Naturalism

Naturalism is an approach to philosophical problems that interprets them as tractable through the methods of the empirical sciences or at least, without a distinctively a priori project of theorizing. For much of the history of philosophy it has been widely held that philosophy involved a distinctive method, and could achieve knowledge distinct from that attained by the special sciences. Thus, metaphysics and epistemology have often jointly occupied a position of “first philosophy,” laying the necessary grounds for the understanding of reality and the justification of knowledge claims. Naturalism rejects philosophy’s claim to that special status. Whether in epistemology, ethics, philosophy of mind, philosophy of language, or other areas, naturalism seeks to show that philosophical problems as traditionally conceived are ill-formulated and can be solved or displaced by appropriately naturalistic methods. Naturalism often assigns a key role to the methods and results of the empirical sciences, and sometimes aspires to reductionism and physicalism. However, there are many versions of naturalism and some are explicitly non-scientistic. What they share is a repudiation of the view of philosophy as exclusively a priori theorizing concerned with a distinctively philosophical set of questions.

Naturalistic thinking has a long history, but it has been especially prominent since the last decades of the twentieth century, and its influence is felt all across philosophy. This article looks at why and in what ways it is prominent and describes some of the most influential versions of naturalism.

Introduction
Basic Elements of Naturalism Concerning Reality and Knowledge
1. What There Is
2. How We Know
Naturalism in Various Versions and Various Contexts
1. Naturalism in Ethics
2. Naturalism in the Philosophy of Mind
Overview of the Debate About Naturalism
1. Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

“Naturalism” is a term that is applied to many doctrines and positions in philosophy, and in fact, just how it is to be defined is itself a matter of philosophical debate. Still, the overall landscape of naturalism can be surveyed, and that is what we will do here. This discussion will not present a defense or critique of one or another specific version of naturalism. Its aim is to characterize the broad range of views typically identified as naturalistic and to say something about what motivates them. It will also locate the debate about naturalism in the larger setting of philosophical inquiry and theorizing overall.

Different periods in the history of philosophy exhibit different emphases in what are the most prominent and pressing concerns, and there are reasons why different issues are at the forefront at different times. In antiquity, basic questions about the constitution of reality motivated various conceptions about the material substance of things, about whether that substance is material, and about the relation between matter and whatever else might be constitutive of reality. Views ranged from variants of (recognizably naturalistic) materialism to those that included decidedly non-materialist and non-naturalist elements, such as Platonism and Aristotelianism. During the Medieval Period, debates over the status of universals and the nature of the intellect, the will, and the soul were especially central. In large part, this had to do with their significance for issues in natural theology. Also, questions concerning the relation between soul and body and whether and how the soul survives the death of the body were prominent. This was because of their significance for the individuation of persons, the possibility and nature of immortality, and for the nature of providence. These families of issues were prominent in all three of the great Western religious traditions. They are though, enduring philosophical questions. Many of them have roots in the Classical tradition.

In the Early Modern Period debates about the respective roles of reason and the senses in knowledge were especially prominent. They had long been important, but there was a revived interest in skepticism and the possibility of knowledge. Also, debates concerning determinism and free will attained high visibility. In both cases, the explanation had to do, in part, with the impact of dramatic developments in scientific theorizing. Those developments led to large-scale revisions in the conceptions of many things, including human nature and human action. In the twentieth century a focus on questions of meaning and semantic issues played a role in many different philosophical movements (from logical positivism to ordinary language philosophy). It was widely thought that linguistic approaches might untie some age-old philosophical knots.

The main problems of philosophy have not really changed over time, but there are differences in what motivates certain formulations of them and ways of addressing them. Since the Early Modern Period, the methods and the results of the sciences are again playing an increasingly important role in motivating new philosophical conceptions, and indeed, overall conceptions of philosophy itself. Various versions and defenses of naturalism are currently at the center of many philosophical debates. Naturalism is a philosophical view, but one according to which philosophy is not a distinct mode of inquiry with its own problems and its own special body of (possible) knowledge. According to many naturalists, philosophy is a certain sort of reflective attention to the sciences and it is continuous with them. They maintain that this is so not only in the sense that philosophy’s problems are motivated by the sciences, but also in that its methods are not fundamentally distinct. It might be said that the sciences afford us a more systematic, rigorous, and explanatory conception of the world than is supplied by common sense. In turn, we might say that philosophy is motivated by, and remains connected to the scientific conception of the world. There may be ways in which the scientific conception dramatically departs from common sense, but it is rooted in experience and the questions that arise at the level of common sense. Similarly, according to many defenders of naturalism, philosophy is not discontinuous with science. While it attains a kind of generality of conceptions and explanations that is perhaps not attained by the special sciences, it is not an essentially different inquiry. There are no separate philosophical problems that need to be addressed in a distinctive manner. Moreover, philosophy does not yield results that are different in content and kind from what could be attained by the sciences. Thus, in being a view about the world, naturalism is also a view about the nature of philosophy.

It is worthy of remark that while the sources of naturalism go back a very long way in Western philosophy, it has been especially prominent in philosophy in America. The pragmatist tradition, in which philosophers such as C. S. Peirce, William James, John Dewey, W. V. O. Quine, and Richard Rorty are key figures, has been crucial to the development of recent and contemporary naturalism. (There are other key figures in the American pragmatist tradition less clearly associated with its naturalist dimension. In recent years Nelson Goodman [1978; 1979] and Hilary Putnam [1981] are examples.) There is a naturalistic cast to a great deal of pragmatist thought in a number of respects. It regards the general skeptical problem in epistemology as less than genuine. (We will see the significance of this below.) It closely ties meaning to experiential consequences, and it closely ties truth to methods of inquiry and the practical consequences of belief. Also, it often emphasizes the public or social and non-a priori character of inquiry (in contrast to the ego-situated method described by René Descartes, for example). It is anti-foundational, anti-skeptical, and fallibilist. It tends to put a great deal of weight on the accessibility to scientific resolution of genuine intellectual problems. In the American pragmatist tradition there is a wide spectrum of views, of course. But it is an outstanding example of a significant, modern, and still evolving tradition with significant naturalistic currents running in it. Peirce and other American pragmatists have influenced a great deal of recent philosophy of many types. As a result, they are beginning to be more thoroughly studied, after having been widely neglected for several decades.

At numerous places in this discussion we will see that the affirmation of science as the only genuine approach to acquiring knowledge is often a feature of naturalism. However, naturalism is not always narrowly scientistic. There are versions of naturalism that repudiate supernaturalism and various types of a priori theorizing without exclusively championing the natural sciences.

2. Basic Elements of Naturalism Concerning Reality and Knowledge

The debate about naturalism ranges across many areas of philosophy, including metaphysics, epistemology, ethics, and philosophy of mind, just to mention areas where it is especially prominent. There are two basic dimensions in which the debate takes place. One of them concerns (to put it simply) what there is, and the other concerns methods of acquiring belief and knowledge. There are several affiliated issues (supervenience, objectivity, various realism/antirealism debates, the character of norms of epistemic justification, the theory of meaning, and so forth) but they are all connected through those two main concerns.

a. What There Is

With respect to the first, the naturalist maintains that all of what there is belongs to the natural world. Obviously, a great deal turns on how nature is understood. But the key point is that an accurate, adequate conception of the world does not (according to the naturalist) include reference to supernatural entities or agencies. According to the naturalist, there are no Platonic forms, Cartesian mental substances, Kantian noumena, or any other agents, powers, or entities that do not (in some broad sense) belong to nature. As a very loose characterization, it may suffice to say that nature is the order of things accessible to us through observation and the methods of the empirical sciences. If some other method, such as a priori theorizing, is needed to have access to the alleged entity or to the truth in question, then it is not a real entity or a genuine truth. According to the naturalist, there is only the natural order. If something is postulated or claimed to exist, but is not described in the vocabulary that describes natural phenomena, and not studied by the inquiries that study natural phenomena, it is not something we should recognize as real.

Unsurprisingly, the success of the sciences has been one of the main motivations for thinkers to embrace naturalism. The sciences have proved to be powerful tools for making the world intelligible. They seem to have such a strong claim to yield genuine knowledge that it is widely thought that whatever there is, is a proper object of science. That does not require that in embracing naturalism one also embrace determinism, physicalism, and reductionism. (However, it is true that many advocates of some or all of those are also very often naturalists.) While those specific theses about the structure or character of the world are not essential features of naturalism, many who endorse naturalism believe that over time scientific progress will make the case for physicalism, in particular. Even if, for example, attempts to provide fully reductive accounts of mental phenomena, certain biological phenomena, and values do not succeed, that would not be an insurmountable impediment to physicalism; or, at least that is the view of some defenders of naturalism. There is only the physical natural order, even if there are various constituents and aspects of it that are to be described in their own non-reducible vocabularies.

Naturalism could be said to involve a denial that there is any distinctively metaphysical area of inquiry. Thus, even if one’s preferred interpretation of naturalism is not reductionist or even physicalist (in a non-reductionist form), naturalism is a conception of reality as homogeneous in the sense that there is one natural order that comprises all of reality. There are no objects or properties that can only be identified or comprehended by metaphysical theorizing or non-empirical understanding. What exactly is the true theory of that single natural order may remain open to dispute. The key points are that our conception of reality need include nothing that is exclusively accessible to a priori theorizing, or to “first philosophy,” and there is only one natural order.

b. How We Know

For naturalistic epistemology, the main claim is roughly the following: the acquisition of belief and knowledge is a (broadly) causal process within the natural order, and a priori norms, principles, and methods are not essential to the acquisition or justification of beliefs and knowledge. Compare David Hume and Descartes, for example. Hume explains our acceptance of beliefs on the basis of habits of association—causal tendencies that we can reflectively articulate into rules of epistemic practice. There are processes of belief acquisition and acceptance, but they are not underwritten by principles formulated a priori, nor are they structured by such principles. Epistemology is part of the overall science of human nature. It is not a project that is prior to or independent of the empirical sciences. There are norms of belief acceptance and of inquiry, but they are derived from consideration of experience and practice. (Here too, there is also an important point of contrast with Kant and also with the Platonic theory of knowledge as recollection of innate ideas, as well as with Descartes.)

Descartes held that the norms and method of belief acceptance must be independent of experience, and must have their grounds in reason alone. Otherwise, they would be vulnerable to exactly the sorts of skeptical objections that led to the search for epistemic principles in the first place. Even if one does not defend rationalism or a conception of the synthetic a priori, one might still think (as most philosophers have) that there are certain distinctively philosophical epistemological issues that can be dealt with only by distinctively philosophical (that is, a priori) methods. Hume and Descartes’ positions are rather like bookends, and there are many other, less “pure” or radical positions, in between theirs. But they are excellent examples of a causal-empirical approach on the one hand and a rationalist-a priori normative approach on the other.

There is a vast contemporary literature on the extent to which epistemology can be naturalized and what a naturalized epistemology would or should look like. At the core of the controversy is whether we need a philosophical theory in order to understand knowledge or epistemic justification, or is the so-called “problem of knowledge” really just another (broadly) empirical problem. If it is, then perhaps it can be addressed by the methods of the sciences (psychology, linguistics, neuroscience, cognitive science, etc.). This is not just the same as the debate between rationalists and empiricists, though it is related to it. It is open to an empiricist to argue that there are analytic truths that are known just by consideration of their meanings, and that this knowledge is not explicable in exclusively naturalistic terms. Similarly, if there are conceptual truths or logical truths that are not explicated in naturalistic terms, then that could be an important part of an empiricism that is not also a variant of naturalism. Still, there are some affinities between empiricism and naturalism that make them plausible candidates for having close relations.

Most epistemological theories are not as purely rationalistic as Descartes’. Also, though Kant’s influence has been enormous, there are few contemporary theorists who accept the conception of synthetic a priori knowledge on the basis of Kant’s transcendental idealism. Nonetheless, many epistemologists argue that fundamental issues concerning skepticism and the nature of epistemic justification cannot be successfully handled by the resources of naturalism. Or, they argue that they can only be handled in a question begging way by those resources. On the other hand, naturalists insist that there is nothing for a priori epistemology to be. Unless epistemology remains fully grounded in and tethered to the practices of scientific inquiry and the results they yield, it is cut off from the only sorts of evidence and strategies of explanation that can be conclusively vindicated or confirmed.

Recent decades have seen the development of not only different versions of naturalized epistemology, but also different overall approaches to it. One of the key distinctions is between what are sometimes called “replacement” theories and theories that develop naturalistic accounts of epistemic justification instead of repudiating the traditional epistemological project. The former are attempts to abandon the normative issue of epistemic justification. They substitute for it a more fully descriptive and causal account of our beliefs.

For example, at some points in his career, Quine openly rejected the traditional project of justification (at least as he construed it). He sought to fully assimilate epistemology to psychology (broadly construed), making it a part of empirical science, rather than a special inquiry that might underwrite scientific knowledge claims. He held that we should abandon (as hopeless) the project of identifying epistemically privileged foundational beliefs and inferring other beliefs from them, via a priori rules. Moreover, there is no clean break between supposed analytic truths on the one hand and synthetic truths on the other, and there is no realm of meanings distinct from linguistic behavior and the rest of behavior that it is embedded in. The philosophical distinction between truths of meaning and truths of fact does not reflect a genuine, explanatorily significant distinction. Like the entire project of a priori epistemology, it is a misrepresentation of what the actual problems of knowledge are. Also, while Hume had shown that there is no a priori justification of inductive inference, Quine maintained that that does not leave us with a profound skeptical difficulty. Rather, we are to examine and adjust our inductive practices in light of what we find to be empirically effective and supported without first (or ever) requiring that they be justified on non-empirical grounds. There is no “first philosophy” that underwrites science.

Other defenders of naturalistic epistemology, such as Alvin Goldman (1979; 1986), have developed causal accounts of justified beliefs or of knowledge, but still regard the philosophical project of epistemology as a genuine project, though it is to be carried out with naturalistic resources. We still are to speak in terms of beliefs being justified. In that respect there are versions of naturalism that continue to regard epistemology as involving normative considerations about belief and knowledge. Also, if we ascertain what is involved in beliefs being caused by reliable processes, we can deflect or defeat various general skeptical challenges. Those can be taken seriously, but naturalism can meet them. In meeting them, we will have attained substantive conditions of justification, but without requiring that they be accessible to a cognitive agent in order to be fulfilled. The causality of justified beliefs is one thing; whether an agent can articulate grounds for his beliefs is another. Justification can be explicated in non-epistemic terms, in terms of processes that are reliably truth-conducive. The problems of epistemology admit of naturalistic solutions, but need not repudiate the problems as unwelcome and less than genuine philosophical artifice.

Both the more and the less radical approaches share the central claim that the correct account of knowledge is in terms of reliable processes of belief-acquisition that are themselves explicated in empirical, and mainly causal, terms. The true beliefs of cognitive subjects, we might say, are one type of phenomenon that occurs in the natural world. We need not leave the latter in order to explain the former. There is no stand-alone problem of epistemic justification, requiring its own distinctive vocabulary and evidential considerations. Epistemic value, we might say, can be interpreted in terms of naturalistic facts and properties.

3. Naturalism in Various Versions and Various Contexts

On the basis of the discussion so far, it might appear that naturalism is more or less a type of scientism, the view that only the methods of the sciences are legitimate in seeking knowledge, and that only the things recognized by the sciences as real are real. There are indeed naturalists who hold that view, but it is not a necessary feature of naturalism. As noted at the outset, there is considerable debate over what sorts of views should be recognized as naturalistic. There are theorists who wish to identify their views and approaches as naturalistic without embracing reductionist physicalism. There are also some approaches that can plausibly be described as naturalistic that are quite self-consciously anti-scientistic. In particular, there are philosophers who have been influenced by the later work of Ludwig Wittgenstein (1953) who regard their general approach as naturalistic, though it is just as critical of scientism as it is of traditional metaphysics.

This is not to say that Wittgenstein was deliberately making a case for naturalism. Rather, because of his emphasis on the importance of looking at actual practice, the significance of the wider social context of practices, and the avoidance of a priori theorizing, his work can be seen as having features of naturalism. Like G. E. Moore before him, Wittgenstein argued that the refutation of skeptical hypotheses is not required in order to succeed in making knowledge claims, and that we have knowledge of the external world without first proving that such knowledge is possible. Moreover, Wittgenstein rejected the view that there is some single, global method (including the scientific method) for arriving at a true account of the world, and his approach is explicitly oriented to honoring the differences between contexts. This is evident in his discussion of language games, for example. His philosophical explorations are anti-reductionist. They disavow any attempt to capture and explain everything in the terms of some overall theory within one or another special science. He vigorously opposed the attempt to force phenomena to “fit” some preferred theory or vocabulary. Indeed, in some important ways, his work is anti-theoretical without being anti-philosophical. (The same might be said of Thomas Reid [1785] in the eighteenth century. It is also plausible to regard his views as naturalistic in important respects. One can see this especially in contrast to Kant, for example.)

If it is appropriate to describe this approach as naturalistic it is because of the ways in which Wittgenstein insisted that philosophical examination should look closely at the facts and should avoid theorizing about them in ways that lead to a large scale reconceiving of them or to postulation of entities, agencies, and processes. Very often the truth is disclosed by looking carefully, rather than by discovering something “behind” or distinct from what we encounter in experience. There is not some order of the “really real” or a transcendent order beyond what we meet with in the natural world. Yet, this does not mean that only a narrowly scientific understanding of it is a correct understanding. That sort of view itself would be an example of an overly restrictive approach that misrepresents the world and our understanding of it.

In addition, Wittgenstein was especially concerned to understand normative issues (such as the normativity involved in the use of concepts and in engaging in various practices) without explaining them away or reducing them to something non-normative. There are important normative issues even in contexts where we are not directly investigating questions concerning values. All sorts of practices, including various kinds of thinking and the use of language, have normative dimensions. Their normativity cannot be reduced to the occurrence of this or that event, or state, or causal process. For example, there may be no specific physical or psychological state or process that underlies or causally explains how a person is able to go on applying a concept to new cases, and to use a term in indefinitely many new situations, and to do so correctly in ways that are understood by others. That might mean that there is an irreducible normativity involved in the use of concepts and terms. There is nothing metaphysically exotic about that. It does not indicate that there are special normative entities or properties in addition to the practices and activities in question. There just is the normative, but natural activity of speaking, understanding, and making judgments. These are altogether familiar to all of us. If we want to understand what makes for the correct use of a term, for example, we should look at the way that it is used rather than look for some other fact or entity underlying its use. There is no special realm of meanings, or a thinking substance that grasps them, or a world of universals outside of space and time that is grasped by thought. (It is noteworthy that Plato understood the forms to be not only real, but normative realities.)

Many approaches to meaning, to the explication of inference and thought in general, and to the acquisition of concepts that have been influenced by Wittgenstein (see Wittgenstein on meaning), are naturalistic in an anti-metaphysical regard and in their close descriptive attention to the actual facts and natural and social contexts of the phenomena at issue. Traditional, central, philosophical debates, such as those between realism and nominalism in regard to universals, are purportedly deflated by Wittgensteinian approaches. That makes it plausible to regard them as naturalistic in at least a broad sense, though there is a very wide spectrum of Wittgenstein-influenced views and of Wittgenstein interpretation. Many different “-isms” can be interpretively connected to Wittgenstein’s work. Some Wittgensteinians and interpreters of Wittgenstein seem to support antirealism and nominalism. Others present views plausibly described as realist, but in a distinctively Wittgensteinian way. The range of Wittgenstein-influenced views is so wide, in large part, because he refused to be drawn into the use of many of the prevailing formulations of issues.

Wittgensteinian approaches have been very influential in the philosophy of social explanation, an area in which there has long been a debate about whether the methods of the natural sciences are appropriate to the kinds of phenomena it is claimed are uniquely encountered in social explanation. This is a place where we can see the breadth of the field of interpretation of naturalism. In one sense, Wittgensteinian approaches are naturalistic, in the ways described. At the same time, they are decidedly not naturalistic, if by “naturalism” we mean that the categories, concepts, and methods of the natural sciences are the only ones that are needed to explain whatever there is.

There are some affinities between Wittgenstein and some currents in American pragmatism with respect to the emphasis on the importance of the shared, public world for understanding language and the significance of practices. In particular, recent work by Richard Rorty (1979; 1982) has been important in drawing attention to that tradition and reinvigorating pragmatism in a post-Wittgensteinian context. His views and others like them have also attracted a great deal of criticism, reinvigorating debates about the interpretation and plausibility of naturalism. At the center of the debate is the issue of whether there are enduring philosophical problems about the nature of reality, and truth, and about value, for example, or just the more concrete, contingent, but still significant problems that individuals and societies encounter in the business of living.

As might be expected, many naturalistic thinkers feel discomfort at being grouped with Wittgenstein under the same heading. They regard his approach as unscientific and as much more permissive in regard to interpretation than more empirically fastidious approaches can accept. Still, it is plausible to regard at least some of Wittgenstein’s views as naturalistic even though they constitute a version of naturalism that differs from others in important respects.

a. Naturalism in Ethics

Ethics is a context in which there are important non-scientistic versions of naturalism. For example, there are respects in which neo-Aristotelian virtue ethics can be regarded as naturalistic. It does not involve a non-natural source or realm of moral value, as does Kant’s ethical theory, or Plato’s or Moore’s. For Aristotle, judgments of what are goods for a human being are based upon considerations about human capacities, propensities, and the conditions for successful human activity of various kinds. Thus, while it is not a scientistic conception of human agency or moral value, it also contrasts clearly with many clearly non-naturalistic conceptions of agency and moral value. Central to the view are the notions that there are goods proper to human nature and that the virtues are excellent states of character enabling an agent to act well and realize those goods. This can be construed as naturalism in that many defenders of the view, especially recent ones, have argued that familiar versions of the so-called “fact-value distinction” are seriously mistaken. Correlatively, they have argued that the distinction between descriptive meaning and evaluative meaning is mistaken. Their view is that various types of factual considerations have ethical significance—not as a non-natural supervening property, and not merely expressively or projectively. The agent with virtues is able to acknowledge and appreciate the ethical significance of factual considerations, and act upon them accordingly.

While it is apt to call this “naturalism,” it is quite different from some paradigmatic examples of moral naturalism, such as the hedonistic utilitarianism of John Stuart Mill. Mill attempted to explain moral value in non-moral (naturalistic) terms—in terms of what people desire for its own sake and what they find pleasing. He sought to do this without any non-empirical assumptions or commitments about what people should desire, or what are proper goods for human beings. (He tried to make distinctions between inferior and superior pleasures on an empirical basis independent of antecedent normative commitments.) This is an attempt to demystify moral value by showing that it can be explained (even if not outright defined) in terms of facts and properties that are themselves non-moral and accessible to observation and the methods of the sciences. Other theorists, whether or not they accept Mill’s conception of what in fact has moral value, have pursued the project of theorizing in the same general direction in so far as they wish to show that moral values can be understood in terms of natural (including social) facts and properties.

In some respects, this is analogous to showing how, say, biological phenomena are explicable in physico-chemical terms. There are theories of moral value according to which it is constituted by, supervenes upon, or is defined in terms of non-moral, natural facts and properties. (Each is a different account of the relation between the moral and the non-moral. They are not simply different ways of saying the same thing.) This does not turn moral thought into a department of natural science, but it does mean that the explanation of what moral thought is about may very well depend extensively upon scientific methods. There may be regular and even law-like relations between non-moral facts and properties on the one hand, and moral facts and properties on the other. It may be that moral concepts are not entailed by or reducible to non-moral ones, but moral values have no independent ontological standing and are not essentially different in kind from natural phenomena in the way that Moore, for example, understood them to be. At the same time, moral values are real, and there are moral facts. The evaluative meaning of moral judgments is not merely expressive (see non-cognitivism in ethics). Moral judgments report moral facts, and moral claims are literally true or false. There are numerous versions of naturalistic moral realism.

There are other versions of ethical naturalism that owe much more to Hume and make the case for antirealism rather than realism. It was central to Hume’s moral theory that there are no value-entities or special faculties for perceiving or knowing them. According to Hume, moral value and moral motivation are to be explained in terms of facts about human sensibility. In this type of view, moral judgments are to be interpreted projectively, but they are also to be regarded as having all the form and force of cognitive discourse. On the one hand, commitment to objective values (with all of their alleged metaphysical and epistemological difficulties) is avoided. On the other hand, there is ample scope for moral argument, for critical assessment of moral views, and for regarding moral language as having much richer meaning than just being emotive in a person-relative way. The learning of moral concepts, the practice of reason-giving, and the adjustment of moral beliefs that we take to be part of moral experience and practice really are parts of it, though their genuineness does not depend upon there being moral facts or objective values. All that is needed is a common human sensibility and our propensity to make action-guiding judgments. To defenders of this approach, naturalism is not a way of explaining away moral values, or translating moral language into non-moral language. Instead it is the project of explaining all that moral values can be, in terms of sensibility, and showing how that is sufficient for full-fledged morality. It may be instructive to interpret this account of moral thought and discourse as analogous to Hume’s treatment of causal thought and discourse. There too, he severely criticized realist interpretations, but he also sought to show that his account could preserve the significance and the form of causal claims and causal reasoning. In that regard, the Humean approach can be said to explain moral judgments and causal judgments, rather than explaining them away.

Some Humean-influenced views of morality put weight on the role of evolutionary explanations. They can be important to the story of how there came to be creatures with morally relevant sentiments and moral concern, and also why certain kinds of cooperative and coordinated behavior—certain types of moral behavior—well-serve us as a species, and are regarded by us as valuable. That does not mean that we are “naturally” moral, but that naturalistic explanations are central to the account of the possibility and character of morality. The Humean-influenced approach (of which there are many variants) to meta-ethics is not reductive naturalism, but it certainly seems to count as a type of naturalism. And, as we have noted, special argumentation is needed to show why naturalism would have to be reductive.

There are also versions of evolutionary ethics that are not much influenced by Hume. Ethical theories strongly influenced by evolutionary thinking but without ties to Hume’s philosophy were developed in the latter half of the nineteenth century and the first half of the twentieth. Some were crude variants of Social Darwinism, but others were sophisticated attempts to show the naturalistic origin and ground of ethical value and practice. (Thomas Henry Huxley [1893] is a good example of a subtle, sophisticated nineteenth century exponent of the role of evolution in ethics.) In recent decades there have been important developments in this tradition, incorporating knowledge of genetics and animal behavior and its physiological bases.

In general terms, evolutionary ethics attempts to show that the attitudes, motives, and practices that are part and parcel of ethical life are to be accounted for in terms of how they are adaptive. Virtues, vices, moral rules and principles, and so forth do not have an independent standing, or a basis in a priori reasoning. Moral values are not detected by a quasi-perceptual moral sense or by a faculty of intuition. This does not mean that morally significant behavior is robotic or uninfluenced by judgment and reasoning. Rather, the point is that needs are met by certain dispositions, susceptibilities, and behaviors, and the presence of those things themselves is explicable in terms of selective advantage in the struggle for existence. Altruism and various patterns of coordinated behaviors are explained in terms of the biological benefits they confer. They enhance fitness. That there is morality and concern for moral issues at all are facts that can be accounted for in terms of an account of how we came to be, and came to be the sorts of animals we are in a process of natural selection. Defenders of this view argue that only if one thinks morality must have its source in God or reason would one find this threatening to morality. It does not subvert virtue, or render moral motivation something base or no more than an animal function, like digestion or excretion. Morality is a no less real or significant part of our lives, but it is in our lives at all, in the ways that it is, because of our evolutionary history. We need not look elsewhere.

b. Naturalism in the Philosophy of Mind

The philosophy of mind is another area in which naturalistic views have been prominent and highly controversial in recent times. Many theorists hold that the categories, concepts, and vocabulary needed to explain consciousness, experience, thought, and language are those of the natural sciences (and perhaps some of the social sciences, understood naturalistically). The impetus for this view comes from a number of directions, including developments in biological sciences, linguistics, artificial intelligence, and cognitive science. To many theorists it seems increasingly clear, or at least plausible, that the mind is as fully a part of nature as anything else. They hold that while the properties and processes of mental life may have distinctive features, (which, admittedly, may be especially difficult to study and to understand) they are not ultimately inexplicable by the methods of the sciences. The study of them is especially complicated because of the ways in which biochemical, physiological, social, developmental, and many other processes and events interact. But according to the naturalist, the mind is not “outside of nature.” It operates in accordance with principles fundamentally like those that govern other natural phenomena. Here again, the naturalist need not be a reductionist physicalist. The theorist of mind may be a non-reductionist physicalist (taking the view that the mental supervenes on the physical) or not take an explicit stand on physicalism one way or the other. Rather, the naturalist with respect to philosophy of mind may emphasize the claim that the study of the mind does not involve any methods other than those recognized in the various natural sciences. It requires no commitments to the existence of entities and properties other than those recognized in the sciences.

As before, Plato, Descartes, and Kant are excellent examples of non-naturalism concerning the mind. Their theories differ in important ways, but they all share the principle that the mind and its activities are not physical and are not governed by the laws of nature. This is not because of pre-scientific ignorance or lack of sophistication. It is because they found it virtually or literally incoherent that awareness, comprehension, and the activity of thought should just be part of what goes on in the natural order. Many theorists still find that incoherent. They argue that either the object of cognition is something non-natural, such as a state of affairs, or a proposition, or a universal (or a complex of instances of universals), or that cognition itself is something non-natural—or that both are. Thinking, the objects of thought, and the relations between them (which are often necessary relations, but not causally necessary relations) seem to be matters that are not susceptible to being rendered in naturalistic terms. (It may be that the objects of cognition are not exactly the same things as the objects of perception, which are natural objects and also artifacts made by human beings.) Indeed, even apart from disputes focused on naturalism these are some of the persistent, fundamental problems of philosophy of mind, and its relations to epistemology, metaphysics, and philosophy of language.

Modern critics of naturalism often point to (at least) two especially significant problem areas for naturalism. One of them concerns how a naturalistic conception of mind is to handle intentional states—states such as belief, desire, hope, fear, and others that have objects. These are expressed in the form, “X believes that…” or “X hopes that…” and so forth. These are states that are about something. Many mental states are intentional in this way, and this feature of being about something seems to be distinctive of mental states. A state of temperature, or a quantity, or a positive or negative charge, or a valence, or combustion, or the suppression of an immunological response is not about something. These and other states, events, and processes have causes (and effects) but do not have objects. They are not directed at anything in the way that many mental states are. There are difficult questions concerning the nature of intentionality and also the nature and status of the objects of intentional states. Are the latter propositions, or states of affairs, or something else? Many mental states (such as belief) seem to be representational. How is representation to be understood?

A second issue is the following. Is understanding the meaning of a sentence, or the grasp of a mathematical truth, or the grasp of other sorts of necessary truths (as in logic) something that can be exhaustively explained in terms confined to the language of the natural sciences and its referents? In addition to questions about how thought has intentional objects and about the objects of thought, there are questions about the form and structure of thought and whether they are susceptible to naturalistic treatment. Is the necessity of logical validity something that can be completely accounted for in causal-empirical terms? Are relations between concepts supervenient upon, or explicable in terms of, relations between events? Are they resistant to assimilation into natural causal processes, even if they are dependent upon them? (There are analogies here to the issue of epistemic justification and the status of moral values, which too may be dependent upon naturalistic phenomena, though not simply “nothing but” naturalistic phenomena.)

The insistence that the mind is not a separate substance is not sufficient to make for naturalism about the mind. Similarly, insisting that we can only learn language and develop cognitive abilities because of the way we have evolved is not enough to underwrite naturalism. It is not a view only about what is relevant to explain or understand a certain range of phenomena. It is a view about what is sufficient to do so. Substance dualism is very much out of favor, but it is hardly the only alternative to naturalism with regard to the mind. In this context, as in the other contexts, there is a broad range of views, many of them naturalistic, many of them not. It is not as though there is a single, prevailing naturalistic theory of mind. The debate about what naturalism about the mind should look like remains very much open and ongoing.

4. Overview of the Debate About Naturalism

The debate about naturalism remains so very much alive and so complex. Much of it concerns just how narrowly or broadly to construe naturalism and how open it should be to the form and content of what is accepted as belonging to science. What if our best understanding of the sciences indicates that reductionism is at best “local,” confined to certain areas, and there is no single, fundamental level of description in which all scientific truths can be expressed? And what if the interpretation of the “physical” is expanded to include supervenient properties, including mental properties, and moral values? Would that be a defeat for naturalism, or only for certain versions of it? Or, suppose a theorist claimed that philosophy could dispense with a priori theorizing or with attempts to arrive at highly general theories altogether (the theory of knowledge, the theory of morality, the theory of meaning, etc.), say, in the manner of the later Wittgenstein? Would that rejection of “first philosophy” and the search for foundations or essences constitute a kind of naturalism? We can imagine a defender of that approach answering in the affirmative, and other self-avowed naturalists finding that inappropriate and misleading. In their view naturalism requires certain quite specific commitments about what there is and how it can be known or explained.

This does not mean that the debate about naturalism is merely or mainly verbal. There are significant, substantive issues involved. Some of them concern just how naturalism is to be interpreted, and some of them concern the truth of naturalism in one or another area. These are not matters of stipulation, but difficult, complex issues. In trying to resolve them there is considerable traffic back and forth between philosophical theorizing and empirical science. One could, for example, be a naturalist about moral value, but not a “global” naturalist, a naturalist about all things. Moral theorizing has some important relations with epistemology, metaphysics, and philosophy of mind, but one need not tackle all of those issues and relations at once in order to assess the claims of naturalism in one area. Or, at least that appears to be a workable approach. At the same time, part of the appeal of naturalism is its potentially global scope. It has the apparent merit of providing a single, or at least integrated overall account of what there is, and what it is like, and how it works—including the actions, experiences, and thoughts of rational animals.

a. Conclusion

Totalizing views have often had considerable appeal to philosophers. Such views promise to make the world intelligible with a single array of fundamental concepts. They purport to overcome the perplexities attending views in which the world is ultimately heterogeneous, with objects, properties, and processes of fundamentally different kinds, belonging to different categories. Objective idealism such as Hegel’s is one sort of totalizing view, and so is global naturalism, though the two are radically different from each other. Spinoza’s metaphysical theory according to which there is just one substance is another totalizing view, and so is phenomenalism, in its own way. Each is an attempt to produce the widest and most thorough intelligibility by identifying a small number of basic categories and principles through which things can be understood.

It is understandable that a great deal of philosophical theorizing should have a tendency to be reductionist or to seek a “privileged” vocabulary for describing the ultimate constituents of reality or the basic activities or processes that govern it. After all, many philosophers conceive the project of philosophy to include the task of articulating an account of the most general features of reality, knowledge, value, and so forth. In one respect, naturalism resists that tendency, in so far as it rejects the project of a priori theorizing as hopeless, irrelevant, or obsolete. Given the guiding intellectual disposition of naturalism, it seems that it would countenance as real whatever the progress of (empirical) enquiry indicates is required for complete explanations. It would be open to what is found. Rather than fashioning a completely general and abstract conception of reality, it focuses on the substantive explanations and theories that are developed in specific areas of inquiry. According to naturalism, if philosophy becomes detached from those, it is mere theory-building and does not afford us real understanding.

In another respect though, naturalism is a decidedly philosophical approach and an entrant in the grand debate about what is the true global view. As noted above, naturalism is itself a philosophical view, though it claims to be a rejection of a great deal that historically has been distinctive of philosophy. Even if naturalism is articulated in strictly empirical terms, and strives to be scientific, we are still faced with the issue of whether strictly empirical terms are adequate to capture and express all that there is and all we can know. It is not as though naturalism can avoid questions about whether it is itself a true view, and all the associated concerns about how to interpret truth, and what would make it a true view. The issue of whether naturalism is true may be the sort of issue that is not clearly resolvable in exclusively naturalistic terms. At least it seems that the view that it can be, is itself a distinctively philosophical view. Once we begin to explore such questions, we are of course doing philosophy, even if our aim is to make the case for naturalism.

For critiques of naturalism, see the Social Science article.

5. References and Further Reading

This list indicates titles of selected sources and is not an attempt to be exhaustive. It includes some of the most relevant works of thinkers referred to in the article and also some important works by thinkers who are not named in the article.

Aristotle. Nicomachean Ethics.
Blackburn, Simon (1988). “How To be an Ethical Anti-realist,” Midwest Studies in Philosophy 12, pp. 361-375.
Blackburn, Simon (1998). Ruling Passions, Oxford University Press.
Churchland, P. M. (1988). Matter and Consciousness, MIT Press.
Descartes, René (1641). Meditations on First Philosophy.
Dewey, John (1920). Reconstruction in Philosophy, N.Y.: Henry Holt and Company.
Dewey, John (1925). Experience and Nature, Chicago: Open Court.
Foot, Philippa (2003). Natural Goodness, Oxford University Press.
Gibbard, Alan (1990). Wise Choices, Apt Feelings: A Theory of Normative Judgment, Oxford University Press.
Goldman, Alvin (1979) “What is Justified Belief?” in George S. Pappas Justification and Knowledge Dordrecht, pp. 1-23.
Goldman, Alvin (1986). Epistemology and Cognition, Harvard University Press
Goodman, Nelson (1978). Ways of Worldmaking, Hackett Publishing Company.
Goodman, Nelson (1979). Fact, Fiction, and Forecast, Harvard University Press.
Hume, David (1748). An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding.
Hume, David (1751). An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals.
Huxley, Thomas Henry (1893). Evolution and Ethics, Pilot Press.
Jackson, Frank (1982). “Epiphenomenal Qualia” The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 32, No. 127 April, pp. 127-136.
James, William (1907/1979). Pragmatism: A New Name for Some Old Ways of Thinking, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1979 (originally published in 1907).
Kant, Immanuel (1781/87). Critique of Pure Reason, Werner Pluhar (trans.), Indianapolis: Hackett, 1996. (First edition originally published in 1781, second edition in 1787.)
Kant, Immanuel (1783). Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics, Gary Hatfield (trans.), New York: Cambridge University Press, 1997 (originally published in1783).
Kim, Jaegwon: “What Is ‘Naturalized Epistemology’?” Philosophical Perspectives 2, James E. Tomberlin (ed.), Asascadero, CA: Ridgeview Publishing Co., pp. 381-406.
Kornblith, Hilary, ed. (1985). Naturalizing Epistemology, MIT Press.
McDowell, John (1995). “Two Sorts of Naturalism” in Virtues and Reasons: Philippa Foot and Moral Theory, Rosalind Hursthouse, Gavin Lawrence, and Warren Quinn (eds.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, pp. 149-79.
McDowell, John (1996). Mind and World, Harvard University Press.
Mill, John Stuart (1861/1998). Utilitarianism, Roger Crips (ed.), Oxford University Press. (Originally published in 1861).
Moore, G. E. (1925). “A Defense of Common Sense,” Contemporary British Philosophy (2nd series), ed. J. H. Muirhead. Reprinted in Moore (1959c).
Moore, G. E. (1959a). “Proof of the External World” Ch. 7 of Moore (1959b), pp. 126-148.
Moore, G. E. (1959b). Philosophical Papers. London: George, Allen and Unwin.
Peirce, Charles Sanders (1898/1992). Reasoning and the Logic of Things: The Cambridge Conference Lectures of 1898, Kenneth Laine Ketner (ed., intro.) and Hilary Putnam (intro., comm.), Harvard University Press, 1992.
Peirce, Charles Sanders (1903/1997). Pragmatism as a Principle and Method of Right Thinking: The 1903 Harvard Lectures on Pragmatism, Patricia Ann Turrisi (ed.), SUNY Press.
Plato. Republic.
Plato. Theaetetus.
Plato. Sophist.
Putnam, Hilary (1981). Reason, Truth and History, Cambridge University Press.
Quine, W. V. O. (1969a). “Epistemology Naturalized,” Ontological Relativity and Other Essays, New York: Columbia University Press.
Quine, W. V. O. (1969b). “Natural Kinds,”Ontological Relativity and Other Essays, New York: Columbia University Press.
Quine, W. V. O. (1990). Pursuit of Truth, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
Reid, Thomas (1785). Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man.
Rorty, Richard (1979). Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature, Princeton University Press.
Rorty, Richard (1982). Consequences of Pragmatism, University of Minnesota Press.
Ruse, Michael (1986). Taking Darwin Seriously: A Naturalistic Approach to Philosophy, N.Y.: Blackwell.
Ruse, Michael & Wilson, E. O. (1985). “The Evolution of Ethics,” New Scientist 108, pp. 50-52.
Searle, John (1980). “Minds, Brains and Programs,” Behavioral and Brain Sciences 3, pp. 417-57.
Searle, John (1983). Intentionality: An Essay in the Philosophy of Mind. Cambridge University Press.
Trigg, Roger (1982). The Shaping of Man: Philosophical Aspects of Sociobiology, Oxford: Blackwell.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig (1953). Philosophical Investigations, New York: Macmillan.

Author Information

Jon Jacobs
Email: jojacobs@jjay.cuny.edu
Colgate University
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Law

law_scales Philosophy of law (or legal philosophy) is concerned with providing a general philosophical analysis of law and legal institutions. Issues in the field range from abstract conceptual questions about the nature of law and legal systems to normative questions about the relationship between law and morality and the justification for various legal institutions.

Topics in legal philosophy tend to be more abstract than related topics in political philosophy and applied ethics. For example, whereas the question of how properly to interpret the U.S. Constitution belongs to democratic theory (and hence falls under the heading of political philosophy), the analysis of legal interpretation falls under the heading of legal philosophy. Likewise, whereas the question of whether capital punishment is morally permissible falls under the heading of applied ethics, the question of whether the institution of punishment can be justified falls under the heading of legal philosophy.

There are roughly three categories into which the topics of legal philosophy fall: analytic jurisprudence, normative jurisprudence, and critical theories of law. Analytic jurisprudence involves providing an analysis of the essence of law so as to understand what differentiates it from other systems of norms, such as ethics. Normative jurisprudence involves the examination of normative, evaluative, and otherwise prescriptive issues about the law, such as restrictions on freedom, obligations to obey the law, and the grounds for punishment. Finally, critical theories of law, such as critical legal studies and feminist jurisprudence, challenge more traditional forms of legal philosophy.

Analytic Jurisprudence
Normative Jurisprudence
Critical Theories of Law
References and Further Reading

1. Analytic Jurisprudence

The principal objective of analytic jurisprudence has traditionally been to provide an account of what distinguishes law as a system of norms from other systems of norms, such as ethical norms. As John Austin describes the project, analytic jurisprudence seeks “the essence or nature which is common to all laws that are properly so called” (Austin 1995, p. 11). Accordingly, analytic jurisprudence is concerned with providing necessary and sufficient conditions for the existence of law that distinguish law from non-law.

While this task is usually interpreted as an attempt to analyze the concepts of law and legal system, there is some confusion as to both the value and character of conceptual analysis in philosophy of law. As Brian Leiter (1998) points out, philosophy of law is one of the few philosophical disciplines that takes conceptual analysis as its principal concern; most other areas in philosophy have taken a naturalistic turn, incorporating the tools and methods of the sciences. To clarify the role of conceptual analysis in law, Brian Bix (1995) distinguishes a number of different purposes that can be served by conceptual claims:

to track linguistic usage;
to stipulate meanings;
to explain what is important or essential about a class of objects; and
to establish an evaluative test for the concept-word.

Bix takes conceptual analysis in law to be primarily concerned with (3) and (4).

In any event, conceptual analysis of law remains an important, if controversial, project in contemporary legal theory. Conceptual theories of law can be divided into two main headings: (a) those that affirm there is a conceptual relation between law and morality and (b) those that deny that there is such a relation. Nevertheless, Ronald Dworkin’s view is often characterized as a third theory partly because it is not clear where he stands on the question of whether there is a conceptual relation between law and morality.

a. Natural Law Theory

All forms of natural law theory subscribe to the Overlap Thesis, which is that there is a necessary relation between the concepts of law and morality. According to this view, then, the concept of law cannot be fully articulated without some reference to moral notions. Though the Overlap Thesis may seem unambiguous, there are a number of different ways in which it can be interpreted.

The strongest form of the Overlap Thesis underlies the classical naturalism of St. Thomas Aquinas and William Blackstone. As Blackstone describes the thesis:

This law of nature, being co-eval with mankind and dictated by God himself, is of course superior in obligation to any other. It is binding over all the globe, in all countries, and at all times: no human laws are of any validity, if contrary to this; and such of them as are valid derive all their force, and all their authority, mediately or immediately, from this original (1979, p. 41).

In this passage, Blackstone articulates the two claims that constitute the theoretical core of classical naturalism: 1) there can be no legally valid standards that conflict with the natural law; and 2) all valid laws derive what force and authority they have from the natural law. On this view, to paraphrase Augustine, an unjust law is no law at all.

Related to Blackstone’s classical naturalism is the neo-naturalism of John Finnis (1980). Finnis believes that the naturalism of Aquinas and Blackstone should not be construed as a conceptual account of the existence conditions for law. According to Finnis (see also Bix, 1996), the classical naturalists were not concerned with giving a conceptual account of legal validity; rather they were concerned with explaining the moral force of law: “the principles of natural law explain the obligatory force (in the fullest sense of “obligation”) of positive laws, even when those laws cannot be deduced from those principles” (Finnis 1980, pp. 23-24). On Finnis’s view of the Overlap Thesis, the essential function of law is to provide a justification for state coercion. Accordingly, an unjust law can be legally valid, but cannot provide an adequate justification for use of the state coercive power and is hence not obligatory in the fullest sense; thus, an unjust law fails to realize the moral ideals implicit in the concept of law. An unjust law, on this view, is legally binding, but is not fully law.

