The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Call for Submissions and Volunteers

 

ARTICLE SUBMISSIONS: Philosophy professors around the internet are encouraged to e-mail the editor or area editors with requests for submissions to the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy. The Encyclopedia also occasionally considers submissions from A.B.D. graduate students in philosophy. Note our list of 100 most desired articles and the lists of desired articles for each area of philosophy. Prospective authors may propose articles on these or any traditional philosophy topic or figure that is not currently listed in the IEP. Authors may also offer to replace any IEP proto-articles, which are identifiable by the inclusion of the initials IEP at the foot of the article. Please check our list of articles in production to avoid duplicating a topic currently reserved. When contacting the editor, please indicate (a) your educational credentials and/or university affiliation, (b) the provisional title of the proposed article, and (c) a tentative date of completion (six months is typical). Acceptance decisions are based on the quality of the article, with special attention to the accuracy of the coverage of the topic, fairness to alternative positions, and clarity for the intended audience of philosophy students and faculty who are not specialists in the field. Consult the IEP guidelines for authors for information on article format, style, and the licensing agreement. Submitted articles are peer reviewed by academic specialists (see IEP statement of scholarly standards) and are subject to four possible decisions: (1) acceptance in its current form with no revisions; (2) acceptance contingent on some revisions; (3) rejection with an invitation to revise and resubmit; (4) rejection with no invitation to resubmit. Most submitted articles require at least some revision in form or substance before final acceptance.

REFEREES: There is some advice for referees who are making a decision about whether to recommend an article for publication.

AREA EDITORS: Philosophy professors are encouraged to e-mail the editor with requests to be an area editor for the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Please check our list of area editors for open positions. The primary responsibilities of area editors include (1) maintaining a list of most needed articles in the area, (2) recruiting authors for articles, (3) coordinating peer evaluation of articles submitted, and (4) proofreading submitted articles.

VOLUNTEERS: We are seeking volunteers for a variety of tasks at different skill levels:

  • PHP and SQL UI developers - we have an immediate need for volunteers with experience writing custom code in PHP, XHTML, Javascript and SQL statements. Skill with Perl helpful; experience with Web 2.0 RIA very helpful. Please contact the technical editor, Marilynn Lawrence, to volunteer.
  • Formatters: Articles submitted to the IEP are converted to HTML by means of a special IEP formatting tool. Volunteers for this task should have knowledge of basic computer and web formatting skills and an interest in learning to use our HTML conversion program.
  • Copy editors: Copy editors are needed to read through newly accepted articles and make the appropriate changes. Ideally, volunteers for this task should have a B.A. degree in some Humanities discipline, such as Philosophy, English, or History, and have basic copy editing skills; however, you can help even without meeting these qualifications.
  • Recruiters: To help expand the number of articles and the breadth of coverage of important areas of philosophy, we seek recruiters who will systematically contact philosophy departments and organizations requesting submissions. Volunteers for this task will be supplied with form letters written by the IEP Editors, and volunteers will be responsible for tracking down the appropriate e-mail addresses and sending the form letters. The form letters often will need to be customized for the particular organization.
  • Computer consultants: The Encyclopedia is in regular need of special help with computer-related issues, such as Unix-based programming, and the installation of software such as statistics programs and search engines. Volunteers for this task should be professionally trained computer technicians who have experience creating and running websites for businesses or organizations.

Volunteers will work with the Volunteer Coordinator who will assign tasks based on volunteers’ qualifications and monitor the outcomes.

The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy

© 2007