Lon Fuller (1964) rejects the idea that there are necessary moral constraints on the content of law. On Fuller’s view, law is necessarily subject to a procedural morality consisting of eight principles:

P1: the rules must be expressed in general terms;
P2: the rules must be publicly promulgated;
P3: the rules must be prospective in effect;
P4: the rules must be expressed in understandable terms;
P5: the rules must be consistent with one another;
P6: the rules must not require conduct beyond the powers of the affected parties;
P7: the rules must not be changed so frequently that the subject cannot rely on them; and
P8: the rules must be administered in a manner consistent with their wording.

On Fuller’s view, no system of rules that fails minimally to satisfy these principles of legality can achieve law’s essential purpose of achieving social order through the use of rules that guide behavior. A system of rules that fails to satisfy (P2) or (P4), for example, cannot guide behavior because people will not be able to determine what the rules require. Accordingly, Fuller concludes that his eight principles are “internal” to law in the sense that they are built into the existence conditions for law: “A total failure in any one of these eight directions does not simply result in a bad system of law; it results in something that is not properly called a legal system at all” (1964, p. 39).

b. Legal Positivism

Opposed to all forms of naturalism is legal positivism, which is roughly constituted by three theoretical commitments: (i) the Social Fact Thesis, (ii) the Conventionality Thesis, and (iii) the Separability Thesis. The Social Fact Thesis (which is also known as the Pedigree Thesis) asserts that it is a necessary truth that legal validity is ultimately a function of certain kinds of social facts. The Conventionality Thesis emphasizes law’s conventional nature, claiming that the social facts giving rise to legal validity are authoritative in virtue of some kind of social convention. The Separability Thesis, at the most general level, simply denies naturalism’s Overlap Thesis; according to the Separability Thesis, there is no conceptual overlap between the notions of law and morality.

i. The Conventionality Thesis

According to the Conventionality Thesis, it is a conceptual truth about law that legal validity can ultimately be explained in terms of criteria that are authoritative in virtue of some kind of social convention. Thus, for example, H.L.A. Hart (1996) believes the criteria of legal validity are contained in a rule of recognition that sets forth rules for creating, changing, and adjudicating law. On Hart’s view, the rule of recognition is authoritative in virtue of a convention among officials to regard its criteria as standards that govern their behavior as officials. While Joseph Raz does not appear to endorse Hart’s view about a master rule of recognition containing the criteria of validity, he also believes the validity criteria are authoritative only in virtue of a convention among officials.

ii. The Social Fact Thesis

The Social Fact Thesis asserts that legal validity is a function of certain social facts. Borrowing heavily from Jeremy Bentham, John Austin (1995) argues that the principal distinguishing feature of a legal system is the presence of a sovereign who is habitually obeyed by most people in the society, but not in the habit of obeying any determinate human superior. On Austin’s view, a rule R is legally valid (that is, is a law) in a society S if and only if R is commanded by the sovereign in S and is backed up with the threat of a sanction. The relevant social fact that confers validity, on Austin’s view, is promulgation by a sovereign willing to impose a sanction for noncompliance.

Hart takes a different view of the Social Fact Thesis. Hart believes that Austin’s theory accounts, at most, for one kind of rule: primary rules that require or prohibit certain kinds of behavior. On Hart’s view, Austin overlooked the presence of other primary rules that confer upon citizens the power to create, modify, and extinguish rights and obligations in other persons. As Hart points out, the rules governing the creation of contracts and wills cannot plausibly be characterized as restrictions on freedom that are backed by the threat of a sanction.

Most importantly, however, Hart argues Austin overlooks the existence of secondary meta-rules that have as their subject matter the primary rules themselves and distinguish full-blown legal systems from primitive systems of law:

[Secondary rules] may all be said to be on a different level from the primary rules, for they are all about such rules; in the sense that while primary rules are concerned with the actions that individuals must or must not do, these secondary rules are all concerned with the primary rules themselves. They specify the way in which the primary rules may be conclusively ascertained, introduced, eliminated, varied, and the fact of their violation conclusively determined (Hart 1994, p. 92).

Hart distinguishes three types of secondary rules that mark the transition from primitive forms of law to full-blown legal systems: (1) the rule of recognition, which “specif[ies] some feature or features possession of which by a suggested rule is taken as a conclusive affirmative indication that it is a rule of the group to be supported by the social pressure it exerts” (Hart 1994, p. 92); (2) the rule of change, which enables a society to add, remove, and modify valid rules; and (3) the rule of adjudication, which provides a mechanism for determining whether a valid rule has been violated. On Hart’s view, then, every society with a full-blown legal system necessarily has a rule of recognition that articulates criteria for legal validity that include provisions for making, changing and adjudicating law. Law is, to use Hart’s famous phrase, “the union of primary and secondary rules” (Hart 1994, p. 107).

According to Hart’s view of the Social Fact Thesis, then, a proposition P is legally valid in a society S if and only if it satisfies the criteria of validity contained in a rule of recognition that is binding in S. As we have seen, the Conventionality Thesis implies that a rule of recognition is binding in S only if there is a social convention among officials to treat it as defining standards of official behavior. Thus, on Hart’s view, “[the] rules of recognition specifying the criteria of legal validity and its rules of change and adjudication must be effectively accepted as common public standards of official behaviour by its officials” (Hart 1994, p. 113).

iii. The Separability Thesis

The final thesis comprising the foundation of legal positivism is the Separability Thesis. In its most general form, the Separability Thesis asserts that law and morality are conceptually distinct. This abstract formulation can be interpreted in a number of ways. For example, Klaus F¸þer (1996) interprets it as making a meta-level claim that the definition of law must be entirely free of moral notions. This interpretation implies that any reference to moral considerations in defining the related notions of law, legal validity, and legal system is inconsistent with the Separability Thesis.

More commonly, the Separability Thesis is interpreted as making only an object-level claim about the existence conditions for legal validity. As Hart describes it, the Separability Thesis is no more than the “simple contention that it is in no sense a necessary truth that laws reproduce or satisfy certain demands of morality, though in fact they have often done so” (Hart 1994, pp. 181-82). Insofar as the object-level interpretation of the Separability Thesis denies it is a necessary truth that there are moral constraints on legal validity, it implies the existence of a possible legal system in which there are no moral constraints on legal validity.

Though all positivists agree there are possible legal systems without moral constraints on legal validity, there are conflicting views on whether there are possible legal systems with such constraints. According to inclusive positivism (also known as incorporationism and soft positivism), it is possible for a society’s rule of recognition to incorporate moral constraints on the content of law. Prominent inclusive positivists include Jules Coleman and Hart, who maintains that “the rule of recognition may incorporate as criteria of legal validity conformity with moral principles or substantive values … such as the Sixteenth or Nineteenth Amendments to the United States Constitution respecting the establishment of religion or abridgements of the right to vote” (Hart 1994, p. 250).

In contrast, exclusive positivism (also called hard positivism) denies that a legal system can incorporate moral constraints on legal validity. Exclusive positivists like Raz (1979) subscribe to the Source Thesis, according to which the existence and content of law can always be determined by reference to its sources without recourse to moral argument. On this view, the sources of law include both the circumstances of its promulgation and relevant interpretative materials, such as court cases involving its application.

c. Ronald Dworkin’s Third Theory

Ronald Dworkin rejects positivism’s Social Fact Thesis on the ground that there are some legal standards the authority of which cannot be explained in terms of social facts. In deciding hard cases, for example, judges often invoke moral principles that Dworkin believes do not derive their legal authority from the social criteria of legality contained in a rule of recognition (Dworkin 1977, p. 40). Nevertheless, since judges are bound to consider such principles when relevant, they must be characterized as law. Thus, Dworkin concludes, “if we treat principles as law we must reject the positivists’ first tenet, that the law of a community is distinguished from other social standards by some test in the form of a master rule” (Dworkin 1977, p. 44).

Dworkin believes adjudication is and should be interpretive: “judges should decide hard cases by interpreting the political structure of their community in the following, perhaps special way: by trying to find the best justification they can find, in principles of political morality, for the structure as a whole, from the most profound constitutional rules and arrangements to the details of, for example, the private law of tort or contract” (Dworkin 1982, p. 165). There are, then, two elements of a successful interpretation. First, since an interpretation is successful insofar as it justifies the particular practices of a particular society, the interpretation must fit with those practices in the sense that it coheres with existing legal materials defining the practices. Second, since an interpretation provides a moral justification for those practices, it must present them in the best possible moral light. Thus, Dworkin argues, a judge should strive to interpret a case in roughly the following way:

A thoughtful judge might establish for himself, for example, a rough “threshold” of fit which any interpretation of data must meet in order to be “acceptable” on the dimension of fit, and then suppose that if more than one interpretation of some part of the law meets this threshold, the choice among these should be made, not through further and more precise comparisons between the two along that dimension, but by choosing the interpretation which is “substantively” better, that is, which better promotes the political ideals he thinks correct (Dworkin 1982, p. 171).

Accordingly, on Dworkin’s view, the legal authority of a binding principle derives from the contribution it makes to the best moral justification for a society’s legal practices considered as a whole. Thus, a legal principle maximally contributes to such a justification if and only if it satisfies two conditions:

the principle coheres with existing legal materials; and
the principle is the most morally attractive standard that satisfies (1).

The correct legal principle is the one that makes the law the moral best it can be.

In later writings, Dworkin expands the scope of his “constructivist” view beyond adjudication to encompass the realm of legal theory. Dworkin distinguishes conversational interpretation from artistic/creative interpretation and argues that the task of interpreting a social practice is more like artistic interpretation:

The most familiar occasion of interpretation is conversation. We interpret the sounds or marks another person makes in order to decide what he has said. Artistic interpretation is yet another: critics interpret poems and plays and paintings in order to defend some view of their meaning or theme or point. The form of interpretation we are studying-the interpretation of a social practice-is like artistic interpretation in this way: both aim to interpret something created by people as an entity distinct from them, rather than what people say, as in conversational interpretation” (Dworkin 1986, p. 50).

Artistic interpretation, like judicial interpretation, is constrained by the dimensions of fit and justification: “constructive interpretation is a matter of imposing purpose on an object or practice in order to make of it the best possible example of the form or genre to which it is taken to belong” (Dworkin 1986, p. 52).

On Dworkin’s view, the point of any general theory of law is to interpret a very complex set of related social practices that are “created by people as an entity distinct from them”; for this reason, Dworkin believes the project of putting together a general theory of law is inherently constructivist:

General theories of law must be abstract because they aim to interpret the main point and structure of legal practice, not some particular part or department of it. But for all their abstraction, they are constructive interpretations: they try to show legal practice as a whole in its best light, to achieve equilibrium between legal practice as they find it and the best justification of that practice. So no firm line divides jurisprudence from adjudication or any other aspect of legal practice (Dworkin 1986, p. 90).

Indeed, so tight is the relation between jurisprudence and adjudication, according to Dworkin, that jurisprudence is no more than the most general part of adjudication; thus, Dworkin concludes, “any judge’s opinion is itself a piece of legal philosophy” (Dworkin 1986, p. 90).

Accordingly, Dworkin rejects not only positivism’s Social Fact Thesis, but also what he takes to be its underlying presuppositions about legal theory. Hart distinguishes two perspectives from which a set of legal practices can be understood. A legal practice can be understood from the “internal” point of view of the person who accepts that practice as providing legitimate guides to conduct, as well as from the “external” point of view of the observer who wishes to understand the practice but does not accept it as being authoritative or legitimate.

Hart understands his theory of law to be both descriptive and general in the sense that it provides an account of fundamental features common to all legal systems-which presupposes a point of view that is external to all legal systems. For this reason, he regards his project as “a radically different enterprise from Dworkin’s conception of legal theory (or ‘jurisprudence’ as he often terms it) as in part evaluative and justificatory and as ‘addressed to a particular legal culture’, which is usually the theorist’s own and in Dworkin’s case is that of Anglo-American law” (Hart 1994, p. 240).

These remarks show Hart believes Dworkin’s theoretical objectives are fundamentally different from those of positivism, which, as a theory of analytic jurisprudence, is largely concerned with conceptual analysis. For his part, Dworkin conceives his work as conceptual but not in the same sense that Hart regards his work:

We all-at least all lawyers-share a concept of law and of legal right, and we contest different conceptions of that concept. Positivism defends a particular conception, and I have tried to defend a competing conception. We disagree about what legal rights are in much the same way as we philosophers who argue about justice disagree about what justice is. I concentrate on the details of a particular legal system with which I am especially familiar, not simply to show that positivism provides a poor account of that system, but to show that positivism provides a poor conception of the concept of a legal right (Dworkin 1977, 351-52).

These differences between Hart and Dworkin have led many legal philosophers, most recently Bix (1996), to suspect that they are not really taking inconsistent positions at all. Accordingly, there remains an issue as to whether Dworkin’s work should be construed as falling under the rubric of analytic jurisprudence.

2. Normative Jurisprudence

Normative jurisprudence involves normative, evaluative, and otherwise prescriptive questions about the law. Here we will examine three key issues: (a) when and to what extent laws can restrict the freedom of citizens, (b) the nature of one’s obligation to obey the law, and (c) the justification of punishment by law.

a. Freedom and the Limits of Legitimate Law

Laws limit human autonomy by restricting freedom. Criminal laws, for example, remove certain behaviors from the range of behavioral options by penalizing them with imprisonment and, in some cases, death. Likewise, civil laws require people to take certain precautions not to injure others and to honor their contracts. Given that human autonomy deserves prima facie moral respect, the question arises as to what are the limits of the state’s legitimate authority to restrict the freedom of its citizens.

John Stuart Mill provides the classic liberal answer in the form of the harm principle:

[T]he sole end for which mankind are warranted, individually or collectively, in interfering with the liberty of action of any of their number is self-protection. The only purpose for which power can rightfully be exercised over any member of a civilised community against his will is to prevent harm to others. His own good, either physical or moral, is not a sufficient warrant. Over himself, over his own body and mind, the individual is sovereign (Mill 1906, pp. 12-13).

While Mill left the notion of harm underdeveloped, he is most frequently taken to mean only physical harms and more extreme forms of psychological harm.

Though Mill’s view—or something like it—enjoys currency among the public, it has generated considerable controversy among philosophers of law and political philosophers. Many philosophers believe that Mill understates the limits of legitimate state authority over the individual, claiming that law may be used to enforce morality, to protect the individual from herself, and in some cases to protect individuals from offensive behavior.

i. Legal Moralism

Legal moralism is the view that the law can legitimately be used to prohibit behaviors that conflict with society’s collective moral judgments even when those behaviors do not result in physical or psychological harm to others. According to this view, a person’s freedom can legitimately be restricted simply because it conflicts with society’s collective morality; thus, legal moralism implies that it is permissible for the state to use its coercive power to enforce society’s collective morality.

The most famous legal moralist is Patrick Devlin, who argues that a shared morality is essential to the existence of a society:

[I]f men and women try to create a society in which there is no fundamental agreement about good and evil they will fail; if, having based it on common agreement, the agreement goes, the society will disintegrate. For society is not something that is kept together physically; it is held by the invisible bonds of common thought. If the bonds were too far relaxed the members would drift apart. A common morality is part of the bondage. The bondage is part of the price of society; and mankind, which needs society, must pay its price. (Devlin 1965, p. 10).

Insofar as human beings cannot lead a meaningful existence outside of society, it follows, on Devlin’s view, that the law can be used to preserve the shared morality as a means of preserving society itself.

H.L.A. Hart (1963) points out that Devlin overstates the extent to which preservation of a shared morality is necessary to the continuing existence of a society. Devlin attempts to conclude from the necessity of a shared social morality that it is permissible for the state to legislate sexual morality (in particular, to legislate against same-sex sexual relations), but Hart argues it is implausible to think that “deviation from accepted sexual morality, even by adults in private, is something which, like treason, threatens the existence of society” (Hart 1963, p. 50). While enforcement of certain social norms protecting life, safety, and property are likely essential to the existence of a society, a society can survive a diversity of behavior in many other areas of moral concern-as is evidenced by the controversies in the U.S. surrounding abortion and homosexuality.

ii. Legal Paternalism

Legal paternalism is the view that it is permissible for the state to legislate against what Mill calls “self-regarding actions” when necessary to prevent individuals from inflicting physical or severe emotional harm on themselves. As Gerald Dworkin describes it, a paternalist interference is an “interference with a person’s liberty of action justified by reasons referring exclusively to the welfare, good, happiness, needs, interests or values of the person being coerced” (G. Dworkin 1972, p. 65). Thus, for example, a law requiring use of a helmet when riding a motorcycle is a paternalistic interference insofar as it is justified by concerns for the safety of the rider.

Dworkin argues that Mill’s view that a person “cannot rightfully be compelled to do or forbear because it will be better for him” (Mill 1906, p. 13) precludes paternalistic legislation to which fully rational individuals would agree. According to Dworkin, there are goods, such as health and education, that any rational person needs to pursue her own good-no matter how that good is conceived. Thus, Dworkin concludes, the attainment of these basic goods can legitimately be promoted in certain circumstances by using the state’s coercive force.

Dworkin offers a hypothetical consent justification for his limited legal paternalism. On his view, there are a number of different situations in which fully rational adults would consent to paternalistic restrictions on freedom. For example, Dworkin believes a fully rational adult would consent to paternalistic restrictions to protect her from making decisions that are “far-reaching, potentially dangerous and irreversible” (G. Dworkin 1972, p. 80). Nevertheless, he argues that there are limits to legitimate paternalism: (1) the state must show that the behavior governed by the proposed restriction involves the sort of harm that a rational person would want to avoid; (2) on the calculations of a fully rational person, the potential harm outweighs the benefits of the relevant behavior; and (3) the proposed restriction is the least restrictive alternative for protecting against the harm.

iii. The Offense Principle

Joel Feinberg believes the harm principle does not provide sufficient protection against the wrongful behaviors of others, as it is inconsistent with many criminal prohibitions we take for granted as being justified. If the only legitimate use of the state coercive force is to protect people from harm caused by others, then statutes prohibiting public sex are impermissible because public sex might be offensive but it does not cause harm (in the Millian sense) to others.

Accordingly, Feinberg argues the harm principle must be augmented by the offense principle, which he defines as follows: “It is always a good reason in support of a proposed criminal prohibition that it would probably be an effective way of preventing serious offense (as opposed to injury or harm) to persons other than the actor, and that it is probably a necessary means to that end” (Feinberg 1985). By “offense,” Feinberg intends a subjective and objective element: the subjective element consists in the experience of an unpleasant mental state (for example, shame, disgust, anxiety, embarrassment); the objective element consists in the existence of a wrongful cause of such a mental state.

b. The Obligation to Obey Law

Natural law critics of positivism (for example, Fuller 1958) frequently complain that if positivism is correct, there cannot be a moral obligation to obey the law qua law (that is, to obey the law as such, no matter what the laws are, simply because it is the law). As Feinberg (1979) puts the point:

The positivist account of legal validity is hard to reconcile with the [claim] that valid law as such, no matter what its content, deserves our respect and general fidelity. Even if valid law is bad law, we have some obligation to obey it simply because it is law. But how can this be so if a law’s validity has nothing to do with its content?

The idea is this: if what is essential to law is just that there exist specified recipes for making law, then there cannot be a moral obligation to obey a rule simply because it is the law.

Contemporary positivists, for the most part, accept the idea that positivism is inconsistent with an obligation to obey law qua law (compare Himma 1998), but argue that the mere status of a norm as law cannot give rise to any moral obligation to obey that norm. While there might be a moral obligation to obey a particular law because of its moral content (for example, laws prohibiting murder) or because it solves a coordination problem (for example, laws requiring people to drive on the right side of the road), the mere fact that a rule is law does not provide a moral reason for doing what the law requires.

Indeed, arguments for the existence of even a prima facie obligation to obey law (that is, an obligation that can be outweighed by competing obligations) have largely been unsuccessful. Arguments in favor of an obligation to obey the law roughly fall into four categories: (1) arguments from gratitude; (2) arguments from fair play; (3) arguments from implied consent; and (4) arguments from general utility.

The argument from gratitude begins with the observation that all persons, even those who are worst off, derive some benefit from the state’s enforcement of the law. On this view, a person who accepts benefits from another person thereby incurs a duty of gratitude towards the benefactor. And the only plausible way to discharge this duty towards the government is to obey its laws. Nevertheless, as M.B.E. Smith points out (1973, p. 953), “if someone confers benefits on me without any consideration of whether I want them, and if he does this in order to advance some purpose other than promotion of my particular welfare, I have no obligation to be grateful towards him.” Since the state does not give citizens a choice with respect to such benefits, the mere enjoyment of them cannot give rise to a duty of gratitude.

John Rawls (1964) argues that there is a moral obligation to obey law qua law in societies in which there is a mutually beneficial and just scheme of social cooperation. What gives rise to a moral obligation to obey law qua law in such societies is a duty of fair play: fairness requires obedience of persons who intentionally accept the benefits made available in a society organized around a just scheme of mutually beneficial cooperation. There are a couple of problems here. First, Rawls’s argument does not establish the existence of a content-independent obligation to obey law; the obligation arises only in those societies that institutionalize a just scheme of social cooperation. Second, even in such societies, citizens are not presented with a genuine option to refuse those benefits. For example, I cannot avoid the benefits of laws ensuring clean air. But accepting benefits one is not in a position to refuse cannot give rise to an obligation of fair play.

The argument from consent grounds an obligation to obey law on some sort of implied promise. As is readily evident, we can voluntarily assume obligations by consenting to them or making a promise. Of course, most citizens never explicitly promise or consent to obey the laws; for this reason, proponents of this argument attempt to infer consent from such considerations as continued residence and acceptance of benefits from the state. Nevertheless, acceptance of benefits one cannot decline no more implies consent to obey law than it does duties of fair play or gratitude. Moreover, the prohibitive difficulties associated with emigration preclude an inference of consent from continued residence.

Finally, the argument from general utility grounds the duty to obey the law in the consequences of universal disobedience. Since, according to this argument, the consequences of general disobedience would be catastrophic, it is wrong for any individual to disobey the law; for no person may disobey the law unless everyone may do so. In response, Smith points out that this strategy of argument leads to absurdities: “We will have to maintain, for example, that there is a prima facie obligation not to eat dinner at five o’clock, for if everyone did so, certain essential services could not be maintained” (Smith 1973, p. 966).

c. The Justification of Punishment

Punishment is unique among putatively legitimate acts in that its point is to inflict discomfort on the recipient; an act that is incapable of causing a person minimal discomfort cannot be characterized as a punishment. In most contexts, the commission of an act for the purpose of inflicting discomfort is morally problematic because of its resemblance to torture. For this reason, institutional punishment requires a moral justification sufficient to distinguish it from other practices of purposely inflicting discomfort on other people.

Justifications for punishment typically take five forms: (1) retributive; (2) deterrence; (3) preventive; (4) rehabilitative; and (5) restitutionary. According to the retributive justification, what justifies punishing a person is that she committed an offense that deserves the punishment. On this view, it is morally appropriate that a person who has committed a wrongful act should suffer in proportion to the magnitude of her wrongdoing. The problem, however, is that the mere fact that someone is deserving of punishment does not imply it is morally permissible for the state to administer punishment; it would be wrong for me, for example, to punish someone else’s child even though her behavior might deserve it.

In contrast to the retributivist theories that look back to a person’s prior wrongful act as justification for punishment, utilitarian theories look forward to the beneficial consequences of punishing a person. There are three main lines of utilitarian reasoning. According to the deterrence justification, punishment of a wrongdoer is justified by the socially beneficial effects that it has on other persons. On this view, punishment deters wrongdoing by persons who would otherwise commit wrongful acts. The problem with the deterrence theory is that it justifies punishment of one person on the strength of the effects that it has on other persons. The idea that it is permissible to deliberately inflict discomfort on one person because doing so may have beneficial effects on the behavior of other persons appears inconsistent with the Kantian principle that it is wrong to use people as mere means.

The preventive justification argues that incarcerating a person for wrongful acts is justified insofar as it prevents that person from committing wrongful acts against society during the period of incarceration. The rehabilitative justification argues that punishment is justified in virtue of the effect that it has on the moral character of the offender. Each of these justifications suffers from the same flaw: prevention of crime and rehabilitation of the offender can be achieved without the deliberate infliction of discomfort that constitutes punishment. For example, prevention of crime might require detaining the offender, but it does not require detention in an environment that is as unpleasant as those typically found in prisons.

The restitutionary justification focuses on the effect of the offender’s wrongful act on the victim. Other theories of punishment conceptualize the wrongful act as an offense against society; the restitutionary theory sees wrongdoing as an offense against the victim. Thus, on this view, the principal purpose of punishment must be to make the victim whole to the extent that this can be done: “The point is not that the offender deserves to suffer; it is rather that the offended party desires compensation” (Barnett 1977, p. 289). Accordingly, a criminal convicted of wrongdoing should be sentenced to compensate her victim in proportion to the victim’s loss. The problem with the restitutionary theory is that it fails to distinguish between compensation and punishment. Compensatory objectives focus on the victim, while punitive objectives focus on the offender.

3. Critical Theories of Law

a. Legal Realism

The legal realist movement was inspired by John Chipman Gray and Oliver Wendall Holmes and reached its apex in the 1920s and 30s through the work of Karl Llewellyn, Jerome Frank, and Felix Cohen. The realists eschewed the conceptual approach of the positivists and naturalists in favor of an empirical analysis that sought to show how practicing judges really decide cases (see Leiter 1998). The realists were deeply skeptical of the ascendant notion that judicial legislation is a rarity. While not entirely rejecting the idea that judges can be constrained by rules, the realists maintained that judges create new law through the exercise of lawmaking discretion considerably more often than is commonly supposed. On their view, judicial decision is guided far more frequently by political and moral intuitions about the facts of the case (instead of by legal rules) than theories like positivism and naturalism acknowledge.

As an historical matter, legal realism arose in response to legal formalism, a particular model of legal reasoning that assimilates legal reasoning to syllogistic reasoning. According to the formalist model, the legal outcome (that is, the holding) logically follows from the legal rule (major premise) and a statement of the relevant facts (minor premise). Realists believe that formalism understates judicial lawmaking abilities insofar as it represents legal outcomes as entailed syllogistically by applicable rules and facts. For if legal outcomes are logically implied by propositions that bind judges, it follows that judges lack legal authority to reach conflicting outcomes.

Legal realism can roughly be characterized by the following claims:

the class of available legal materials is insufficient to logically entail a unique legal outcome in most cases worth litigating at the appellate level (the Local Indeterminacy Thesis);
in such cases, judges make new law in deciding legal disputes through the exercise of a lawmaking discretion (the Discretion Thesis); and
judicial decisions in indeterminate cases are influenced by the judge’s political and moral convictions, not by legal considerations.

Though (3) is logically independent of (1) and (2), (1) seems to imply (2): insofar as judges decide legally indeterminate cases, they must be creating new law.

It is worth noting the relations between legal realism, formalism, and positivism. While formalism is often thought to be entailed by positivism, it turns out that legal realism is not only consistent with positivism, but also presupposes the truth of all three of positivism’s core theses. Indeed, the realist acknowledges that law is essentially the product of official activity, but believes that judicial lawmaking occurs more frequently than is commonly assumed. But the idea that law is essentially the product of official activity presupposes the truth of positivism’s Conventionality, Social Fact, and Separability theses. Though the preoccupations of the realists were empirical (that is, attempting to identify the psychological and sociological factors influencing judicial decision-making), their implicit conceptual commitments were decidedly positivistic in flavor.

b. Critical Legal Studies

The critical legal studies (CLS) movement attempts to expand the radical aspects of legal realism into a Marxist critique of mainstream liberal jurisprudence. CLS theorists believe the realists understate the extent of indeterminacy; whereas the realists believe that indeterminacy is local in the sense that it is confined to a certain class of cases, CLS theorists argue that law is radically (or globally) indeterminate in the sense that the class of available legal materials rarely, if ever, logically/causally entails a unique outcome.

CLS theorists emphasize the role of ideology in shaping the content of the law. On this view, the content of the law in liberal democracies necessarily reflects “ideological struggles among social factions in which competing conceptions of justice, goodness, and social and political life get compromised, truncated, vitiated, and adjusted” (Altman 1986, p. 221). The inevitable outcome of such struggles, on this view, is a profound inconsistency permeating the deepest layers of the law. It is this pervasive inconsistency that gives rise to radical indeterminacy in the law. For insofar as the law is inconsistent, a judge can justify any of a number of conflicting outcomes.

At the heart of the CLS critique of liberal jurisprudence is the idea that radical indeterminacy is inconsistent with liberal conceptions of legitimacy. According to these traditional liberal conceptions, the province of judges is to interpret, and not make, the law. For, on this view, democratic ideals imply that lawmaking must be left to legislators who, unlike appointed judges, are accountable to the electorate. But if law is radically indeterminate, then judges nearly always decide cases by making new law, which is inconsistent with liberal conceptions of the legitimate sources of lawmaking authority.

c. Law and Economics

The law and economics movement argues for the value of economic analysis in the law both as a description about how courts and legislators do behave and as a prescription for how such officials should behave. The legal economists, led by Richard Posner, argue that the content of many areas of the common law can be explained in terms of its tendency to maximize preferences:

[M]any areas of law, especially the great common law fields of property, torts, crimes, and contracts, bear the stamp of economic reasoning. It is not a refutation that few judicial opinions contain explicit references to economic concepts. Often the true grounds of decision are concealed rather than illuminated by the characteristic rhetoric of judicial opinions. Indeed, legal education consists primarily of learning to dig beneath the rhetorical surface to find those grounds, many of which may turn out to have an economic character (Posner 1992, p. 23).

Posner subscribes to the so-called efficiency theory of the common law, according to which “the common law is best (not perfectly) explained as a system for maximizing the wealth of society” (Posner 1992, p. 23).

More influential than Posner’s descriptive claims is his normative view that law should strive to maximize wealth. According to Posner, the proper goal of the statutory and common law is to promote wealth maximization, which can best be done by facilitating the mechanisms of the free market. Posner’s normative view combines elements of utilitarian analysis with a Kantian respect for autonomy. On the utilitarian side, markets tend to maximize wealth and the satisfaction of preferences. In a market transaction with no third-party effects, wealth is increased because all parties are made better off by the transaction-otherwise there would be no incentive to consummate the transaction-and no one is made worse off.

On the Kantian side, the law should facilitate market transactions because market transactions best reflect autonomous judgments about the value of individual preferences. At least ideally, individuals express and realize their preferences through mutually consensual market transactions consummated from positions of equal bargaining power. Thus, market transactions tend, ideally, to be both efficient (because they tend to maximize wealth without harmful third-party effects) and just (because all parties are consenting).

d. Outsider Jurisprudence

So-called “outsider jurisprudence” is concerned with providing an analysis of the ways in which law is structured to promote the interests of white males and to exclude females and persons of color. For example, one principal objective of feminist jurisprudence is to show how patriarchal assumptions have shaped the content of laws in a wide variety of areas: property, contract, criminal law, constitutional law, and the law of civil rights. Additionally, feminist scholars challenge traditional ideals of judicial decision-making according to which judges decide legal disputes by applying neutral rules in an impartial and objective fashion. Feminists have, of course, always questioned whether it is possible for judges to achieve an objective and impartial perspective, but now question whether the traditional model is even desirable.

Critical race theory is likewise concerned to point up the way in which assumptions of white supremacy have shaped the content of the law at the expense of persons of color. Additionally, critical race theorists show how the experience, concerns, values, and perspectives of persons of color are systematically excluded from mainstream discourse among practicing lawyers, judges, and legislators. Finally, such theorists attempt to show how assumptions about race are built into most liberal theories of law.

4. References and Further Reading

Andrew Altman (1986), “Legal Realism, Critical Legal Studies, and Dworkin,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, vol. 15, no. 2, pp. 205-236.
Thomas Aquinas (1988), On Law, Morality and Politics (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Co.).
John Austin (1977), Lectures on Jurisprudence and the Philosophy of Positive Law (St. Clair Shores, MI: Scholarly Press.
John Austin (1995), The Province of Jurisprudence Determined (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Randy E. Barnett (1977), “Restitution: A New Paradigm of Criminal Justice,” Ethics, vol. 87, no. 4, pp. 279-301.
Jeremy Bentham (1988), A Fragment of Government (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Jeremy Bentham (1970), Of Laws In General (London: Athlone Press).
Brian Bix (1995), “Conceptual Questions and Jurisprudence,” Legal Theory, vol. 1, no. 4 (December), pp. 465-479.
Brian Bix (1996a), Jurisprudence: Theory and Context (Boulder, CO: Westview Press).
Brian Bix (1996b), “Natural Law Theory,” in Dennis M. Patterson (ed.), A Companion to Philosophy of Law and Legal Theory (Cambridge: Blackwell Publishing Co.).
William Blackstone (1979), Commentaries on the Law of England (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press).
Jules L. Coleman (1989), “On the Relationship Between Law and Morality,” Ratio Juris, vol. 2, no. 1, pp. 66-78.
Jules L. Coleman (1982), “Negative and Positive Positivism,” 11 Journal of Legal Studies vol. 139, no. 1, pp. 139-164.
Jules L. Coleman (1996), “Authority and Reason,” in Robert P. George, The Autonomy of Law: Essays on Legal Positivism (Oxford: Clarendon Press), pp. 287-319.
Jules L. Coleman (1998), “Incorporationism, Conventionality and The Practical Difference Thesis,” Legal Theory, vol. 4, no. 4, pp. 381-426.
Jules L. Coleman and Jeffrie Murphy (1990), Philosophy of Law (Boulder, CO: Westview Press).
Kimberle Crenshaw, Neil Gotanda, Gary Peller, and Kendall Thomas, eds. (1995), Critical Race Theory: The Key Writings That Formed the Movement (New York: The New Press).
Patrick Devlin (1965), The Enforcement of Morals (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Gerald Dworkin (1972), “Paternalism,” The Monist, vol. 56, pp. 64-84.
Ronald Dworkin (1978), Taking Rights Seriously (Cambridge: Harvard University Press).
Ronald Dworkin (1982), “‘Natural’ Law Revisited,” University of Florida Law Review vol. 34, no. 2, pp. 165-188.
Ronald Dworkin (1986), Law’s Empire (Cambridge: Harvard University Press).
Joel Feinberg (1985), Offense to Others (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Joel Feinberg (1979), “Civil Disobedience in the Modern World,” Humanities in Review, vol. 2, pp. 37-60.
John Finnis (1980), Natural Law and Natural Rights (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
William Fisher, Morton Horovitz, and Thomas Reed, eds. (1993), American Legal Realism (New York: Oxford University Press).
Jerome Frank (1930), Law and the Modern Mind (New York: Brentano’s Publishing).
Lon L. Fuller (1964), The Morality of Law (New Haven, CT: Yale University Press).
Lon L. Fuller (1958), “Positivism and Fidelity to Law,” Harvard Law Review, vol. 71, no. 4, pp. 630-672 .
Klaus Füßer (1996), “Farewell to ‘Legal Positivism’: The Separation Thesis Unravelling,” in Robert P. George, The Autonomy of Law: Essays on Legal Positivism (Oxford: Clarendon Press), pp. 119-162.
John Chipman Gray (1921), The Nature and Source of Law (New York: Macmillan).
Kent Greenawalt (1987), Conflicts of Law and Morality (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
H.L.A. Hart (1994), The Concept of Law, 2nd Edition (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
H.L.A. Hart (1983), Essays in Jurisprudence and Philosophy (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
H.L.A. Hart (1963), Law, Liberty and Morality (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Kenneth Einar Himma (1998), “Positivism, Naturalism, and the Obligation to Obey Law,” Southern Journal of Philosophy, vol. 36, no. 2, pp. 145-161.
Oliver Wendall Holmes (1898), “The Path of the Law,” Harvard Law Review, vol. 110, no. 5, pp. 991-1009 .
Brian Leiter (1998), “Naturalism and Naturalized Jurisprudence,” in Brian Bix (ed.), Analyzing Law: New Essays in Legal Theory (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
Brian Leiter, “Legal Realism,” in Dennis M. Patterson, ed. (1996), A Companion to Philosophy of Law and Legal Theory (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers).
John Stuart Mill (1906), On Liberty (New York: Alfred A. Knopf).
Michael Moore (1992), “Law as a Functional Kind,” in Robert P. George (ed.), Natural Law Theories: Contemporary Essays (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
Michael Moore, “The Moral Worth of Retribution,” in Ferdinand Schoeman, ed. (1987), Responsibility, Character, and the Emotions (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Richard Posner (1992), Economic Analysis of Law, 4th Edition (Boston: Little, Brown, and Company).
John Rawls (1964), “Legal Obligation and the Duty of Fair Play,” in Sidney Hook (ed.), Law and Philosophy (New York: New York University Press), pp. 3-18.
Joseph Raz (1979), The Authority of Law: Essays on Law and Morality (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
Joseph Raz (1980), The Concept of a Legal System: An Introduction to the Theory of Legal Systems, Second Edition (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
Roger Shiner (1992), Norm and Nature (Oxford: Clarendon Press).
M.B.E. Smith (1973), “Do We have a Prima Facie Obligation to Obey the Law,” 82 Yale Law Journal 950-976.
Patricia Smith, ed. (1993), Feminist Jurisprudence (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
C.L. Ten (1987), Crime, Guilt, and Punishment (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
W.J. Waluchow (1994), Inclusive Legal Positivism (Oxford: Clarendon Press).

Author Information

Kenneth Einar Himma
Email: himma@spu.edu
Seattle Pacific University
U. S. A.

Feminist Jurisprudence

American feminist jurisprudence is the study of the construction and workings of the law from perspectives which foreground the implications of the law for women and women’s lives. This study includes law as a theoretical enterprise as well its practical and concrete effects in women’s lives. Further, it includes law as an academic discipline, and thus incorporates concerns regarding pedagogy and the influence of teachers. On all these levels, feminist scholars, lawyers, and activists raise questions about the meaning and the impact of law on women’s lives. Feminist jurisprudence seeks to analyze and redress more traditional legal theory and practice. It focuses on the ways in which law has been structured (sometimes unwittingly) that deny the experiences and needs of women. Feminist jurisprudence claims that patriarchy (the system of interconnected relations and institutions that oppress women) infuses the legal system and all its workings, and that this is an unacceptable state of affairs. Consequently, feminist jurisprudence is not politically neutral, but a normative approach, as expressed by philosopher Patricia Smith: “[F]eminist jurisprudence challenges basic legal categories and concepts rather than analyzing them as given. Feminist jurisprudence asks what is implied in traditional categories, distinctions, or concepts and rejects them if they imply the subordination of women. In this sense, feminist jurisprudence is normative and claims that traditional jurisprudence and law are implicitly normative as well” (Smith 1993, p. 10). Feminist jurisprudence sees the workings of law as thoroughly permeated by political and moral judgments about the worth of women and how women should be treated. These judgments are not commensurate with women’s understandings of themselves, nor even with traditional liberal conceptions of (moral and legal) equality and fairness.

Although feminist jurisprudence revolves around a number of questions and features a diversity of focus and approach, two characteristics are central to it. First, because the Anglo-American legal tradition is built on liberalism and its tenets, feminist jurisprudence tends to respond to liberalism in some way. The second characteristic is the goal of bringing the law and its practitioners to recognize that law as currently constructed does not acknowledge or respond to the needs of women, and must be changed. These two features can be seen in the major debates in current feminist jurisprudence, which range from questions of the proper perspective from which to understand the problems of the law, to questions of legal theory and practice.

Responding to Liberalism: Questions of Perspective
Central Concerns: Questions of Theory and Practice
Trajectories
References and Further Reading

1. Responding to Liberalism: Questions of Perspective

As a critical theory, feminist jurisprudence responds to the current dominant understanding of legal thought, which is usually identified with the liberal Anglo-American tradition. (This tradition is represented by such authors as Hart 1961 and Dworkin 1977, 1986.) Two major branches of this tradition have been legal positivism, on the one hand, and natural law theory on the other. Feminist jurisprudence responds to both these branches of the American legal tradition by raising questions regarding their assumptions about the law, including:

that law is properly objective and thus must have recourse to objective rules or understandings at some level
that law is properly impartial, especially in that it is not to be tainted by the personal experience of any of its practitioners, particularly judges
that equality must function as a formal notion rather than a substantive one, such that in the eyes of the law, difference must be shown to be “relevant” in order to be admissible/visible
that law, when working properly, should be certain, and that the goal of lawmaking and legal decision-making is to gain certainty
that justice can be understood as a matter of procedures, such that a proper following of procedures can be understood as sufficient to rendering justice.

Each of these assumptions, although contested and debated, has remained a significant feature of the liberal tradition of legal understanding.

Feminist jurisprudence usually frames its responses to traditional legal thought in terms of whether or not the critic is maintaining some commitment to the tradition or some particular feature of it. This split in responses has been formulated in a number of different ways, according to the particular concerns they emphasize. The two formulations found most frequently in American feminist jurisprudence characterize the split either as the reformist/radical debate or as the sameness/difference debate. Within the reformist/radical debate, reformist feminists argue that the liberal tradition offers much that can be shaped to fit feminist hands and should be retained for all that it offers. These feminists approach jurisprudence with an eye to what needs to be changed within the system that already exists. Their work, then, is to gain entry into that system and use its own tools to construct a legal system which prevents the inequities of patriarchy from affecting justice.

Those who see the traditional system as either bankrupt or so problematic that it cannot be reshaped are often referred to as transformist or radical feminists. According to this approach, the corruption of the legal tradition by patriarchy is thought to be too deeply embedded to allow for any significant adjustments to the problems that women face. Feminists using this approach tend to argue that the legal system, either parts or as a whole, must be abandoned. They argue that liberal legal concepts, categories and processes must be rejected, and new ones put in place which can be free from the biases of the current system. Their work, then, is to craft the transformations that are necessary in legal theory and practice and to create a new legal system that can provide a more equitable justice.

Under the sameness/difference debate, the central concern for feminists is to understand the role of difference and how women’s needs must be figured before the law. Sameness feminists argue that to emphasize the differences between men and women is to weaken women’s abilities to gain access to the rights and protections that men have enjoyed. Their concern is that it is women’s difference that has been used to keep women from enjoying a legal status equal to men’s. Consequently, they see difference as a concept that must be de-emphasized. Sameness feminists work to highlight the ways in which women can be seen as the same as men, entitled to the same rights, protections, and privileges.

Difference feminists argue that (at least some of) the differences between men and women, as well as other types of difference such as race, age, and sexual orientation, are significant. These significant differences must be taken into account by the law in order for justice and equity to be achieved. What has been good law for men cannot simply be adopted by women, because women are not in fact the same as men. Women have different needs which require different legal remedies. The law must be made to recognize differences that are relevant to women’s lives, status and possibilities.

The two characterizations of the debate about what perspective is best for understanding the problems of the law do share some features. Those who argue a sameness position are often thought to fit, to some degree, with the reformist view. Difference feminists are seen as sharing much with radicals. The parallel between the two characterizations is that both argue over how much, if any, of the current legal system can and must be preserved and put to use in the service of feminist concerns. The two characterizations are not the same, but the important parallel between them allows for some generalization regarding the ways in which each is likely to respond to particular theoretical and substantive issues. However, while the two may reasonably be grouped for some purposes, they must not be conflated.

From these perspectives, feminist jurisprudence emphasizes two kinds of question: the theoretical and the substantive. These two kinds of question are, perhaps especially for feminists, deeply connected and overlapping. Discussions of central theoretical issues in feminist jurisprudence are punctuated by elaboration of the substantive issues with which they are intertwined.

2. Central Concerns: Questions of Theory and Practice

In asking theoretical questions, feminists are concerned with how to understand the law itself, its proper scope, legitimacy, and meaning. Many of these are the questions of traditional legal theory, but asked in the context of the feminist project: What is the proper moral foundation of the law, especially given that any answer depends on the moral principles of the dominant structure of the society? What is the meaning of rule of law, especially given that obedience to law has been an important part of the history of subjugation? What is the meaning of equality, especially in a world of diversity? What is the meaning of harm, especially in a world in which women, not men, are subjected by men to certain kinds of violence? How can adjudication of conflict be properly and fairly achieved, especially when not all persons are able to come to the adjudication process on a “level playing field”? What is the meaning of property, and how can women avoid being categorized as property? Is law the best and most appropriate channel for the resolution of conflict, especially given its traditional grounding in patriarchal goals and structures?

Although feminists have addressed all these questions and more, perhaps one issue stands out in many feminists’ eyes as a matter of special importance, encompassing as it does some aspect of many of the questions noted above. The issue that for many feminists is at the heart of concerns is that of equality and rights. Two others that may be considered nearly as central are problems of harm, and of the processes of adjudication.

a. Equality and Rights

Law works partly by drawing abstract guiding principles out of the specifics of the cases it adjudicates. On this abstract level, theoretical questions arise for feminist jurisprudence regarding equality and rights, including the following: what understanding of equality will make it possible for women to have control over their lives, in both the private and public spheres? What understanding of equality will provide an adequate grounding for the concept of rights, such that women’s rights can protect both their individual liberty and their identity as women?

In general, the feminist concern with equality involves the claim that equality must be understood not simply as a formal concept that functions rhetorically and legally. Equality must be a substantive concept which can actually make changes in the power structure and the relative power positions of men and women generally. Although equality is examined in a wide variety of specific applications, the major concern is the goal of making equality meaningful in the lives of women. But for many feminists, concerns with equality cannot be addressed without also attending to rights. Because the liberal tradition figures rights as the hallmark of equality, it is in terms of rights that we are expected to see ourselves as equals before the law. Further, rights discourse has structured both our understanding of equality, and our claims to it.

Examinations of equality are, therefore, often framed by particular substantive issues. For example, much feminist jurisprudence regarding equality is framed in terms of concerns about work. If women are equal, then how will this be expressed in workplace law and policy? One of the key issues in this field has been how to treat pregnancy in the workplace: Is it fair for women to have extended or paid leave for pregnancy and birthing? Under what circumstances, or limitations? Are women being given “special” rights if they have a right to such leave? The struggle over the proper understanding of pregnancy and work raises questions about whether women should be treated in such law as individuals or as a class. As individuals, it has seemed relatively easy for workplaces to claim that not all employees are given such leave, and thus that women who do not are being treated “equally”. One feminist strategy has been to attempt to revise such law to recognize the particular difference of women as a class. Herma Hill Kay, for example, argues that pregnancy can be seen as an episode which affects women’s ability to take advantage of opportunities in the workplace, and that pregnant workers must be protected against loss of equal opportunity during episodes of pregnancy. (Kay, 1985)

Concerns over pregnancy express the fundamental questions of the sameness/difference debate. The sameness position suggests difference should be erased to the greatest extent possible, because it has been used as a basis for discrimination. Difference proponents argue that pregnancy involves significant differences which should be seen as a linchpin of legal understanding. Does equality mean that women should wish to be treated exactly the same as men, or does it mean that women should wish to be treated differently, because their differences are such that same treatment cannot provide equity?

Feminists who argue that equality requires creating for women the same opportunities and rights which are currently available to men of the ruling class are bringing the reformist or sameness approach to bear. Approaches to rights and equality which focus on women’s individuality, emphasizing it in the way that law has done for men and requiring women to show that they are like men and thus may be treated like men, tend then to be reformist or sameness oriented. Because these approaches are seen as requiring that women become as much like men as possible, and that law treat women as it does men, they are often referred to as assimilationist.

Christine Littleton (Littleton, 1987) offers a further set of terms for approaches to understanding equality: symmetrical (paralleling reformist and sameness approaches) and asymmetrical (paralleling radical and difference approaches). This classification refers to how women and men are “located in society” with regard to issues, norms and rules. If a theorist sees men and women as sharing a location regarding an issue, then that theorist has a symmetrical approach; if not, then the approach is asymmetrical. Littleton classifies assimilationist approaches as symmetrical, along with what she calls the androgyny approach. The androgyny approach argues that men and women are very much alike, but that equality will require social institutions to pick a “mean” between the two, and apply that standard to all persons. This model is less frequently argued than the assimilation model.

There are also many radical and difference approaches to equality. What they share is the desire to avoid having to take on all that is questionable and/or undesirable about (society’s construction of) men in order to be considered equal before the law. Thus many radical approaches (although not all – MacKinnon, below, is an example of one which is not) emphasize similar questions and problems as difference approaches. How to recognize relevant difference, and what kind of difference law must be responsive to, is a crucial part of these feminist examinations of equality. Ann Scales, for example, argues that liberal/reformist approaches do not do enough to really make the changes that are necessary, because the problem in equality is a problem of understanding how domination works. We must learn to see how equality has formally been tied in to domination through the liberal framework. In her view, a certain kind of inequality needs to be recognized and worked with, rather than ignored or assimilated. (Scales, 1986)

Other difference/radical approaches include the special rights, accommodation, acceptance, and empowerment models. (Littleton, 1987) The special rights model suggests that justice requires our recognizing that equality is too easily understood as “sameness”, where men and women are not the same. Rights should be based on needs, and if women have needs that men do not, that should not limit their rights. The accommodation model asserts that differences which are not fundamental or biologically based should be treated under a symmetrical or assimilation model. But this leaves those differences which are fundamental (such as the ability to be pregnant) as differences which must be recognized in the law and accommodated by it.

Littleton’s own approach is expressed in the acceptance model. This argues that (gender) difference must be accepted, and that law should focus on the consequences of such differences, rather than the differences themselves. Although differences exist between men and women, equality should function to make these differences “costless” relative to each other. Equality should function to prevent women’s being penalized on the basis of their difference. Thus equality should require us to institute paid leave for pregnancy and birthing, and to guarantee women’s return to their jobs after birthing.

Empowerment models reject difference as irrelevant, and shift focus to levels of empowerment. Equality, then, is understood as what balances power for groups and individuals, and dismantles the ability of some to dominate others. This radical and asymmetrical view does not, however, fit well with the categorization of feminist positions in terms of sameness and difference. The empowerment model’s focus on domination and the ways in which power is distributed seems to represent a significant departure from the parallel suggested above. Thus some feminist jurists have suggested that it be understood as a separate approach. Judith Baer calls it simply the domination model of feminist jurisprudence. Catherine MacKinnon is one well-known scholar who holds this view. (MacKinnon, 1987) In her theorizing of pornography, for example, she focuses on the question of how power is used in pornography to maintain a structure of domination which belies the possibility of equality between men and women.

Feminist critiques of rights in general assert that rights have been apportioned based on notions of equality that deliberately exclude the needs of women. If rights are to be truly equal, they must be apportioned on a more equitable basis, informed by the experience of women and others previously excluded. Or, following MacKinnon or Patricia Williams (discussed below), rights must be apportioned based on how they empower those to whom they are granted. Feminist scholars debate the ground for understanding rights while working to create a foundation from which women can claim and exercise rights that will be meaningful in their lives.

b. Understanding Harm

Perhaps the most difficult question for feminist jurisprudence regarding the issue of harm is that of perspective: who defines and identifies harm in specific cases? Given that law has traditionally worked from a patriarchal perspective, it is perhaps not surprising that identifying harm to women has been problematic. A patriarchal system will benefit from a very stingy recognition of harms against women. Feminist jurisprudence, therefore, must examine the basic question, what is harm? It also must ask, what counts as harm in our legal system, and why? What has been excluded from definitions of harm that women need included, and how can such trends be overturned?

Three types of harm-causing actions that are typically and systematically directed against women have formed the background for discussion about what harm means, and what counts as harm: rape, sexual harassment, and battering. Until fairly recently (for example, before the legislative reform movements of the 1970s), some forms of these actions were not considered actionable offenses under the law. This was largely due to the history of understanding women not as independent and autonomous agents, but as property belonging to men (thus issues of the meaning of property are also crucial to understanding harm). Feminist jurisprudence has challenged this state of affairs. As a result, changes have been made in the laws regarding each of the three categories, although the effectiveness of these changes is widely disputed (see, e.g., Schulhofer 1998 for an excellent review of this law). At the very least, work by feminists has made it possible to speak of these harms by providing a vocabulary for them, by raising awareness about them, and by prosecuting them more frequently and with some success.

Discussions of rape attempt to answer many of the questions that apply to all three types of harm-causing actions. Cases of all three types give rise to similar problems that prevent women from being treated justly: blaming the victim; privileging the point of view of “the” agent, i.e., the male perpetrator; indicting the woman’s sexual history while ignoring the man’s history, whether sexual or violent. Underlying all these problems are assumptions about gender and agency which encourage the law to place responsibility for their own harm on women rather than on the men who cause it. Women have been believed to be mentally unstable or at least weak-minded, to be scheming and deceptive, and to have an improper motivation for making claims of harm against men. For these reasons, they tend to be seen as untrustworthy witnesses. Because they have been characterized as sexually insatiable and indiscriminate, they tend to be seen as deserving whatever harm they “provoke” from men. Corresponding assumptions about men’s rational superiority encourage their being seen as believable witnesses. At the same time, assumptions about men’s natural sexual needs are taken as justification for their violations of women. Feminist jurisprudence attempts to respond to these problems as double standards and matters of equality and rights.

Other issues of harm require different responses. Harm-causing actions tend to be defined in terms of external and observable characteristics (levels of force), of intention on the part of the agent (mens rea), and of the consent of the one harmed. Consequently, what is at issue is how law uses these criteria in determining both when harm has occurred and whether it is to be justified or excused. What feminist jurisprudence has found is that women and men frequently differ over the understanding of each of these criteria. But since it is a patriarchal understanding which grounds the law, women’s understandings tend not to be given a proper hearing.

In Susan Estrich’s discussion of rape (Estrich, 1987, 1987a), she claims that the mens rea criterion can be used to create either too much emphasis on the perpetrator’s intention, or too little. In either case, she believes the focus on this criterion makes evident the law’s lack of understanding of and concern for the harms women suffer. The law’s focus is to not wrongly punish men, which is achieved at the cost of not protecting women.

Further, Estrich argues that the force criterion is understood from a patriarchal perspective: force is seen as a matter of what “boys do in schoolyards.” This criterion figures force as a simple matter of the straightforward use of physical strength, or the use of implements of violence. But it ignores the kinds of force that are most frequently used in rape and other types of harm to women, such as psychological coercion. If the courts expect women to resist physical and psychological coercion in the same ways and at the same level that men do, then the courts impose an unreasonable expectation on the “reasonable” woman.

Regarding consent, Estrich explains that the courts have believed that if consent is given, then rape (or other harms) do not occur. This places responsibility on the one who has been harmed to show that she did not, in fact, consent. But patriarchal courts have held that only the strongest and most emphatic expression of non-consent functions as evidence. This means that in many cases, women have been said to have “consented” even though they were physically carried off by men and verbally expressed non-consent (Schulhofer 1998). Non-consent has not been easily proven unless the woman has been severely beaten, or unless a significant weapon (that is, gun or knife) was used, or death was threatened in a way that convinces the court. Thus what non-consent means for the court has been very different from what women themselves have said about (their) consent.

Robin West (West, 1988) argues along similar lines, claiming that women’s social training does not impart the same fundamental values that men’s training does. She theorizes that men value separation and autonomy to the point that they would physically fight, desperately, to maintain theirs. But because women value connection and relation most highly, they find it difficult to respond to physical violence with violence of their own. Violence destroys connection and relationship, which is what women are socialized to value most. This makes it difficult for women to respond to rape, and other harms, in a way which convinces masculine courts that they did not consent. Women’s definition and identification of these harms is very different from what the courts have so far constructed.

It is difficult to separate out some parts of the reformist or sameness and radical or difference approaches with regard to harm. In general, however, those who argue that current laws can be changed to adequately protect women have reformist or sameness views. Those arguing that the current definitions of harm simply cannot be revised sufficiently have radical or difference views. Thus Estrich, who concludes that we need to treat rape as we treat other kinds of crime which require nonconsent (theft, for example) could be considered a reformist view. Mary Lou Fellows and Bev Balos offer a similar analysis of how women’s perception of the harms of date rape can be accommodated in current law. This can be accomplished by the application of the heightened duty of care that exists already in the common law doctrine of confidential relationship. (Fellows and Balos, 1991) West’s argument, based on recognizing and responding to fundamental differences between men and women regarding harm, could be seen as a radical or difference view. MacKinnon’s analysis of sexual harassment, which focuses on the need for women to be empowered to define the harms against them, represents a dominance view on harms.

c. The Processes of Adjudication

Many feminist jurists challenge the processes of adjudication by raising questions about the neutrality or impartiality that such processes are assumed to embody. Neutrality is believed to function in the law in at least two ways. It is assumed to be built into the processes of the law, and it is assumed to be produced by those processes. Feminist jurisprudence challenges the first set of assumptions by raising questions about legal reasoning. It challenges the second by raising questions about how a law created and applied by partial and biased persons can itself be neutral. Thus feminist jurisprudence also raises the question of whether neutrality is a possible, or an appropriate, goal of the law.

As traditionally understood, neutrality in law is supposed to protect us from a number of ills. It protects from personal bias by insisting that judges, attorneys, law enforcement officers, etc., treat us not as people with specific characteristics, but as interchangeable subjects. We should be seen only in terms of certain specific actions and our intentions with regard to those specific actions. Officials are expected not to bring their personal biases to bear on those who come before them, and certain personal aspects of those brought before the law are not permitted to come under scrutiny. For example, if a judge personally believes that women are pathological liars, this is not supposed to influence his or her interpretation of any particular woman’s testimony. Similarly, no person’s race is supposed to influence any judge’s understanding of their case. Feminist jurisprudence challenges such claims to neutrality.

Neutrality in law is supposed to protect against ideological bias as well. It does this by taking a supposedly universal perspective on a case, rather than a particular perspective. This belief that law and its practitioners can see, and judge, from the “view from nowhere” has been criticized by feminist jurisprudence. Feminists claim that such complete objectivity seems not to be fully possible. They also argue that claiming such neutrality deflects attention away from the fact that a partial view – a masculinist view – is being presented as universal. Feminist jurisprudence, like most feminist theory, rejects the claim of law that it is a neutral practice, and instead points to the ways in which law is clearly not neutral.

One of the ways law is not neutral is through the individual people that work in law. Feminist jurisprudence argues that because there is no such thing as the “view from nowhere”, every understanding has a perspective. This perspective influences it, and provides an interpretive field for whatever matters of fact there may be. Since law is made, administered and enforced by people, and people must have a perspective, law must reflect those perspectives at least to some degree. Feminists tend to agree that to the extent that a practice or person is unaware of their own perspective, that perspective will more strongly influence their interpretations of the world. It is when we become aware of biases that we are able, through critical reflection, to reduce their influence and thus move toward a greater (although not a perfect) objectivity.

Another way that law is not neutral is in its content. Because it is made by people, many of whom have not critically examined their own standpoints, the content of law may be unfair or discriminatory. Such content would require officials to act in ways that are not impartial, or not fair. But even if law is written by those whose perspectives are relatively objective, our legislative system often imposes compromises on laws. Some compromises required to pass law may change or weaken its objectives in ways that prevent its functioning as intended. These criticisms show that the content of the law, affected by the contestations of our legislative system, may not be neutral. Further, it shows that the processes of the law do not guarantee the neutrality that they are assumed to do.

Neutrality is also assumed to be built into certain processes of the law, and in particular the processes of judicial reasoning. The traditional model of judicial decision-making relies on case law, which uses precedent and analogy to provide evidence and justification. Interpretation of statutes in prior cases provides precedent or rules. Courts then attempt to determine how the facts of current cases require one rule or another to be brought to bear. This way of making decisions has itself been thought to be neutral, and the formalities of due process that support it are thought to reinforce that neutrality. This feature of law, relying on past judgments to influence current and future ones, also makes it peculiarly resistant to change. For feminist jurisprudence, use of precedent allows the law to insulate itself against the critiques of outsiders, including women.

Use of precedent has been challenged by a feminist and non-feminist critiques, including the pragmatism of Margaret Radin (Radin, 1990) and Jerome Frank’s legal realism (Frank, 1963). Feminist jurisprudence responds to use of precedent by pointing out those areas which are most likely to be subject to sexist understandings. For example, case law that has derived from cases in which plaintiffs and defendants are men will assume that the circumstances for those men are simply the “normal” circumstances. Workplace law has frequently been challenged by feminist critics for this reason. The law assumes, based on cases in which the workplace was populated mainly by men, that everyone who works shares men’s circumstances. This assumption entails that workers are supported by a full-time homemaker, such that the burdens of home life and child rearing should not affect one’s ability to function efficiently in the workplace. But such assumptions work against women, who usually are supporting someone else in this way rather than being supported.

Reform and sameness feminists argue that case law is not a bad system but that reforms are needed to emphasize to the realities of women’s lives. Radical and difference feminists are more likely to argue that case law is itself a system that is too heavily entrenched in patriarchy to be maintained. Its reliance on precedent makes it too conservative a system of decision-making to be adequately brought to the service of feminism.

3. Trajectories

Although it seems that the sameness/difference and the reform/radical debates could create an impasse for feminists, some theorists believe that some combination of the two views can be more effective than either alone. Patricia Williams (Williams, 1991), for example, believes that rights can function as powerful liberatory tools for the traditionally disadvantaged. However, she also believes that in a racist society such as contemporary America, racial difference must be recognized because it creates disadvantage before the law. In this way, she claims that some features of the liberal tradition, like rights, need to be maintained for the liberatory work they can do. However, she argues that the liberal tradition of formal equality is damaging to historically marginalized groups. This aspect of law needs to be completely transformed.

As an example of the ways in which rights are still needed by the traditionally disadvantaged, she examines the relationship to rights that is enjoyed by a white male colleague. His sense of his rights is so entrenched that he sees them as creating distance between himself and others, and believes that rights should be played down. In contrast, Williams expresses her own relationship to rights, being a black woman, as much more tenuous. The history of American slavery, under which black Americans were literally owned by whites, makes it difficult for both blacks and whites to figure blacks as empowered by rights in the same ways that whites are.

This example shows how Williams weaves together important elements of both reform and radical positions, and at the same time includes the element of empowerment that is seen in dominance positions. She claims that for blacks, and for any traditionally disadvantaged group, rights are a significant part of a program of advancement. One’s relationship to rights depends on who one is, and how one is empowered by one’s society and law. For those whose rights are already guaranteed, what may be necessary for social change is to challenge the power of rights rhetoric for one’s group. But for those whose rights have never been secure, this will not look like the best course of action. Williams’ suggestion is that we recognize that rights and rights rhetoric function differently in different settings and for different people. But this, then, is a response which relies on the radical and difference premise that difference must in fact be attended to rather than elided. In order that rights be made effective for historically marginalized people, we must first see that they do not in fact function for all people in the way that they do for those they were created for.

Another approach to drawing the two sides of the debate in feminist jurisprudence together is offered by Judith Baer, whose claim is that feminist jurisprudence to date has failed to either reform or transform law because feminists in both camps have made crucial mistakes. (Baer, 1999) The primary error has been that feminist jurisprudence has tended to misunderstand the tradition it criticizes. Although feminist jurists recognize that the liberal tradition has secured rights for men but not women, they have failed to make explicit the corresponding asymmetry of responsibility. Women are accorded responsibility for themselves and others in ways that men are not. For example, women are expected to be responsible for the lives of children in ways that men are not; as noted above, this has implications in areas like workplace law.

The second major error Baer sees in feminist jurisprudence is that it, along with most feminism, has tended to focus almost exclusively on women. This has drawn feminist attention away from men and the institutions that feminism needs to study, criticize, challenge and change. It has also created a series of debates within feminism that are divisive and draining of feminist energy. Again, the solution is to recognize when reform (sameness) and radical (difference) approaches are effective, and to use each as appropriate. Baer argues that

[f]eminist jurists need not – indeed, we must not – choose between laws that treat men and women the same and laws that treat them differently. We already know that both kinds of law can be sexist. Our gender-neutral law of reproductive rights treats women worse than men, but so did “protective” labor legislation. Conversely, both gender-neutral and gender-specific laws can promote sexual equality. Comparable worth legislation would make women more nearly equal with men. So have affirmative action policies. Women can have it both ways. Law can treat men and women alike where they are alike and differently where they are different. (Baer 1999, 55)

Baer provides critiques of both reform and radical feminist jurisprudence. She concludes that neither alone is sufficient, but that both, applied where appropriate, could be. She argues that the feminist focus on women has encouraged an inability to think on a universal scale. This leaves feminists, and law under feminist jurisprudence, mired in the particularities of individual cases and individual traits. To move out of this mire, she suggests three tasks for feminist jurisprudence:

First, it must do the opposite of what conventional theory and feminist critiques have done: posit rights and question responsibility. Second, it must develop analyses that will separate situations from the people experiencing them, so we can talk about women’s victimization without labeling them as victims. Finally, it must move beyond women and begin scrutinizing men and institutions. (Baer 1999, 68)

Baer does not suggest that feminism, nor feminist jurisprudence, should give up the study of women and women’s situations. Rather, her suggestion is that this study as an exclusive focus is not sufficient for either reform or transformation. Because “women neither create nor sustain their position in society” feminists need to scrutinize those who do. Baer’s suggestion is that what is needed is an account of “what it means to be a human being, a man, or a woman, which makes equality possible.” (Baer 1999, 192) The mistakes that feminist jurisprudence has made have prevented its developing this account, which Baer thinks could be the foundation of what she calls a feminist postliberalism sufficient for feminist jurisprudence.

4. References and Further Reading

Baer, Judith A, Our Lives Before the Law: Constructing a Feminist Jurisprudence (Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1999)
Cornell, Drucilla, Beyond Accommodation: Ethical Feminism, Deconstruction and the Law (New York: Routledge, 1990)
Dworkin, Andrea, Intercourse, (New York: The Free Press, 1987)
Dworkin, Ronald, Law’s Empire (Cambridge: Harvaard University Press, 1986)
Dworkin, Ronald, Taking Rights Seriously (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1977)
Estrich, Susan, “Rape,” 95 Yale Law Journal 1087-1184 (1987)
Estrich, Susan, Real Rape (Cambrdige: Harvard University Press, 1987a)
Fellows, Mary Louise and Beverly Balos, “Guilty of the Crime of Trust: Nonstranger Rape” 75 Minnesota Law Review 599 (1991)
Hart, H.L.A., The Concept of Law, (New York, Oxford University Press, 1961)
Jerome, Frank, Law and the Modern Mind (New York: Doubleday and Co., 1963)
Kay, Herma Hill, “Equality and Difference: The Case of Pregnancy,” 1 Berkeley Women’s Law Journal 1-37 (1985)
Littleton, Christine A., “Reconstructing Sexual Equality,” 75 California Law Review 1279-1337 (1987)
MacKinnon, Catherine, Feminism Unmodified: Discourses on Life and Law (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1987)
Minow, Martha, Making All the Difference: Inclusion, Exclusion and American Law (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1991)
Radin, Margaret Jane, “The Pragmatist and the Feminist,” 63 Southern California Law Review, 1699 (1990)
Scales, Ann C., “The Emergence of Feminist Jurisprudence: An Essay,” 95 Yale Law Journal 1373-1403 (1986)
Schulhofer, Stephen J., Unwanted Sex: The Culture of Intimidation and the Failure of Law (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1998)
Smith, Patricia, ed., Feminist Jurisprudence (New York: Oxford University Press, 1993)
Tong, Rosemarie, Women, Sex and the Law (Totowa, NJ: Rowman and Littlefield, 1984)
West, Robin, “Jurisprudence and Gender,” 55 University of Chicago Law Review 1 (1988)
Williams, Patricia, The Alchemy of Race and Rights (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1991)

Author Information

Melissa Burchard
Email: mburchard@unca.edu
University of North Carolina – Asheville
U. S. A.

Animal Minds

This article surveys philosophical issues related to the nature and scope of animal mentality, as well as to our commonsense understanding and scientific knowledge of animal minds. Two general sets of problems have played a prominent role in defining the field and will take center stage in the discussion below: (i) the problems of animal thought and reason, and (ii) the problems of animal consciousness.

The article begins by examining three historically influential views on animal thought and reason. The first is David Hume’s analogical argument for the existence of thought and reason in animals. The second is René Descartes‘ two arguments against animal thought and reason. And the third is Donald Davidson‘s three arguments against ascribing thought and reason to animals.

Next, the article examines contemporary philosophical views on the nature and limits of animal reason by Jonathan Bennett, José Bermúdez, and John Searle, as well as four prominent arguments for the existence of animal thought and reason: (i) the argument from the intentional systems theory by Daniel Dennett, (ii) the argument from common-sense functionalism by Jerry Fodor, Peter Carruthers, and Stephen Stich, (iii) the argument from biological naturalism by John Searle, and (iv) the argument from science by Colin Allen and Marc Bekoff, and José Bermúdez.

The article then turns to the important debate over animal consciousness. Three theories of consciousness—the inner-sense theory, the higher-order thought theory, and the first-order theory—are examined in relation to what they have to say about the possibility and existence of animal consciousness.

The article ends with a brief description of other important issues within the field, such as the nature and existence of animal emotions and propositional knowledge, the status of Lloyd Morgan’s canon and other methodological principles of simplicity used in the science of animal minds, the nature and status of anthropomorphism employed by scientists and lay folk, and the history of the philosophy of animal minds. The field has had a long and distinguished history and has of late seen a revival.

The Problems of Animal Thought and Reason
The Problems of Animal Consciousness
1. Higher-Order Theories of Consciousness
  1. Inner-Sense Theories
  2. Higher-Order Thought Theories
2. First-Order Theories
Other Issues
References and Further Reading
1. References
2. Suggested Further Readings

1. The Problems of Animal Thought and Reason

Given what we know or can safely assume to be true of their behaviors and brains, can animals have thought and reason? The answer depend in large measure on what one takes thought and reason to be, as well as what animals one is considering. Philosophers have held various views about the nature and possession conditions of thought and reason and, as a result, have offered various arguments for and against thought and reason in animals. Below are the most influential of such arguments.

a. Hume’s Argument for Animal Thought and Reason

David Hume (1711-1776) famously proclaimed that “no truth appears to be more evident, than that beast are endow’d with thought and reason as well as men” (1739/1978, p. 176). The type of thought that Hume had in mind here was belief, which he defined as a “lively idea” or “image” caused by (or associated with) a prior sensory experience (1739/1978, p. 94). Reason Hume defined as a mere disposition or instinct to form associations among such ideas on the basis of past experience. In the section of A Treatise of Human Nature entitled, “Of the Reason of Animals,” Hume argued by analogy that since animals behave in ways that closely resemble the behaviors of human beings that we know to be caused by associations among ideas, animals also behave as a result of forming similar associations among ideas in their minds. Given Hume’s definitions of “thought” and “reason,” he took this analogical argument to give “incontestable” proof that animals have thought and reason.

A well-known problem with Hume’s argument is the fact that “belief” does not appear to be definable in terms of vivid ideas presented to consciousness. Beliefs have propositional content, whereas ideas, as Hume understood them, do not (or need not). To have a belief or thought about some object (for example, the color red) always involves representing some fact or proposition about it (for example, that red is the color of blood), but one can entertain an image of something (for example, the color red) without representing any fact or proposition about it. Also, beliefs aim at the truth, they represent states of affairs as being the case, whereas ideas, even vivid ideas, do not. Upon looking down a railway track, for instance, one could close one’s eyes and entertain a vivid idea of the tracks as they appeared a moment ago (that is, as converging in the distance) without thereby believing that the tracks actually converge. And it is further argued, insofar as “belief” fails to be definable in terms of vivid ideas presented to consciousness, “reason” fails to be definable in terms of a disposition to form associations among such ideas; for whatever else reason might be, so the argument goes, it is a surely a relation among beliefs. Finally, and independently of Hume’s definitions of “belief” and “reason,” there is a serious question about how incontestable his analogical proof is, since similar types of behaviors can often be caused by very different types of processes. Toy robotic dogs, computers, and even radios behave in ways that are similar to the ways that human beings behave when we have vivid ideas presented to our consciousness, but few would take this fact alone as incontestable proof that these objects act as a result of vivid ideas presented to their consciousness (Searle 1994).

b. Descartes’ Two Arguments Against Animal Thought and Reason

Equally as famous as Hume’s declaration that animals have thought and reason is René Descartes’ (1596-1650) declaration that they do not. “[A]fter the error of those who deny God, ” Descartes wrote, “there is none that leads weak minds further from the straight path of virtue than that of imagining that the souls of beasts are of the same nature as our own” (1637/1988, p. 46). Descartes gave two independent arguments for his denial of animal thought and reason, which have come to be called his language-test argument and his action-test argument, respectively (Radner & Radner 1989).

i. The Language-Test Argument

Not surprising, Descartes meant something different from Hume by “thought.” In the context of denying it of animals, Descartes appears to take the term to stand for occurrent thought—that is, thoughts that one entertains, brings to mind, or is suddenly struck by (Malcolm 1973). Normal adult human beings, of course, express their occurrent thoughts through their declarative speech; and declarative speech and occurrent thoughts share some important features. Both, for example, have propositional content, both are stimulus independent (that is, thoughts can occur to one, and declarative speech can be produced, quite independently of what is going on in one’s immediate perceptual environment), and both are action independent (that is, thoughts can occur to one, and declarative speech can be produced, that are quite irrelevant to one’s current actions or needs). In light of these commonalities, it is understandable why Descartes took declarative speech to be “the only certain sign of thought hidden in a body” (1649/1970, p. 244-245).

In addition to taking speech to be thought’s only certain sign, Descartes argued that the absence of speech in animals could only be explained in terms of animals lacking thought. Descartes was well aware that animals produce calls, cries, songs, and various gestures that function to express their “passions,” but, he argued, they never produce anything like declarative speech in which they “use words, or put together other signs, as we do in order to declare our thoughts to others” (1637/1988, p. 45). This fact, Descartes reasoned, could not be explained in terms of animals lacking the necessary speech organs, since, he argued, speech organs are not required, as evidenced by the fact that humans born “deaf” or “dumb” typically invent signs to engage in declarative speech, and some animals (for example, magpies and parrots) who have the requisite speech organs never produce declarative speech; nor could it be explained as a result of speech requiring a great deal of intelligence, since even the most “stupid” and “insane” humans beings are capable of it; and neither could it be explained, as it is in the case of human infants who are incapable of speech but nevertheless possess thought, in terms of animals failing to develop far enough ontogenetically, since “animals never grow up enough for any certain sign of thought to be detected in them” (1649/1970, p. 251). Rather, Descartes concluded, the best explanation for the absence of speech in animals is the absence of what speech expresses—thought. There are various places in his writings where Descartes appears to go on from this conclusion to maintain that since all modes of thinking and consciousness depend upon the existence of thought, animals are devoid of all forms of thinking and consciousness and are nothing but mindless machines or automata. It should be noted, however, that not every commentator has accepted this interpretation (see Cottingham 1978).

Various responses have been given to Descartes’ language-test argument. Malcolm (1973), for example, argued that dispositional thinking is not dependent upon occurrent thought, as Descartes seemed to suppose, and is clearly possessed by many animals. The fact that Fido cannot entertain the thought, the cat is in the tree, Malcolm argued, is not a reason to doubt that he thinks that the cat is in the tree. Others (Hauser et al. 2002), following Noam Chomsky, have argued that the best explanation for the absence of speech in animals is the not the absence of occurrent thought but the absence of the capacity for recursion (that is, the ability to produce and understand a potentially infinite number of expressions from a finite array of expressions). And others (Pepperberg 1999; Savage-Rumbaugh et al. 1998; Tetzlaff & Rey 2009) have argued that, contrary to Descartes and Chomsky, some animals, such as grey parrots, chimpanzee, and honeybees, possess the capacity to put together various signs in order to express their thoughts. Finally, it has been argued that there are behaviors other than declarative speech, such as insight learning, that can reasonably be taken as evidence of occurrent thought in animals (see Köhler 1925; Heinrich 2000).

ii. The Action-Test Argument

Whereas Descartes’ principal aim in his language-test argument was to prove that animals lack thought, his principal aim in his action-test argument is prove that animals lack reason. By “reason,” Descartes meant “a universal instrument which can be used in all kinds of situations” (1637/1988, p. 44). For Descartes, to act through reason is to act on general principles that can be applied to an open-ended number of different circumstances. Descartes acknowledged that animals sometime act in accordance with such general rules of reason (for example, as when the kingfisher is said to act in accordance with Snell’s Law when it dives into a pond to catch a fish (see Boden 1984)), but he argued that this does not show that they act for these reasons, since animals show no evidence of transferring this knowledge of the general principles under which their behaviors fall to an open-ended number of novel circumstances.

Some researchers and philosophers have accepted Descartes’ definition of “reason” but have argued that some animals do show the capacity to transfer their general knowledge to a wide (or wide enough) range of novel situations. For example, honey bees that were trained to fly down a corridor that had the same (or different) color as the entry room into which they had initially flown automatically transferred this knowledge to the novel stimulus dimension of smell: those that were trained to choose the corridor with the same color, flew down the corridor with the same smell as in the entry room; and those that were trained to choose the corridor with a different color, flew down the corridor with a different smell as in the entry room. It is difficult to resist interpreting the bees’ performance here, as the researchers do, in terms of their grasping and then transferring the general rule, “pick the same/different feature” (Giurfa et al. 2001). Other researchers and philosophers, however, have objected to Descartes’ definition of “reason.” They argue that reason is not, as Descartes conceived it, a universal instrument but is more like a Swiss army knife in which there is a collection of various specialized capacities dedicated to solving problems in particular domains (Hauser 2000; Carruthers 2006). On this view of intelligence, sometimes called the massive modularity thesis, subjects have various distinct mechanisms, or modules, in their brains for solving problems in different domains (for example, a module for solving navigation problems, a module for solving problems in the physical environment, a module for solving social problems within a group, and so on). It is not to be expected on this theory of intelligence that an animal capable of solving problems in one domain, such as exclusion problems for food, should be capable of solving similar problems in a variety of other domains, such as exclusion problems for predators, mates, and offspring. Therefore, on the massive modularity thesis, the fact that “many animals show more skill than we do in some of their actions, yet the same animals show none at all in many others” is not evidence, as Descartes saw it (1637/1988, p. 45), that animals lack intelligence and reason but that their intelligence and reason are domain specific.

c. Davidson’s Arguments Against Animal Thought and Reason

No 20th century philosopher is better known for his denial of animal thought and reason than Donald Davidson (1917-2003). In a series of articles (1984, 1985, 1997), Davidson put forward three distinct but related arguments against animal thought and reason: the intensionality test, the argument from holism, and his main argument. Although Davidson’s arguments are not much discussed these days (for exceptions, see Beisecker 2001; Glock 2000; Fellows 2000), they were quite influential in shaping the direction of the contemporary debate in philosophy on animal thought and reason and continue to pose a challenging skeptical position on this topic, which makes them deserved of close examination.

i. The Intensionality Test

The intensionality test rest on the assumption that the contents of beliefs (and thought in general) are finer grained than the states of affairs they are about. The belief that Benjamin Franklyn was the inventor of bifocals, for example, is not the same as the belief that the first postmaster general of the US was the inventor of bifocals, even though both beliefs are about the same state of affairs. This fine-grained nature of belief content is reflected in the sentences we use to ascribe them. Thus, the sentence, “Sam believes that Benjamin Franklyn was the inventor of bifocals,” may be true while the sentence, “Sam believes that the first postmaster general of the US was the inventor of bifocals,” may be false. Belief ascriptions that have this semantic feature—that is, their truth value may be affected by the substitution of co-referring expressions within their “that”-clauses—are called intensional (or semantically opaque). The reason that is typically given for why belief ascriptions are intensional is that their purpose is to describe the way the subject thinks or conceives of some object or state of affairs. Belief ascriptions with this purpose are called de dicto ascriptions, as opposed to de re ascriptions (see below).

Our de dicto belief ascriptions to animals are unjustified, Davidson argued, since for any plausible de dicto belief ascription that we make there are countless others and no principled way of deciding which is the correct way of describing how the animal thinks. Take, for instance, the claim that Fido believes that the cat is in the tree. It seems that one could just as well have said that Fido believes that the small furry object is in the tree, or that the small furry object is in the tallest object in the yard, and so on. And yet there does not appear to be any objective fact of the matter that would determine the correct translation into our language of the way Fido thinks about the cat and the tree. Davidson concludes that “unless there is behaviour that can be interpreted as speech, the evidence will not be adequate to justify the fine distinctions we are used to making in attribution of thought” (1984, p. 164).

Some philosophers (Searle 1994; McGinn 1982) have interpreted Davidson’s argument here as aiming to prove that animals cannot have thought on the basis of a verificationist principle which holds that if we cannot determinately verify what a creature thinks, then it cannot think. Such philosophers reject this principle on the grounds that absence of proof of what is thought is not thereby proof of the absence of thought. But Davidson himself states that he is not appealing to such a principle in his argument (1985, p. 476), and neither does he say that he takes the intensionality test to prove that animals cannot have thought. Rather, he takes the argument to undermine our intuitive confidence in our ascriptions of de dicto beliefs to animals.

However, even on this interpretation of the intensionality test, objections have been raised. Some philosophers (Armstrong 1973; Allen & Bekoff 1997; Bermúdez 2003a, 2003b) have argued that, contrary to Davidson’s claim, there is a principled way of deciding among the alternative de dicto belief ascriptions to animals—by scientifically studying their discriminatory behaviors under various conditions and by stipulating the meanings of the terms used in our de dicto ascriptions so the they do not attribute more than what is necessary to capture the way the animal thinks. Although at present we may not be completely entitled to any one of the many de dicto belief ascriptions to animals, according to this view, there is no reason to think that we could not come to be so entitled through future empirical research on animal behavior and by the stipulation of the meanings of the terms used in our belief ascriptions. Also, it is important to mention that Bermúdez (2003a; 2003b) has developed a fairly well worked out theory of how to make de dicto ascriptions to animals that takes the practice of making such attributions to be a form of success semantics—”the idea that true beliefs are functions from desires to action that cause thinkers to behave in the ways that will satisfy their desires” (2003a, p. 65). (See Fodor 2003 for a criticism of Bermúdez’s success semantic approach.)

In addition, David Armstrong (1973) has objected that the intensionality test merely undermines our justification of de dicto belief ascriptions to animals, not de re belief ascriptions, since the latter do not aim to describe how the animal thinks but simply to identify the state of affairs the animal’s thought is about. Furthermore, Armstrong argues that it is in fact de re belief ascriptions, not de dicto belief ascriptions, that we ordinarily use to describe animal beliefs. When we say that Fido believes that the cat is up the tree, for example, our intention is simply to pick out the state of affairs that Fido’s belief is about, while remaining neutral with respect to how Fido thinks about it. Roughly, what we are saying, according to Armstong, is that Fido believes a proposition of the form Rab, where “R” is Fido’s relational concept that picks out the same two-place relation as our term “up,” “a” is Fido’s concept that refers to the same class of animals as our word “cat,” and “b” is Fido’s concept that refers to the same class of objects as our word “tree.”

ii. The Argument from Holism

One thing that Armstrong’s objection assumes is that we are at present justified in saying what objects, properties, or states of affairs in the world an animal’s belief is about. Davidson’s second argument, the argument from holism, aims to challenge this assumption. Davidson endorses a holistic principle regarding how the referents or extension of beliefs are determined. According to this principle, “[b]efore some object in, or aspect of, the world can become part of the subject matter of a belief (true or false) there must be endless true beliefs about the subject matter” (1984, p. 168). Applying this principle to the case of animals, Davidson argues that in order for us to be entitled to fix the extension of an animal’s belief, we must suppose that the animal has an endless stock of other beliefs. So, according to Davidson, to be entitled to say that Fido has a belief about a cat, we must assume that Fido has a large stock of other beliefs about cats and related things, such as that cats are three-dimensional objects that persist through various changes, that they are animals, that animals are living organisms, that cats can move freely about their environment, and so on. There is no fixed list of beliefs about cats and related items that Fido needs to possess in order to have a belief about cats, Davidson maintains, but unless Fido has a very large stock of such general beliefs, we will not be entitled to say that he has a belief about a cat as opposed to something else, such as undetached cat parts, or the surface of a cat, or a cat appearance, or a stage in the history of a cat. But in the absence of speech, Davidson claims, “there could [not] be adequate grounds for attributing the general beliefs needed for making sense of any thought” (Davidson 1985, p. 475). The upshot is that we are not, and never will be, justified even in our de re ascriptions of beliefs to animals.

One chief weakness with Davidson’s argument here is that its rests upon a radical form of holism that would appear to deny that any two human beings could have beliefs about the same things, since no two human beings ever share all (or very nearly all) the same general background beliefs on some subject. This has been taken by some philosophers as a reductio of the theory (Fodor and Lepore 1992).

iii. Davidson’s Main Argument

Davidson’s main argument against animal thought consists of the following two steps:

First, I argue that in order to have a belief, it is necessary to have the concept of belief.

Second, I argue that in order to have the concept of belief one must have language.
(1985, p. 478)

Davidson concludes from these steps that since animals do not understand or speak a language, they cannot have beliefs. Davidson goes on to defend the centrality of belief, which holds that no creature can have thought or reason of any form without possessing beliefs, and concludes that animals are incapable of any form of thought or reason.

Davidson supports the first step of his main argument by pointing out what he sees as a logical connection between the possession of belief and the capacity for being surprised, and between the capacity for being surprised and possessing the concept belief. The idea, roughly, is that for any (empirical) proposition p, if one believes that p, then one should be surprised to discover that p is not the case, but to be surprised that p is not the case involves believing that one’s former belief that p was false, which, in turn, requires one to have the concept belief (as well as the concept falsity). (See Moser (1983) for a rendition of Davidson’s argument that avoids Davidson’s appeal to surprise.)

Davidson’s defense of the second step of his main argument is sketchier and more speculative. The general idea, however, appears to be as follows. If one has the concept belief and is thereby able to comprehend that one has beliefs, then one must also be able to comprehend that one’s beliefs are sometimes true and sometimes false, since beliefs are, by their nature, states capable of being true or false. However, to comprehend that one’s beliefs are true or false is to comprehend that they succeed or fail to depict the objective facts. But the only way for a creature to grasp the idea of a world of objective facts, Davidson speculates, is through its ability to triangulate—that is, through its ability to compare its own beliefs with those of others. Therefore, Davidson argues, since triangulation necessarily involves the capacity of ascribing beliefs to others and this capacity, according to the intensionality test and the argument from holism (see sections 1c.i and 1c.ii. above), requires language, possessing the concept belief requires the possession of language.

A number of commentators of Davidson’s main argument have raised objections to his defense of its first step—that having beliefs requires having the concept belief. Carruthers (2008), Tye (1997) and Searle (1996), for example, all argue that having beliefs does not require having the concept belief. These philosophers agree that beliefs, by their nature, are states that are revisable in light of supporting or countervailing evidence presented to the senses but maintain that this process of belief revision does not require the creature to be aware of the process or to have the concept belief. Carruthers (2008) offers the most specific defense of this claim by developing an account of surprise that does not involve higher-order beliefs, as Davidson maintains. According to Carruthers’ account, being surprised simply involves a mechanism that is sensitive to conflicts between the contents of one’s beliefs—that is, conflicts with what one believes, not conflicts with the fact that one believes such contents. On this model, being surprised that there is no coin in one’s pocket involves having a mechanism in one’s head that takes as its input the content that there is a coin in one’s pocket (not the fact that one believes this content) and the content that there is no coin in one’s pocket (again, not the fact that one believes this content) and produces as its output a suite of reactions, such as releasing chemicals into the bloodstream that heightens alertness, widening the eyes, and orienting towards and attending to the perceived state of affairs one took as evidence that there is no coin in one’s pocket. It is one’s awareness of these changes, Carruthers argues, not one’s awareness that one’s former belief was false, as Davidson maintains, that constitutes being surprised.

Compared with the commentary on the first step of his main argument, there is little critical commentary in print on Davidson’s defense of the second step of his main argument. However, Lurz (1998) has raised the following objection. He argues that the intensionality test and the argument from holism at most show that belief attributions to nonlinguistic animals are unjustified but not that they are impossible. The fact that we routinely attribute beliefs to nonlinguistic animals shows that such attributions are quite possible. But, Lurz argues, if we can attribute beliefs to nonlinguistic animals on the basis of their nonlinguistic behavior, then there is no reason to think (at least, none provided by the intensionality test and the argument from holism) that a nonlinguistic animal could not in principle attribute beliefs to other nonlinguistic animals on the same basis. Of course, if the intensionality test and argument from holism are sound, such belief attributions would be unjustified, but this alone is irrelevant to whether it is possible for nonlinguistic animals to attribute beliefs to others and thereby engage in triangulation; for triangulation requires the capacity for belief attribution, not the capacity for justified belief attribution. Therefore, Lurz argues, if triangulation is possible without language, then Davidson has failed to prove that having the concept belief requires language. Furthermore, if some animals actually are capable of attributing beliefs to others, as some researchers (Premack & Woodruff 1978; Menzel 1974; Tschudin 2001) have suggested that chimpanzees and dolphins may be (thought such claims are considered highly controversial at present), then even if triangulation is a requirement for having beliefs, as Davidson maintains, it may turn out that some animals (for example, chimpanzees and dolphins) actually have beliefs, contrary to what Davidson’s main argument concludes.

d. Contemporary Philosophical Arguments on Animal Reason

Although the vast majority of contemporary philosophers do not go as far as Descartes and Davidson in denying reason to animals completely, a number of them have argued for important limits on animal rationality. The arguments here are numerous and complex; so only an outline of the more influential ones is provided.

In Rationality (1964/1989), Jonathan Bennett argued that since it is impossible for animals without language to express universal beliefs (for example, All As are Bs) and past-tensed beliefs (for example, A was F) separately, they cannot posses either type of belief, on the grounds that what cannot be manifested separately in behavior cannot exist as distinct and separate states in the mind. A consequence of this argument is that animals cannot think or reason about matters beyond their own particular and immediate circumstances. In Linguistic Behaviour (1976), Bennett went further and argued that animals cannot draw logical inferences from their beliefs, on the grounds that if they did, they would do so for every belief that they possessed, which is absurd. According to this argument, Fido may believe that the cat is in tree, as well as believe that there is an animal in the tree, but he cannot come to have the latter belief as result of inferring it from the former.

More recently, José Bermúdez (2003a) has argued that the ability to think about thoughts (what Bermúdez calls “intentional ascent”) requires the ability to think about words in one’s natural language (what Bermúdez calls “semantic ascent”), and that since animals cannot do the latter, they cannot do the former. Bermudez’s argument that intentional ascent requires semantic ascent is, roughly, that thinking about thought involves the ability to “‘to hold a thought in mind’ in such a way that can only be done if the thought is linguistically vehicled” via a natural language sentence that one understand (p. ix). The idea is that the only way for a creature to grasp and think about a thought (that is, an abstract proposition) is by its saying, writing, or bringing to mind a concrete sentence that expresses the thought in question. Bermúdez goes on to argue that the ability to think about thoughts (propositions) is involved in a wide variety of types of reasoning, from thinking about and reasoning with truth-functional, temporal, modal, and quantified propositions, to thinking and reasoning about one’s own and others’ propositional attitudes (for example, beliefs and desires). Bermúdez concludes that since animals do no think about words or sentences in a natural language, their thinking and reasoning are restricted to observable states of affairs in their environment. However, see Lurz (2007) for critical comment on Bermúdez’s argument here.

Finally, John Searle (1994) has argued that since animals lack certain linguistic abilities, they cannot think or reasons about institutional facts (for example, facts about money or marriages), facts about the distant past (for example, facts about matters before their birth), logically complex facts (for example, subjunctive facts or facts that involve mixed quantifies), or facts that can only be represented via some symbolic system (for example, facts pertaining to the days of the week). In addition, and more interesting, Searle (2001) has argued that since animals cannot perform certain speech acts such as asserting, they cannot have desire-independent reasons for action. According to this argument, animals act only for the sake of satisfying some non-rationally assessable desire (for example, the satisfaction of hunger) and never out of a sense of commitment. Consequently, if acts of courage, fidelity, loyalty, and parental commitment involve desire-independent reasons for action, as they arguably do, then on Searle’s argument here, no animal is or can be courageous, faithful, loyal, or a committed parent.

e. Contemporary Philosophical Arguments for Animal Thought and Reason

There are four types of arguments in contemporary philosophy for animal thought and reason. The first is the argument from the intentional systems theory championed by Daniel Dennett (1987, 1995, 1997). The second is the argument from common-sense functionalism championed by (among others) Jerry Fodor (1987), Stephen Stich (1979) and Peter Carruthers (2004). The third is the argument from biological naturalism, championed by John Searle (1994). And the fourth is the argument from science championed by (among others) Allen and Bekoff (1997) and Bermúdez (2003a).

i. The Intentional Systems Theory Argument

The intentional systems theory consists of two general ideas. The first is that our concepts of intentional states, such as our concepts belief, desire, and perceiving, are theoretical concepts whose identity and existence are determined by a common-sense psychological theory or folk-psychology. Folk psychology is a set of general principles that state that subjects, on the assumption that they are rational, tend to believe what they perceive, tend to draw obvious logical inferences from their beliefs, and tend act so as to satisfy their desires given what they believe. In many cases, we apply our folk psychology to animals to predict and make sense of their behaviors. When we do, we view animals as intentional systems and take up, what Dennett (1987) calls, the intentional stance toward them. The second important idea of the intentional systems theory is its instrumentalist interpretation of folk psychology. On the instrumentalist interpretation, what it is for a creature to have intentional states is for its behaviors to be well predicted and explained by the principles of folk psychology. Nothing more is required. There need not be anything inside the creature’s brain or body, for instance, that corresponds to or has structural or functional features similar to the intentional state concepts employed in our folk psychology. Our intentional state concepts, on the instrumentalist reading, do not aim to refer to real, concrete internal states of subjects but to abstract entities that are merely useful constructs for predicting and explaining various behaviors (much like centers of gravity used in mechanics). Therefore, according to the intentional systems theory argument, the fact that much of animal behavior is usefully predicted and explained from the intentional stance makes animals genuine thinkers and reasoners.

There are two general types of objections raised against the intentional systems theory argument. First, some have argued (Searle 1983) that our intentional state concepts are not theoretical concepts, since intentional states are experienced and, hence, our concepts of them are independent of our having any theory about them. Second, some (Braddon-Mitchell & Jackson 2007) have objected to the intentional systems theory’s commitment to instrumentalism, arguing that on such an interpretation of folk psychology, even lowly thermostats, laptop computers, and Blockheaded robots have beliefs and desires, since it is useful to predict and explain behaviors of such objects from the intentional stance.

ii. The Argument from Common-Sense Functionalism

Similar to the intentional systems theory, common-sense functionalism holds that our intentional state concepts are theoretical concepts that belong to and are determined by our folk psychology. Unlike the intentional systems theory, however, common-sense functionalism takes a realist interpretation of folk psychology. (In addition, many common-sense functionalists reject the rationality assumption that the intentional systems theory places on folk psychology (Fodor 1987, 1991).) On the realist interpretation, for a subject to have intentional states is for the subject to have in his brain a variety of discrete internal states that play the causal roles and have the internal structures that our intentional state concepts describe. According to this view, if Fido believes that the cat is up the tree, then he has in his brain an individual state, s, that plays the causal role that beliefs play according to our folk psychology, and s has an internal structure similar to the “that”-clause used to specify its content—that is, s has the structure Rxy where “R” represents the two-place relation up, “x” represents the cat, and “y” represents the tree. Since the internal state s is seen as having an internal structure similar to the sentence “the cat is up the tree,” common-sense functionalism is often taken to support the view that thinking involves an internal language or language of thought (Fodor 1975). It is then argued that since animal behavior is successfully predicted and explained by our folk psychology, there is defeasible grounds for supposing that animals actually have such internal states in their heads (Fodor 1987; Stich 1979; Carruthers 2004).

Two problems are typically raised regarding the argument from common-sense functionalism. Some (Stalnaker 1999) have objected that if, as common-sense functionalism claims, our ascriptions of intentional states to animals commit us to thinking that the animals have in their heads states that have the same representational structure as the “that”-clauses we use to specify their contents, then intentional ascriptions to animals (and to ourselves) would be a far more speculative practice than it actually is. The objection here does not deny that animals actually have such representational structures in their heads, it simply denies that that is what we are saying or thinking when we ascribe intentional states to them. Others (Camp, 2009) accept the common-sense functionalist account of intentional state concepts but have argued, on the basis of Evan’s (1982) generality constraint principle, that few animals have the sorts of structured representational states in their heads that folk psychology describes them as having. If Fido’s thoughts are structured in the way that common-sense functionalism claims, the objection runs, then if Fido is able to think that he is chasing a cat, then he must also be capable of thinking that a cat is chasing him, but, it is argued, this may be a thought that is completely unthinkable by Fido. However, see Carruthers (2009) and Tetzlaff and Rey (2009) for important objections to this type of argument.

iii. The Argument from Biological Naturalism

Biological naturalism is the theory, championed by John Searle (1983, 1992), that holds that our concepts of intentional states are concepts of experienced subjective states. The concept belief, for example, is the concept of an experienced, conscious state that has truth conditions and world-to-mind direction of fit; whereas, our concept desires is the concept of an experienced, conscious state that has satisfaction conditions and mind-to-world direction of fit. Intentional states, according to this theory, are irreducibly subjective states that are caused by low-level biochemical states of the brain in virtue of their causal structures, not in virtue of their functional or causal roles, or, if they have such, their representational structures. According to biological naturalism, if Fido believes that the cat is in the tree, then he has in his brain a low-level biochemical state, s, that, in virtue of its unique causal structure, causes Fido to have a subjective experience that has a world-to-mind direction of fit and is true if and only if the cat is in the tree.

Searle argues that there are two main reasons why we find it irresistible to suppose that animals have intentional states, as biological naturalism conceives them. First, many animals have perceptual organs (for example, eyes, ears, mouths, and skin) that we see as similar to our own and which, we assume, operate according to similar physiological principles. Since we know in our own case that the stimulation of our perceptual organs leads to certain physiological processes which cause us to have certain perceptual experiences, we reason, from the principle of similar cause-similar effect, that the stimulation of perceptual organs in animals leads to similar physiological processes which cause them to have similar perceptual experiences. The behavior of animals, Searle repeatedly stresses, is by itself irrelevant to why we think animals have perceptual experiences; it is only relevant if we take the behavior to be caused by the stimulation of perceptual organs and underlying physiological processes relevantly similar to our own. This argument, of course, would only account for why we think that animals have perceptual experiences, not why we think that they have beliefs, desires, and other intentional states that are only distantly related to the stimulation of sensory organs. So Searle adds that the second reason we find it irresistible that animals have intentional states is that we cannot make sense of their behaviors otherwise. To make sense of why Fido is still barking up the tree when the cat is long out of sight, for example, we must suppose that Fido continues to want to catch the cat and continues to think that the cat is up the tree.

There are two main problems with Searle’s argument for animal thought and reason. First, according to biological naturalism, animals have intentional states solely in virtue of their having brain states that are relevantly similar in causal structure to those in human beings which cause us to have intentional states. But this raises the question: how are we to determine whether the brain states of animals are relevantly similar to our own? They will not be exactly similar, since animal brains and human brains are different. Suppose, for example, scientists discover that a certain type of electro-chemical process (XYZ) in human brains is necessary and sufficient for intentional states in us, and that an electro-chemical process (PDQ) similar to XYZ occurs in animal brains. Is PDQ similar enough to XYZ to produce intentional states in animals? Well, suppose PDQ produces behaviors in animals that are similar to those that XYZ produces in humans. Would that show that PDQ is enough like XYZ to produce intentional states in animals? No, says Searle, for unless those behaviors are produced by relevantly similar physiological processes they are simply irrelevant to whether the animal has intentional states. But that is precisely what we are trying to determine here, of course. It would appears that the only way to determine whether PDQ is similar enough to XYZ, on biological naturalism, is if we humans could temporarily exchange our brains for those of animals and see whether PDQ produces intentional states in us. This, of course, is impossible. And so it would appear that the question of whether animals have intentional states is, on biological naturalism, unknowable in principle.

Finally, Searle’s explanation for why we find it irresistible to ascribe perceptual experiences to animals seems questionable in some cases. If Searle’s explanation were correct, then most ordinary individuals should not find it at all compelling, for example, to ascribe auditory experiences (that is, hearing) to birds, or tactile experiences (that is, feelings of pressures, pain, or temperature) to fish or armadillos, since most ordinary individuals do not see anything on birds’ heads that looks like ears or on the outer surface of fish or armadillos that looks like skin.

iv. The Argument from Science

Why should we believe that colds are caused by viruses and not by drastic changes in weather, as many folk had (and still do) believe? A reasonable answer is that our best scientific theory of the causes of colds is in terms of viruses, commonsense notwithstanding. Sometimes, of course, science and commonsense agree, and when they do, commonsense can be said to be vindicated by science. In either case, it is science that ultimately determines what should (and should not) be believed. This type of argument, sometimes called the argument from science, has been used to justify the claim that animals have thought, reason, consciousness, and other folk-psychological states of mind (see Allen & Bekoff 1997; Bermúdez 2003a). In the past thirty years or so, due in large measure to the demise of radical behaviorism and the birth of cognitivism in psychology, as well as from the influential writings of ethologist Donald Griffin (1976, 1984, 2001), scientists from various fields have found it increasingly useful to propose, test, and ultimately accept hypotheses about the causes of animal behavior in explicitly folk-psychological terms. It is quite common these days to see scientific articles on whether, for example, animals have conscious experiences such as pain, seeing and (even) joy (Griffin & Speck 2004; Panksepp & Burgdorf 2003), on whether scrub jays have desires, and beliefs, and can recollect their pasts (Clayton et al. 2006), on whether primates understand that other animals know, see, and hear(Hare et al. 2000; Hare et al. 2001; Santos et al. 2006), on whether primates make judgments about their own states of knowledge and ignorance (Hampton et al. 2004; Smith et al. 2003), and so on. According to the argument, since scientists are finding it useful to test and accept hypothesis about animal behavior in folk-psychological terms, we are justified in believing that animals have such states of mind.

Not everyone has found the argument from science here convincing, however. The chief concern is whether explanations of animal behavior in folk-psychological terms are, as the argument assumes, scientifically respectable (see Kennedy 1992). There are two features of scientific explanations of animal behavior that appear to count against their being so. First, scientific explanations of animal behavior are causal explanations in terms of concrete internal states of the animal, but on some models of folk-psychology, such as Dennett’s intentional systems theory (see 1.e.i. above), folk-psychological explanations are neither causal explanations nor imply anything about the internal states of the animal. Second, scientific explanations of animal behavior are objective in that there is typically a general agreement among researchers in the field on what would count in favor of or against the explanation; however, it has been argued that since the only generally agreed upon indicators of consciousness are verbal reports of the subject, explanations of animal behavior in terms of consciousness are unscientific (see Clayton et al. 2006, p. 206).

One standard type of reply to these objections has been to adopt a common-sense functionalist model of folk-psychology (see 1e.ii above) which interprets folk-psychological explanations as imputing causally efficacious internal states while denying that these explanations imply anything about the consciousness of the internal states. (This seems to be the approach that Clayton et al. (2006) take in their explanation of the behaviors of scrub jays in terms of “episodic-like” memories, which are episodic memories minus consciousness.) This, of course, raises the vexing issue of whether our folk-psychological concepts, such as belief, desire, intention, seeing, and so forth, imply consciousness (see Carruthers 2005; Lurz 2002a; Searle 1992; Stich 1979). Others have responded to the above objections by developing non-subjective measures for consciousness that could be applied to animals (and humans) incapable of verbal reports (Dretske 2006). And still others have proposed objective measures of consciousness in animals by appealing to the communicative signals of animals as non-verbal reports of the presence of conscious experiences (Griffin 1976, 1984, 2001).

2. The Problems of Animal Consciousness

It is generally accepted that most (if not all) types of mental states can be either conscious or unconscious, and that unconscious mental states can have effects on behavior that are not altogether dissimilar from those of their conscious counterparts. It is quite common, for example, for one to have a belief (for example, that one’s keys are in one’s jacket pocket) and a desire (for example, to locate one’s keys) that are responsible for some behavior (for example, reaching into one’s jacket pocket as one approaches one’s apartment) even though at the time of the behavior (and beforehand) one’s mind is preoccupied with matters completely unrelated to one’s belief or desire. Similarly, scientists have shown through various masking experiments and the like that our behaviors are often influenced by stimuli that are perceived below the level of consciousness (Marcel 1983). Also some philosophers have argued that even pains and other bodily sensations can be unconscious, such as when one continues to limp from a pain in one’s leg though at the time one is preoccupied with other matters and is not attending to the pain (Tye 1995).

Given this distinction between conscious and unconscious mental states, the question arises whether the mental states of animals are or can be conscious. It should be noted that this question not only has theoretical import but moral and practical import, as well. For arguably the fact that conscious pains and experiences feel a certain way to their subjects makes them morally relevant conditions, and it is, therefore, of moral and practical concern to determine whether the mental states of animals are conscious (Carruthers 1992). Of course, as with the question of animal thought and reason, the answer to this question depends in large part on what one takes consciousness to be. There are two general philosophical approaches to consciousness—typically referred to as first-order and higher-order theories—that have played a prominent role in the debate over the status of animal consciousness. These two approaches and their relevance to the question of conscious states in animals are described below.

a. Higher-Order Theories of Consciousness

Higher-order theories of consciousness start with the common assumption that conscious mental states are states of which one is higher-order aware, and unconscious mental states are states of which one is not higher-order aware. The theories diverge, however, over what is involved in being higher-order aware of one’s mental states.

i. Inner-Sense Theories

Inner-sense theories take a subject’s higher-order awareness to be a type of perceptual awareness, akin to seeing, that is directed inwardly toward the mind as opposed to outwardly toward the world (Lycan 1996; Armstrong 1997). Since higher-order awareness is a species of perceptual awareness, on this view, it is not usually taken to require the capacity for higher-order thought or the possession of mental-state concepts. A subject need not be able to think that he is in pain or have the concepts I or pain, for example, in order for him to be higher-order aware of his pain. On the inner-sense theory, then, the mental states of animals will be conscious just in case they are higher-order aware of them by means of an inner perception.

Some inner-sense theorists have argued that since higher-order awareness does not require higher-order thought or the possession of mental-state concepts, it is quite consistent with what we know about animal behavior and brains that many animals may have such an awareness of their own mental states. Furthermore, there are recent studies in comparative psychology (Smith et al. 2003; Hampton et al. 2004) that suggest that monkeys, apes and dolphins actually have the capacity to be higher-order aware of their own states of certainty, memory, and knowledge. However, the results of these studies have not gone unchallenged (see Carruthers 2008).

The chief problem with inner-sense theories, however, is not so much their account of animal consciousness but their account of higher-order awareness. Some (Rosenthal 1986; Shoemaker 1996) have argued against a perceptual account of higher-order awareness on the grounds that (i) there is no dedicated perceptual organ in the brain for such a perception as there is for external perception; (ii) there is no distinct phenomenology associated with higher-order awareness as there is for all other types of perceptual modalities; and (iii) it is impossible to reposition oneself in relation to one’s mental states so as to get a better perception of them as one can do in the case of perception of external objects. And still others (Lurz 2003) have objected that the inner-sense theory cannot explain how concept-involving mental states, such as beliefs and desires, can be conscious, since to be aware of such states would require being aware of their conceptual contents, which cannot be done by way of a perceptual awareness that is not itself concept-involving.

ii. Higher-Order Thought Theories

Problems such as these have led a number of higher-order theorists (Rosenthal 1986; Carruthers 2000) to embrace some version or other of the higher-order thought theory. According to this theory, a mental state is conscious just in case one has (or is disposed to have) the higher-order thought that one is in such a mental state. Animals will have conscious mental states, on this theory, if and only if that they are capable of higher-order thoughts about themselves as having mental states. The question of animal consciousness, then, becomes the question of whether animals are capable of such higher-order thought.

A number of philosophers have argued that animals are incapable of such thought. Some have argued that since higher-order thoughts require the possession of the first-person I-concept, it is unlikely that animals are capable of having them. The selves of animals, the argument runs, are selves that experience numerous mental states at any one moment in time and that persist through various changes to their mental states. Thus, if an animal possessed the I-concept, it must be capable of understanding itself as such an entity—that is, it must be capable of thinking not only, I am currently in pain, for example, but I am currently in pain, am seeing, am hearing, am smelling, as well as be capable of thinking I was in such-and-such mental states but am not now. However, such thoughts appear to involve the mental equivalent of pronominal reference and past-tensed thoughts, both of which, it is argued, are impossible without language (see Quine 1995; Bermúdez 2003a; Bennett 1964, 1966, 1988).

Various objections have been raised against this argument on behalf of the higher-order theory and animal consciousness. Gennaro (2004, 2009) argues that that the I-concept involved in higher-order thoughts need be no more sophisticated than the concept this particular body or the concept experiencer of mental states, and that the results of various self-recognition studies with apes, dolphins and elephants, as well as the results of a number of episodic memory tests with scrub jays, suggest that many animals possess such minimal I-concepts (Parker et al. 1994; Clayton et al., 2003). Lurz (1999) goes further and argues that insofar as higher-order thoughts confer consciousness on mental states, they need not involve any I-concept at all. The idea here is that just as one can be aware that it is raining, where the “it” here is not used to express one’s concept of a thing or a subject—for there is no thing or subject that is raining—an animal can be aware that it hurts or thinks that p, where the “it” here does not express a concept of a thing or a subject that is thought to possess pain or to think that p. Animals, on this view, are thought to conceive of their mental states as we conceive of rain and snow—that is, as subject-less features placed at a time (see Strawson (1959) and Proust (2009) for similar arguments).

The most common argument against animals possessing higher-order thought, however, is that such thoughts requires linguistic capabilities and mental-state concepts that animals do not possess. Dennett (1991), for example, argues that the ability to say what mental state one is in is the very basis of one’s having the higher-order thought that one is in such mental state, and not the other way round. To think otherwise, Dennett argues, is to commit oneself to an objectionable Cartesian theater view of the mind. According to Dennett’s argument, since animals are incapable of saying what they are feeling or thinking, they are incapable of thinking that they are feeling or thinking. In reply, Carruthers (1996) has argued that there is a way of understand higher-order thoughts that is not tied to linguistic expression of any kind or committed to a Cartesian theater view of the mind.

In a somewhat similar vein of thought to Dennett’s, Davidson (1984, 1985) and Bermúdez (2003a) argue, although on different grounds, that since animals are incapable of speaking and interpreting a natural language, they cannot possess mental-state concepts for propositional attitudes and, therefore, cannot have higher-order thoughts about their own or others propositional attitudes (see sections 1c and 1d.iii above). This alone, of course, is not sufficient to prove that animals are incapable of higher-order thoughts about non-propositional mental states, such as bodily sensations and perceptual experiences. However, some have gone further and argued that animals are incapable of possessing any type of mental-state concept and, therefore, any type of higher-order thought. The argument for this view generally consist of the following two main premises: (1) if animals possess mental-state concepts, then they must have the capacity to apply these concepts to themselves as well as to other animals; and (2) animals have been shown to perform poorly in some important experiments designed to test whether they can apply mental-state concepts to other animals.

Premise (1) of this argument is sometimes supported (Seager 2004) by an appeal to Evan’s generality constraint (see section 1e.ii above); roughly, the argument runs, if an animal can think, for example, I am in pain, and can think of another animal that, for example, he walks, then the animal in question must be capable of thinking of another animal, he is pain, as well as be capable of thinking of himself, I walk. Others, however, have supported premise (1) on evolutionary grounds, arguing that animals would not have evolved the capacity to think with mental-state concepts unless their doing so was of some selective advantage, and the only selective advantage of thinking with mental-state concepts is its use in anticipating and manipulating other animals’ behaviors (Humphrey 1976). Premise (2) of this argument has been supported mainly by the results of a series of experiments conducted by Povinelli and colleagues (see Povinelli & Vonk 2004) which appear to show that chimpanzees are incapable of discriminating betweenseeing and not seeing in other subjects.

Various objections have been raised against such defenses of premises (1) and (2). Gennaro (2009), for example, has argued against the defense of premise (1) based on Evan’s generality constraint. Others have argued that, contrary to the evolutionary defense given for premise (1), the principal selective advantage of thinking with mental-state concepts is its use in recognizing and correcting errors in one’s own thinking, and that the results of various meta-cognition studies have shown that various animals are capable of reflecting upon and improving their pattern of thinking (Smith et al., 2003). (However, see Carruthers (2008) for a critique of such higher-order interpretations of these studies.) And with respect to premise (2), others have argued that, contrary to Povinelli’s interpretation, chimpanzees fail such discrimination tasks not because they are unable to attribute mental states to others but because the experimental tasks are unnatural and confusing for the animals, and that when the experimental tasks are more suitable and natural, such as those used in competitive paradigms (Hare et al. 2000; Hare et al. 2001; Santos et al. 2006), the animals show signs of mental-state attribution. However, see Penn and Povinelli (2007) for challenges to the supposed successes of mental-state attributions by animals in these new experimental protocols and for suggestions on how to improve experimental methods used in testing mental-state attributions in animals.

b. First-Order Theories

According to first-order theories, conscious mental states are those that make one conscious of things or facts in the external environment (Evans 1982; Tye 1995; Dretske 1995). Mental states are not conscious because one is higher-order aware of them but because the states themselves make one aware of the external world. Unconscious mental states, therefore, are mental states that fail to make one conscious of things or facts in the environment—although, they may have various effects on one’s behavior. Furthermore, mental states that make subjects conscious of things or facts in the environment do so, according to first-order theories, in virtue of their effecting, or being poised to effect, subjects’ belief-forming system. So, for example, one’s current perception of the computer screen is conscious, on such theories, because it causes, or is poised to cause, one to believe that there is a computer screen before one; whereas, those perceptual states that are involved in subliminal perception, for instance, are not conscious because they do not cause, nor are poised to cause, subjects to form beliefs about the environment.

First-order theorists argue (Tye 1997; Dretske 1995) that many varieties of animals, from fish to bees to chimpanzees, form beliefs about their environment based upon their perceptional states and bodily sensations and, therefore, enjoy conscious perceptual states and bodily sensations. Additional virtues of first-order theories, it is argued, are that they offer a more parsimonious account of consciousness than higher-order theories, since they do not require higher-order awareness for consciousness, and that they provide a more plausible account of animal consciousness than higher-order theories, since they ascribe consciousness to animals that we intuitively believe to possess conscious perceptual states (for example, bats and mice) but do not intuitively believe to possess higher-order awareness.

It has been argued (Lurz 2004, 2006), however, that first-order theories are at their best when explaining the consciousness of perceptual states and bodily sensations but have difficultly explaining the consciousness of beliefs and desires. Most first-order theorists have responded to this problem by endorsing a higher-order thought theory of consciousness for such mental states (Tye 1997; Dretske 2000, p. 188). On such a hybrid view, beliefs and desires are conscious in virtue of having higher-order thoughts about them, while perceptual states and bodily sensations are conscious in virtue of their being poised to make an impact on one’s belief-forming system. This hybrid view faces two important problems, however. First, on such a view, few, if any, animals would be capable of conscious beliefs and desires, since it seems implausible, for various reasons, to suppose that many animals are capable of higher-order thoughts about their own beliefs and desires. And yet it has been argued (Lurz 2002b) that there is intuitively compelling grounds for thinking that many animals are capable of conscious beliefs and desires, since their behaviors are quite often predictable and explainable in terms of the concepts beliefand desire of our folk psychology, which is a set of laws about the causal properties and interactions ofconscious beliefs and desires (or, at the very least, a set of laws about the causal properties and interactions of beliefs and desires that are apt to be conscious (Stich 1978)). However, see Carruthers (2005) for a reply to this argument.

The second problem for the hybrid view is that on its most plausible rendition it would ascribe consciousness to the same limited class of animals as higher-order thought theory and, thereby, provide no more of an intuitively plausible account of animal consciousness than its main competitor. For it seems intuitively plausible to suppose that a perceptual state or bodily sensation will be conscious only if it effects, or is poised to effect, a subject’s conscious belief-forming system. If it were discovered, for example, that the perceptual states involved in subliminal perception (or blindsight) caused subjects to form unconscious beliefs about the environment, no one but the most committed first-order theorist would conclude from this alone that these perceptual states were, after all, conscious. But if perceptual states and bodily sensations are conscious only insofar as they effect (or are poised to effect) a subject’sconscious belief-forming system, and conscious beliefs, on the hybrid view, require higher-order thought, then to possess conscious perceptions and bodily sensations, an animal would have to be, as higher-order thought theories maintain, capable of higher-order thought. What appears to be need here in order to save first-order theories from this problem is a first-order account of conscious beliefs and desires. See Lurz (2006) for a sketch of such an account.

3. Other Issues

There are many other important issues in the philosophy of animal minds in addition to those directly related to the nature and scope of animal thought, reason, and consciousness. Due to considerations of length, however, only a brief list of such issues with reference to a few relevant and important sources is provided.

The nature and extent of animal emotions has been, and continues to be, an important issue in the philosophy of animal minds (see Nussbaum 2001; Roberts 1996, 2009: Griffiths 1997), as well as the nature and extent of propositional knowledge in animals (see Korblith 2002). Philosophers have also been particularly interested in the philosophical foundations and the methodological principles, such as Lloyd Morgan’s canon, employed in the various sciences that study animal cognition and consciousness (see Bekoff et al. 2002; Allen and Bekoff 1997; Fitzpatrick 2007, 2009; Sober 1998, 2001a, 2001b, 2005). Philosophers have also been interested in the nature and justification of the practice of anthropomorphism by scientists and lay folk (Mitchell at al.1997; Bekoff & Jamieson 1996; Datson & Mitman 2005). And finally, there is a rich history of philosophical thought on animal minds dating back to the earliest stages of philosophy and, therefore, there has been, and continues to be, philosophical interest and issues related to the history of the philosophy of animal minds (see Sorabji, 1993; Wilson, 1995; DeGrazia, 1994).

4. References and Further Reading

a. References

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Hume, D. (1739/1978). A Treatise of Human Nature. Edited by P. H. Nidditch, 2nd Ed. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Humphrey, N. (1976). The Social Function of Intellect. In P. P. G. Bateson & R. A. Hinde (Eds.)Growing Points in Ethology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Hurley, S. & Nudds, M. (2006). Rational Animals? Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Kennedy, J. (1992). The New Anthropomorphism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Köhler, W. (1925). The Mentality of Apes. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
Kornblith, H. (2002). Knowledge and its Place in Nature. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Lurz, R. (1998). Animal Minds: The Possibility of Second-Order Beliefs in Non- Linguistic Animals. (Doctoral dissertation Temple University, 1998). Dissertation Abstracts International,59, no. 03A.
Lurz, R. (1999). Animal Consciousness. Journal of Philosophical Research 24: 149-168.
Lurz, R. (2002a). Reducing Consciousness by Making it HOT: A Commentary on Carruthers’Phenomenal Consciousness, Psyche 8.
Lurz, R. (2002b). Neither HOT nor COLD: An Alternative Account of Consciousness. Psyche 9.
Lurz, R. (2003). Advancing the Debate Between HOT and FO Theories of Consciousness. Journal of Philosophical Research 28: 23-44.
Lurz, R. (2004). Either FOR or HOR: A False Dichotomy, in R. Gennaro (Ed.) Higher- Order Theories of Consciousness, John Benjamins, Amsterdam, 2004, pp. 226- 54.
Lurz, R. (2007). In Defense of Wordless Thoughts about Thoughts. Mind and Language 22 : 270-296.
Lurz. R. (2006). Conscious Beliefs and Desires: A Same-Order Approach, in U. Kriegel and K. Williford (Eds.) Self-Representational Approaches to Consciousness, MIT Press.
Lurz, R. (2009). Philosophy of Animal Minds : New Essays on Animal Thought and Consciousness. Cambridge : Cambridge University Press.
Lurz, R. (2011). Mindreading Animals: The Debate over What Animals Know about Other Minds. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Lycan, W. (1996). Consciousness and Experience. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Malcolm, N. (1977). Thoughtless Brutes. In Thought and Knowledge. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Marcel , A. (1983). Conscious and unconscious perception. Cognitive Psychology, 15: 197-237
Menzel, E. (1974). A Group of Chimpanzees in a 1-Acre Field: Leadership and Communication. In A. M. Shrier & F. Stollnitz (Eds.) Behaviour of Nonhuman Primates. New York: Academic Press.
McGinn, C. (1982). The Character of Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Mitchell, R., Thompson, N. & Miles, H. (1997). Anthropomorphism, Anecdotes, and Animals. New York: SUNY Press.
Moser, P. (1983). Rationality without Surprise: Davidson on Rational Belief. Dialectica 37: 221-226.
Nussbaum, M. (2001). Upheavals of Thought: The Intelligence of Emotions. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Panksepp, J. & Burgdorf, J. (2003). “Laughing Rats and the Evolutionary Antecedents of Human Joy?Physiology and Behavior 79:533-547.
Parker, S. T., Mitchell, R. & Boccia, M. (1994). Self-Awareness in Animals and Humans: Developmental Perspectives. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Penn, D. & Povinelli, D. (2007). On the Lack of Evidence that Non-Human Animals Possess Anything Remotely Resembling a “Theory of Mind.” Philosophical Transactions of the Royal Society B362: 731-744.
Pepperberg, E. (1999). The Alex Studies: Cognitive and Communicative Abilities of Grey Parrots.Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Povinelli, D & Vonk, J. (2004). We don’t need a microscope to explore the chimpanzee’s mind.Mind and language 19: 1-28. Reprinted in Hurley and Nudds (Eds.) Rational Animals? 2006. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Premack, D. & Woodruff, G. (1978). Does the Chimpanzee have a Theory of Mind? Behaviorial and Brain Sciences 1: 515-526.
Proust, J. (2009). Metacognitive states in non-human animals: a defense. In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Quine, W. V. O. (1995). From Stimulus to Science. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
Radner, D. and Radner, M. (1989). Animal Consciousness. Buffalo, NY: Prometheus Books.
Rey, G. & Tetzlaff, M. (forthcoming). Systematicity in Honeybee Navigation. In Lurz Ed.) Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Roberts, R. (1996). Propositions and Animal Emotion. Philosophy 71:147-156.
Roberts, R. (2009). The Sophistication of Non-Human Emotion. In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Rosenthal, D. (1986). Two Concepts of Consciousness. Philosophical Studies 49: 329-359.
Santos, L., Nissen, A., & Ferrugia, J. (2006). Rhesus Monkeys, Macca mulatta, Know What Others Can and Cannot Hear. Animal Behavior 71:1175-1181.
Savage-Rumbaugh, S., Shanker, S. and Taylor, T. (1998). Apes, Language, and the Human Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Seager, W. (2004). A Cold Look at HOT Theory. In R. Gennaro (Ed.) Higher-Order Theories of Consciousness. Amsterdam: John Benjamins.
Searle, J. (1983). Intentionality. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Searle, J. (1992). The Rediscovery of Mind. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
Searle, J. (1994). Animal Minds. Midwest Studies in Philosophy 19: 206-219.
Searle. J. (2001). Rationality in Action. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press. Shoemaker, S. (1996). Self-Knowledge and “Inner Sense.” Lecture I: The Object Perception Model. In The First-Person Perspective and Other Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Stich, S. (1978). Belief and Subdoxastic States. Philosophy of Science 45: 499-518.
Stich, S. (1979). Do Animals Have Beliefs? Australasian Journal of Philosophy 57: 15- 28.
Stalnaker, R. (1999). Mental Content and Linguistic Form. In Context and Content. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Smith, J., Shields, W., & Washburn, D. (2003). The Comparative Psychology of Uncertainty Monitoring and Meta-Cognition. Behavioral and Brain Sciences 26, 317-373.
Sober, E. (1998). Morgan’s Canon. In C. Allen and D. Cummins (Eds.) The Evolution of Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Sober, E. (2001a). Simplicity. In W.H. Newton-Smith (Ed.), Companion to the Philosophy of Science. Oxford: Blackwell Publishing.
Sober, E. (2001b). The Principle of Conservatism in Cognitive Ethology. In D. Walsh (Ed.)Naturalism, Evolution, and Mind. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Sober, E. (2005). Comparative Psychology Meets Evolutionary Biology: Morgan’s Canon and Cladistic Parsimony. In L. Daston & G. Mitman (Eds.) Thinking With Animals: New Perspectives on Anthropomorphism. New York. Columbia University Press.
Sorabji, R. (1993). Animal Minds and Human Morals: The Origins of the Western Debate. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
Tetzlaff, M. & Rey, G. (2009). Systematicity in Honeybee Navigation. In R. Lurz (Ed.) Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Tschudin , A.J-P.C. (2001). “Mindreading” mammals? Attribution of belief tasks with dolphins . Animal Welfare , 10 , 119-127 .
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Tye, M. (1997). The Problem of Simple Minds: Is There Anything it is Like to be a Honey Bee?Philosophical Studies 88: 289-317.
Wilson, M. D. (1995). Animal Ideas. Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association 69:7-25.

b. Suggested Further Readings

Recent Volumes of New Essays in the Philosophy of Animal Mind

Lurz, R. (2009). The Philosophy of Animal Minds: New Essays on Animal Thought and Consciousness. Cambridge : Cambridge University Press.
Hurley, S. & Nudds, M. (2006). Rational Animals? Oxford: Oxford University Press.

Articles and Books on Contemporary Issues in Philosophy of Mind

Akins, K. A. (1993) A Bat Without Qualities. In M. Davies and G. Humphreys (Eds.) Consciousness. Oxford: Blackwell.
Allen, C. and Hauser, M. (1991). Concept Attribution in Non-Human Animals:Theoretical and Methodological Problems of Ascribing Complex Mental Processes. Philosophy of Science 58: 221-240.
Allen, C. (1995) Intentionality: Natural and Artificial. In H. Roitblat and J.-A.Meyer (Eds.)Comparative Approaches to Cognitive Science. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Allen, C. (1999). Animal Concepts Revisted: The Use of Self-Monitoring as An Empirical Approach. Erkenntnis 51: 33-40.
Allen, C. (2004). Animal Pain. Noûs 38: 617-643.
Allen, C. (2004). Animal Consciousness. Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
Bennett, J. (1990). How to Read Minds in Behaviour: A Suggestion from a Philosopher. In A. Whiten’s (Ed.) The Emergence of Mindreading. Oxford: Blackwell.
Bennett, J. (1996). How is Cognitive Ethology Possible? In C. Ristau (Ed.) Cognitive Ethology: The Minds of Other Animals. New Jersey: Lawrence Erlbaum Associates.
Bermúdez, J. (2009). Mindreading in the Animal Kingdom? In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Bishop, J. (1980). More Thought on Thought and Talk. Mind 89:1-16. Browne, D. (2004) “Do Dolphins Know Their Own Minds?” Biology & Philosophy 19: 633-653.
Carruthers, P. (1989). Brute Experience. The Journal of Philosophy 86: 258-269.
Carruthers, P. (1998). Animal Subjectivity. Psyche 4, .
Cherniak, C. (1986). Minimal Rationality. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Dennett, D. (1983). Intentional Systems in Cognitive Ethology: The “Panglossian Paradigm” Defended.Behavioral and Brain Sciences 6:343-390.
Dennett, D. (1995). Animal Consciousness: What Matters and Why. Social Research 62: 691-711.
DeGrazia, D. (2009). Self-Awareness in Animals. In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Dixon, B. (2001). Animal Emotions. Ethics and the Environment 6.2: 22-30.
Dreckmann, F. (1999). Animal Beliefs and Their Contents. Erkenntnis 51:93-111.
Dretske, F. (1999). Machines, Plants and Animals: The Origins of Agency. Erkenntnis 51: 19-31.
Dummett, M. (1993). Language and Communication. In The Seas of Language. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Dummett, M. (1993). The Origins of Analytic Philosophy. London: Duckworth.
Fodor, J. (1986). Why Paramecia Don’t Have Mental Representations. Midwest Studies in Philosophy 10: 3-23.
Graham, G. (1993). Belief in Animals. In Philosophy of Mind: An Introduction. Oxford: Blackwell.
Griffiths, P. E. (2003). Basic Emotions, Complex Emotions, Machiavellian Emotions. In Philosophy and the Emotions A. Hatzimoysis (Ed.), Cambridge, CUP: 39-67.
Griffiths, P and Scarantino, A. (in press). Emotions in the Wild: The situated perspective on emotion. in P. Robbins and M. Aydede (eds.) Cambridge Handbook of Situated Cognition, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Heil, J. (1982). Speechless Brutes. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 42: 400-406.
Heil, J. (1992). Talk and Thought. In The Nature of True Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Jamieson, D. and Bekoff, M. (1992) Carruthers on Nonconscious Experience. Analysis 52: 23-28.
Jamieson, D. (1998). Science, Knowledge, and Animals Minds. Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 98: 79-102.
Jamieson, D. (2009). What Do Animals Think? In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Kornblith, H. (1999). Knowledge in Humans and Other Animals. Philosophical Perspectives 13: 327-346.
Marcus, R. B. (1995). The Anti-Naturalism of Some Language Centered Accounts of Belief.Dialectica 49: 113-129.
McAninch, A., Goodrich, G. & Allen, C. (2009). Animal Communication and Neo- Expressivism. In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
McGinn, C. (1995). Animal Minds, Animal Morality. Journal of Social Research 62: 731-747.
Millikan, R. G. (1997). Varieties of Purposive Behavior. In R. Mitchell, N. Thompson, and H. L. Miles (Eds.) Anthropomorphism, Anecdotes, and Animals. New York: State University of New York Press.
Nagel, T. (1974). What is it Like to be a Bat? Philosophical Review 83: 435-450.
Papineau, D. (2001). The Evolution of Means-End Reasoning. Philosophy 49: 145-178.
Proust, J. (1999). Mind, Space and Objectivity in Non-Human Animals. Erkenntnis 51: 41-58.
Proust, J. (2000). L’animal intentionnel. Terrain 34:23-36.
Proust, J. (2000). Can Non-Human Primates Read Minds? Philosophical Topics 27:203-232.
Putnam, H. (1992). Intentionality and Lower Animals. In Renewing Philosophy. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Radner, D. (1993) Direct Action and Animal Communication. Ratio 6: 135-154.
Radner, D. (1994) Heterophenomenology: Learning About the Birds and the Bees. Journal of Phiosophy 91: 389-403.
Radner, D. (1999). Mind and function in animal communication. Erkenntnis 51: 129-144.
Rescorla, M. (2009). Chrysippus’s Dog as a Case Study in Non-Linguistic Cognition. In R. Lurz (Ed.)The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Ridge, M. (2001). Taking Solipsism Seriously: Nonhuman Animals and Meta-Cognitive Theories of Consciousness. Philosophical Studies 103: 315-340.
Rollin, B. E. (1989) The Unheeded Cry: Animal Consciousness, Animal Pain and Science. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Rowlands, M. (2002). Do Animals Have Minds? In Animals Like Us. New York: Verso.
Routley, R. (1981). Alleged Problems in Attributing Beliefs and Intentionality to Animals. Inquiry, 24, 385-417.
Saidel, E. (2002). Animal Minds, Human Minds. In M. Bekoff, C. Allen, and G. M. Burghardt The Cognitive Animal. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Saidel, E. (2009). Attributing Mental Representations to Animals. In R. Lurz (Ed.) The Philosophy of Animal Minds. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Smith, P. (1982). On Animal Beliefs. Southern Journal of Philosophy 20, 503-512.
Sober, E. (2001). The Principle of Conservatism in Cognitive Ethology. In Denis M. Walsh (ed.)Naturalism, Evolution, and Mind. Cambridge University Press.
Sober, E. (2001). Comparative Psychology Meets Evolutionary Biology: Morgan’s Canon and Cladistic Parsimony. In L. Daston and G. Mitman (Eds.) Thinking With Animals: New Perspective on Anthropomorphism. Columbia University Press.
Stephan, A. (1999). Are Animals Capable of Concepts? Erkenntnis 51:79-92.
Sterelny, K. (1995). Basic Minds. Philosophical Perspectives 9: 251-270.
Sterelny, K. (2000). Primate Worlds. In C. Heyes and L. Huber (Eds.) Evolution and Cognition. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Stich, S. (1983). Animal Beliefs. In From Folk Psychology to Cognitive Science. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Ward, A. (1988). Davidson on Attributions of Beliefs to Animals. Philosophia 18: 97-106.

Historical Works on Animal Minds

Arnold, D. G. (1995). Hume on the Moral Difference Between Humans and Other Animals. History of Philosophy Quarterly 12: 303-316.
Beauchamp, T. L. (1999). Hume on the Nonhuman Animal. Journal of Medicine and Philosophy 24:322-335.
Boyle, D. (2003). Hume on Animal Reason. Hume Studies 29: 3-28.
Churchill, J. (1989). If a Lion Could Talk. Philosophical Investigations 12: 308-324.
Fuller, B. A. G. (1949). The Messes Animals Make in Metaphysics. The Journal of Philosophy 46: 829—838.
Frongia, G. (1995). Wittgenstein and the Diversity of Animals. Monist 78: 534-552.
Glock, H. J. (2000). Animals, Thoughts and Concepts. Synthese 123:35-64.
Gordon, D. M. (1992). Wittgenstein and Ant-Watching. Biology and Philosophy 7: 13- 25.
Harrison, P. (1992). Descartes on Animals. Philosophical Quarterly 42: 219-227.
Seidler, M. J. (1977). Hume and the Animals. Southern Journal of Philosophy 15:361- 372.
Squadrito, K. (1980). Descartes, Locke and the Soul of Animals. Philosophy Research Archives 6.
Squadrito, K. (1991). Thoughtful Brutes: The Ascription of Mental Predicates to Animals in Locke’s Essay. Dialogos 91: 63-73.
Sorabji, R. (1992). Animal Minds. Southern Journal of Philosophy 31: 1-18.
Tranoy, K. (1959). Hume on Morals, Animals, and Men. Journal of Philosophy 56: 94- 192.

Author Information

Robert Lurz
Email: Rlurz@brooklyn.cuny.edu
Brooklyn College
U. S. A.

Buddha (c. 500s B.C.E.)

buddha The historical Buddha, also known as Gotama Buddha, Siddhārtha Gautama, and Buddha Śākyamuni, was born in Lumbini, in the Nepalese region of Terai, near the Indian border. He is one of the most important Asian thinkers and spiritual masters of all time, and he contributed to many areas of philosophy, including epistemology, metaphysics and ethics. The Buddha’s teaching formed the foundation for Buddhist philosophy, initially developed in South Asia, then later in the rest of Asia. Buddhism and Buddhist philosophy now have a global following.

In epistemology, the Buddha seeks a middle way between the extremes of dogmatism and skepticism, emphasizing personal experience, a pragmatic attitude, and the use of critical thinking toward all types of knowledge. In ethics, the Buddha proposes a threefold understanding of action: mental, verbal, and bodily. In metaphysics, the Buddha argues that there are no self-caused entities, and that everything dependently arises from or upon something else. This allows the Buddha to provide a criticism of souls and personal identity; that criticism forms the foundation for his views about the reality of rebirth and an ultimate liberated state called “Nirvana.” Nirvana is not primarily an absolute reality beyond or behind the universe but rather a special state of mind in which all the causes and conditions responsible for rebirth and suffering have been eliminated. In philosophical anthropology, the Buddha explains human identity without a permanent and substantial self. The doctrine of non-self, however, does not imply the absolute inexistence of any type of self whatsoever, but is compatible with a conventional self composed of five psycho-physical aggregates, although all of them are unsubstantial and impermanent. Selves are thus conceived as evolving processes causally constrained by their past.

Interpreting the Historical Buddha
1. Dates
2. Sources
3. Life
4. Significance
The Buddha’s Epistemology
The Buddha’s Cosmology and Metaphysics
Nirvana and the Silence of the Buddha
1. Two Kinds of Nirvana and the Undetermined Questions
2. Eternalism, Nihilism, and the Middle Way
Buddhist Ethics
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Sources
2. Secondary Sources

1. Interpreting the Historical Buddha

a. Dates

There is no complete agreement among scholars and Buddhist traditions regarding the dates of the historical Buddha. The most common dates among Buddhists are those of the Theravāda school, 623-543 B.C.E. From the middle of the 19th century until the late 20th century, Western scholars had believed the dates of the Buddha to be ca. 560-480 B.C.E. However, after the publication in 1991-2 of the proceedings of the international symposium on the date of the historical Buddha held in Göttingen in 1988, the original consensus on these dates no longer exists.

Although there is no conclusive evidence for any specific date, most current scholars locate the Buddha’s life one hundred years earlier, around the fifth century B.C.E. Some of the new dates for the Buddha’s “death” or more accurately, for his parinirvāṇa are: ca. 404 B.C.E. (R. Gombrich), between 410-390 B.C.E. (K.R. Norman), ca. 400 B.C.E. (R. Hikata), ca. 397 B.C.E. (K.T.S. Sarao), between ca.400-350 B.C.E. (H. Bechert), 383 B.C.E. (H. Nakamura), 368 B.C.E. (A. Hirakawa), between 420-380 B.C.E. (A. Bareau).

b. Sources

The historical Buddha did not write down any of his teachings, they were passed down orally from generation to generation for at least three centuries. Some scholars have attempted to distinguish the Buddha’s original teachings from those developed by his early disciples. Unfortunately, the contradictory conclusions have led most scholars to be skeptical about the possibility of knowing what the Buddha really taught. This however, does not mean that all Buddhist texts that attribute teachings to the Buddha are equally valuable to reconstruct his thought. The early sūtras in Pāli and other Middle Indo-Aryan languages are historically and linguistically closer to the cultural context of the Buddha than Mahāyāna sūtras in Sanskrit, Tibetan, and Chinese. This does not imply that later translations of the early sūtras in Chinese (there are no Tibetan translations of the early sūtras) are less authentic or useless in reconstructing the philosophy of the Buddha. On the contrary, the comparative study of Pāli and Chinese versions of the early sūtras can help to infer what might have been the Buddha’s position on a number of issues.

Following what seems to be a growing scholarly tendency, I will reconstruct the philosophy of the historical Buddha by drawing on the Sutta Piṭaka of the Pāli canon. More specifically, our main sources are the first four Pāli Nikāyas (Dīgha, Majjhima, Saṃyutta, Aṅguttara) and some texts of the fifth Pāli Nikāya (Dhammapada, Udāna, Itivuttaka, and Sutta Nipāta). I do not identify these sources with the Buddha’s “ipsissima verba,” that is, with “the very words” of the Buddha, even less with his “actual” thought. Whether these sources are faithful to the actual thought and teachings of the historical Buddha is an unanswerable question; I can only say that to my knowledge there are not better sources to reconstruct the philosophy of the Buddha.

According to the traditional Buddhist account, shortly after the Buddha’s death five hundred disciples gathered to compile his teachings. The Buddha’s personal assistant, Ānanda, recited the first part of the Buddhist canon, the Sūtra Piṭaka, which contains discourses in dialogue form between the Buddha, his disciples, and his contemporaries on a variety of doctrinal and spiritual questions. Ānanda is reported to have recited the sutras just as he had heard them from the Buddha; that is why Buddhist sutras begin with the words “Thus have I heard.” Another disciple, Upāli, recited the second part of the Buddhist canon, the Vinaya Piṭaka, which also contains sutras, but primarily addresses the rules that govern a monastic community. After the recitation of Ānanda and Upāli, the other disciples approved what they had heard and communally recited the teachings as a sign of agreement. The third part of the Buddhist canon or Abhidharma Piṭaka, was not recited at that moment. The Theravāda tradition claims that the Buddha taught the Abhidharma while visiting the heaven where his mother was residing.

From a scholarly perspective, the former account is questionable. It might be the case that a large collection of Buddhist texts was written down for the first time in Sri Lanka during the first century B.C.E. However, the extant Pāli canon shows clear signs of historical development in terms of both content and language. The three parts of the Pāli canon are not as contemporary as the traditional Buddhist account seems to suggest: the Sūtra Piṭaka is older than the Vinaya Piṭaka, and the Abhidharma Piṭaka represents scholastic developments originated at least two centuries after the other two parts of the canon. The Vinaya Piṭaka appears to have grown gradually as a commentary and justification of the monastic code (Prātimokṣa), which presupposes a transition from a community of wandering mendicants (the Sūtra Piṭaka period ) to a more sedentary monastic community (the Vinaya Piṭaka period). Even within the Sūtra Piṭaka it is possible to detect older and later texts.

Neither the Sūtra Piṭaka nor the Vinaya Piṭaka of the Pāli canon could have been recited at once by one person and repeated by the entire Buddhist community. Nevertheless, the Sūtra Piṭaka of the Pāli canon is of particular importance in reconstructing the philosophy of Buddha for four main reasons. First, it contains the oldest texts of the only complete canon of early Indian Buddhism, which belong to the only surviving school of that period, namely, the Theravāda school, prevalent in Sri Lanka and Southeast Asia. Second, it has been preserved in a Middle Indo-Aryan language closely related to various Prakrit dialects spoken in North of India during the third century B.C.E., including the area where the Buddha spent most of his teaching years (Magadha). Third, it expresses a fairly consistent set of doctrines and practices. Fourth, it is strikingly similar to another version of the early Sūtra Piṭaka extant in Chinese (Āgamas). This similarity seems to indicate that a great part of the Sūtra Piṭaka in Pāli does not contain exclusively Theravāda texts, and belongs to a common textual tradition probably prior to the existence of Buddhist schools.

c. Life

Since the Pāli Nikāyas contain much more information about the teachings of the Buddha than about his life, it seems safe to postulate that the early disciples of the Buddha were more interested in preserving his teachings than in transmitting all the details of his life. The first complete biographies of the Buddha as well as the Jātaka stories about his former lives appeared centuries later, even after, and arguably as a reaction against, the dry lists and categorizations of early Abhidharma literature. The first complete biography of the Buddha in Pāli is the Nidānakathā, which serves as an introduction to the Jātaka verses found in the fifth Pāli Nikāya. In Sanskrit, the most popular biographies of the Buddha are the Buddhacarita attributed to the Indian poet Aśvaghoṣa (second century C.E), the Mahāvastu, and the Lalitavistara, both composed in the first century C.E.

The first four Pāli Nikāyas contain only fragmented information about the Buddha’s life. Especially important are the Mahāpadāna-suttanta, the Ariyapariyesanā-suttanta, the Mahāsaccaka-suttanta, and the Mahāparinibbāna-suttanta. According to the Mahāpadāna-suttanta, the lives of all Buddhas or perfectly enlightened beings follow a similar pattern. Like all Buddhas of the past, the Buddha of this cosmic era, also known as Gautama (Gotama in Pāli), was born into a noble family. The Buddha’s parents were King Śuddhodana and Queen Māyā. He was a member of the Śakya clan and his name was Siddhartha Gautama. Even though he was born in Lumbinī while his mother was traveling to her parents’ home, he spent the first twenty-nine years of his life in the royal capital, Kapilavastu, in the Nepalese region of Terai, close to the Indian border.

Like all past Buddhas, the conception and birth of Gautama Buddha are considered miraculous events. For instance, when all Buddhas descend into their mothers’ wombs from a heaven named Tuṣita, a splendid light shines forth and the entire universe quakes; their mothers are immaculate, healthy, and without pain of any sort during their ten months of pregnancy, but they die a week after giving birth. Buddha babies are born clean, though they are ritually bathed with two streams of water that fall from the sky; they all take seven steps toward the north and solemnly announce that this is their last rebirth.

Like former Buddhas, prince Siddhartha enjoyed all types of luxuries and sensual pleasures during his youth. Unsatisfied with this type of life, he had a crisis when he realized that everything was ephemeral and that his existence was subject to old age, sickness, and death. After seeing the serene joy of a monk and out of compassion for all living beings, he renounced his promising future as prince in order to start a long quest for a higher purpose, nirvāṇa (Pali nibbāna), which entails the cessation of old age, sickness and death. Later traditions speak of the Buddha as abandoning his wife Yaśodharā immediately after she gave birth to Rāhula, the Buddha’s only son. The Pāli Nikāyas, however, do not mention this story, and refer to Rāhula only as a young monk.

According to the Ariyapariyesanā-suttanta and the Mahāsaccaka-suttanta, the Buddha tried different spiritual paths for six years. First, he practiced yogic meditation under the guidance of Ālāra Kālāma and Uddaka Rāmaputta. After experiencing the states of concentration called base of nothingness and base of neither-perception-nor-non-perception, he realized that these lofty states did not lead to nirvana. Then the Buddha began to practice breathing exercises and fasting. The deterioration of his health led the Buddha to conclude that extreme asceticism was equally ineffective in attaining nirvana. He thus resumed eating solid food; after recovering his health, he began to practice a more moderate spiritual path, the middle path, which avoids the extremes of sensual self-indulgence and self-mortification. Soon after, the Buddha experienced enlightenment, or awakening, under a bodhi-tree. First he was inclined to inaction rather than to teaching what he had discovered. However, he changed his mind after the god Brahmā Sahampati asked him to teach. Out of compassion for all living beings, he decided to start a successful teaching career that lasted forty-five years.

d. Significance

It would be simplistic to dismiss all supernatural aspects of the Buddha’s life as false and consider historically true only those elements that are consistent with our contemporary scientific worldview. However, this approach towards the Buddha’s life was prevalent in the nineteenth century and a great part of the twentieth century. Today it is seen as problematic because it imposes modern western ideals of rationality onto non-western texts. Here I set aside the question of historical truth and speak exclusively of significance. The significance of all the biographies of Buddha does not lie in their historical accuracy, but rather in their effectiveness to convey basic Buddhist ideas and values throughout history. Even today, narratives about the many deeds of Buddha are successfully used to introduce Buddhists of all latitudes into the main values and teachings of Buddhism.

The supernatural elements of the Buddha’s life are as historically significant as the natural ones because they help to understand the way Buddhists conceived – and in many places continue to conceive – the Buddha. Like followers of other religious leaders, Buddhist scribes tended to glorify the sanctity of their foundational figure with extraordinary events and spectacular accomplishments. In this sense, the narratives of the Buddha are perhaps better understood as hagiographies rather than as biographies. The historical truth behind hagiographies is impossible to determine: how can we tell whether or not the Buddha was conceived without sexual intercourse; whether or not he was able to talk and walk right after his birth; whether or not he could walk over water, levitate, fly, and ascend into heaven at will? How do we know whether the Buddha was really tempted by Māra the evil one; whether there was an earthquake at the moment of his birth and death? The answers to these questions are a matter of faith. If the interpreter does not believe in the supernatural, then many narratives will be dismissed as historically false. However, for some Buddhists the supernatural events that appear in the life of Buddha did take place and are historically true.

The significance of the hagiographies of the Buddha is primarily ethical and spiritual. In fact, even if the life of Buddha did not take place as the hagiographies claim, the ethical values and the spiritual path they illustrate remain significant. Unlike other religions, the truth of Buddhism does not depend on the historicity of certain events in the life of the Buddha. Rather, the truth of Buddhism depends on the efficacy of the Buddhist path exemplified by the life of the Buddha and his disciples. In other words, if the different Buddhist paths inspired by the Buddha are useful to overcome existential dissatisfaction and suffering, then Buddhism is true regardless of the existence of the historical Buddha.

The fundamental ethical and spiritual point behind the Buddha’s life is that impermanent, conditioned, and contingent things such as wealth, social position, power, sensual pleasures, and even lofty meditative states, cannot generate a state of ultimate happiness. In order to overcome the profound existential dissatisfaction that all ephemeral and contingent things eventually generate, one needs to follow a comprehensive path of ethical and mental training conducive to the state of ultimate happiness called nirvana.

2. The Buddha’s Epistemology

a. The Extremes of Dogmatism and Skepticism

While the Buddha’s view of the spiritual path is traditionally described as a middle way between the extremes of self-indulgence and self-mortification, the Buddha’s epistemology can be interpreted as a middle way between the extremes of dogmatism and skepticism.

The extreme of dogmatism is primarily represented in the Pāli Nikāyas by Brahmanism. Brahmanism was a ritualistic religion that believed in the divine revelation of the Vedas, thought that belonging to a caste was determined by birth, and focused on the performance of sacrifice. Sacrifices involved the recitation of hymns taken from the Vedas and in many cases the ritual killing of animals.

Ritual sacrifices were offered to the Gods (gods for Buddhism) in exchange for prosperity, health, protection, sons, long life, and immortality. Only the male members of the highest caste, the priestly caste of Brahmins, could afford the professional space to seriously study the three Vedas (the Atharva Veda did not exist, or if it existed, it was not part yet of the Brahmanic tradition). Since only Brahmins knew the three Vedas, only they could recite the hymns necessary to properly perform the ritual sacrifice. Both ritual sacrifice and the social ethics of the caste system were seen as an expression of the cosmic order (Dharma) and as necessary to preserve that order.

Epistemologically speaking, Brahmanism emphasized the triple knowledge of the Vedas, and dogmatic faith in their content: “in regard to the ancient Brahmanic hymns that have come down through oral transmission and in the scriptural collections, the Brahmins come to the definite conclusion: ‘Only this is true, anything else is wrong’ ” (M.II.169).

The extreme of skepticism is represented in the Pāli Nikāyas by some members of the Śramanic movement, which consisted of numerous groups of spiritual seekers and wandering philosophers. The Sanskrit word “śramana” means “those who make an effort,” and probably refers to those who practice a spiritual discipline requiring individual effort, not just rituals performed by others. In order to become a śramana it was necessary to renounce one’s life as householder and enter into an itinerant life, which entailed the observance of celibacy and a simple life devoted to spiritual cultivation. Most śramanas lived in forests or in secluded places wandering from village to village where they preached and received alms in exchange.

The Śramanic movement was extremely diverse in terms of doctrines and practices. Most śramanas believed in free will as well as the efficacy of moral conduct and spiritual practices in order to attain liberation from the cycle of reincarnations. However, there was a minority of śramanas who denied the existence of the after life, free will, and the usefulness of ethical conduct and other spiritual practices. Probably as a reaction to these two opposite standpoints, some śramanas adopted a skeptic attitude denying the possibility of knowledge about such matters. Skeptics are described by the Buddha as replying questions by evasion (D.I.58-9), and as engaging in verbal wriggling, in eel-wriggling (amarāvikkhepa): “I don’t say it is like this. And I don’t say it is like that. And I don’t say it is otherwise. And I don’t say it is not so. And I don’t say it is not not so” (M.I. 521).

b. The Role of Personal Experience and the Buddha’s Wager

In contrast to Brahmanic dogmatism, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas did not claim to be omniscient (M.I.482); in fact, he proposed a critical attitude toward all sources of knowledge. In the Majjhima Nikāya (II.170-1), the Buddha challenges Brahmins who accept Vedic scriptures out of faith (saddhā) and oral tradition (anussava); he compares those who blindly follow scripture and tradition without having direct knowledge of what they believe with “a file of blind men each in touch with the next: the first one does not see, the middle one does not see, and the last one does not see.” The Buddha also warns Brahmins against knowledge based on likeability or emotional inclination (ruci), reflection on reasons (ākāraparivitakka), and consideration of theories (diṭṭhinijjhānakkhanti). These five sources of knowledge may be either true or false; that is, they do not provide conclusive grounds to claim dogmatically that “only this is true, anything else is wrong.”

Dogmatic claims of truth were not the monopoly of Brahmins. In the Majjhima Nikāya (I.178), the Buddha uses the simile of the elephant footprint to question dogmatic statements about him, his teachings, and his disciples: he invites his followers to critically investigate all the available evidence (different types of elephant footprints and marks) until they know and see for themselves (direct perception of the elephant in the open). The Pāli Nikāyas also refer to many śramanas who hold dogmatic views and as a consequence are involved in heated doctrinal disputes. The conflict of dogmatic views is often described as “a thicket of views, a wilderness of views, a contortion of views, a vacillation of views, a fetter of views. It is beset by suffering, by vexation, by despair, and by fever, and it does not lead to disenchantment, to dispassion, to cessation, to peace, to higher knowledge, to enlightentment, to Nibbāna” (M.I.485).

Public debates were common and probably a good way to gain prestige and converts. Any reputed Brahmin or śramana had to have not only the ability to speak persuasively but also the capacity to argue well. Rational argument played an important role in justifying doctrines and avoiding defeat in debate, which implied conversion to the other’s teaching. At the time of the Buddha many of these debates seem to have degenerated into dialectical battles that diverted from spiritual practice and led to disorientation, anger, and frustration. Although the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas utilizes reasoning to justify his positions in debates and conversations with others, he discourages dogmatic attachment to doctrines including his own (see the simile of the raft, M.I.135), and the use of his teachings for the sake of criticizing others and for winning debates (M.I.132).

Unlike the skepticism of some śramanas, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas takes clear stances on ethical and spiritual issues, and rejects neither the existence of right views (M.I.46-63) nor the possibility of knowing certain things as they are (yathābhūtaṃ). In order to counteract skepticism, the Buddha advises to the Kālāma people “not go by oral tradition, by succession of disciples, by hearsay, by the content of sacred scripture, by logical consistency, by inference, by reflection on reasons, by consideration of theories, by appearance, by respect to a teacher.” Instead, the Buddha recommends knowing things for oneself as the ultimate criterion to adjudicate between conflicting claims of truth (A.I.189).

When personal experience is not available to someone, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas proposes taking into account what is praised or censored by the wise, as well as a method to calculate the benefits of following certain opinions called the incontrovertible teaching (apaṇṇakadhamma), which, in some ways, resembles Pascal’s wager. According to the incontrovertible teaching, it would be better to believe in certain doctrines because they produce more benefits than others. For instance, even if there is no life after death and if good actions do not produce good consequences, still a moral person is praised in this life by the wise, whereas the immoral person is censured by society. However, if there is life after death and good action produce happy consequences, a moral person is praised in this life, and after death he or she goes to heaven. On the contrary, the immoral person is censured in this life, and after death he or she goes to hell (M.I.403). Therefore, it is better to believe that moral actions produce good consequences even if we do not have personal experience of karma and rebirth.

c. Interpretations of the Buddha’s Advice to the Kālāma People

Some have interpreted the Buddha’s advice to the Kālāma people as an iconoclast rejection of tradition and faith. This, however, does little justice to the Pāli Nikāyas, where the Buddha is said to be part of a long and respectable tradition of past Buddhas, and where the first Brahmins are sometimes commended by their holiness. The Buddha shows respect for many traditional beliefs and practices of his time, and rejects only those that are unjustified, useless, or conducive to suffering for oneself and others.

Faith in the Buddha, his teachings, and his disciples, is highly regarded in the Pāli Nikāyas: it is the first of the five factors of striving (M.II.95-6), and a necessary condition to practice the spiritual path (M.III.33). Buddhist faith, however, is not unconditional or an end in and of itself but rather a means towards direct knowledge that must be based on critical examination, supported by reasons, and eventually verified or rooted in vision (dassanamūlikā) (M.I.320).

Another common interpretation of the advice to the Kālāmas is that for the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas only personal experience provides reliable knowledge. However, this is misleading because analogical and inferential reasoning are widely used by the Buddha and his disciples to teach others as well as in debates with non-Buddhists. Similarly, analytical or philosophical meditation is a common practice for the attainment of liberation through wisdom. Personal experience, like any other means of knowledge is to be critically examined. Except in the case of Buddhas and liberated beings, personal experience is always tainted by affective and cognitive prejudices.

The Pāli Nikāyas might give the first impression of endorsing a form of naïve or direct realism: that is, the Buddha and his disciples seem to think that the world is exactly as we perceive it to be. While it is true that the Pāli Nikāyas do not question the common sense connection between objects of knowledge and the external world, there are some texts that might support a phenomenalist reading. For instance, the Buddha defines the world as the six senses (five ordinary senses plus the mind) and their respective objects (S.IV.95), or as the six senses, the six objects, and the six types of consciousness that arise in dependence on them (S.IV.39-40).

Here, the epistemology of the Buddha is a special form of realism that allows both for the direct perception of reality and the constructions of those less realized. Only Buddhas and liberated beings perceive the world directly; that is, they see the Dharma, whose regularity and stability remains independent of the existence of Buddhas (S.II.25). Unenlightened beings, on the other hand, see the world indirectly through a veil of negative emotions and erroneous views. Some texts go so far as to suggest that the world is not simply seen indirectly, but rather that it is literally constructed by our emotional dispositions. For instance, in the Majjhima Nikāya (I.111), the Buddha explicitly states that “what one feels, one perceives” (Yaṃ vedeti, taṃ sañjānāti). That is, our knowledge is formed by our feelings. The influence of feelings in our ways of knowing can also be inferred from the twelve-link chain of dependent arising, which explains the arising and cessation of suffering. The second link, saṅkhāra, or formations, conditions the arising of the third link, consciousness. The term saṅkhāra literally means “put together,” connoting the constructive role of the mental factors that fall into this category, many of them affective in nature.

Similarly, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas says that “with what one has mentally constructed as the root cause (Yaṃ papañceti tato nidānaṃ), perceptions, concepts, and [further] mental constructions (papañcasaññāsaṅkhā) beset a man with respect to past, future, and present forms…sounds…odours…flavors…tangibles…mind-objects cognizable by the eye…ear… nose…tongue…body…mind” (M.I.111-112). That is, the knowledge of unenlightened beings has papañca, or mental constructions, as its root cause. The word papañca is a technical term that literally means diversification or proliferation; it refers to the tendency of unenlightened minds to construct or fabricate concepts conducive to suffering, especially essentialist and ego-related concepts such as “I” and “mine,” concepts which lead to a variety of negative mental states such as craving, conceit, and dogmatic views about the self (Ñāṇananda 1971).

It is precisely because our experiences are affectively and cognitively conditioned that the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas advocates a critical approach toward all sources of knowledge, including personal experience. Even the lofty experiences derived from meditation are to be analyzed carefully because they might lead to false opinions about the nature of the self, the world, and the after life. The epistemological ideal is to know things directly beyond mental constructions (papañca), which presupposes the “tranquilization of all mental formations” (sabbasaṅkhārasamatha).

d. Higher Knowledge and the Question of Empiricism

Contemplative experiences are of two main types: meditative absorptions or abstractions (jhāna), and higher or direct knowledge (abhiññā). There are six classes of higher or direct knowledge: the first one refers to a variety of supernatural powers including levitation and walking on water; in this sense, it is better understood as a know-how type of knowledge. The second higher knowledge is literally called “divine ear element” or clairaudience. The third higher knowledge is usually translated as telepathy, though it means simply the ability to know the underlying mental state of others, not the reading of their minds and thoughts.

The next three types of higher knowledge are especially important because they were experienced by the Buddha the night of his enlightenment, and because they are the Buddhist counterparts to the triple knowledge of the Vedas. The fourth higher knowledge is retrocognition or knowledge of past lives, which entails a direct experience of the process of rebirth. The fifth is the divine eye or clairvoyance; that is, direct experience of the process of karma, or as the texts put it, the passing away and reappearing of beings in accordance with their past actions. The sixth is knowledge of the destruction of taints, which implies experiential knowledge of the four noble truths and the process of liberation.

Some scholars have interpreted the Buddha’s emphasis on direct experience and the verifiable nature of Buddhist faith as a form of radical empiricism (Kalupahana 1992), and logical empiricism (Jayatilleke 1963). According to the empiricist interpretation, Buddhist faith is always subsequent to critically verifying the available empirical evidence. All doctrines taught by the Buddha are empirically verifiable if one takes the time and effort to attain higher or direct knowledge, interpreted as extraordinary sense experience. For instance, the triple knowledge of enlightenment implies a direct experience of the processes of karma, rebirth, and the four noble truths. Critiques of the empiricist interpretation point out that, at least at the beginning of the path, Buddhist faith is not always based on empirical evidence, and that the purpose of extraordinary knowledge is not to verify the doctrines of karma, rebirth, and the four noble truths (Hoffman 1982, 1987).

Whether or not the Buddha’s epistemology can be considered empiricist depends on what we mean by empiricism and experience. The opposition between rationalism and empiricism and the sharp distinction between senses and reason is foreign to Buddhism. Nowhere in the Pāli Nikāyas does the Buddha say that all knowledge begins in or is acquired from sense experience. In this sense, the Buddha is not an empiricist.

3. The Buddha’s Cosmology and Metaphysics

a. The Universe and the Role of Gods

The Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas accepts the cosmology characteristic of his cultural context: a universe with several realms of existence, where people are reborn and die again and again (saṃsāra) depending on their past actions (karma) until they attain salvation (mokṣa). However, the Buddha substantially modifies the cosmology of his time. Against the Brahmanic tendency to understand karma as ritual action, and the Jain claim that all activities including involuntary actions constitute karma, the Buddha defines karma in terms of volition, or free will, which is expressed through thoughts, words, and behavior. That is, for the Buddha, only voluntary actions produce karma.

Another important modification is that for the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas, saṃsāra refers primarily to a psychophysical process that takes place within the physical universe. For instance, when the Buddha speaks about the end of the world, he says that it cannot be reached by traveling through the physical universe, but only by putting an end to suffering (saṃsāra), where “one is not born, does not age, does not die, does not pass away, and is not reborn” Accordingly, salvation is not understood in world-denying terms or as an escape from the physical universe, but rather as an inner transformation that takes place within one’s own psychophysical organism: “It is, friend, in just this fathom-high carcass endowed with perception and mind that I make known the world, the origin of the world, the cessation of the world, and the way leading to the cessation of the world.” (S.I.62; A.II.47-9).

There are five kinds of destinations within saṃsāra: hell, animal kingdom, realm of ghosts, humankind, and realm of devas or radiant beings, commonly translated as gods (M.I.73). There are many hells and heavens and life there is transitory, just as in other destinations. In some traditions there is another destination, the realm of asuras or demigods, who are jealous of the gods and who are always in conflict with them.

The Pāli Nikāyas further divide the universe of saṃsāra into three main planes of existence, each one subdivided into several realms. The three planes of existence are sensorial, fine-material, and immaterial (M.I.50). Most destinations belong to the sensorial realm. Only a minority of heavens belong to the fine-material and immaterial realms. Rebirth in a particular realm depends on past actions: good actions lead to good destinations and bad actions to bad rebirths. Rebirth as a human or in heaven is considered a good destination; rebirth in the realm of ghosts, hell, and the animal realm are bad. Human rebirth is extremely difficult to attain (S.V.455-6; M.III.169), and it is highly regarded because of its unique combination of pain and pleasure, as well as its unique conductivity for attaining enlightenment. In this last sense human rebirth is said to be even better than rebirth as a god.

Rebirth also depends on the prevalent mental states of a person during life, and especially at the moment of death. That is, there is a correlation between mental states and realms of rebirth, between cosmology and psychology. For instance, a mind where hatred and anger prevails is likely to be reborn in hell; deluded and uncultivated minds are headed toward the animal kingdom; someone obsessed with sex and food will probably become bound to earth as a ghost; loving and caring persons will be reborn in heaven; someone who frequently dwells in meditative absorptions will be reborn in the fine-material and immaterial realms. Human rebirth might be the consequence of any of the aforementioned mental states.

Perhaps the most important modification the Buddha introduces into the traditional cosmology of his time was a new view of Gods (gods within Buddhism). In the Pāli Nikāyas, gods do not play any significant cosmological role. For the Buddha, the universe has not been created by an all-knowing, all-powerful god that is the lord of the universe and father of all beings (M.I.326-7). Rather, the universe evolves following certain cyclic patterns of contraction and expansion (D.III.84-5).

Similarly, the cosmic order, or Dharma, does not depend on the will of gods, and there are many good deeds far more effective than ritual sacrifices offered to the gods (D.I144ff). Gods for the Buddha are unenlightened beings subject to birth and death that require further learning and spiritual practice in order to attain liberation; they are more powerful and spiritually more developed than humans and other living beings, but Buddhas excel them in all regards: spiritual development, wisdom, and power. Even the supreme type of god, Brahmā, offers his respects to the Buddha, praises him, and asks him to preach the Dharma for those with little dust in their eyes (M.I.168-9).

Since the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas does not deny the existence of gods, only their cosmological and soteriological functions, it is inaccurate to define early Buddhism as atheistic or as non-theistic. The word atheistic is usually associated with anti-religious attitudes absent in the Buddha, and the term non-theistic seems to imply that rejecting the theistic concept of God is one of the main concerns of the Buddha, when in fact it is a marginal question in the Pāli Nikāyas.

b. The Four Noble Truths or Realities

One the most common frameworks to explain the basic teachings of early Buddhism is the four noble truths (ariyasacca, Sanskrit āryasatya). The word sacca means both truth and reality. The word ariya refers primarily to the ideal type of person the Buddhist path is supposed to generate, a noble person in the ethical and spiritual sense. Translating ariyasacca by ‘noble truths’ is somehow misleading because it gives the wrong impression of being a set of beliefs, a creed that Buddhists accept as noble and true. The four noble truths are primarily four realities whose contemplation leads to sainthood or the state of the noble ones (ariya). Other possible translations of ariyasacca are “ennobling truths” or “truths of the noble ones.”

Each noble truth requires a particular practice from the disciple; in this sense the four noble truths can be understood as four types of practice. The first noble truth, or the reality of suffering, assigns to the disciple the practice of cultivating understanding. Such understanding takes place gradually through reflection, analytical meditation, and eventually direct experience. What needs to be understood is the nature of suffering, and the different types of suffering and happiness within saṃsāra.

A common misconception about the first noble truth is to think that it presupposes a pessimistic outlook on life. This interpretation would be correct only if the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas had not taught the existence of different types of happiness and the third noble truth, or cessation of suffering; that is, the good news about the reality of nirvana, defined as the highest happiness (Dhp.203; M.I.505). Since the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas teaches the reality of both suffering and the highest happiness, perhaps it is more accurate to speak of his attitude as realist: there is a problem but there is also a solution to that problem.

The second noble truth, or reality of the origin of suffering, calls for the practice of renunciation to all mental states that generate suffering for oneself and others. The mental state that appears in the second noble truth is taṇhā, literally “thirst.” It was customary in the first Western translations of Buddhist texts (Burnouf, Fausboll, Muller, Oldenberg, Warren) to translate taṇhā by desire. This translation has misled many to think that the ultimate goal of Buddhists is the cessation of all desires. However, as Damien Keown puts it, “it is an oversimplification of the Buddhist position to assume that it seeks an end to all desire.” (1992: 222).

In fact, there are many terms in the Pāli Nikāyas that can be translated as desire, not all of them related to mental states conducive to suffering. On the contrary, there are many texts in the Pāli Nikāyas that demonstrate the positive role of certain types of desire in the Buddha’s path (Webster, 2005: 90-142). Nonetheless, the term taṇhā in the Pāli Nikāyas designates always a harmful type of desire that leads to “repeated existence” (ponobhavikā), is “associated with delight and lust” (nandirāgasahagatā), and “delights here and there” (tatra tatrābhinandinī) (M.I.48; D.II.308; etc). There is only one text (Nettipakaraṇa 87) that speaks about a wholesome type of taṇhā that leads to its own relinquishment, but this text is extra-canonical except in Myanmar.

The most common translation of taṇhā nowadays is craving. Unlike the loaded, vast, and ambivalent term desire, the term craving refers more specifically to a particular type of desire, and cannot be misinterpreted as conveying any want and aspiration whatsoever. Rather, like taṇhā in the Pāli Nikāyas, craving refers to intense (rāga can be translated by both lust and passion), obsessive, and addictive desires (the idiom tatra tatra can also be interpreted as connoting the idea of repetition or tendency to repeat itself).

Since craving, or taṇhā, does not include all possible types of desires, there is no “paradox of desire” in the Pāli Nikāyas. In other words, the Buddha of the the Pāli Nikāyas does not teach that in order to attain liberation from suffering one has to paradoxically desire to stop all desires. There is no contradiction in willing the cessation of craving. That is, for the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas it is possible to want, like, or strive for something without simultaneously craving for it.

The Pāli Nikāyas distinguish between three kinds of taṇhā: craving for sensual pleasures (kāmataṇhā), craving for existence (bhavataṇhā), and craving for non-existence (vibhavataṇhā). Following Webster, I understand the last two types of craving as “predicated on two extreme (wrong) views, those of eternalism and annihilationism” (2005:130-1). In other words, craving for existence longs for continued existence of one’s self within saṃsāra, and craving for non-existence is a reversed type of desire or aversion to one’s own destruction at the moment of death.

The underlying root of all suffering, however, is not craving but spiritual ignorance (avijjā). In the Pāli Nikāyas spiritual ignorance does not connote a mere lack of information but rather a misconception, a distorted perception of things under the influence of conceptual fabrications and affective prejudices. More specifically, ignorance refers to not knowing things as they are, the Dharma, and the four noble truths. The relinquishing of spiritual ignorance, craving, and the three roots of the unwholesome (greed or lobha, aversion or dosa, delusion or moha) entails the cultivation of many positive mental states, some of the most prominent in the Pāli Nikāyas being: wisdom or understanding (paññā), letting go (anupādāna), selflessness (alobha), love (avera, adosa, avyāpāda), friendliness (mettā), compassion (karuṇā), altruistic joy (muditā), equanimity (upekkhā), calm (samatha, passaddhi), mindfulness (sati), diligence (appamāda).

The third noble truth, or reality of the cessation of suffering, asks us to directly realize the destruction of suffering, usually expressed with a variety of cognitive and affective terms: peace, higher knowledge, the tranquilization of mental formations, the abandonment of all grasping, cessation, the destruction of craving, absence of lust, nirvana (Pali nibbāna). The most popular of all the terms that express the cessation of suffering and rebirth is nirvana, which literally means blowing out or extinguishing.

Metaphorically, the extinction of nirvana designates a mental event, namely, the extinguishing of the fires of craving, aversion, and delusion (S.IV.251). That nirvana primarily denotes a mental event, a psychological process, is also confirmed by many texts that describe the person who experiences nirvana with intransitive verbs such as to nirvanize (nibbāyati) or to parinirvanize (parinibbāyati). However, there are a few texts that seem to indicate that nirvana might also be a domain of perception (āyatana), element (dhātu), or reality (dhamma) known at the moment of enlightenment, and in special meditative absorptions after enlightenment. This domain is usually defined as having the opposite qualities of saṃsāra (Ud 8.1), or with metaphoric expressions (S.IV.369ff).

What is important to point out is that the concern of the Pāli Nikāyas is not to describe nirvana, which, strictly speaking, is beyond logic and language (It 37), but rather to provide a systematic explanation of the arising and cessation of suffering. The goal of Buddhism as it appears in the Pāli Nikāyas does not consist in believing that suffering arises and ceases like the Buddha says, but in realizing that what he teaches about suffering and its cessation is the case; that is, the Buddha’s teaching, or Dharma, is intended to be experienced by the wise for themselves (M.I.265).

The fourth noble truth, or reality of the path leading to the cessation of suffering, imposes on us the practice of developing the eightfold ennobling path. This path can be understood either as eight mental factors that are cultivated by ennobled disciples at the moment of liberation, or as different parts of the entire Buddhist path whose practice ennoble the disciple gradually. The eight parts of the Buddhist path are usually divided into three kinds of training: training in wisdom (right view and right intention), ethical training (right speech, right bodily conduct, and right livelihood), and training in concentration (right effort, right mindfulness and right concentration).

c. Ontology of Suffering: the Five Aggregates

A prominent concern of the Buddha in the Pāli Nikāyas is to provide a solution to the problem of suffering. When asked about his teachings, the Buddha answers that he only teaches suffering and its cessation (M.I.140). The first noble truth describes what the Buddha means by suffering: birth, aging, illness, death, union with what is displeasing, separation from what is pleasing, not getting what one wants, the five aggregates of grasping (S.V.421).

The original Pali term for suffering is dukkha, a word that ordinarily means physical and mental pain, but that in the first noble truth designates diverse kinds of frustration, and the existential angst generated by the impermanence of life and the unavoidability of old age, disease, and death. However, when the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas mentions birth and the five aggregates of grasping, he seems to be referring to the fact that our psychophysical components are conditioned by grasping, and consequently, within saṃsāra, the cycle of births and deaths. This interpretation is consistent with later Buddhist tradition, which speaks about three types of dukkha: ordinary suffering (mental and physical pain), suffering due to change (derived from the impermanence of things), and suffering due to conditions (derived from being part of saṃsāra).

When the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas speaks about personal identity and the human predicament, he uses the technical expression “five aggregates of grasping” (pañcupādānakkhandhā). That is, the Buddha describes human existence in terms of five groups of constituents. The five aggregates are: material form (rūpa), sensations (vedanā), perceptions (saññā), mental formations (saṃkhāra), consciousness (viññāṇa). While the first aggregate refers to material components, the other four designate a variety of mental functions.

The aggregate material form is explained as the four great elements and the shape or figure of our physical body. The four great elements are earth, water, fire, and air. The earth element is further defined as whatever is solid in our body, and water as whatever is liquid. The fire element refers to “that by which one is warmed, ages, and is consumed,” and the process of digestion. The air element denotes the breathing process and movements of gas throughout the body (M.I.185ff).

The aggregate sensations denote pleasant, unpleasant and neutral feelings experienced after there is contact between the six sense organs (eye, ear, nose, tongue, body, and mind) and their six objects (forms, sounds, odors, tastes, tangible objects, and mental phenomena). The aggregate perceptions express the mental function by which someone is able to identify objects. There are six types of perceptions corresponding to the six objects of the senses. The aggregate formations express emotional and intellectual dispositions, literally volitions (sañcetanâ), towards the six objects of the senses. These dispositions are the result of past cognitive and affective conditioning, that is, past karma or past voluntary actions. The aggregate consciousness connotes the ability to know and to be aware of the six objects of the senses (S.III.59ff).

d. Arguments for the Doctrine of Non-self

The Buddha reiterates again and again throughout the Pāli Nikāyas that any of the five aggregates “whether past, future or present, internal or external, gross or subtle, inferior or superior, far or near, ought to be seen as it actually is with right wisdom thus: ‘this is not mine, this I am not, this is not my self.’ ” When the disciple contemplates the five aggregates in this way, he or she becomes disenchanted (nibbindati), lust fades away (virajjati), and he or she attains liberation due to the absence of lust (virāgā vimuccati) (M.I.138-9).

The Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas justifies this view of the five aggregates as non-self with three main arguments, which are used as a method of analytical meditation, and in polemics with members of other schools. The assumption underlying the Buddha’s arguments is that something might be considered a self only if it were permanent, not leading to suffering, not dependently arisen, and subject to one’s own will. Since none of the five aggregates fulfill any of these conditions, it is wrong to see them as belonging to us or as our self.

In the first and most common argument for non-self the Buddha asks someone the following questions: “What do you think, monks, is material form permanent or impermanent?” – “Impermanent, venerable sir.” – “Is what is impermanent suffering or happiness?” – “Suffering, venerable sir.” –Is what is impermanent, suffering, and subject to change, fit to be regarded as: “this is mine, this I am, this is my self?” – “No, venerable sir” (M.I.138, etc). The same reasoning is applied to the other aggregates.

The first argument is also applied to the six sensual organs, the six objects, the six types of consciousness, perceptions, sensations, and formations that arise dependent on the contact between the senses and their objects (M.III.278ff). Sometimes the first argument for non-self is applied to the six senses and their objects without questions and answers: “Monks, the visual organ is impermanent. What is impermanent is suffering. What is suffering is non-self. What is non-self ought to be seen as it really is with right wisdom thus: ‘this is not mine, this I am not, this is not my self’ ” (S.IV.1ff).

The second argument for non-self is much less frequent: “Monks, material form is non-self. If it were self, it would not lead to affliction. It would be possible [to say] with regard to material form: ‘Let my material form be thus. Let my material form not be thus.’ But precisely because it is non-self, it leads to affliction. And it is not possible [to say] with regard to material form: ‘Let my material form be thus. Let my material form not be thus’ ”(S.III.66-7). The same reasoning is applied to the other four aggregates.

The third argument deduces non-self from that fact that physical and mental phenomena depend on certain causes to exist. For instance, in (M.III.280ff), the Buddha first analyzes the dependent arising of physical and mental phenomena. Then he argues: “If anyone says: ‘the visual organ is self,’ that is unacceptable. The rising and falling of the visual organ are fully known (paññāyati). Since the rising and falling of the visual organ are fully known, it would follow that: ‘my self arises and falls.’ Therefore, it is unacceptable to say: ‘the visual organ is self.’ Thus the visual organ is non-self.” The same reasoning is applied to the other senses, their objects, and the six types of consciousness, contacts (meeting of sense, object and consciousness), sensations, and cravings derived from them.

The third argument also appears combined with the first one without questions and answers. For instance, in (A.V.188), it is said that “whatever becomes, that is conditioned, volitionally formed, dependently arisen, that is impermanent. What is impermanent, that is suffering. What is suffering, that is [to be regarded thus]: ‘this is not mine, this I am not, this is not my self.’ ”

If something can be inferred from these three arguments, it is that the target of the doctrine of non-self is not all concepts of self but specifically views of the self as permanent and not dependently arisen. That is, the doctrine of non-self opposes what is technically called “views of personal identity” or more commonly translated “personality views” (sakkāyadiṭṭhi). Views of personal identity relate the five aggregates to a permanent and independent self in four ways: as being identical, as being possession of the self, as being in the self, or as the self being in them (M.I.300ff). All these views of personal identity are said to be the product of spiritual ignorance, that is, of not seeing with right wisdom the true nature of the five aggregates, their origin, their cessation, and the way leading to their cessation.

e. Human Identity and the Meaning of Non-self

Since the Pāli Nikāyas accept the common sense usages of the word “self” (attan, Skt. ātman), primarily in idiomatic expressions and as a reflexive pronoun meaning “oneself,” the doctrine of non-self does not imply a literal negation of the self. Similarly, since the Buddha explicitly criticizes views that reject karma and moral responsibility (M.I.404ff), the doctrine of non-self should not be understood as the absolute rejection of moral agency and any concept of personal identity. In fact, the Buddha explicitly defines “personal identity” (sakkāya) as the five aggregates (M.I.299).

Since the sixth sense, or mind, includes the four mental aggregates, and since the ordinary five senses and their objects fall under the aggregate of material form, it can be said that for the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas personal identity is defined not only in terms of the five aggregates, but also in terms of the six senses and their six objects.

If the meaning of non-self were that there is literally no self whatsoever, no personal identity and no moral agency whatsoever, then the only logical conclusion would be to state that the Buddha taught nonsense and that the Pāli Nikāyas are contradictory, sometimes accepting the existence of a self and other times rejecting it. Even though no current scholar of Buddhism would endorse such an interpretation of non-self, it is still popular in some missionary circles and apologetic literature.

A more sympathetic interpretation of non-self distinguishes between two main levels of discourse (Collins 1982). The first level of discourse does not question the concept of self and freely uses personal terms and expressions in accordance with ordinary language and social conventions. The second level of discourse is philosophically more sophisticated and rejects views of self and personal identity as permanent and not dependently arisen. Behind the second level of discourse there is a technical understanding of the self and personal identity as the five aggregates, that is, as a combination of psychophysical processes, all of them impermanent and dependently originated.

This concept of the self as permanent and not dependently arisen is problematic because it is based on a misperception of the aggregates. This misperception of the five aggregates is associated with what is technically called “the conceit I am” (asmimāna) and “the underlying tendency to the conceits ‘I’ and ‘mine’ ” (ahaṃkāra-mamaṅkāra-mānānusaya). This combination of conceit and ignorance fosters different types of cravings, especially craving for immortal existence, and subsequently, speculations about the past, present, and future nature of the self and personal identity. For instance, in (D.I.30ff), the Buddha speaks of different ascetics and Brahmins who claim that the self after death is “material, immaterial, both material and immaterial, neither material nor immaterial, finite, infinite, both, neither, of uniform perception, of varied perception, of limited perception, of unlimited perception, wholly happy, wholly miserable, both, neither.” The doctrine of non-self is primarily intended to counteract views of the self and personal identity rooted in ignorance regarding the nature of the five aggregates, the conceit “I am,” and craving for immortal existence.

A minority of scholars reject the notion that the Buddha’s doctrine of non-self implies the negation of the true self, which for them is permanent and independent of causes and conditions. Accordingly, the purpose of the doctrine of non-self is simply to deny that the five aggregates are the true self. The main reason for this interpretation is that the Buddha does not say anywhere in the Pāli Nikāyas that the self does not exist; he only states that a self and what belongs to a self are not apprehended (M.I.138). Therefore, for these interpreters the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas only claims that impermanent and conditioned things like the five aggregates are not the true self. For these scholars, the Buddha does talk about the true self when he speaks about the consciousness of liberated beings (M.I.140), and the unconditioned, unborn and deathless nirvana (Bhattacarya 1973; Pérez Remón 1981).

However, the majority of Buddhist scholars agree with the traditional Buddhist self-understanding: they think that the doctrine of non-self is incompatible with any doctrine about a permanent and independent self, not just with views that mistakenly identify an alleged true self with the five aggregates. The main reason for this interpretation relates to the doctrine of dependent arising.

f. Causality and the Principle of Dependent Arising

The importance of dependent arising (paṭiccasamuppāda) cannot be underestimated: the Buddha realized its workings during the night of his enlightenment (M.I.167). Preaching the doctrine of dependent arising amounts to preaching the Dharma (M.II.32), and whoever sees it sees the Dharma (M.I.191). The Dharma of dependent arising remains valid whether or not there are Buddhas in the world (S.II.25), and it is through not understanding it that people are trapped into the cycle of birth and death (D.II.55).

The doctrine of dependent arising can be formulated in two ways that usually appear together: as a general principle or as a chain of causal links to explain the arising and ceasing of suffering and the process of rebirth. The general principle of dependent arising states that “when this exists, that comes to be; with the arising of this, that arises. When this does not exist, that does not come to be; with the cessation of this, that ceases” (M.II.32; S.II.28).

Unlike the logical principle of conditionality, the principle of dependent arising does not designate a connection between two ideas but rather an ontological relationship between two things or events within a particular timeframe. Dependent arising expresses not only the Buddha’s understanding of causality but also his view of things as interrelated. The point behind dependent arising is that things are dependent on specific conditions (paṭicca), and that they arise together with other things (samuppāda). In other words, the principle of dependent arising conveys both ontological conditionality and the constitutive relativity of things. This relativity, however, does not mean that for the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas everything is interdependent or that something is related to everything else. This is a later development of Buddhist thought, not a characteristic of early Indian Buddhism.

The most comprehensive chain of dependent arising contains twelve causal links: (1) ignorance, (2) formations, (3) consciousness, (4) mentality-materiality, (5) the six senses, (6) contact, (7) sensations, (8) craving (9) grasping, (10) becoming, (11) birth, (12) old age and death. The most common formulation is as follows: with 1 as a condition 2 [comes to be]; with 2 as a condition 3 [comes to be], and so forth. Conversely, with the cessation of 1 comes the cessation of 2; with the cessation of 2 comes the cessation of 3, and so forth.

It is important to keep in mind that this chain does not imply a linear understanding of causality where the antecedent link disappears once the subsequent link has come to be. Similarly, each of the causal links is not to be understood as the one and only cause that produces the next link but rather as the most necessary condition for its arising. For instance, ignorance, the first link, is not the only cause of the process of suffering but rather the cause most necessary for the continuation of such a process. For the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas, as well as for later Buddhist tradition, there is always a multiplicity of causes and conditions at play.

The traditional interpretation divides the twelve link chain of dependent arising into three lives. The first two links (ignorance and formations) belong to the past life: due to a misperception of the nature of the five aggregates, a person (the five aggregates) performs voluntary actions: mental, verbal, and bodily actions, with wholesome, unwholesome, and neutral karmic effects. The next ten factors correspond to the present life: the karmic effects of past voluntary formations are stored in consciousness and transferred to the next life. Consciousness together with the other mental aggregates combines with a new physical body to constitute a new psychophysical organism (mentality-materiality). This new stage of the five aggregates develops the six senses and the ability to establish contact with their six objects. Contacts with objects of the senses produce pleasant, unpleasant and neutral sensations. If the sensations are pleasant, the person usually responds with cravings for more pleasant experiences, and if the sensations are unpleasant, with aversion. Craving and aversion, as well as the underlying ignorance of the nature of the five aggregates are fundamental causes of suffering and rebirth: the three roots of the unwholesome according to the Pāli Nikāyas, or the three mental poisons according to later Buddhist traditions.

By repeating the affective responses of craving and aversion, the person becomes more and more dependent on whatever leads to more pleasant sensations and less unpleasant ones. This creates a variety of emotional dependencies and a tendency to grasp or hold onto what causes pleasure and avoids pain. The Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas speaks about four types of grasping: towards sensual pleasures, views, rites-and-observances, and especially towards doctrines of a [permanent and independent] self (D.II.57-8).

The original term for grasping is upādāna, which also designates the fuel or supply necessary to maintain a fire. In this sense, grasping is the psychological fuel that maintains the fires of craving, aversion, and delusion, the fires whose extinction is called nirvana. The Buddha’s ideal of letting go and detachment should not be misunderstood as the absence of any emotions whatsoever including love and compassion, but specifically as the absence of emotions associated with craving, aversion, and delusion. Motivated by grasping and the three mental fires, the five aggregates perform further voluntary actions, whose karmic effects perpetuate existence within the cycle of rebirth and subsequent suffering. The last two links (birth, aging and death) refer to the future life. At the end of this present existence, a new birth of the five aggregates will take place followed by old age, death, and other kinds of suffering.

The twelve-link chain of dependent arising explains the processes of rebirth and suffering without presupposing a permanent and independent self. The Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas makes this point explicit in his passionate rebuttal of the monk Sāti, who claimed that it is the same consciousness that wanders through the cycle of rebirth. For the Buddha, consciousness, like the other eleven causal links, is dependent on specific conditions (M.I.258ff), which entails that consciousness is impermanent, suffering, and non-self.

Instead of a permanent and independent self behind suffering and the cycle of rebirth, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas presupposes five psychophysical sets of processes, namely, the five aggregates, which imply an impermanent and dependently-arisen concept of ‘self’ and ‘personal identity.’ In other words, the Buddha rejects substance-selves but accepts process-selves (Gowans 2003). Yet, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas explicitly refuses to use personal terms such as ‘self’ in technical explanations of rebirth and suffering, and he prefers to speak in terms of causes and conditions that produce other causes and conditions (S.II.13-4; S.II.62; M.III.19). But what happens to consciousness and the other aggregates when grasping no longer exists and the three mental fires have been extinguished? What happens when suffering ceases and the cycle of rebirth stops?

4. Nirvana and the Silence of the Buddha

a. Two Kinds of Nirvana and the Undetermined Questions

When the fires of craving, aversion, and ignorance are extinguished at the moment of enlightenment, the aggregates are liberated due to the lack of grasping. This is technically called nirvana with remainder of grasping (saupādisesa-nibbāna), or as later tradition puts it, nirvana of mental defilements (kilesa-parinibbāna). The expression ‘remainder of grasping’ refers to the five aggregates of liberated beings, which continue to live after enlightenment but without negative mental states.

The aggregates of the liberated beings perform their respective functions and, like the aggregates of anybody else, they grow old, get sick, and are subject to pleasant and unpleasant sensations until death. The difference between unenlightened and enlightened beings is that enlightened beings respond to sensations without craving or aversion, and with higher knowledge of the true nature of the five aggregates.

The definition of nirvana without remainder (anupādisesa-nibbāna) that appears in (It 38) only says that for the liberated being “all that is experienced here and now, without enchantment [another term for grasping], will be cooled (sīta).” Since “all” is defined in the Pāli Nikāyas as the six senses and their six objects (S.IV.15), which is another way of describing the individual psychophysical experience or the five aggregates, the expression “all that is experienced” refers to what happens to the aggregates of liberated beings. Since (It 38) explicitly uses the expression “here and now” (idheva), it seems impossible to conclude that the definition of nirvana without remainder is intended to say anything about nirvana or the aggregates beyond death. Rather (It 38) describes nirvana and the aggregates at the moment of death: they will be no longer subject to rebirth and they will become cooled, tranquil, at peace. The question is: what does this peace or coolness entail? What happens after the nirvana of the aggregates? Does the mind of enlightened beings survive happily ever after? Does the liberated being exist beyond death or not?

These questions are left undetermined (avyākata) by the Buddha of the the Pāli Nikāyas. The ten questions in the the Pāli Nikāyas ask whether (1) The world is eternal; (2) The world is not eternal; (3) The world is infinite; (4) The world is finite; (5) Body and soul are one thing; (6) Body and soul are two different things; (7) A liberated being (tathāgata) exists after death; (8) A liberated being (tathāgata) does not exist after death; (9) A liberated being (tathāgata) both exists and does not exist after death; (10) A liberated being (tathāgata) neither exists nor does not exist after death. In Sanskrit Buddhist texts the ten views become fourteen by adding the last two possibilities of the tetralema (both A and B, neither A nor B) to the questions about the world.

Unfortunately for those looking for quick answers, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas does not provide a straightforward yes or no response to any of these questions. When the Buddha is asked whether the liberated being exists, does not exist, both, or neither, he sets aside these questions by saying that (1) he does not hold such views, (2) he has left the questions undetermined, and (3) the questions do not apply (na upeti). The first two answers are also used to respond to questions about the temporal and spatial finitude or infinitude of the world, and the identity or difference between the soul and the body. Only the third type of answer is given to the questions about liberated beings after death.

Most presentations of early Buddhism interpret these three answers of the Buddha as an eloquent silence about metaphysical questions due primarily to pragmatic reasons, namely, the questions divert from spiritual practice and are not conducive to liberation from suffering. While the pragmatic reasons for the answers of the Buddha are undeniable, it is inaccurate to understand them as silence about metaphysical questions. In fact, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas does address many metaphysical issues with his teachings of non-self and dependent arising.

The answers of the Buddha to the undetermined questions are due not only to pragmatic reasons but also to metaphysical reasons: the questions are inconsistent with the doctrines of non-self and dependent arising because they assume the existence of a permanent and independent self, a self that is either finite or infinite, identical or different from the body, existing or not existing after death. Besides pragmatic and metaphysical reasons, there are cognitive and affective reasons for the answers of the Buddha: the undetermined questions are based on ignorance about the nature of the five aggregates and craving for either immortal existence or inexistence. The questions are expressions of ‘identity views,’ that is, they are part of the problem of suffering. Answering the questions directly would have not done any good: a yes answer would have fostered more craving for immortal existence and led to eternalist views, and a no answer would have fostered further confusion and led to nihilist views (S.IV.400-1).

In the case of the undetermined questions about the liberated being, there are also apophatic reasons for answering “it does not apply.” The Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas illustrates the inapplicability of the questions with the simile of the fire extinct: just as it does not make sense to ask about the direction in which an extinct fire has gone, it is inappropriate to ask about the status of the liberated being beyond death: “The fire burned in dependence on its fuel of grass and sticks. When that is used up, if it does not get any more fuel, being without fuel, it is reckoned as extinguished. Similarly, the enlightened being has abandoned the five aggregates by which one might describe him…he is liberated from reckoning in terms of the five aggregates, he is profound, immeasurable, unfathomable like the ocean” (M.I.487-8).

b. Eternalism, Nihilism, and the Middle Way

There are three possible interpretations of the simile of the extinct fire: (1) liberated beings no longer exist beyond death (2) liberated beings exist in a mysterious unfathomable way beyond death (3) the Buddha is silent about both the liberated being and nirvana after death. The first interpretation seems the most logical conclusion given the Buddha’s ontology of suffering and the doctrine of non-self. However, the nihilist interpretation makes Buddhist practice meaningless and contradicts texts where the Buddha criticizes teachings not conducive to spiritual practice such as materialism and determinism (M.I.401ff). But more importantly, the nihilist interpretation is vehemently rejected in the Pāli Nikāyas: “As I am not, as I do not proclaim, so have I been baselessly, vainly, falsely, and wrongly misrepresented by some ascetics and brahmins thus: ‘the ascetic Gotama [Buddha] is one who leads astray; he teaches the annihilation, the destruction, the extermination of an existing being’ ”(M.I.140).

The second interpretation appears to some as following from the Buddha’s incontrovertible response to the nihilist reading of his teachings: since the Buddha rejects nihilism, he must somehow accept the eternal existence of liberated beings, or at least the eternal existence of nirvana. For eternalist interpreters, the texts in the Pāli Nikāyas that speak about the transcendence and ineffability of liberated beings and nirvana can be understood as implying their existence after or beyond death.

There are several eternalist readings of the Buddha’s thought. We have already mentioned the most common: the doctrine of non-self merely states that the five aggregates are not the true self, which is the transcendent and ineffable domain of nirvana. However, there are eternalist interpretations within Buddhism too. That is, interpretations that are nominally consistent with the doctrine of non-self but that nevertheless speak of something as eternally existing: either the mind of liberated beings or nirvana. For instance, Theravāda Buddhists usually see nirvana as non-self, but at the same time as an unconditioned (asaṃkhata) and deathless (amata) reality. The assumption, though rarely stated, is that liberated beings dwell eternally in nirvana without a sense of “I” and “mine,” which is a transcendent state beyond the comprehension of unenlightened beings. Another eternalist interpretation is that of the Dalai Lama who, following the standard interpretation of Tibetan Buddhists, claims that the Buddha did not teach the cessation of all aggregates but only of contaminated aggregates. That is, the uncontaminated aggregates of liberated beings continue to exist individually beyond death, though they are seen as impermanent, dependently arisen, non-self, and empty of inherent existence (Dalai Lama 1975:27). Similarly, Peter Harvey understands nirvana as a selfless and objectless state of consciousness different from the five aggregates that exists temporarily during life and eternally beyond death (1995: 186-7).

The problem with eternalist interpretations is that they contradict what the Pāli Nikāyas say explicitly about the way to consider liberated beings, the limits of language, the content of the Buddha’s teachings, and dependent arising as a middle way between the extremes of eternalism and annihilationism. In (S.III.110ff), Sāriputta, the Buddha’s leading disciple in doctrinal matters, explains that liberated beings should be considered neither as annihilated after death nor as existing without the five aggregates.

In (D.II.63-4) the Buddha makes clear that consciousness and mentality-materiality, that is, the five aggregates, are the limits of designation (adhivacana), language (nirutti), cognitions (viññatti), and understanding (paññā). Accordingly, in (D.II.68) the Buddha says it is inadequate to state that the liberated being exists after death, does not exist, both, or neither. This reading is confirmed by (Sn 1076): “There is not measure (pamāṇa) of one who has gone out, that by which [others] might speak (vajju) of him does not exist. When all things have been removed, then all ways of speech (vādapathā) are also removed.”

Given the Buddha’s understanding of the limits of language and understanding in the Pāli Nikāyas, it is not surprising that he responded to the accusation of teaching the annihilation of beings, by saying that “formerly and now I only teach suffering and the cessation of suffering.” Since the Buddha does not teach anything beyond the cessation of suffering at the moment of death, that is, beyond the limits of language and understanding, it is inaccurate to accuse him of teaching the annihilation of beings. Similarly, stating that liberated beings exist after death in a mysterious way beyond the four logical possibilities of existence, non-existence, both or neither, is explicitly rejected in (S.III.118-9) and (S.IV.384), where once again the Buddha concludes that he only makes known suffering and the cessation of suffering.

If the eternalist interpretation were correct, it would have been unnecessary for the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas to put so much emphasis on the teaching of dependent arising. Why would dependent arising be defined in (S.II.17) as right view and as the middle way between the extremes of eternalism and annihilationism if the truth were that the consciousness of liberated beings or the unconditioned nirvana exist eternally? If knowing and seeing dependent arising precludes someone from speculating about a permanent self in the past and the future (M.I.265), why would the Buddha teach anything about the eternal existence of liberated beings and nirvana?

In order to avoid the aforementioned contradictions entailed by eternalist readings of the Pāli Nikāyas, all texts about nirvana and the consciousness of liberated beings are to be understood as referring to this life or the moment of death, never to some mysterious consciousness or domain that exists beyond death. Since none of the texts about nirvana and liberated beings found in the Pāli Nikāyas refer unambiguously to their eternal existence beyond death, I interpret the Buddha as being absolutely silent about nirvana and liberated beings beyond death (Vélez de Cea 2004a). In other words, nothing of what the Pāli Nikāyas say goes beyond the limits of language and understanding, beyond the content of the Buddha’s teachings, and beyond dependent arising as the middle way between eternalism and annihilationism.

Instead of focusing on nirvana and liberated beings beyond death, the Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas emphasizes dependent arising and the practice of the four foundations of mindfulness. Dependent arising is intended to avoid views about a permanent and independent self in the past and the future (M.I.265; M.III.196ff), and the four foundations of mindfulness are said to be taught precisely to destroy such views (D.III.141). That is, the Buddha’s fundamental concern is to address the problem of suffering in the present without being distracted by views about the past or the future: “Let not a person revive the past, or on the future build his hopes; for the past has been left behind and the future has not been reached. Instead with insight let him see each presently arising state (paccuppannañca yo dhammaṃ tattha tattha vipassati); let him know that and be sure of it, invincibly, unshakeably. Today the effort must be made, tomorrow death may come, who knows?” (Bhikkhu Bodhi’s translation. M.III.193).

5. Buddhist Ethics

Early Buddhist ethics includes more than lists of precepts and more than the section on ethical training of the eightfold noble path; that is, Buddhist ethics cannot be reduced to right action (abstaining from killing, stealing, lying), right speech (abstaining from false, divisive, harsh, and useless speech), and right livelihood (abstaining from professions that harm living beings). Besides bodily and verbal actions, the Pāli Nikāyas discuss a variety of mental actions including thoughts, motivations, emotions, and perspectives. In fact, it is the ethics of mental actions that constitutes the main concern of the Buddha’s teaching.

Early Buddhist ethics encompasses the entire spiritual path, that is, bodily, verbal, and mental actions. The factors of the eightfold noble path dealing with wisdom and concentration (right view, right intentions, rights effort, right concentration, right mindfulness) relate to different types of mental actions. The term “right” (sammā) in this context does not mean the opposite of “wrong,” but rather “perfect” or “complete;” that is, it denotes the best or the most effective actions to attain liberation. This, however, does not imply that the Buddha advocates the most perfect form of ethical conduct for all his disciples.

Early Buddhist ethics is gradualist in the sense that there are diverse ways of practicing the path with several degrees of commitment; not all disciples are expected to practice Buddhist ethics with the same intensity. Monks and nuns take more precepts and are supposed to devote more time to spiritual practices than householders. However, a complete monastic code (prātimoka) like those found in later Vinaya literature does not appear in the Pāli Nikāyas. The most comprehensive formulation of early Buddhist ethics, probably common to monastic disciples and lay people, is the list of ten dark or unwholesome actions and their opposite, the ten bright or wholesome actions: three bodily actions (abstaining from killing, stealing, sexual misconduct), four verbal actions (abstaining from false, divisive, harsh, and useless speech), and tree mental actions (abstaining from covetousness, ill-will, and dogmatic views).

The Buddha of the Pāli Nikāyas defines action in terms of intention or choice (cetanā): “It is intention, monks, what I call action. Having intended, someone acts through body, speech, and mind” (A.III.415). The Pāli Nikāyas define the roots of unwholesome (akusala) actions as greed (lobha), aversion (dosa), and delusion (moha). Conversely, the roots of wholesome actions are defined as the opposite mental states (M.I.47). Some scholars infer from these two definitions that Buddhist ethics is an ethics of intention or an agent-based form of virtue ethics. That is, according to these scholars, for the Buddha of the the Pāli Nikāyas, only the agent’s intention or motivation determine the goodness of actions. This interpretation, however, is disproved by many texts of the Pāli Nikāyas where good and evil actions are discussed without any reference to the underlying intention or motivation of the agent. Consequently, the more comprehensive account understands intention not as the only factor that determines the goodness of actions, but rather as the condition of possibility, the necessary condition for speaking about action in the moral sense. Without intention or choice, there is no ethical action. Similarly, motivation, while a central moral factor in Buddhist ethics, is neither the only factor nor always the most important factor to determine the goodness of actions. Understanding Buddhist ethics as concerned exclusively with the three roots of the wholesome does not fully capture the breath of moral concern of the Pāli Nikāyas (Vélez de Cea 2004b).

The fundamental moral law of the universe according to early Buddhism is what is popularly called the “law of karma”: good actions produce good consequences, and bad actions lead to bad consequences. The consequences of volitional actions can be experienced in this life or in subsequent lives. Although not everything we experience is due to past actions, physical appearance, character, lifespan, prosperity, and rebirth destination are believed to be influenced by past actions. This influence however, is not to be confused with fatalism, a position rejected in the Pāli Nikāyas. There is always room for mitigating and even eradicating the negative consequences of past actions with new volitions in the present. That is, past karma does not dictate our situation: the existence of freewill and the possibility of changing our predicament is always assumed. There is conditioning of the will and other mental factors, but no hard determinism.

A common objection to early Buddhist ethics is how there can be freewill and responsibility without a permanent self that transmigrates through lives. If there is no self, who is the agent of actions? Who experiences the consequences of actions? Is the person who performs an action in this life the same person that experiences the consequences of that action in a future life? Is it a different person? The Buddha considers these questions improper of his disciples, who are trained to explain things in terms of causes and condition (S.II.61ff; S.II.13ff)). In other words, since the Buddha’s disciples explain processes with the doctrine of dependent arising, they should avoid explanations that use personal terms and presuppose the extremes of eternalism and nihilism. The moral agent is not a substance-self but rather the five aggregates, a dynamic and dependently-arisen process-self who, like a flame or the water of a river, changes all the time and yet has some degree of continuity.

The most common interpretations of early Buddhist ethics view its nature as either a form of agent-based virtue ethics or as a sophisticated kind of consequentialism. The concern for virtue cultivation is certainly prevalent in early Buddhism, and evidently the internal mental state or motivation underlying actions is extremely important to determine the overall goodness of actions, which is the most important factor for advanced practitioners. Similarly, the concern for the consequences of actions, whether or not they lead to the happiness or the suffering of oneself and others, also pervades the Pāli Nikāyas. However, the goodness of actions in the Pāli Nikāyas does not depend exclusively on either the goodness of motivations or the goodness of consequences. Respect to status and duty, observance of rules and precepts, as well as the intrinsic goodness of certain external bodily and verbal actions are equally necessary to assess the goodness of at least certain actions. Since the foundations of right action in the Pāli Nikāyas are irreducible to one overarching principle, value or criterion of goodness, early Buddhist ethics is pluralistic in a metaethical sense. Given the unique combination of deontological, consequentialist, and virtue ethical trends found in the Pāli Nikāyas, early Buddhist ethics should be understood in its own terms as a sui generis normative theory inassimilable to Western ethical traditions.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

All references to the Pāli Nikāyas are to the edition of The Pāli Text Society, Oxford. References to the Aṅguttara, Dīgha, Majjhima, and Saṃyutta Nikāyas are to the volume and page number. References to Udāna and Itivuttaka are to the page number and to Dhammapada and Sutta Nipāta to the verse number.

A. Aṅguttara Nikāya

D. Dīgha Nikāya

M. Majjhima Nikāya

S. Saṃyutta Nikāya

Ud. Udāna

It. Itivuttaka

Dhp. Dhammapada

Sn. Sutta Nipāta

b. Secondary Sources

Bechert, H. (Ed) 1995. When Did the Buddha Live? The Controversy on the Dating of the Historical Buddha. Selected Papers Based on a Symposium Held under the Auspices of the Academy of Sciences in Göttingen. Delhi: Sri Satguru Publications. 1995.
Bhattacharya, K. 1973. L´Ātman-Brahman dans le Bouddhisme Ancien. París: EFEO.
Bhikkhu Ñānamoli and Bhikkhu Bodhi. 1995. The Middle Length Discourses of the Buddha. A New Translation of the Majjhima Nikāya. Kandy: Buddhist Publication Society.
Bhikkhu Ñāṇananda. 1971. Concept and Reality in Early Buddhist Thought. Kandy: Buddhist Publication Society.
Cousins, L.S. 1996. “Good or Skillful? Kusala in Canon and Commentary.” Journal of Buddhist Ethics.Vol. 3: 133-164.
Collins, S. 1982. Selfless Persons. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Collins, S. 1994. “What are Buddhists Doing When They Deny the Self?” In Religion and Practical Reason, edited by Frank E. Reynolds and David Tracy. Albany: SUNY.
Collins, S. 1998. Nirvana and other Buddhist Felicities. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press
Dalai Lama. 1994. The Way to Freedom. San Francisco: Harper.
Dharmasiri, G. 1996. Fundamentals of Buddhist Ethics. Singapore: Buddhist Research Society.
Fuller, P. 2005. The Notion of Diṭṭhi in Theravāda Buddhism. London: RoutledgeCurzon.
Gombrich, R. 1988. Theravāda Buddhism: A Social History from Ancient Benares to Modern Colombo. London: Routledge.
Gombrich, R. 1996. How Buddhism Began. London: Athlone.
Gethin, R. 2001. The Buddhist Path to Awakening. Richmon Surrey: Curzon Press.
Gowans, C. W. 2003. Philosophy of the Buddha. London: Routledge.
Hallisey, C. 1996. “Ethical Particularism in Theravāda Buddhism.” Journal of Buddhist Ethics. Vol. 3: 32-34.
Hamilton, S. 2000. Early Buddhism: A New Approach. Richmon Surrey: Curzon Press.
Harvey, P. 1995. The Selfless Mind: Personality, Consciousness, and Nirvana in Early Buddhism. Richmon Surrey: Curzon Press.
Harvey, P. 1995. “Criteria for Judging the Unwholesomeness of Actions in the Texts of Theravāda Buddhism.” Journal of Buddhist Ethics. Vol. 2: 140-151.
Harvey, P. 2000. An Introduction to Buddhist Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Hoffman, F. J. 1987. Rationality and Mind in Early Buddhism. New Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
Hwang, S. 2006. Metaphor and Literalism in Buddhism: The Doctrinal History of Nirvana. London: RoutledgeCurzon.
Jayatilleke, K. N. 1963. Early Buddhist Theory of Knowledge. London: Allen & Unwin.
Johansson, R. 1969. The Psychology of Nirvana. London: Allen and Unwin Ltd.
Kalupahana, D. 1976. Buddhist Philosophy: A Historical Analysis. Honolulu: University Press of Hawai’i.
Kalupahana, D. 1992. A History of Buddhist Philosophy: Continuities and Discontinuities. Honolulu: University Press of Hawai’i.
Keown, D. 1992. The Nature of Buddhist Ethics. New York: Palgrave.
Norman, K. R. 1983. Pāli Literature: Including the Canonical Literature in Prakrit and Sanskrit of all the Hīnayāna schools of Buddhism. Wiesbaden: Otto Harrassowitz.
Norman, K. R. 1990-6. Collected Papers. Oxford: The Pāli Text Society.
Pande, G.C. 1995. Studies in the Origins of Buddhism. New Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
Pérez-Remón, J. 1980. Self and Non-Self in Early Buddhism. New York: Mouton.
Perret, R. 1986. “Egoism, Altruism, and Intentionalism in Buddhist Ethics.” Journal of IndianPhilosophy. Vol. 15: 71-85.
Premasiri, P. D. 1987. “Early Buddhist Concept of Ethical Knowledge: A Philosophical Analysis.” Kalupahana, D.J. and Weeraratne, W.G. eds. Buddhist Philosophy and Culture: Essays in Honor of N.A. Jayawickrema. Colombo: N.A. Jayawickrema Felicitation Volume Committee. Pp. 37-70.
Ronkin, N. 2005. Early Buddhist Metaphysics: The Making of a Philosophical Tradition. London: RoutledgeCurzon.
Tilakaratne, A. 1993. Nirvana and Ineffability: A Study of the Buddhist Theory of Reality and Languague. Colombo: Karunaratne and Sons.
Vélez de Cea , A. 2004 a. “The Silence of the Buddha and the Questions about the Tathāgata after Death.” The Indian International Journal of Buddhist Studies, no 5.
Vélez de Cea , A. 2004 b. “The Early Buddhist Criteria of Goodness and the Nature of Buddhist Ethics.”Journal of Buddhist Ethics 11, pp.123-142.
Vélez de Cea , A. 2005. “Emptiness in the Pāli Suttas and the Question of Nāgārjuna’s Orthodoxy.”Philosophy East and West. Vol. 55: 4.
Webster, D. 2005. The Philosophy of Desire in the Pali Canon. London: RoutledgeCurzon.

See also the Encylopedia articles on Madhyamaka Buddhism and Pudgalavada Buddhism.

Author Information

Abraham Velez
Email: abraham.velez@eku.edu
Eastern Kentucky University
U. S. A.

Evolutionary Psychology

In its broad sense, the term “evolutionary psychology” stands for any attempt to adopt an evolutionary perspective on human behavior by supplementing psychology with the central tenets of evolutionary biology. The underlying idea is that since our mind is the way it is at least in part because of our evolutionary past, evolutionary theory can aid our understanding not only of the human body, but also of the human mind. In this broad sense, evolutionary psychology is a general field of inquiry that includes such diverse approaches as human behavioral ecology, memetics, dual-inheritance theory, and Evolutionary Psychology in the narrow sense.

The latter is a narrowly circumscribed adaptationist research program which regards the human mind as an integrated collection of cognitive mechanisms that guide our behavior and form our universal human nature. These cognitive mechanisms are supposed to be adaptations—the result of evolution by natural selection, that is, heritable variation in fitness. Adaptations are traits present today because in the past they helped our ancestors to solve recurrent adaptive problems. In particular, Evolutionary Psychology is interested in those adaptations that have evolved in response to characteristically human adaptive problems that have shaped our ancestors’ lifestyle as hunter-gatherers during our evolutionary past in the Pleistocence, like choosing and securing a mate, recognizing emotional expressions, acquiring a language, distinguishing kin from non-kin, detecting cheaters or remembering the location of edible plants. The purpose of Evolutionary Psychology is to discover and explain these cognitive mechanisms that guide current human behavior because they have been selected for as solutions to the recurrent adaptive problems prevalent in the evolutionary environment of our ancestors.

Evolutionary Psychology thus rests on a couple of key arguments and ideas: (1) The claim that the cognitive mechanisms that are underlying our behavior are adaptations. (2) The idea that they cannot be studied directly, for example, through observation of the brain or our overt behavior, but have to be discovered by means of a method known as “functional analysis,” where one starts with hypotheses about the adaptive problems faced by our ancestors, and then tries to infer the cognitive adaptations that must have evolved to solve them. (3) The claim that these cognitive mechanisms are adaptations not for solving problems prevalent in our modern environment, but for solving recurrent adaptive problems in the evolutionary environment of our ancestors. (4) The idea that our mind is a complex set of such cognitive mechanisms, or domain-specific modules. (5) The claim that these modules define who we are, in the sense that they define our universal human nature and ultimately trump any individual, cultural or societal differences.

Historic and Systematic Roots
Key Concepts and Arguments
Examples of Empirical Research
Problems and Objections
Evolutionary Approaches to Mind, Culture, and Behavior: Alternatives to Evolutionary Psychology
References and Further Reading
1. Suggested Further Reading
2. Other Referenced Works

1. Historic and Systematic Roots

Modern Evolutionary Psychology has its roots in the late 1980s and early 1990s, when psychologist Leda Cosmides and anthropologist John Tooby from Harvard joined the anthropologist Donald Symons at The University of California, Santa Barbara (UCSB) where they currently co-direct the Center for Evolutionary Psychology. It gained wide attention in 1992 with the publication of the landmark volume The Adapted Mind by Jerome Barkow, Leda Cosmides and John Tooby, and since then numerous textbooks (for example, Buss 1999) and popular presentations (for example, Pinker 1997, 2002; Wright 1994) have appeared. These days, Evolutionary Psychology is a powerful research program that has generated some interesting research, but it has also sparked a heated debate about its aspirations and limitations (see, for example, Rose and Rose 2000).

Evolutionary Psychology is effectively a theory about How the Mind Works (Pinker 1997). The human mind is not an all-purpose problem solver relying on a limited number of general principles that are universally applied to all problems—a view that dominated early artificial intelligence (AI) and behaviorism (for example, Skinner 1938, 1957). (For the idea of an all-purpose problem solver see, for example, Newell and Simon 1972; for some of the earliest AI work related to this idea see, for example, Newell and Simon 1961, Newell et al. 1958.) Rather, the human mind is a collection of independent, task-specific cognitive mechanisms, a collection of instincts adapted for solving evolutionary significant problems. The human mind is sort of a Swiss Army knife (Pinker 1994). This conception of the mind is based on three important ideas adopted from other disciplines (Cosmides and Tooby 2003, 54; Samuels 1998, 577): the computational model of the mind, the assumption of modularity, and the thesis of adaptationism.

a. The Computational Model of the Mind

Following the development of modern logic (Boole 1847; Frege 1879) and the formalization of the notion of computation (Turing 1936), early AI construed logical operations as mechanically executable information processing routines. Eventually, this led to the idea that mental processes (for example, reasoning) and mental states (for example, beliefs and desires) may themselves also be analyzable in purely syntactic terms. The “Computational Theory of Mind,” developed by philosophers like Hilary Putnam (1963) and Jerry Fodor (1975, 1981), for instance, conceives of mental states as relations between a thinker and symbolic representations of the content of the states, and of mental processes as formal operations on the syntactic features of those representations.

Evolutionary Psychology endorses the computational model of the mind as an information processing system or a formal symbol manipulator and thus treats the mind as a collection of “computational machines” (Cosmides and Tooby 2003, 54) or “information-processing mechanisms” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990a, 21) that receive input from the environment and produce behavior or physiological changes as output. To this, it adds an evolutionary perspective: “The evolutionary function of the human brain is to process information in ways that lead to adaptive behavior; the mind is a description of the operation of a brain that maps informational input onto behavioral output” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 282). The brain is thus not just like a computer. “It is a computer—that is, a physical system that was designed to process information” (Tooby and Cosmides 2005, 16; italics added).

The Computational Model of the Mind: The human mind is an information processing system, physically realized in the brain, and can be described at a computational level as a device whose evolutionary function is to process information by mapping informational input onto behavioral output.

b. The Modularity of Mind

Early attempts at simulating human intelligence revealed that artificial cognitive systems that are not already equipped with a fair amount of “innate knowledge” about a particular problem domain are unable to solve even the easiest problems (see, for example, the idea of “scripts” in Schank and Abelson 1977). In the 1970s and 1980s, the work of scientists like Noam Chomsky, Jerry Fodor, or David Marr further undermined the idea of the mind as a “blank slate” which acquires knowledge about the world by means of only a couple of general learning mechanisms. Their findings suggested instead that the mind incorporates a number of cognitive subsystems that are triggered only by a certain kind of input. While Marr (1982) was working on the neuroscience of vision, Chomsky famously criticized the behaviorist idea that language acquisition is just an ordinary kind of learning that follows the stimulus-response model by proving the intractability of some learning algorithms (see, for example, his 1959 review of Skinner’s Verbal Behavior or Chomsky 1957; for a later statement of similar ideas see Chomsky 1975). According to his “Poverty of the Stimulus” argument, a child cannot learn her first language through observation because the available stimuli (that is, the utterances of adult speakers) neither enable her to produce grammatically correct nor prevent her from producing grammatically incorrect sentences. Instead, Chomsky argued, we possess a “language acquisition device” which, rather than extracting all information from the world through some general mechanism, comes already equipped with a certain amount of “innate knowledge.” Just as our body contains a number of innate, genetically predisposed organs that serve a specific function, our mind also contains a number of information processing systems (like the language acquisition device), so called mental organs or modules in Fodor’s (1983) terminology, that are designed to perform a particular cognitive function.

The model of the mind as a general learning mechanism that is indiscriminately applied to any problem domain was also disconfirmed in other areas of cognitive science. Garcia and Koelling (1966) showed that while rats can learn some associations by means of stimulus-response mechanisms, others, albeit structurally similar, cannot be learned at all, or only much slower: rats that are given food that makes them nauseous subsequently avoid that kind of food, but they are unable to learn an association between a sound or a light and feeling nauseous. Galef (1990) demonstrated that rats readily eat a new kind of food if they smell it at another rat’s mouth, but not if they smell it at another part of the body. Mineka and Cook (1988) showed that a laboratory raised monkey that initially did not show fear of snakes started to do so once he observed another monkey exhibiting fear of snakes; yet, he didn’t start to show fear of flowers when observing the other doing so. Comparable “learning biases” have been found for humans in various areas (for example, Cook et al. 1986; Marks and Nesse 1994; Seligman and Hagar 1972).

Evolutionary Psychologists conclude that the assumption that the human mind is composed mainly of a few content-free cognitive processes that are “thought to govern how one acquires a language and a gender identity, an aversion to incest and an appreciation for vistas, a desire for friends and a fear of spiders—indeed, nearly every thought and feeling of which humans are capable” (Ermer et al. 2007, 155) is inadequate. Such mechanisms would be “limited to knowing what can be validly derived by general processes from perceptual information” (Cosmides and Tooby 1994, 92) and thus incapable of efficiently solving adaptive problems (see section 2d). Instead, Evolutionary Psychologists claim, “our cognitive architecture resembles a confederation of hundreds or thousands of functionally dedicated computers” (Tooby and Cosmides 1995, xiii), the so-called “modules”:

Modularity: The mind consists of a (possibly large) number of domain-specific, innately specified cognitive subsystems, called “modules.”

c. Adaptationism

Since cognitive mechanisms are not directly observable, studying them requires some indirect way of discovering them (see section 2b). Evolutionary Psychologists adopt the kind of adaptationist reasoning well known from evolutionary biology that also characterizes many works in sociobiology (Wilson 1975). Ever since Charles Darwin (1859/1964) proposed his theory of evolution by natural selection, evolutionary biologists quite successfully offer adaptationist explanations of physiological features of living things that explain the presence of a trait by claiming that it is an adaptation, that is, a trait current organisms possess because it enhanced their ancestors’ fitness. During the 1970s, sociobiologists argued that “social behaviors [too] are shaped by natural selection” (Lumsden and Wilson 1981, 99; for the original manifesto of sociobiology see Wilson 1975) and started to seek adaptationist explanations for cognitive, cultural, and social traits, like the ability to behave altruistically, different mating preferences in males and females, or the frequently observed parent-offspring conflicts.

Evolutionary Psychologists have inherited sociobiology’s adaptationist program: “The core idea … is that many psychological characteristics are adaptations—just as many physical characteristics are—and that the principles of evolutionary biology that are used to explain our bodies are equally applicable to our minds” (Durrant and Ellis 2003, 5). Our mind, they argue, is a complex, functionally integrated collection of cognitive mechanisms, and since the only known natural process that can bring about such functional complexity is evolution by natural selection (Cosmides and Tooby 1991, 493; Symons 1987, 126; Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 382), these cognitive mechanisms are likely to be adaptations to the adaptive problems of our ancestors. This, Evolutionary Psychologists hold, intimately links psychology with evolutionary theory: “Because the architecture of the human mind acquired its functional organization through the evolutionary process, theories of adaptive function are the logical foundation on which to build theories of the design of cognitive mechanisms” (Ermer et al. 2007, 153–4). While evolutionary theory is used to describe the relevant ancestral problems and to make educated guesses about the information processing cognitive mechanisms that have been shaped by natural selection in response, the task of psychology is to establish that current humans actually possess these mechanisms (see section 2b).

Adaptationism: The human mind, like any other complex feature, was shaped by a process of evolution through natural selection. Its subsystems, the modules, are adaptations for solving recurrent information processing problems that arose in our ancestors’ evolutionary environment.

2. Key Concepts and Arguments

According to Evolutionary Psychology, the human mind is a set of cognitive adaptations designed by natural selection. Since such design takes time, the adaptive problems that shaped our mind are not the ones we know from our life as industrialists during the past 200 years, or from our life as agriculturalists during the past 10,000 years, but those characteristic of our past life as hunter-gatherers. Since these problems varied considerably, the human mind contains many problem-specific adaptations. The task of Evolutionary Psychology is to discover these modules by means of what is called a “functional analysis,” where one starts with hypotheses about the adaptive problems faced by our ancestors, and then tries to infer the cognitive adaptations that must have evolved to solve them.

This theoretical framework of Evolutionary Psychology centers on a couple of key ideas which will be explained in this section: (1) The cognitive mechanisms that underlie our behavior are adaptations. (2) They have to be discovered by means of functional analysis. (3) They are adaptations for solving recurrent adaptive problems in the evolutionary environment of our ancestors. (4) Our mind is a complex set of such mechanisms, or domain-specific modules. (5) These modules define our universal human nature.

a. Adaptation and Adaptivity

That our evolutionary history influenced not only our bodies, but also our brains, and thus our minds, is not very controversial. But how exactly has evolution affected the way we are, mind-wise? How exactly can evolutionary theory elucidate the structure and function of the human mind?

It may seem that “behavioral traits are like any other class of characters” (Futuyama 1998, 579), so that they can be subject to natural selection in the same way as physiological traits. In that case, an evolutionary study of human behavior could then proceed by studying behavioral variants and see which of them are adaptive and which selectively neutral or detrimental. However, since natural selection is heritable variation in fitness, it can act only on entities that are transmitted between generations, and behavior as such is not directly transmitted between generations, but only via the genes that code for the proximal cognitive mechanisms that trigger it. Hence, “[t]o speak of natural selection as selecting for ‘behaviors’ is a convenient shorthand, but it is misleading usage. … Natural selection cannot select for behavior per se; it can only select for mechanisms that produce behavior” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 281).

Hence, an evolutionary approach to human psychology must proceed by studying the cognitive mechanisms that underlie our behavior: “In the rush to apply evolutionary insights to a science of human behavior, many researchers have made a conceptual ‘wrong turn,’ … [which] has consisted of attempting to apply evolutionary theory directly to the level of manifest behavior, rather than using it as a heuristic guide for the discovery of innate psychological mechanisms” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 278–9). By sharply distinguishing between adaptive behavior and the cognitive mechanisms that are adaptations for producing adaptive behavior, Evolutionary Psychologists provide “the missing link between evolutionary theory and manifest behavior” (Tooby and Cosmides 1989, 37). [The drawback is that things become more complicated since “it is less easy to sustain claims that a trait is a product of natural selection than claims that it confers reproductive benefits on individuals in contemporary populations” (Caro and Borgerhoff Mulder 1987, 66). Section 2b shows how Evolutionary Psychologists try to cope with this difficulty, and section 5a discusses a version of evolutionary psychology that focuses on adaptive behavior.]

We quite often do things detrimental to survival and reproduction (we use contraceptives, consume unhealthy doses of fatty food, and blow ourselves up in the middle of crowded market places). We also willfully refrain from doing things that would be conducive to survival (buy some healthy food, exercise) or boost our potential for reproduction (donate our sperm or eggs to cryobanks). If Evolutionary Psychology is right that our mind contains cognitive mechanisms that are adaptations for producing adaptive behavior, then why are we behaving maladaptively so often?

The claim that the brain is an adaptation for producing adaptive behavior does not entail that it is currently producing adaptive behavior. Adaptations are traits that are present today because of the selective advantage they offered in the past, and the past environment arguably differed notably from the current one. The modern metropolis in which we live in unprecedented large groups, consume fast food and use contraceptives is not even 100 years old, and even agriculture arose only some 10,000 years ago. Compared to this, our ancestors spent an unimaginably long time in Pleistocene conditions (roughly, the period spanning 1.8 million years ago to 10,000 years ago) living in small nomadic hunter-gatherer bands. The cognitive mechanisms produced by natural selection are adaptations for producing adaptive behavior in these circumstances, not for playing chess, passing logic exams, navigating through lower Manhattan, or keeping ideal weight in an environment full of fast food restaurants. [Which is why we are so bad at these things: “it is highly unlikely that the cognitive architecture of the human mind includes procedures that are dedicated to solving any of these problems: The ability to solve them would not have enhanced the survival or reproduction of the average Pleistocene hunter-gatherer” and hence “the performance of modern humans on such tasks is generally poor and uneven” (Cosmides and Tooby 1994, 95).]

Among the day-to-day problems of our ancestors that shaped the human mind are: “giving birth, winning social support from band members, remembering the locations of edible plants, hitting game animals with projectiles, …, recognizing emotional expressions, protecting family members, maintaining mating relationships, …, assessing the character of self and others, causing impregnation, acquiring language, maintaining friendships, thwarting antagonists, and so on” (Cosmides and Tooby 2003, 59). In these areas, we still behave the way we do because our behavior is guided by cognitive mechanisms that have been selected for because they produced behavior that was adaptive in our ancestors’ evolutionary environment. As Evolutionary Psychologists colorfully put it: “Our modern skulls house a Stone Age mind” (Cosmides and Tooby 1997, 85).

It is thus crucial to distinguish between a trait’s being an adaptation and its being adaptive. A trait is an adaptation if it was “designed” by natural selection to solve the specific problems posed by the regularities of the physical, chemical, ecological, informational, and social environments encountered by the ancestors of a species during the course of its evolution” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 383), while a trait is adaptive if it currently enhances its bearer’s fitness. Since the environment in which a trait was selected for may differ from the current one, “[t]he hypothesis that a trait is an adaptation does not imply that the trait is currently adaptive” (Symons 1990, 430). But if cognitive adaptations can neither be discovered in the brain, nor by observing current human behavior, how can they be studied?

b. Functional Analysis

Verifying the claim that a trait is an adaptation is difficult because this is essentially a historical claim. A trait is an adaptation because it was adaptive in the past, and it is unclear what the past was like, let alone what would have been adaptive under past conditions. According to Evolutionary Psychology, however, it is possible to verify adaptationist claims:

Researchers can identify an aspect of an organism’s physical, developmental, or psychological structure … as an adaptation by showing that (1) it has many design features that are improbably well suited to solving an ancestral adaptive problem, (2) these phenotypic properties are unlikely to have arisen by chance alone, and (3) they are not better explained as the by-product of mechanisms designed to solve some alternative adaptive problem or some more inclusive class of adaptive problem. Finding that a reliably developing feature of the species’ architecture solves an adaptive problem with reliability, precision, efficiency, and economy is prima facie evidence that an adaptation has been located. (Tooby and Cosmides 2005, 28)

What Tooby and Cosmides suggest is a procedure known as functional analysis. One uses evolutionary reasoning to identify the adaptive problems our ancestors presumably awaited in their evolutionary environment, infers from this the cognitive mechanisms that one thinks must have evolved to solve these problems, conducts psychological experiments to show that they are actually found in current human beings, and rules out alternative explanations.

A bit more precisely, identifying adaptations by means of functional analysis proceeds in six steps (Tooby and Cosmides 1989, 40–1):

Step 1 uses evolutionary considerations to formulate a model of the past adaptive problems the human mind had to solve.

Step 2 generates hypotheses about exactly how these problems would have manifested themselves under the selection pressures present in the evolutionary environment of our ancestors.

Step 3 formulates a “computational theory” that specifies “a catalog of the specific information processing problems” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 289) that had to be solved to overcome the adaptive problems identified in step 2.

Step 4 uses the computational theory “as a heuristic for generating testable hypotheses about the structure of the cognitive programs that solve the adaptive problems in question” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 302).

Step 5 rules out alternative accounts of the cognitive mechanisms in question that do not treat them as the result of evolution by natural selection.

Step 6 tests the adaptationist hypotheses by checking whether modern Homo sapiens indeed possess the cognitive mechanisms postulated in step 4. If this test is successful, Evolutionary Psychologists contend, it is quite likely that the cognitive mechanisms are indeed adaptations for solving the problems identified in step 1. (For examples of empirical research that, by and large, follow this theoretical framework, see section 3.)

(One may add a seventh step which tries to discover the neural basis of the cognitive mechanisms, so that eventually theories of adaptive problems guide the search for the cognitive mechanisms that solve them, while knowing what cognitive mechanisms exist in turn guides the search for their neural basis.)

The procedure of functional analysis shows what sort of evidence would support the claim that a cognitive mechanism is an adaptation for solving a given adaptive problem. However, since functional analysis itself relies on hypotheses about the adaptive problems prevalent in our ancestors’ past, the obvious question is: How can we today know with any certainty which adaptive problems our ancestors faced?

c. The Environment of Evolutionary Adaptedness

Since the “description of ancestral conditions is one indispensable aspect of characterizing an adaptation” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 387), discovering the mind’s modules requires knowing what exactly the environment that Bowlby (1969) calls the environment of evolutionary adaptedness (EEA) looked like. The human EEA consists in the set of environmental conditions encountered by human populations during the Pleistocene (from 1.8 million years ago to 10,000 years ago), when early hominids lived on the savannahs of eastern Africa as hunter-gatherers. Yet, the EEA “is not a place or a habitat, or even a time period. Rather, it is a statistical composite of the adaptation-relevant properties of the ancestral environments encountered by members of ancestral populations, weighted by their frequency and fitness consequences” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 386–7). More specifically, it is a “composite of environmental properties of the most recent segment of a species’ evolution that encompasses the period during which its modern collection of adaptations assumed their present form” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 388). Importantly, “different adaptations will have different EEAs. Some, like language, are firmly anchored in approximately the last two million years; others, such as infant attachment, reflect a much lengthier evolutionary history” (Durrant and Ellis 2003, 10). Speaking about the EEA is thus at least misleading, since strictly speaking one has to distinguish between the EEA of a species and the EEA of particular cognitive adaptations.

There are two crucial questions with regard to the EEA: First, why suppose that our cognitive mechanisms, even if they are adaptations, are adaptations to exactly the problems faced by our ancestors in the EEA? Second, how can we today determine the EEA of a particular adaptation in enough detail?

Evolutionary Psychologists offer two related arguments in response to the first question. The first draws attention to the large amount of time our ancestors spent in Pleistocene conditions compared to the brief stretch of time that has passed since the advent of agriculture or industrialization: “Our species spent over 99% of its evolutionary history as hunter-gatherers in Pleistocene environments. Human psychological mechanisms should be adapted to those environments, not necessarily to the twentieth-century industrialized world” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 280). The second argument maintains that since natural selection is a slow process, there just have not been enough generations for it to design new cognitive mechanisms that are well-adapted to our post-agricultural industrial life: “It is no more plausible to believe that whole new mental organs could evolve since the Pleistocene … than it is to believe that whole new physical organs such as eyes would evolve over brief spans. … [and] major and intricate changes in innately specified information-processing procedures present in human psychological mechanisms do not seem likely to have taken place over brief spans of historical time” (Tooby and Cosmides 1989, 34).

Both arguments seem to suffer from the same difficulty. The 10,000 years that have passed since the Pleistocene correspond to roughly 400 generations, and if the selection pressure and the heritability (roughly, a measure of the response to selection) are high enough, quite a lot can happen in 400 generations. In particular, no one needs to hold that “whole new mental organs could evolve since the Pleistocene.” In order to undermine the claim that we are walking fossils with Stone Age minds in our heads, it is sufficient to show that significant changes can occur within 400 generations. The same observation threatens the first argument: How much time our ancestors spent in one environment as compared to another is completely irrelevant, if the selection pressures in one differ radically from those in the other.

In response to the second question, Evolutionary Psychologists point out that, first, we can be relatively sure that the physical conditions were comparable to the ones today—”an enormous number of factors, from the properties of light to chemical laws to the existence of parasites, have stably endured” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 390)—and, second, we can be relatively certain on paleontological grounds that a great deal of our ancestors spend a great deal of their time on African savannahs as hunter-gatherers. Yet, since it is in response to the social problems faced by our ancestors that our cognitive adaptations are said to have evolved, what matters is not so much the physical environment (which may have stayed constant, by and large) but the social environment, and the question is what we can know with any certainty about the social life of our ancestors, given that social traits do not fossilize.

Evolutionary Psychologists contend that with regard to the social environment little has changed, too: our ancestors arguably had to attract and retain mates, provide care for their children, understand the intentions and emotions of those with whom they engaged in social exchange, and so forth, just as we do. However, such general knowledge about the EEA seems to be of little use, for discovering cognitive adaptations requires formulating a computational theory that provides “a catalog of the specific information processing problems” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 289; italics added), and that goes significantly beyond being told that our ancestors had to find mates, care for children, find food and so forth (for more on this see section 4c).

d. Domain-specificity and Modularity

Empiricism in philosophy, behaviorism in psychology and the rules and representation approach to artificial cognitive systems characteristic of GOFAI (“good old fashioned artificial intelligence”), roughly speaking, shared the belief that our mind contains only a few domain-general cognitive mechanisms that account for everything we can learn, be it speaking and understanding a language, solving algebra equations, playing chess or driving a bike. In contrast, Evolutionary Psychologists insist that “[f]rom an evolutionary perspective, the human cognitive architecture is far more likely to resemble a confederation of hundreds or thousands of functionally dedicated computers … than it is to resemble a single general purpose computer equipped with a small number of domain-general procedures” (Tooby and Cosmides 2000, 1171).

Evolutionary Psychologists have advanced three arguments for this modularity, or massive modularity, hypothesis. In short, a domain-general psychological architecture cannot guide behavior in ways that promote fitness for at least three related reasons:

What counts as fit behavior differs from domain to domain, so there is no domain-general criterion of success or failure that correlates with fitness.
Adaptive courses of action can be neither deduced nor learned by general criteria, because they depend on statistical relationships between features of the environment, behavior, and fitness that emerge over many generations and are, therefore, not observable during a single lifetime.
Combinatorial explosion paralyzes any truly domain-general system when encountering real-world complexity. (Cosmides and Tooby 1994, 91)

Simply put, the idea behind the first argument is that “[t]here is no such thing as a ‘general problem solver’ because there is no such thing as a general problem” (Symons 1992, 142). Our ancestors faced a host of different adaptive problems, and “different adaptive problems frequently have different optimal solutions” (Cosmides and Tooby 1991, 500): what counts as a successful solution to one, say choosing a mate, arguably differs from what counts as a successful solution to another, say choosing nutritious food. Hence, there is no domain-general criterion of success or failure: “A woman who used the same taste preference mechanisms in choosing a mate that she used to choose nutritious foods would choose a very strange mate indeed, and such a design would rapidly select itself out” (Cosmides and Tooby 1994, 90). Hence, because different solutions can be implemented only by different, functionally distinct mechanisms, there must be as many domain-specific subsystems as there are domains in which the definitions of successful behavior differ. “The human mind … is composed of many different programs for the same reason that a carpenter’s toolbox contains many different tools: Different problems require different solutions” (Tooby and Cosmides 2000, 1168). In response to this argument, the critics have pointed out that there is no reason why a cognitive system that relies on a few domain-general mechanisms that are fed with innate domain-specific information should not be as good as a modular cognitive architecture (see, for example, Samuels 1998, 587).

According to the second argument, a domain general decision rule such as “Do that which maximizes your inclusive fitness” cannot efficiently guide behavior because whether or not a behavior is fitness enhancing is something an individual often cannot find out within its own lifetime, given that the fitness impact of a design feature relative to alternative designs “is inherently unobservable at the time the design alternative actually impacts the world, and therefore cannot function as a cue for a decision rule” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990b, 417). As Buss has put it: “the relevant fitness information only becomes known generations later and hence is not accessible to individual actors” (Buss 1995, 10). For instance, whether one should prefer fatty food over vegetables, or whether one should decide to have children with potential partner A or with rival B are behavioral decisions whose impact on one’s fitness clearly cannot be learned empirically at the time these decisions have to be made. While in the former case, it may help to have a look at what others are doing, that strategy is of no avail in the latter case. And even in the former case the appeal to the possibility of learning from others only pushes the problem one step further because “[i]mitation is useless unless those imitated have themselves solved the problem of the adaptive regulation of behavior” (Cosmides and Tooby 1987, 295).

As Ermer et al. (2007) have put the point, the problem for domain-general cognitive architectures is that we are living in “clueless environments”:

Content-free architectures are limited to knowing what can be validly derived by general processes from perceptual information available during an individual’s lifetime. This sharply limits the range of problems they can solve: When the environment is clueless, the mechanism will be, too. Domain-specific mechanisms are not limited in this way. They can be constructed to embody clues that fill in the blanks when perceptual evidence is lacking or difficult to obtain (Ermer et al. 2007, 157).

At this point, a natural question to ask for the critic would be how natural selection is supposed to operate if “relevant fitness information” is indeed not available. As Buss puts it: would the result of a really “clueless environment” not be extinction, rather than adaptation?

Cosmides and Tooby’s third argument for the claim that domain-general systems could not live up to the tasks our mind regularly solves concerns the general computational problems faced by such systems. As they put it, a domain-general architecture “is defined by what it lacks: It lacks any content, either in the form of domain-specific knowledge or domain-specific procedures, that can guide it toward the solution of an adaptive problem” (Cosmides and Tooby 1994, 94). Therefore, they argue, a domain-general system must evaluate all alternatives it can define, and this raises an obvious problem: “Permutations being what they are, alternatives increase exponentially as the problem complexity increases. By the time you analyze any biological problem of routine complexity, a mechanism that contains no domain-specific rules of relevance, procedural knowledge, or privileged hypotheses could not solve the problem in the amount of time the organism has to solve it” (Cosmides and Tooby 1994, 94). Given that a specialization-free architecture contains no rules of relevance, or domain-specialized procedural knowledge, to restrict its search of a problem space, it could not solve any biological problem of routine complexity in time.

These theoretical considerations (see Samuels 1998 and Buller 2005, ch. 4 for criticism), together with the empirical support for the modularity hypothesis that comes from cognitive science (see section 1b), have led Evolutionary Psychologists to the conclusion that “the mind is organized into modules or mental organs, each with a specialized design that makes it an expert in one area of interaction with the world” (Pinker 1997, 21). The mind is a Swiss Army knife containing evolved, functionally specialized computational devices like, for example, “face recognition systems, a language acquisition device, mindreading systems, navigation specializations, animate motion recognition, cheater detection mechanisms, and mechanisms that govern sexual attraction” (Cosmides and Tooby 2003, 63).

Although there can be little doubt that the mind is modular to some extent, it is currently a hotly debated question exactly how modular it is. Is it really massively modular in the sense that it is a collection of hundreds or thousands of modules, or is it modular in a weaker sense (see, for example, the debate between Carruthers 2006, Prinz 2006, and Samuels 2006)? Interestingly, even the most ardent advocates of Evolutionary Psychology have recently acknowledged that “[t]he mind presumably does contain a number of functionally specialized programs that are relatively content-free and domain-general,” but they have insisted that “these can regulate behavior adaptively only if they work in tandem with a bevy of content-rich, domain-specialized ones …” (Ermer et al. 2007, 156; see also Tooby and Cosmides 1998, 200).

e. Human Nature

According to Evolutionary Psychologists, since the modules of which the human mind is made up have been constantly selected for during a vast stretch of time there is ample reason to think that “human universals … exist at the level of the functionally described psychological mechanism” (Tooby and Cosmides 1989, 36; italics added). That is, the modules discovered by functional analysis constitute “an array of psychological mechanisms that is universal among Homo sapiens” (Symons 1992, 139), they are “the psychological universals that constitute human nature” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990a, 19). As a consequence, Evolutionary Psychology has the potential to discover a “human nature [that] is everywhere the same” (Tooby and Cosmides 1992, 38).

Apart from the observation that enough time has passed with constant selection pressures for our cognitive modules virtually being driven to fixation, Cosmides and Tooby have offered two arguments for the universality of our psychological adaptations (see also Buller 2005, 73–4). The first argument is more or less a plausibility argument, according to which since our bodies and our minds are both the result of evolution by natural selection, and our bodies are universal, so should be our minds:

[T]he fact that any given page out of Gray’s Anatomy describes in precise anatomical detail individual humans from around the world demonstrates the pronounced monomorphism present in complex human physiological adaptations. Although we cannot directly ‘see’ psychological adaptations …, no less could be true of them. (Tooby and Cosmides 1992, 38)

The second argument first appeared in Tooby and Cosmides (1990a), has been repeated in Tooby and Cosmides (1992) and is treated by Evolutionary Psychologists as a definite proof of universal panhuman design. In a nutshell, the argument is that since in sexual reproduction a child’s genome is a mixture of its father’s and its mother’s genes, and since cognitive adaptations are complex and thus not coded for by a single gene but require hundreds or thousands of genes to work in concert for their development, “it is improbable that all of the genes necessary for a complex adaptation would be together in the same individual if the genes coding for the components of complex adaptations varied substantially between individuals” (Tooby and Cosmides 1992, 78–9).

If there is a complex series of interdependent adaptations required to produce a sex, a behavioral strategy, or a personality type, there is only one way to ensure the necessary coordination. All of the parts of the genetic programs necessary to build the integrated design must be present when needed in every individual of a given type. The only way that the 50 genes, or 100 genes, or 1,000 genes that may be required to assemble all of the features defining a given type can rely on each other’s mutual presence is that they are all present in every individual. (Tooby and Cosmides 1990a, 45)

Evolutionary Psychologists are thus not claiming that human behavior or culture is the same everywhere. Quite obviously, there is significant behavioral and cultural diversity throughout the world. What they claim is that the genes that are required for our cognitive adaptations to develop, and thus the cognitive adaptations themselves, must be the same all over the world, although, of course, the behavior that results from them may differ (for more on this, see section 4a).

3. Examples of Empirical Research

Evolutionary Psychology has sparked an enormous amount of empirical research covering nearly any imaginable topic, including issues as diverse as language, morality, emotions, parental investment, homicide, social coercion, rape, psychopathologies, landscape preferences, spatial abilities, or pregnancy sickness (see, for example, Buss 1999, 2005; Barkow et al. 1992 for an overview).

For instance, Margie Profet (1992) has argued that pregnancy sickness—a set of symptoms like food aversion, nausea, and vomiting that some women experience during the first three months of pregnancy—is an adaptation for protecting the embryo against maternal ingestion of toxins abundant in natural foods by lowering the typical human threshold of tolerance to toxins during the period of the embryo’s maximum susceptibility to toxins. Irwin Silverman and Marion Eals (1992) have argued that from an evolutionary point of view the male advantage in spatial abilities usually found in psychological experiments does not make sense. Although hunting, the primary task of our male ancestors, clearly required spatial abilities, no less is true of gathering plants, the primary task of our female ancestors. In order to be efficient foragers, our female ancestors must have been able to encode and remember the locations of thousands of different plants. When Silverman and Eals designed spatial tests that measured subjects’ ability to recall the location of items in a complex array or objects in a room, they found that women indeed consistently recalled more objects than men did, and recalled their location more accurately.

David Buss has argued that there are major differences between males and females regarding mate choice and jealousy that are evolved responses to different selection pressures (see, for example, Buss 1992, 1994, 2000; Buss and Schmitt 1993). For instance, he reasoned that because men need to guard against cuckoldry, while women need to guard against losing their mate’s economic resources, men should be concerned more by signs of sexual infidelity than about the loss of their partner’s emotional attachment, while women should be troubled more by cues that signal emotional infidelity than by signs of sexual infidelity. Buss et al. (1992) asked males and females from the USA, Europe and Asia whether they would be more distressed by sexual or emotional infidelity:

Please think of a serious committed romantic relationship that you have had in the past, that you currently have, or that you would like to have. Imagine that you discover that the person with whom you’ve been seriously involved became interested in someone else. What would distress or upset you more (please circle only one):

(A) Imagining your partner forming a deep emotional attachment to that person.

(B) Imagining your partner enjoying passionate sexual intercourse with that other person.

(Buss et al. 1992, 252)

Nowhere did women report sexual infidelity to be more upsetting than men, and on average, 51% of the men, but only 22% of the women chose option B above (for data and critical discussion, see Buller 2005, 316–45). These results have been taken to confirm Buss’ evolutionary hypothesis about sex differences with regard to jealousy (for a dissenting view see, for example, DeSteno and Salovey 1996; Harris and Christenfeld 1996).

The flagship example of Evolutionary Psychology is still Cosmides and Tooby’s work on cheater detection. In the 1960s, the Swedish psychologist Peter Wason devised the so-called “Wason Selection Task” in order to investigate how good subjects are at checking conditional rules (Wason 1966). He gave subjects a rule of the form “If P, then Q” (for example, “If a person goes to Boston, then that person takes the subway”), and showed them four cards. Two of the cards exemplified the P– and not-P-option, respectively (for example, “Boston” and “New York”), and two of them exemplified the Q and not-Q-option, respectively (for example, “subway” and “cab”). The subjects were told that the unseen sides of the P and not-P-cards could contain an instance of either Q or not-Q, and vice versa, and that they should indicate all and only the cards that would definitely have to be turned over in order to determine whether they violated the rule. Since a material conditional is false if and only if its antecedent is true and its consequent is false, the logically correct response would be to pick the P– and the not-Q-card. However, Wason discovered that most subjects choose either only the P-card or the P– and the Q-card, while few choose the P– and the not-Q-card. More importantly, subjects’ performance was apparently influenced by the content of the rules. While 48% correctly solved the Boston/transportation problem, successful performance dropped to less then 25% for the rule “If a person has a ‘D’ rating, then his documents must be marked code ‘3’” (with the options ‘D’, ‘F’, ‘3’, ‘7’), and increased to nearly 75% for the rule “If a person is drinking beer, then he must be over 21 years old” (with the options “drinking beer,” “drinking coke,” “25 years old,” “16 years old”) (Cosmides and Tooby 1992, 182–3). By the 1980s, the psychological literature was full with reports of such “content effects,” but there was no satisfying theory to explain them.

Evolutionary biologists had long been puzzled by our ability to engage in altruistic behavior—behavior an individual A performs for the benefit of another individual B, associated with some significant cost for A (like warning calls, help in raising offspring, saving a drowning child, and so forth). How could a tendency to behave in a way that increases another individual’s fitness at some non-negligible cost to oneself be produced and retained by natural selection? Robert Trivers (1971) argued that altruistic behavior can evolve if it is reciprocal, that is, if A‘s act a has benefit bB for B and cost cA for A, B reciprocates with some act a* with benefit bA for A and cost cB for B, where bA outweighs cA and bB outweighs cB. Interactions that satisfy this cost-benefit structure constitute what is called a “social exchange.” Since in social exchanges both A and B incur a net-benefit, Trivers reasoned, altruistic behavior can evolve. Yet, the problem is that once a propensity for altruistic behavior has evolved, it is obviously better for an individual to cheat by accepting the benefit of an altruistic act without paying the cost of reciprocation. In the long run, this would lead to an increase in the number of cheaters until altruism was driven to extinction. In order for altruism to evolve, Trivers (1971, 48) concluded, natural selection must “favor more acute abilities to detect cheating.”

Cosmides and Tooby saw a connection between the need to detect cheaters in acts of social exchange and the content effect discovered by Wason (Cosmides 1989; Cosmides and Tooby 1989, 1992). Since the ability to test abstract logical rules would not have had any adaptive value in the EEA, we should not expect natural selection to have endowed the human mind with some general conditional reasoning capacity. Rather, natural selection should have designed a module that allows us to detect those who accept the benefit without reciprocating accordingly in situations of social exchange. Consequently, we should be better at testing social contract rules that say “If person A provides the requested benefit to or meets the requirement of person or group B, then B will provide the rationed benefit to A” (Cosmides and Tooby 2000, 1260) than at testing conditional rules that do not describe such conditions.

When Cosmides and Tooby categorized “content effects according to whether they conformed to social contracts, a striking pattern emerged. Robust and replicable content effects were found only for rules that related terms that are recognizable as benefits and cost/requirements in the format of a standard social contract” (Cosmides and Tooby 1992, 183). They argued that the content effect found in Wason Selection Tasks is due to the fact that some tasks involve a social contract rule.

In order to substantiate this hypothesis, they conducted a series of experiments designed to rule out alternative explanations of the content effects. One plausible explanation, for instance, would be that our cognitive system is able to deal better and more effectively with familiar problems (like the drinking/age problem) than with unfamiliar problems (like the letter/number problem). They therefore compared performance on unfamiliar social rules with performance on unfamiliar non-social rules. If familiarity is the issue, then subjects should perform equally bad on both unfamiliar rules. If, however, the increased performance in the drinking/age problem is due to the fact that here the subjects are dealing with a social contract rule, then performance should be better on the unfamiliar social than on the unfamiliar non-social rule.

Cosmides designed two unfamiliar Wason Selection Tasks. One rule read “If a man eats cassava root, then he must have a tattoo on his face” (with the options “eats cassava root,” “eats molo nuts,” “tattoo,” “no tattoo”). The other read “If you eat duiker meat, then you have found an ostrich eggshell” (with the options “duiker,” “weasel,” “ostrich eggshell,” “quail eggshell”). The first was accompanied by a story according to which the inhabitants of a Polynesian island have strict sexual mores that prohibit sex between unmarried people and thus mark married men with a facial tattoo and do not permit unmarried men to eat cassava root, which is a very powerful aphrodisiac. The second story said that anthropologists who notice that the natives frequently say that if someone eats duiker meat, then he has found an ostrich shell hypothesize that this is because duikers often feed on ostrich shells. Thus, the first rule clearly represents a social contract—having a tattoo is the requirement one has to meet if one is being permitted the benefit of eating cassava root—while the second is a non-social rule which simply expresses the hypothesis that duikers and ostrich eggs are frequently found in close proximity.

The results confirmed the cheater detection prediction (Cosmides and Tooby 1992, 186–7): 75% correctly answered the unfamiliar social problem, but only 21% the unfamiliar non-social problem.

Cosmides also hypothesized that if there is a cheater detection module, then subjects should pick the cards that represent cheating even if they correspond to the logically incorrect answer. She thus switched the logical role of the P/not-P– and the Q/not-Q-cards in both the cassava root/tattoo and the duiker meat/ostrich shell problem. The switched rules read “If a man has a tattoo on his face, then he eats cassava root” and “If you have found an ostrich eggshell, then you eat duiker meat.” Since the not-P– and the Q-card (“no tattoo” and “eats cassava root”) still represent accepting a benefit without meeting the requirement, the cheater detection hypothesis predicts that subjects should pick the logically incorrect cards in the first case, whereas performance in the ostrich shell/duiker meat case should be unaffected. Again, the prediction was confirmed (Cosmides and Tooby 1992, 188–9): 67% of the subjects chose the logically incorrect not-P– and Q-cards in response to the switched social problem, but only 4% did so for the switched non-social problem. (For a criticism of Cosmides and Tooby’s work on cheater detection and for further references see Buller 2005, 163–90.)

4. Problems and Objections

Evolutionary Psychology is a successful research program, but it has its problems. Some difficulties have already been mentioned in section 2 in connection with the theoretical underpinnings of Evolutionary Psychology (for a recent critique of Evolutionary Psychology at a methodological and conceptual level see Panksepp and Panksepp 2000). These and a couple of others will be briefly reviewed in this section.

a. Genetic Determinism

One of the most often heard criticisms is also one of the least convincing. The charge is that Evolutionary Psychology is committed to, or at least willfully embraces, a genetic determinism according to which our behavior is determined by our genetic make-up, which, since it is a human universal, cannot be influenced by means of social learning, education, and so forth, Dorothy Nelkin (2000, 27), for instance, claims that Evolutionary Psychology implies “genetic destiny,” and Robin Dunbar maintains that it seems “to be looking for genetically determined characters that are universally valid for all humans,” observing that this makes little sense because the “number of genuinely universal traits are … likely to run to single figures at most” (Dunbar 1988, 168).

It is true that Evolutionary Psychologists are looking for human universals, and it is also true that they think that if humans were not genetically very similar, there could be no cognitive adaptations (see section 2e). Yet, they are not committed to “a form of ‘genetic determinism,’ if by that one means the idea that genes determine everything, immune from an environmental influence” (Tooby and Cosmides 1990a, 19). Their claim is that the cognitive mechanisms underlying behavior are human universals, and that does not entail that our behavior is genetically determined, or the same all over the world. Quite the contrary: It is universally agreed among Evolutionary Psychologists that behavior, like any other human trait, is the result of the complex interplay between genetic and environmental factors. Genetic determinism is false because “every feature of every phenotype is fully and equally codetermined by the interaction of the organism’s genes … and its ontogenetic environments” (Tooby and Cosmides 1992, 83; italics added), as is nicely illustrated by the fact that not even genetic clones, monozygotic twins, are phenotypically identical. In fact, work in Evolutionary Psychology has emphasized the highly flexible and contingent nature of cognitive adaptations. For instance, Martin Daly and Margo Wilson’s often cited work on violence toward children by stepparents (for example, Daly and Wilson 1988a, 1988b) is in fact entirely concerned with contextual factors—the presence of a stepparent in a household, they argue, is one of the primary predictors of fatal violence toward children.

b. Moral and Societal Issues

A related charge is that Evolutionary Psychology is defending the status quo regarding sex, race, intelligence differences, and so forth, by arguing that, first, there is nothing we can do, given that these differences are the result of our hard-wired cognitive mechanisms, and, second, there is no need to do something, because these differences, being the result of natural selection, are optimal solutions to longstanding adaptive problems.

The first claim is just wrong. As seen in section 4a, it is not “all in our genes” because the environment heavily influences what behavior issues forth from cognitive mechanisms, even if the latter are evolutionarily hard-wired.

The second claim is an instance of what many scholars would regard as the fallacious inference from “is” to “ought” (see Naturalistic Fallacy). As Robert Kurzban (2002) has pointed out, Evolutionary Psychologists are well aware that it is illegitimate to move from the first to the second, that there is a difference “between science, which can help us to understand what is, and morality, which concerns questions about what ought to be.” Regarding cognitive adaptations, one cannot infer “ought” from “is” because (1) there is no guarantee that natural selection always finds an optimal solution, (2) since the environment has changed, something that was good for our ancestors may no longer be good for us, and (3) the sense in which it was “good” for our ancestors that, say, they possessed a cognitive mechanism that pre-disposed them to kill children of their mating partners that were not their own (“good” in the sense of “fitness increasing”) is definitely not the sense of “good” that is relevant to ethical discourse (“good” in the sense of “morally praiseworthy/obligatory”).

c. Untestability and Story Telling

One of the key problems for Evolutionary Psychologists is to show that the adaptationist explanations they offer are indeed explanations properly so called and not mere “just-so-stories” that feature plausible scenarios without its being certain that they are historical fact. Stephen Jay Gould, for instance, who famously criticized evolutionary biology for its unreflected and widespread adaptationism that tends to ignore other plausible evolutionary explanations (Gould and Lewontin 1979), has argued that the sole task of Evolutionary Psychology has become “a speculative search for reasons why a behavior that harms us now must once have originated for adaptive purposes” (Gould 2000, 119).

There is something to this charge, but things are more difficult. Evolutionary Psychologists stress that “[i]t is difficult to reconcile such claims with the actual practice of EP, since in evolutionary psychology the evolutionary model or prediction typically precedes and causes the discovery of new facts, rather than being constructed post hoc to fit some known fact” (Sell et al. 2003, 52). The discussion of functional analysis in section 2b has shown that there is a clear sense in which adaptationist hypotheses can be tested: functional analysis predicts the existence of yet unknown cognitive mechanisms on the grounds of evolutionary reasoning about potential adaptive problems in the EEA, and these predictions are then empirically tested. The hypotheses Evolutionary Psychologists derive from their computational theory thus allow them “to devise experiments that make possible the detection and mapping of mechanisms that no one would otherwise have thought to test for in the absence of such theories” (Sell et al. 2003, 48). It is therefore not true that “claims about an EEA usually cannot be tested in principle but only subjected to speculation” (Gould 1997, 51) because if the purported cognitive mechanisms fail to show up in psychological experiments, the adapationist explanation is falsified.

First, however, this holds only for research that conforms to Cosmides and Tooby’s theoretical model (arguably, Cosmides and Tooby’s work on cheater detection, Buss’ work on sex differences with regard to jealousy, and Silverman and Eals’ work on differences in spatial abilities belong to this category). It does not apply to research that does not generate a prediction based on a putative problem, but tries to infer the historical function of an organism’s traits from its current structure. Profet’s work on pregnancy sickness would be a case in point: here, one already knows the trait (pregnancy sickness) and merely speculates about its historic function, in contrast to the other cases, where the existence of the trait (an ability to detect cheaters, sex specific responses to jealousy, or sex specific spatial abilities) is inferred from evolutionary considerations about the problems prevalent in the EEA.

Second, the controversial claim is not that our psychological faculties have evolved. It is that they are adaptations, and, more specifically, adaptations for solving particular adaptive problems. Successful psychological tests that show that current Homo sapiens indeed possesses the hypothesized cognitive mechanisms establish that these traits have evolved, but they fail to establish that they are adaptations, let alone adaptations for, say, detecting cheaters or remembering the location of edible plants. For all these tests tell us, the traits in question could still be exaptations, or even spandrels. In order to show that they are indeed adaptations, a point that is forcefully made by Richardson (2008), additional information would be needed, and it is not clear that this additional information can be had (for a sketch of Richardson’s argument see Walter 2009).

Third, there seems to be a sense in which adaptationist explanations are still “just-so-stories.” Functional analysis relies on claims about the nature of the EEA which cannot be directly verified because there is very little we can know with any confidence about the conditions that obtained in the EEA. As Evolutionary Psychologists like to point out, there are some things which have arguably stayed constant since the EEA:

[R]esearchers know with certainty of high confidence thousands of important things about our ancestors, many of which can be used to derive falsifiable predictions about our psychological architecture: our ancestors had two sexes; contracted infections by contact, collected plant foods; inhabited a world where the motions of objects conformed to the principles of kinematic geometry; had color vision; were predated upon; had faces; lived in a biotic environment with a hierarchical taxonomic structure, and so forth (Sell et al. 2003, 52–3).

The problem is that knowing that our ancestors inhabited a world with two sexes where the motions of objects conformed to the principles of kinematic geometry does not enable us to formulate the adaptive problems our ancestors putatively faced in enough detail. Both our male and female ancestors lived in such a world (as, by the way, did the ancestors of apes, spiders and flies), and yet they evolved different mating strategies, different responses to emotional versus sexual infidelity, different spatial abilities, and so forth. The descriptions of the past adaptive problems that Evolutionary Psychologists rely on in order to explain these differences are much more specific than the platitudes of which we can be relatively certain, and it is unclear how we could ever be confident that we got the specific details right. As Stephen Jay Gould puts it vividly:

But how can we possibly know in detail what small bands of hunter-gatherers did in Africa two million years ago? These ancestors left some tools and bones, and paleoanthropologists can make some ingenious inferences from such evidence. But how can we possibly obtain the key information that would be required to show the validity of adaptive tales about an EEA: relations of kinship, social structures and sizes of groups, different activities of males and females, the roles of religion, symbolizing, storytelling, and a hundred other central aspects of human life that cannot be traced in fossils? (Gould 1997, §31; see also Gould 2000, 120)

In the case of Buss’ research on the evolution of sex differences with regard to jealousy, for instance, we can only hypothesize about such things as group structure and size, mating structures, similarities between ancestral and current group structures, or the alleged differences in mating behavior in ancestral groups that are appealed to or presupposed in the formulation of the adaptive problem (again, a point made convincingly by Richardson 2008).

Of course, as Sell et al. (2003) point out, if our assumptions about our ancestors’ problems are wrong, our computational theory is wrong, too, and should thus predict the existence of cognitive mechanisms that will not be found when checked for empirically. Yet, even if this is so, the two qualifications above apply to this move mutatis mutandis. (For more on the role of historical evidence in the search for adaptations and the kinds of problems that may arise, see Kaplan 2002.)

d. Psychological Inadequacy

In Adapting Minds: Evolutionary Psychology and the Persistent Quest for Human Nature, David Buller argues “not only that the theoretical and methodological doctrines of Evolutionary Psychology are problematic, but that Evolutionary Psychology has not, in fact, produced any solid empirical results” (Buller 2005, 15). What is wrong with Evolutionary Psychology is that the psychological experiments used to establish the existence of the hypothesized cognitive mechanisms in current Homo sapiens are flawed because the data are exiguous, inconclusive and do not support the claims made by Evolutionary Psychologists, as Buller tries to show in detail for the classical studies of Cosmides and Tooby, Buss, and Daly and Wilson on cheater detection, mating strategies, jealousy, and discriminative parenthood. Whereas Richardson (2008) claims that Evolutionary Psychology is problematic as Evolutionary Psychology, Buller challenges the psychological credentials of evolutionary psychology, arguing that Evolutionary Psychology fails as Evolutionary Psychology.

5. Evolutionary Approaches to Mind, Culture, and Behavior: Alternatives to Evolutionary Psychology

In its broad sense, evolutionary psychology attempts to adopt “an evolutionary perspective on human behavior and psychology” (Barrett et al. 2002, 1) by applying Darwinian reasoning to behavioral, cognitive, social, or cultural characteristics of humans. Evolutionary Psychology is one strand of evolutionary psychology, but there are others, and the literature is full of different labels: “sociobiology,” “evolutionary anthropology,” “human behavioral ecology,” “Darwinian psychology,” “gene-culture coevolution,” to name just a few. These approaches share the idea that evolutionary reasoning can enhance our understanding of mind, culture, and society, but they disagree about exactly how Darwinian thinking ought to enter the picture. This is not the place to go into the details, but a brief survey of the theoretical landscape (see Laland and Brown 2002 for a book-length overview) may help to understand the difference between evolutionary psychology as a general field of inquiry and Evolutionary Psychology as a narrowly circumscribed research paradigm.

a. Human Behavioral Ecology

Evolutionary Psychologists insist that an evolutionary approach to human psychology must ask whether a trait is an adaptation, not whether it is currently adaptive. They thereby separate themselves sharply from an approach Symons (1989) dubbed “Darwinian anthropology” that instead focuses on the current adaptiveness of our behavior (for a more reconciliatory approach see, for example, Downes 2001). Human behavioral ecology, as it is nowadays called (Borgerhoff Mulder 1991), originated in the late 1970s when, after the upheaval caused by Wilson’s Sociobiology, some anthropologists decided to go out and test the controversial hypotheses of Wilson and others by means of real data from hunter-gatherer populations (Chagnon and Irons 1979; Hinde 1974). Using quantitative ethnographic information and optimality models, human behavioral ecologists investigate whether and how the current adaptiveness of an individual’s behavior is influenced by its ecological and cultural environment and in which way the different behaviors individuals develop to cope with environmental challenges lead to and account for cultural differences between them.

Natural selection, human behavioral ecologists argue, has created an extraordinary flexibility—known as phenotypic plasticity—that allows our “behavior to assume the form that maximizes inclusive fitness” (Irons 1979, 33) across a wide variety of widely diverse habitats. Since there has been selection for a general phenotypic plasticity, we are not so much “adaptation executers” as rather “fitness maximizers”: “Modern Darwinian theory predicts that human behavior will be … designed to promote maximum reproductive success” (Turke and Betzig 1985, 79; italics added). As a consequence, human behavioral ecologists are less interested in discovering proximal cognitive mechanisms than in checking whether the behavior they trigger is actually adaptive (a strategy known as phenotypic gambit).

b. Memetics

A rather different approach is adopted by memetics (Blackmore 1999; Distin 2005). Memetics tries to explain cultural characteristics and processes and the way they influence our behavior by postulating a process of cultural evolution that is analogous to the process of biological evolution, but largely independent of it. Dawkins (1976) introduced the idea that evolution by natural selection is a substrate neutral process that can act on what he called a “replicator,” that is, any heritable entity for which there is variation in a population and that is associated with different degrees of fitness. The gene, Dawkins said, is the replicator in biological evolution, but the cultural realm also has a replicator, which he famously dubbed a meme: a meme is “a unit of cultural inheritance, hypothesized as analogous to the particulate gene, and as naturally selected in virtue of its phenotypic consequences on its own survival and replication in the cultural environment” (Dawkins 1982, 290). Memes form the substrate of cultural evolution, a process in which different memes are differentially transmitted from individual to individual. One of the key challenges for memetics is to spell out exactly what memes are, and although suggestions abound, there is no agreed consensus [for instance, according to Dawkins “examples of memes are tunes, ideas, catch-phrases, clothes fashions, ways of making pots or of building arches” (Dawkins 1976, 206), while Dennett (1995, 347–8) cites the ideas of the wheel, of wearing clothes, the vendetta, the right triangle, the alphabet, chess, perspective drawing, Impressionism, Greensleeves, and deconstructionism as examples]. Importantly, whatever memes are, they must be sufficiently similar to genes to warrant the claim that cultural evolution is more or less analogous to biological evolution, and critics of memetics argue that this constraint is unlikely to be met (for example, Boyd and Richerson 2000; for a more optimistic view, see Blackmore 1999, ch. 5).

c. Gene-Culture Coevolution

Defenders of what is known as “gene-culture coevolution” or “dual inheritance theory” (Boyd and Richerson 1985, 2005a, 2005b; Cavalli-Sforza and Feldmann 1981; Durham 1991) agree with memetics that transmitted cultural information is too important a factor to be ignored by an evolutionary approach to human culture and behavior. After all, one of the most striking facts about humans is that there are important and persistent differences between human groups that are due to culturally transmitted ideas, and not to genetic, biological, or ecological factors. Yet, although culture is a Darwinian force in its own right, they argue, there is no substantial analogy between cultural and biological evolution. In both processes information is transmitted between individuals and both create patterns of heritable variation, but the differences are much more salient: culture is not based on direct replication but upon teaching, imitation, and other forms of social learning, the transmission of culture is temporally extended and not restricted to parents and their offspring, cultural evolution is not necessarily particulate, and not necessarily random (Boyd and Richerson 2000).

Culture is part of human biology, gene-culture coevolutionists argue, but accounts concerned solely with genetic factors are inadequate because they ignore the fact that culture itself shapes the adaptive environment in which biological evolution takes place by creating a culturally constructed environment in which human genes must evolve. Conversely, accounts aimed solely at explaining cultural replication are also inadequate because they ignore the fact that genes affect cultural evolution, for instance by forming psychological predispositions that bias what people imitate, teach, or are able to learn. Hence, a truly evolutionary approach to culture must acknowledge that genesand culture coevolve, and try to investigate the circumstances under which the cultural habits adopted by individuals are influenced by their genes, and how the natural selection pressures that guide biological evolution may be generated by culture.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Suggested Further Reading

Barkow, Jerome, Leda Cosmides, and John Tooby, eds. (1992). The Adapted Mind: Evolutionary Psychology and the Generation of Culture. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- The manifesto of Evolutionary Psychology.
Barrett, Louise, Robin Dunbar, and John Lycett, eds. (2002). Human Evolutionary Psychology. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
- A very useful textbook of evolutionary psychology in the broad sense, covering both Evolutionary Psychology and Human Behavioral Ecology.
Buller, David (2005). Adapting Minds: Evolutionary Psychology and the Persistent Quest for Human Nature. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- A philosophical critique of Evolutionary Psychology, arguing that the empirical tests Evolutionary Psychologists rely on to establish that current Homo sapiens possesses the postulated cognitive adaptations in the areas of cheater detection, mating, marriage, and parenthood are flawed.
Buss, David (1999). Evolutionary Psychology: The New Science of the Mind. Boston: Allyn and Bacon.
- The textbook of Evolutionary Psychology, written by one of its most ardent advocates.
Cosmides, Leda, and John Tooby (1992). “Cognitive Adaptations for Social Exchange.” In: The Adapted Mind: Evolutionary Psychology and the Generation of Culture. Eds. Jerome Barkow, Leda Cosmides, and John Tooby. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 163–228.
- The classic paper on cheater detection.
Dawkins, Richard (1976). The Selfish Gene. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- A must-read for anyone interested in evolutionary biology in general, in which Dawkins introduces the concept of the meme and defends his theory of evolution from the gene’s eye point of view (also known as the “selfish gene theory”) according to which the ultimate beneficiary of the evolutionary process is neither the species, nor the individual, nor a particular trait, but the gene.
Laland, Kevin, and Gillian Brown (2002). Sense or Nonsense: Evolutionary Perspectives on Human Behavior. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- A highly laudable introduction to sociobiology, Evolutionary Psychology, human behavioral ecology, memetics, and gene-culture coevolution.
Pinker, Steven (1997). How the Mind Works. New York: Norton.
- A very accessible introduction to Evolutionary Psychology and to the kinds of issues discussed in cognitive science in general.
Pinker, Steven (2002). The Blank Slate: The Modern Denial of Human Nature. New York: Penguin.
- Another very accessible introduction to the ideas of Evolutionary Psychology, written by one of the most gifted writers in academia.
Richardson, Robert (2008). Evolutionary Psychology as Maladapted Psychology. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
- A philosophical critique of Evolutionary Psychology from the perspective of evolutionary biology.
Samuels, Richard (1998). “Evolutionary Psychology and the Massive Modularity Hypothesis.” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 49, 575–602.
- Criticizes Evolutionary Psychology’s insistence on the domain-specificity of cognitive mechanisms, arguing that a domain-general architecture that uses domain-specific information would be equally good.
Tooby, John, and Leda Cosmides (1990a). “On the Universality of Human Nature and the Uniqueness of the Individual: The Role of Genetics and Adaptation.” Journal of Personality, 58, 17–67.
- Contains Cosmides and Tooby’s genetic argument (discussed in section 2e) for the claim that our cognitive adaptations are human universals.
Tooby, John, and Leda Cosmides (2005). “Conceptual Foundations of Evolutionary Psychology.” In: The Handbook of Evolutionary Psychology. Ed. David Buss. Hoboken, NJ: Wiley, 5–67.
- A brief, but very valuable overview over the theoretical background of Evolutionary Psychology.
Wright, Robert (1994). The Moral Animal. The New Science of Evolutionary Psychology. New York: Pantheon Books.
- A simplifying introduction to Evolutionary Psychology, written for a general audience, included here under “Suggested Readings” only to stress that it is not to be recommended at all for anyone with a serious interest in Evolutionary Psychology.

b. Other Referenced Works

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Author Information

Sven Walter
Email: s.walter@philosophy-online.de
University of Osnabrueck
Germany

Humor

The philosophical study of humor has been focused on the development of a satisfactory definition of humor, which until recently has been treated as roughly co-extensive with laughter. The main task is to develop an adequate theory of just what humor is.

According to the standard analysis, humor theories can be classified into three neatly identifiable groups:incongruity, superiority, and relief theories. Incongruity theory is the leading approach and includes historical figures such as Immanuel Kant, Søren Kierkegaard, and perhaps has its origins in comments made by Aristotle in the Rhetoric. Primarily focusing on the object of humor, this school sees humor as a response to an incongruity, a term broadly used to include ambiguity, logical impossibility, irrelevance, and inappropriateness. The paradigmatic Superiority theorist is Thomas Hobbes, who said that humor arises from a “sudden glory” felt when we recognize our supremacy over others. Plato and Aristotle are generally considered superiority theorists, who emphasize the aggressive feelings that fuel humor. The third group, Relief theory, is typically associated with Sigmund Freud and Herbert Spencer, who saw humor as fundamentally a way to release or save energy generated by repression. In addition, this article will explore a fourth group of theories of humor: play theory. Play theorists are not so much listing necessary conditions for something’s counting as humor, as they are asking us to look at humor as an extension of animal play.

While the task of defining humor is a seemingly simple one, it has proven quite difficult. Each theory attempts to provide a characterization of what is at least at the core of humor. However, these theories are not necessarily competing; they may be seen as simply focusing on different aspects of humor, treating certain aspects as more fundamental than others.

What Is Humor?
1. Humor, Laughter, and the Holy Grail
2. Problems Classifying Theorists
Theories of Humor
Reference and Further Reading

1. What is Humor?

Almost every major figure in the history of philosophy has proposed a theory, but after 2500 years of discussion there has been little consensus about what constitutes humor. Despite the number of thinkers who have participated in the debate, the topic of humor is currently understudied in the discipline of philosophy. There are only a few philosophers currently focused on humor-related research, which is most likely due to two factors: the problems in the field have proved incredibly difficult, inviting repeated failures, and the subject is erroneously dismissed as an insignificant concern. Nevertheless, scope and significance of the study of humor is reflected in the interdisciplinary nature of the filed, which draws insights from philosophy, psychology, sociology, anthropology, film, and literature. It is rare to find a philosophical topic that bares such direct relevance to our daily lives, our social interactions, and our nature as humans.

a. Humor, Laughter, Comedy, and the Holy Grail

The majority of the work on humor has been occupied with the following foundational question: What is humor? The word “humor” itself is of relatively recent origin. According to the Oxford English Dictionary, it arose during the 17th century out of psycho-physiological scientific speculation on the effects of various humors that might affect a person’s temperament. Much of the earlier humor research is riddled with equivocations between humor and laughter, and the problem continues into recent discussions. John Dewey states one reason to make the distinction: “The laugh is by no means to be viewed from the standpoint of humor; its connection with humor is only secondary. It marks the ending [. . .] of a period of suspense, or expectation, all ending which is sharp and secondary” (John Dewey, 558). We laugh for a variety of reasons—hearing a funny joke, inhaling laughing gas, being tickled—not all of which result from what we think of as humor. Attempting to offer a general theory of laughter and humor, John Morreall (manuscript) makes a finer distinction: laughter results from a pleasant psychological shift, whereas, humor arises from a pleasant cognitive shift. Noting the predominance of non-humorous laughter, researcher Robert Provine (2000) argues that laughter is most often found in non-humorous social interactions, deployed as some sort of tension relief mechanism. If humor is not a necessary condition of laughter, then we might ask if it is sufficient. Often humor will produce laughter, but sometimes it results in only a smile. Obviously, these relatively distinct phenomena are intimately connected in some manner, but to understand the relationship we need clearer notions of both laugher and humor.

Laughter is a fairly well described physiological process that results in a limited range of characteristic vocal patterns that are only physiologically possible, as Provine suggests, for bi-pedal creatures with breath control. If we describe humorous laughter as laughter in response to humor, then we must answer the question, What is humor? This topic will be explored in the next few sections, but for starters, we can say that humor or amusement is widely regarded as a response to a certain kind of stimulus. The comic, on the other hand, is best described as a professionally produced source of humor, a generic element of various artforms. In distinguishing between humorous and non-humorous laughter we presuppose a working definition of humor, based partly on the character of our response and partly on the properties of humorous objects. This is not necessarily to beg the question about what is humor, but to enter into the real world process of correctively developing a definition. The first goal of a humor theory is to look for the basis of our practical ability to identify humor.

Most definitions of humor are essentialist in that they try to list the necessary and sufficient conditions something must meet in order to be counted as humor. Some theories isolate a common element supposedly found in all humor, but hold back from making claims about the sufficient conditions. Many theorists seem to confuse offering the necessary conditions for a response to count as humor with explaining why we find one thing funny rather than another. This second question, what would be sufficient for an object to be found funny, is the Holy Grail of humor studies, and must be kept distinct from the goals of a definition of the humor response. The Holy Grail is often confused with a question regarding the sufficient conditions for our response to count as humorous amusement, but a crucial distinction needs to be made: identifying the conditions of a response is different from the isolating the features something must possess in order to provoke such a response. The first task is much different from suggesting what features are sufficient to provoke a response of humorous amusement. What amounts to a humor response is different from what makes something humorous. The noun (humor) and adjectival (humorous) senses of the term are difficult to keep distinct due to the imprecision of our language in this area. Much of the dissatisfaction with traditional humor theories can be traced back to an equivocation between these two senses of the term.

b. Problems Classifying Theorists

The standard analysis, developed by D. H. Monro, that classifies humor theories into superiority, incongruity, and relief theories sets up a false expectation of genuine competition between the views. Rarely do any of the historical theorists in any of these schools state their theories as listing necessary of sufficient conditions for something to count as humor, much less put their views in competition with others. A further problem concerns just what the something is that might be called humor. Some theories address the object of humor, whereas others are concerned primarily with the characteristics of the response, and other theories discuss both.

The popular reduction of humor theories into three groups—Incongruity, Relief, and Superiority theories—is an over simplification. Several scholars have identified over 100 types of humor theories, and Patricia Keith-Spiegel’s classification of humor theories into 8 major types (biological, superiority, incongruity, surprise, ambivalence, release, configuration, and psychoanalytic theories) has been fairly influential. Jim Lyttle suggests that, based on the question they are primarily addressing humor, theories can be classified into 3 different groups. He argues that, depending on their focus, humor theories can be grouped under these categories: functional, stimuli, and response theories. (1) Functional theories of humor ask what purpose humor has in human life. (2) Stimuli theories ask what makes a particular thing funny. (3)Response theorists ask why we find things funny. A better way to phrase this concern is to say that response theorists ask what is particular about feelings of humor.

A little probing shows that Lyttle’s grouping is strained, since many of the humor theories address more than one of these questions, and an answer to one often involves an answer to the other questions. For instance, though focused on the function of humor, relief theories often have something to say about all three questions: humor serves as a tension release mechanism, the content often concerns the subject of repressed desires, and finding these funny involves a feeling of relief.

Regardless of the classificatory scheme, when analyzing the tradition of humor theories we need to consider how each of the traditionally defined schools answers the major questions that occupy the bulk of the discussion. The primary questions of humor theory include:

1. Humor question: What is humor?

(An answer to this question often entails answers to questions regarding the object and the response. This is the central question of any humor theory.)

2. Object Feature Questions:

Are there any features frequently found in what is found funny?
Are there any features necessary for something to have in order to be found funny?
Are there any features that by themselves or considered jointly are sufficient for something to be found funny? (Answering this question affirmatively would amount to discovering the holy grail of humor theory.)

3. Response Question: Is there anything psychologically or cognitively distinctive or characteristic about finding something funny?

4. Laughter Question: How is humor related to laughter?

Given this list, we may ask what would a theory of humor amount to? To count as a humor theory and not just an approach to humor, a theory must attempt an answer to Question 1—What is humor? Like the relief theories, most humor theorists do not attempt to answer this question head on, but discuss some important or necessary characteristics of humor. Since the various theories of humor are addressing different sets of questions within this cluster as well as related question in the general study of humor, it is often difficult to put them in competition with each other. Accepting this limitation, we can proceed to explore a few of the major humor theories listed in the widely influential standard analysis.

2. Theories of Humor

a. Superiority Theory

We can give two forms to the claims of the superiority theory of humor: (1) the strong claim holds that all humor involves a feeling of superiority, and (2) the weak claim suggests that feelings of superiority are frequently found in many cases of humor. It is not clear that many superiority theorists would hold to the strong claim if pressed, but we will evaluate as a necessary condition nonetheless.

Neither Plato nor Aristotle makes clear pronouncements about the essence of humor, though their comments are preoccupied with the role of feelings of superiority in our finding something funny. In the “Philebus,” Plato tries to expose the “mixture of pleasure and pain that lies in the malice of amusement.” He argues that ignorance is a misfortune that when found in the weak is considered ridiculous. In comedy, we take malicious pleasure from the ridiculous, mixing pleasure with a pain of the soul. Some of Aristotle’s brief comments in the Poetics corroborate Plato’s view of the pleasure had from comedy. Tragedy deals with subjects who are average or better than average; however, in comedy we look down upon the characters, since it presents subjects of lesser virtue than, or “who are inferior to,” the audience. The “ludicrous,” according to Aristotle, is “that is a failing or a piece of ugliness which causes no pain of destruction” (Poetics, sections 3 and 7). Going beyond the subject of comedy, in the Rhetoric (II, 12) Aristotle defines wit as “educated insolence,” and in the Nicomachean Ethics (IV, 8) he describes jokes as “a kind of abuse” which should ideally be told without producing pain. Rather than clearly offering a superiority theory of humor, Plato and Aristotle focus on this common comic feature, bringing it to our attention for ethical considerations.

Thomas Hobbes developed the most well known version of the Superiority theory. Giving emphatic expression to the idea, Hobbes says “that the passion of laughter is nothing else but sudden glory arising from some sudden conception of some eminency in ourselves, by comparison with the infirmity of others, or with our own formerly” (Human Nature, ch. 8). Motivated by the literary conceit of the laugh of triumph, Hobbes’s expression the superiority theory looks like more of a theory of laughter than a theory of humor. Charles Baudelaire (1956) offers an interesting variation on Hobbes’ superiority theory, mixing it with mortal inferiority. He argues that that “laughter is satanic”—an expression of dominance over animals and a frustrated complaint against our being merely mortal.

Critically reversing the superiority theory, Robert Solomon (2002) offers an inferiority theory of humor. He thinks that self-recognition in the silly antics and self-deprecating behavior of the Three Stooges is characteristic of a source of humor based in inferiority or modesty. Rather than comparing our current with our former inferior selves, Solomon sees the ability to not take yourself seriously, or to see yourself as less than ideal, as a source of virtuous modesty and compassion. Solomon’s analysis of the Three Stooges is not a full-blown theory of humor, in that it does not make any pronouncements about the necessary or sufficient conditions of humor; however, it is a theory of humor in the sense that it suggests a possible source of humor or what humor can be and how it might function.

Solomon’s inferiority theory of humor raises a central objection against the Superiority theory, namely, that a feeling of superiority is not a necessary condition of humor. Morreall offers several examples, such as finding a bowling ball in his refrigerator, that could be found funny, but do not clearly involve superiority. If feelings of superiority are not necessary for humor, are they sufficient? Undoubtedly, this is not the case. As an 18th century critic of Hobbes, Francis Hutcheson, points out, we can feel superior to lots of things, dogs, cats, trees, etc, without being amused: “some ingenuity in dogs and monkeys, which comes near to some of our own arts, very often makes us merry; whereas their duller actions, in which the are much below us, are no matter of jest at all” (p. 29). However, if we evaluate the weaker version of the superiority theory—that humor is often fueled by feelings of superiority—then we have a fairly well supported empirical claim, easily confirmable by first hand observation.

b. Relief Theory

Relief theories attempt to describe humor along the lines of a tension-release model. Rather than defining humor, they discuss the essential structures and psychological processes that produce laughter. The two most prominent relief theorists are Herbert Spencer and Sigmund Freud. We can consider two version of the relief theory: (1) the strong version holds that all laughter results from a release of excessive energy; (2) the weak version claims that it is often the case that humorous laughter involves a release of tension or energy. Freud develops a more specific description of the energy transfer mechanism, but the process he describes is not essential to the basic claims of the relief theory of humor.

In “The Physiology of Laughter” (1860), Spencer develops a theory of laughter that is intimately related to his “hydraulic” theory of nervous energy, whereby excitement and mental agitation produces energy that “must expend itself in some way or another.” He argues that “nervous excitation always tends to beget muscular motion.” As a form of physical movement, laughter can serve as the expressive route of various forms of nervous energy. Spencer did not see his theory as a competitor to the incongruity theory of humor; rather, he tried to explain why it is that a certain mental agitation arising from a “descending incongruity” results in this characteristically purposeless physical movement. Spencer never satisfactorily answers this specific question, but he presents the basic idea that laughter serves to release pent up energy.

One criticism of Spencer’s theory of energy relief is that it does not seem to describe most cases of humor that occur quickly. Many instances of jokes, witticisms, and cartoons do not seem to involve a build up of energy that is then released. Perhaps Spencer thinks that the best explanation for laughter, an otherwise purposeless expenditure of energy, must be that it relieves energy produced from humor. However, since most of our experiences of humor do not seem to involve an energy build up, and humor does not seem forthcoming when we are generally agitated, a better explanation might be that laughter is not as purposeless as it seems or that all expenditures of energy, purposeful or not, need involve a build up.

Spencer might reply that everyone is continuously building up energy simply through the process of managing everyday stress. As such, most people have excess energy, a form of energy potential, waiting to be released by humor. For example, one often hears it said that humor allows one to “blow off steam” after a stressful day at work. The problem with this line of argument is that those who are most “stressed out” seem the least receptive to humor. Not only do attempts at humor frequently fall flat on the hurried, the amusement that results is typically minimal. Perhaps Spencer could argue that at a certain threshold the pent up energy jams the gates such that humor is unable to provide a release. This line of defense might be plausible, but the tension release theory starts to look a bit ad hoc when you have to posit things such as jammed energy release gates and the like.

In Jokes and Their Relation to the Unconscious (1905), Freud develops a more fine grained version of the relief theory of laughter, that amounts to a restatement of Spencer’s theory with the addition of a new process. He describes three different sources of laughter—joking, the comic, and humor—which all involve the saving of some psychic energy that is then discharged through laughter. In joking, the energy that would have been used to repress sexual and hostile feelings is saved and can be released in laughter. In the comic, cognitive energy to be used to solve an intellectual challenge is left over and can be released. The humorous involves a saving of emotional energy, since what might have been an emotion provoking situation turns out to be something we should treat non-seriously. The energy building up for the serious emotional reaction can then be released.

The details of Freud’s discussions of the process of energy saving, are widely regarded as problematic. His notion of energy saving is unclear, since it is not clear what sense it makes to say that energy which is never called upon is saved, rather than saying that no energy was expended. Take his theory of jokes, where the energy that otherwise would have been used to repress a desire is saved by joking which allows for aggression to be released. John Morreall and Noel Carroll make a similar criticism of this theory of energy management. We may have an idea of what it is like to express pent up energy, but we have no notion of what it would be to release energy that is used to repress a desire. Beyond the claim of queerness, this theory of joking does not result in the expected empirical observations. On Freud’s explanation, the most inhibited and repressed people would seem to enjoy joking the most, though the opposite is the case.

Relief theories of laughter do not furnish us a way to distinguish humorous from non-humorous laughter. Freud’s saved energy is perceptually indistinguishable with other forms of energy. As we saw with Spencer, Relief theories must be saddled to another theory of humor. Freud’s attempt to explain why we laugh is also an effort to explain why we find certain tendentious jokes especially funny, though it is not clear what he is getting at in his account of the saving of energy. He commits the fundamental mistake of relief theorists—they erroneously assume that since mental energy often finds release in physical movement, any physical movement must be explainable by an excess of nervous energy.

c. Incongruity Theory

The incongruity theory is the reigning theory of humor, since it seems to account for most cases of perceived funniness, which is partly because “incongruity” is something of an umbrella term. Most developments of the incongruity theory only try to list a necessary condition for humor—the perception of an incongruity—and they stop short of offering the sufficient conditions.

In the Rhetoric (III, 2), Aristotle presents the earliest glimmer of an incongruity theory of humor, finding that the best way to get an audience to laugh is to setup an expectation and deliver something “that gives a twist.” After discussing the power of metaphors to produce a surprise in the hearer, Aristotle says that “[t]he effect is produced even by jokes depending upon changes of the letters of a word; this too is a surprise. You find this in verse as well as in prose. The word which comes is not what the hearer imagined.” These remarks sound like a surprise theory of humor, similar to that later offered by René Descartes, but Aristotle continues to explain how the surprise must somehow “fit the facts,” or as we might put it today, the incongruity must be capable of a resolution.

In the Critique of Judgment, Immanuel Kant gives a clearer statement of the role of incongruity in humor: “In everything that is to excite a lively laugh there must be something absurd (in which the understanding, therefore, can find no satisfaction). Laughter is an affection arising from the sudden transformation of a strained expectation into nothing” (I, I, 54).

Arthur Schopenhauer offers a more specific version of the incongruity theory, arguing that humor arising from a failure of a concept to account for an object of thought. When the particular outstrips the general, we are faced with an incongruity. Schopenhauer also emphasizes the element of surprise, saying that “the greater and more unexpected [. . .] this incongruity is, the more violent will be his laughter” (1818, I, Sec. 13).

As stated by Kant and Schopenhauer, the incongruity theory of humor specifies a necessary condition of the object of humor. Focusing on the humorous object, leaves something out of the analysis of humor, since there are many kinds of things that are incongruous which do not produce amusement. A more robust statement of the incongruity theory would need to include the pleasurable response one has to humorous objects. John Morreall attempts to find sufficient conditions for identifying humor by focusing on our response. He defines humorous amusement as taking pleasure in a cognitive shift. The incongruity theory can be stated as a response focused theory, claiming that humor is a certain kind of reaction had to perceived incongruity.

Henri Bergson’s essay “Laughter” (1980) is perhaps the one of the most influential and sophisticated theories of humor. Bergson’s theory of humor is not easily classifiable, since it has elements of superiority and incongruity theories. In a famous phrase, Bergson argues that the source of humor is the “mechanical encrusted upon the living” (p. 84) According to Bergson “the comic does not exist outside of what is strictly human.” He thinks that humor involve an incongruous relationship between human intelligence and habitual or mechanical behaviors. As such, humor serves as a social corrective, helping people recognize behaviors that are inhospitable to human flourishing. A large source of the comic is in recognizing our superiority over the subhuman. Anything that threatens to reduce a person to an object—either animal or mechanical—is prime material for humor. No doubt, Bergson’s theory accounts for much of physical comedy and bodily humor, but he seems to over-estimate the necessity of mechanical encrustation. It is difficult to see how his theory can accommodate most jokes and sources of humor coming from wit.

Three major criticisms of the incongruity theory are that it is too broad to be very meaningful, it is insufficiently explanatory in that it does not distinguish between non-humorous incongruity and basic incongruity, and that revised versions still fail to explain why some things, rather than others, are funny. We have already addressed the third criticism: it confuses the object of humor with the response. What is at issue is the definition of humor, or how to identify humor, not how to create a humor-generating algorithm. The incongruity theorist has a response to this criticism as well, since they can claim that humor is pleasure in incongruity.

d. Play Theories

Describing play theories of humor as an independent school or approach might overstate their relative importance, although they do serve as a good representative of theories focused on the functional question. By looking at the contextual characteristic, play theories try to classify humor as a species of play. In this general categorization effort, the play theorists are not so much listing necessary conditions, as they are asking us to look at humor as an extension of animal play. They try to call our attention to the structural similarities between play contexts and humorous context, to suggest that what might be true of play, might be true of humor as well.

Play theorists often take an ethological approach to studying humor, tracing it back through evolutionary development. They look at laughter triggers like tickling, that are found in other species, to suggest that in humor ontogeny recapitulates phylogeny. In The Enjoyment of Laughter (1936), Max Eastman develops a play theory of humor with an adaptive story. He thinks we can find analogies of humor in the behavior of animals, especially in the proto-laughter of chimps to tickling. He goes so far as to argue that the wagging tail of a happy dog is a form of humorous laughter, since Eastman wants to broaden the definition of laughter to encompass other rhythmic responses to pleasure. Speaking more specifically of humor, he argues that “we come into the world endowed with an instinctive tendency to laugh and have this feeling in response to pains presented playfully” (p. 45). On Eastman’s account, what is central to humor and play is that both require taking a disinterested attitude towards what might otherwise be seen as serious.

Eastman considers humor to be a form of play, because humor involves a disinterested stance, certain kinds of humor involve mock aggression and insults, and because some forms of play activities result in humorous amusement. Since Eastman defines play as the adoption of this disinterested attitude, humor would count as a form of play on his definition, but this seems both too restrictive and too vague to serve as an adequate definition of play. In Homo Ludens (1938), Johan Huizinga criticizes identifying play with laughter or the comic. Though both seem to involve “the opposite of seriousness,” there are crucial asymmetries. Laughter, he argues, is particular to humans, whereas, play is found in other mammals and birds. Also, if we allow for certain types of competitive play, then a non-serious attitude is not essential to play, as it seems to be for humor. Identifying the comic, or humor, with play is problematic, since “in itself play is not comical for either for the player or public” (1938, p. 6). Huizinga questions whether humor and play share any necessary conditions, a requirement of the relationship if humor is a subtype of play. This will, of course, depend on how we describe humor and play, two equally elusive notions.

Play theorists are primarily concerned with the problem of determining the function of humor in order to explain how it might have adaptive value, a task taken up by other biological theories of humor. They argue that similarities between play and humor suggest that the adaptive value of play might be similar to that of humor. Other researchers focused on the functional questions have described humor as having value in cognitive development, social skill learning, tension relief, empathy management, immune system benefits, stress relief, and social bonding. Though these questions are primarily addressed by psychologists, sociologist, anthropologists, and medical researchers, their studies rely on and contribute to an evolving notion of just what counts as humor. Though the functional question is foremost in these theories, play theory tries to give humor a genus by offering some differentiating characteristics, essential to humor.

e. Summary of Humor Theories

We discussed four different schools of humor theories and noted how each reveals aspects common, if not necessary, to humor. Presenting these theories as rivals is misleading since, as we have seen, theorists in each classification focus on different problems and may draw upon the answers to different questions from another school. For instance, while focusing on why we find something funny, Spencer offers a functional explanation and relies on the answer incongruity theorists give to the question of what we find funny. Relief theories and Play theories tend to focus on the function humor serves in human life, though the functional question cannot be separated from characterizing amusement, or the humor response. Superiority theorists tend to focus on what feelings are necessary for there to be humor, or why we find some things funny. Incongruity theories have the most to say about the object of humor, though variants identify humor with the way we respond to a perceived incongruity. Though the functional, stimuli, and response questions are not neatly separated, the differing schools tend to assume that one question is more basic than the others.

3. References and Further Reading

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Bergson, Henri (1980). “Laughter.” Trans. Wylie Sypher, in Comedy, eds. Wylie Sypher. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press.
Berman, Merrie (1986). “How Many Feminists Does It Take To Make A Joke? Sexist Humor and What’s Wrong With It.” Hypatia, vol. 1, no. 1, Spring, pp. 63-82.
Caplow, Theodore (1968). Two Against One: Coalitions in Triads. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall.
Carroll, Noel, ed. (2001a). Beyond Aesthetics: Philosophical Essays. New York: Cambridge University Press.
Carroll, Noel (2001b). “Horror and Humor” in Carroll (2001a), pp. 235-253.
Carroll, Noel (2001c). “Moderate Moralism” in Carroll (2001a), pp. 293- 306.
Carroll, Noel (2001d). “On Jokes” in Carroll (2001), pp. 317-334.
Carroll, Noel (1996). “Notes on the Sight Gag” in Noel Carroll Theorizing the Moving Image. New York, Cambridge Univesrity Press.
Carroll, Noel (1997). “Words, Images, and Laughter.” Persistence of Vision, no. 14, pp. 42-52.
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Author Information

Aaron Smuts
Email: asmuts@gmail.com
University of Wisconsin-Madison
U. s. A.

Design Arguments for the Existence of God

Design arguments are empirical arguments for the existence of God. These arguments typically, though not always, proceed by attempting to identify various empirical features of the world that constitute evidence of intelligent design and inferring God’s existence as the best explanation for these features. Since the concepts of design and purpose are closely related, design arguments are also known as teleological arguments, which incorporates “telos,” the Greek word for “goal” or “purpose.”

Design arguments typically consist of (1) a premise that asserts that the material universe exhibits some empirical property F; (2) a premise (or sub-argument) that asserts (or concludes) that F is persuasive evidence of intelligent design or purpose; and (3) a premise (or sub-argument) that asserts (or concludes) that the best or most probable explanation for the fact that the material universe exhibits F is that there exists an intelligent designer who intentionally brought it about that the material universe exists and exhibits F.

There are a number of classic and contemporary versions of the argument from design. This article will cover seven different ones. Among the classical versions are: (1) the “Fifth Way” of St. Thomas Aquinas; (2) the argument from simple analogy; (3) Paley’s watchmaker argument; and (4) the argument from guided evolution. The more contemporary versions include: (5) the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity; (6) the argument from biological information; and (7) the fine-tuning argument.

The Classical Versions of the Design Argument
Contemporary Versions of the Design Argument
The Scientifically Legitimate Uses of Design Inferences
References and Further Reading

1. The Classical Versions of the Design Argument

a. Scriptural Roots and Aquinas’s Fifth Way

The scriptures of each of the major classically theistic religions contain language that suggests that there is evidence of divine design in the world. Psalms 19:1 of the Old Testament, scripture to both Judaism and Christianity, states that “The heavens declare the glory of God; and the firmament sheweth his handywork.” Similarly, Romans 1:19-21 of the New Testament states:

For what can be known about God is plain to them, because God has shown it to them. Ever since the creation of the world his eternal power and divine nature, invisible though they are, have been understood and seen through the things he has made. So they are without excuse.

Further, Koran 31:20 asks “Do you not see that Allah has made what is in the heavens and what is in the earth subservient to you, and made complete to you His favors outwardly and inwardly?” While these verses do not specifically indicate which properties or features of the world are evidence of God’s intelligent nature, each presupposes that the world exhibits such features and that they are readily discernable to a reasonably conscientious agent.

Perhaps the earliest philosophically rigorous version of the design argument owes to St. Thomas Aquinas. According to Aquinas’s Fifth Way:

We see that things which lack knowledge, such as natural bodies, act for an end, and this is evident from their acting always, or nearly always, in the same way, so as to obtain the best result. Hence it is plain that they achieve their end, not fortuitously, but designedly. Now whatever lacks knowledge cannot move towards an end, unless it be directed by some being endowed with knowledge and intelligence; as the arrow is directed by the archer. Therefore some intelligent being exists by whom all natural things are directed to their end; and this being we call God (Aquinas, Summa Theologica, Article 3, Question 2).

It is worth noting that Aquinas’s version of the argument relies on a very strong claim about the explanation for ends and processes: the existence of any end-directed system or process can be explained, as a logical matter, only by the existence of an intelligent being who directs that system or process towards its end. Since the operations of all natural bodies, on Aquinas’s view, are directed towards some specific end that conduces to, at the very least, the preservation of the object, these operations can be explained only by the existence of an intelligent being. Accordingly, the empirical fact that the operations of natural objects are directed towards ends shows that an intelligent Deity exists.

This crucial claim, however, seems to be refuted by the mere possibility of an evolutionary explanation. If a Darwinian explanation is even coherent (that is, non-contradictory, as opposed to true), then it provides a logically possible explanation for how the end-directedness of the operations of living beings in this world might have come about. According to this explanation, such operations evolve through a process by which random genetic mutations are naturally selected for their adaptive value; organisms that have evolved some system that performs a fitness-enhancing operation are more likely to survive and leave offspring, other things being equal, than organisms that have not evolved such systems. If this explanation is possibly true, it shows that Aquinas is wrong in thinking that “whatever lacks knowledge cannot move towards an end, unless it be directed by some being endowed with knowledge and intelligence.”

b. The Argument from Simple Analogy

The next important version of the design argument came in the 17th and 18th Centuries. Pursuing a strategy that has been adopted by the contemporary intelligent design movement, John Ray, Richard Bentley, and William Derham drew on scientific discoveries of the 16th and 17th Century to argue for the existence of an intelligent Deity. William Derham, for example, saw evidence of intelligent design in the vision of birds, the drum of the ear, the eye-socket, and the digestive system. Richard Bentley saw evidence of intelligent design in Newton’s discovery of the law of gravitation. It is noteworthy that each of these thinkers attempted to give scientifically-based arguments for the existence of God.

David Hume is the most famous critic of these arguments. In Part II of his famous Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, Hume formulates the argument as follows:

Look round the world: contemplate the whole and every part of it: you will find it to be nothing but one great machine, subdivided into an infinite number of lesser machines, which again admit of subdivisions to a degree beyond what human senses and faculties can trace and explain. All these various machines, and even their most minute parts, are adjusted to each other with an accuracy which ravishes into admiration all men who have ever contemplated them. The curious adapting of means to ends, throughout all nature, resembles exactly, though it much exceeds, the productions of human contrivance; of human designs, thought, wisdom, and intelligence. Since, therefore, the effects resemble each other, we are led to infer, by all the rules of analogy, that the causes also resemble; and that the Author of Nature is somewhat similar to the mind of man, though possessed of much larger faculties, proportioned to the grandeur of the work which he has executed. By this argument a posteriori, and by this argument alone, do we prove at once the existence of a Deity, and his similarity to human mind and intelligence.

Since the world, on this analysis, is closely analogous to the most intricate artifacts produced by human beings, we can infer “by all the rules of analogy” the existence of an intelligent designer who created the world. Just as the watch has a watchmaker, then, the universe has a universe-maker.

As expressed in this passage, then, the argument is a straightforward argument from analogy with the following structure:

The material universe resembles the intelligent productions of human beings in that it exhibits design.
The design in any human artifact is the effect of having been made by an intelligent being.
Like effects have like causes.
Therefore, the design in the material universe is the effect of having been made by an intelligent creator.

Hume criticizes the argument on two main grounds. First, Hume rejects the analogy between the material universe and any particular human artifact. As Hume states the relevant rule of analogy, “wherever you depart in the least, from the similarity of the cases, you diminish proportionably the evidence; and may at last bring it to a very weak analogy, which is confessedly liable to error and uncertainty” (Hume, Dialogues, Part II). Hume then goes on to argue that the cases are simply too dissimilar to support an inference that they are like effects having like causes:

If we see a house,… we conclude, with the greatest certainty, that it had an architect or builder because this is precisely that species of effect which we have experienced to proceed from that species of cause. But surely you will not affirm that the universe bears such a resemblance to a house that we can with the same certainty infer a similar cause, or that the analogy is here entire and perfect (Hume, Dialogues, Part II).

Since the analogy fails, Hume argues that we would need to have experience with the creation of material worlds in order to justify any a posteriori claims about the causes of any particular material world; since we obviously lack such experience, we lack adequate justification for the claim that the material universe has an intelligent cause.

Second, Hume argues that, even if the resemblance between the material universe and human artifacts justified thinking they have similar causes, it would not justify thinking that an all-perfect God exists and created the world. For example, there is nothing in the argument that would warrant the inference that the creator of the universe is perfectly intelligent or perfectly good. Indeed, Hume argues that there is nothing there that would justify thinking even that there is just one deity: “what shadow of an argument… can you produce from your hypothesis to prove the unity of the Deity? A great number of men join in building a house or ship, in rearing a city, in framing a commonwealth; why may not several deities combine in contriving and framing a world” (Hume Dialogues, Part V)?

c. Paley’s Watchmaker Argument

Though often confused with the argument from simple analogy, the watchmaker argument from William Paley is a more sophisticated design argument that attempts to avoid Hume’s objection to the analogy between worlds and artifacts. Instead of simply asserting a similarity between the material world and some human artifact, Paley’s argument proceeds by identifying what he takes to be a reliable indicator of intelligent design:

[S]uppose I found a watch upon the ground, and it should be inquired how the watch happened to be in that place, I should hardly think … that, for anything I knew, the watch might have always been there. Yet why should not this answer serve for the watch as well as for [a] stone [that happened to be lying on the ground]?… For this reason, and for no other; namely, that, if the different parts had been differently shaped from what they are, if a different size from what they are, or placed after any other manner, or in any order than that in which they are placed, either no motion at all would have been carried on in the machine, or none which would have answered the use that is now served by it (Paley 1867, 1).

There are thus two features of a watch that reliably indicate that it is the result of an intelligent design. First, it performs some function that an intelligent agent would regard as valuable; the fact that the watch performs the function of keeping time is something that has value to an intelligent agent. Second, the watch could not perform this function if its parts and mechanisms were differently sized or arranged; the fact that the ability of a watch to keep time depends on the precise shape, size, and arrangement of its parts suggests that the watch has these characteristics because some intelligent agency designed it to these specifications. Taken together, these two characteristics endow the watch with a functional complexity that reliably distinguishes objects that have intelligent designers from objects that do not.

Paley then goes on to argue that the material universe exhibits the same kind of functional complexity as a watch:

Every indicator of contrivance, every manifestation of design, which existed in the watch, exists in the works of nature; with the difference, on the side of nature, of being greater and more, and that in a degree which exceeds all computation. I mean that the contrivances of nature surpass the contrivances of art, in the complexity, subtilty, and curiosity of the mechanism; and still more, if possible, do they go beyond them in number and variety; yet in a multitude of cases, are not less evidently mechanical, not less evidently contrivances, not less evidently accommodated to their end, or suited to their office, than are the most perfect productions of human ingenuity (Paley 1867, 13).

Since the works of nature possess functional complexity, a reliable indicator of intelligent design, we can justifiably conclude that these works were created by an intelligent agent who designed them to instantiate this property.

Paley’s watchmaker argument is clearly not vulnerable to Hume’s criticism that the works of nature and human artifacts are too dissimilar to infer that they are like effects having like causes. Paley’s argument, unlike arguments from analogy, does not depend on a premise asserting a general resemblance between the objects of comparison. What matters for Paley’s argument is that works of nature and human artifacts have a particular property that reliably indicates design. Regardless of how dissimilar any particular natural object might otherwise be from a watch, both objects exhibit the sort of functional complexity that warrants an inference that it was made by an intelligent designer.

Paley’s version of the argument, however, is generally thought to have been refuted by Charles Darwin’s competing explanation for complex organisms. In The Origin of the Species, Darwin argued that more complex biological organisms evolved gradually over millions of years from simpler organisms through a process of natural selection. As Julian Huxley describes the logic of this process:

The evolutionary process results immediately and automatically from the basic property of living matter—that of self-copying, but with occasional errors. Self-copying leads to multiplication and competition; the errors in self-copying are what we call mutations, and mutations will inevitably confer different degrees of biological advantage or disadvantage on their possessors. The consequence will be differential reproduction down the generations—in other words, natural selection (Huxley 1953, 4).

Over time, the replication of genetic material in an organism results in mutations that give rise to new traits in the organism’s offspring. Sometimes these new traits are so unfavorable to a being’s survival prospects that beings with the traits die off; but sometimes these new traits enable the possessors to survive conditions that kill off beings without them. If the trait is sufficiently favorable, only members of the species with the trait will survive. By this natural process, functionally complex organisms gradually evolve over millions of years from primordially simple organisms.

Contemporary biologist, Richard Dawkins (1986), uses a programming problem to show that the logic of the process renders the Darwinian explanation significantly more probable than the design explanation. Dawkins considers two ways in which one might program a computer to generate the following sequence of characters: METHINKS IT IS LIKE A WEASEL. The first program randomly producing a new 28-character sequence each time it is run; since the program starts over each time, it incorporates a “single-step selection process.” The probability of randomly generating the target sequence on any given try is 27²⁸ (that is, 27 characters selected for each of the 28 positions in the sequence), which amounts to about 1 in (10,000 x 1,000,0006). While a computer running eternally would eventually produce the sequence, Dawkins estimates that it would take 1,000,0005 years—which is 1,000,0003 years longer than the universe has existed. As is readily evident, a program that selects numbers by means of such a “single-step selection mechanism” has a very low probability of reaching the target.

The second program incorporates a “cumulative-step selection mechanism.” It begins by randomly generating a 28-character sequence of letters and spaces and then “breeds” from this sequence in the following way. For a specified period of time, it generates copies of itself; most of the copies perfectly replicate the sequence, but some copies have errors (or mutations). At the end of this period, it compares all of the sequences with the target sequence METHINKS IT IS LIKE A WEASEL and keeps the sequence that most closely resembles it. For example, a sequence that has an E in the second place more closely resembles a sequence that is exactly like the first except that it has a Q in the second place. It then begins breeding from this new sequence in exactly the same way. Unlike the first program which starts afresh with each try, the second program builds on previous steps, getting successively closer to the program as it breeds from the sequence closest to the target. This feature of the program increases the probability of reaching the sequence to such an extent that a computer running this program hit the target sequence after 43 generations, which took about half-an-hour.

The problem with Paley’s watchmaker argument, as Dawkins explains it, is that it falsely assumes that all of the other possible competing explanations are sufficiently improbable to warrant an inference of design. While this might be true of explanations that rely entirely on random single-step selection mechanisms, this is not true of Darwinian explanations. As is readily evident from Huxley’s description of the process, Darwinian evolution is a cumulative-step selection method that closely resembles in general structure the second computer program. The result is that the probability of evolving functionally complex organisms capable of surviving a wide variety of conditions is increased to such an extent that it exceeds the probability of the design explanation.

d. Guided Evolution

While many theists are creationists who accept the occurrence of “microevolution” (that is, evolution that occurs within a species, such as the evolution of penicillin-resistant bacteria) but deny the occurrence of “macroevolution” (that is, one species evolving from a distinct species), some theists accept the theory of evolution as consistent with theism and with their own denominational religious commitments. Such thinkers, however, frequently maintain that the existence of God is needed to explain the purposive quality of the evolutionary process. Just as the purposive quality of the cumulative-step computer program above is best explained by intelligent design, so too the purposive quality of natural selection is best explained by intelligent design.

The first theist widely known to have made such an argument is Frederick Robert Tennant. As he puts the matter, in Volume 2 of Philosophical Theology, “the multitude of interwoven adaptations by which the world is constituted a theatre of life, intelligence, and morality, cannot reasonably be regarded as an outcome of mechanism, or of blind formative power, or aught but purposive intelligence” (Tennant 1928-30, 121). In effect, this influential move infers design, not from the existence of functionally complex organisms, but from the purposive quality of the evolutionary process itself. Evolution is, on this line of response, guided by an intelligent Deity.

2. Contemporary Versions of the Design Argument

Contemporary versions of the design argument typically attempt to articulate a more sophisticated strategy for detecting evidence of design in the world. These versions typically contain three main elements—though they are not always explicitly articulated. First, they identify some property P that is thought to be a probabilistically reliable index of design in the following sense: a design explanation for P is significantly more probable than any explanation that relies on chance or random processes. Second they argue that some feature or features of the world exhibits P. Third, they conclude that the design explanation is significantly more likely to be true.

As we will see, however, all of the contemporary versions of the design inference seem to be vulnerable to roughly the same objection. While each of the design inferences in these arguments has legitimate empirical uses, those uses occur only in contexts where we have strong antecedent reason for believing there exist intelligent agents with the ability to bring about the relevant event, entity, or property. But since it is the very existence of such a being that is at issue in the debates about the existence of God, design arguments appear unable to stand by themselves as arguments for God’s existence.

a. The Argument from Irreducible Biochemical Complexity

Design theorists distinguish two types of complexity that can be instantiated by any given structure. As William Dembski describes the distinction: a system or structure is cumulatively complex “if the components of the system can be arranged sequentially so that the successive removal of components never leads to the complete loss of function”; a system or structure is irreducibly complex “if it consists of several interrelated parts so that removing even one part completely destroys the system’s function” (Dembski 1999, 147). A city is cumulatively complex since one can successively remove people, services, and buildings without rendering it unable to perform its function. A mousetrap, in contrast, is irreducibly complex because the removal of even one part results in complete loss of function.

Design proponents, like Michael J. Behe, have identified a number of biochemical systems that they take to be irreducibly complex. Like the functions of a watch or a mousetrap, a cilium cannot perform its function unless its microtubules, nexin linkers, and motor proteins are all arranged and structured in precisely the manner in which they are structured; remove any component from the system and it cannot perform its function. Similarly, the blood-clotting function cannot perform its function if either of its key ingredients, vitamin K and antihemophilic factor, are missing. Both systems are, on this view, irreducibly complex—rather than cumulatively complex.

According to Behe, the probability of evolving irreducibly complex systems along Darwinian lines is sufficiently small that it can be ruled out as an explanation of irreducible biochemical complexity:

An irreducibly complex system cannot be produced … by slight, successive modifications of a precursor system, because any precursor to an irreducibly complex system that is missing a part is by definition nonfunctional…. Since natural selection can only choose systems that are already working, if a biological system cannot be produced gradually it would have to arise as an integrated unit, in one fell swoop, for natural selection to have anything to act on (Behe 1996, 39; emphasis added).

Since, for example, a cilium-precursor (that is, one that lacks at least one of a cilium’s parts) cannot perform the function that endows a cilium with adaptive value, organisms that have the cilium-precursor are no “fitter for survival” than they would have been without it. Since chance-driven evolutionary processes would not select organisms with the precursor, intelligent design is a better explanation for the existence of organisms with fully functional cilia.

Though Behe states his conclusion in categorical terms (that is, irreducibly complex systems “cannot be produced gradually”), he is more charitably construed as claiming only that the probability of gradually producing irreducibly complex systems is very small. The stronger construction of the conclusion (and argument) incorrectly presupposes that Darwinian theory implies that every precursor to a fully functional system must itself perform some function that makes the organism more fit to survive. Organisms that have, say, a precursor to a fully functional cilium are no fitter than they would have been without it, but there is nothing in Darwinian theory that implies they are necessarily any less fit. Thus, there is no reason to think that it is logically or nomologically impossible, according to Darwinian theory, for a set of organisms with a precursor to a fully functional cilium to evolve into a set of organisms that has fully functional cilia. Accordingly, the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity is more plausibly construed as showing that the design explanation for such complexity is more probable than the evolutionary explanation.

Nevertheless, this more modest interpretation is problematic. First, there is little reason to think that the probability of evolving irreducibly complex systems is, as a general matter, small enough to warrant assuming that the probability of the design explanation must be higher. If having a precursor to an irreducibly complex system does not render the organism less fit for survival, the probability a subspecies of organisms with the precursor survives and propagates is the same, other things being equal, as the probability that a subspecies of organisms without the precursor survives and propagates. In such cases, then, the prospect that the subspecies with the precursor will continue to thrive, leave offspring, and evolve is not unusually small.

Second, the claim that intelligent agents of a certain kind would (or should) see functional value in a complex system, by itself, says very little about the probability of any particular causal explanation. While this claim surely implies that intelligent agents with the right causal abilities have a reason for bringing about such systems, it does not tell us anything determinate about whether it is likely that intelligent agents with the right causal powers did bring such systems about—because it does not tell us anything determinate about whether it is probable that such agents exist. As a logical matter, the mere fact that some existing thing has a feature, irreducibly complex or otherwise, that would be valuable to an intelligent being with certain properties, by itself, does not say anything about the probability that such a being exists.

Accordingly, even if we knew that the prospect that the precursor-subspecies would survive was “vanishingly small,” as Behe believes, we would not be justified in inferring a design explanation on probabilistic grounds. To infer that the design explanation is more probable than an explanation of vanishingly small probability, we need some reason to think that the probability of the design explanation is not vanishingly small. The problem, however, is that the claim that a complex system has some property that would be valued by an intelligent agent with the right abilities, by itself, simply does not justify inferring that the probability that such an agent exists and brought about the existence of that system is not vanishingly small. In the absence of some further information about the probability that such an agent exists, we cannot legitimately infer design as the explanation of irreducible biochemical complexity.

b. The Argument from Biological Information

While the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity focuses on the probability of evolving irreducibly complex living systems or organisms from simpler living systems or organisms, the argument from biological information focuses on the problem of generating living organisms in the first place. Darwinian theories are intended only to explain how it is that more complex living organisms developed from primordially simple living organisms, and hence do not even purport to explain the origin of the latter. The argument from biological information is concerned with an explanation of how it is that the world went from a state in which it contained no living organisms to a state in which it contained living organisms; that is to say, it is concerned with the explanation of the very first forms of life.

There are two distinct problems involved in explaining the origin of life from a naturalistic standpoint. The first is to explain how it is that a set of non-organic substances could combine to produce the amino acids that are the building blocks of every living substance. The second is to explain the origin of the information expressed by the sequences of nucleotides that form DNA molecules. The precise ordering of the four nucleotides, adenine, thymine, guanine, and cytosine (A, T, G, and C, for short), determine the specific operations that occur within a living cell and is hence fairly characterized as representing (or embodying) information. As Stephen C. Meyer puts the point: “just as the letters in the alphabet of a written language may convey a particular message depending on their sequence, so too do the sequences of nucleotides or bases in the DNA molecule convey precise biochemical instructions that direct protein synthesis within the cell” (Meyer 1998, 526).

The argument from biological information is concerned with only the second of these problems. In particular, it attempts to evaluate four potential explanations for the origin of biological information: (1) chance; (2) a pre-biotic form of natural selection; (3) chemical necessity; and (4) intelligent design. The argument concludes that intelligent design is the most probable explanation for the information present in large biomacromolecules like DNA, RNA, and proteins.

The argument proceeds as follows. Pre-biotic natural selection and chemical necessity cannot, as a logical matter, explain the origin of biological information. Theories of pre-biotic natural selection are problematic because they illicitly assume the very feature they are trying to explain. These explanations proceed by asserting that the most complex nonliving molecules will reproduce more efficiently than less complex nonliving molecules. But, in doing so, they assume that nonliving chemicals instantiate precisely the kind of replication mechanism that biological information is needed to explain in the case of living organisms. In the absence of some sort of explanation as to how non-organic reproduction could occur, theories of pre-biotic natural selection fail.

Theories of chemical necessity are problematic because chemical necessity can explain, at most, the development of highly repetitive ordered sequences incapable of representing information. Because processes involving chemical necessity are highly regular and predictable in character, they are capable of producing only highly repetitive sequences of “letters.” For example, while chemical necessity could presumably explain a sequence like “ababababababab,” it cannot explain specified but highly irregular sequences like “the house is on fire.” The problem is that highly repetitive sequences like the former are not sufficiently complex and varied to express information. Thus, while chemical necessity can explain periodic order among nucleotide letters, it lacks the resources logically needed to explain the aperiodic, highly specified, complexity of a sequence capable of expressing information.

Ultimately, this leaves only chance and design as logically viable explanations of biological information. Although it is logically possible to obtain functioning sequences of amino acids through purely random processes, some researchers have estimated the probability of doing so under the most favorable of assumptions at approximately 1 in 10⁶⁵. Factoring in more realistic assumptions about pre-biotic conditions, Meyer argues the probability of generating short functional protein is 1 in 10¹²⁵—a number that is vanishingly small. Meyer concludes: “given the complexity of proteins, it is extremely unlikely that a random search through all the possible amino acid sequences could generate even a single relatively short functional protein in the time available since the beginning of the universe (let alone the time available on the early earth)” (Meyer 2002, 75).

Next, Meyer argues that the probability of the design explanation for the origin of biological information is considerably higher:

[O]ne can detect the past action of an intelligent cause from the presence of an information-rich effect, even if the cause itself cannot be directly observed. For instances, visitors to the gardens of Victoria harbor in Canada correctly infer the activity of intelligent agents when they see a pattern of red and yellow flowers spelling “Welcome to Victoria”, even if they did not see the flowers planted and arranged. Similarly, the specifically arranged nucleotide sequences—the complex but functionally specified sequences—in DNA imply the past action of an intelligent mind, even if such mental agency cannot be directly observed (Meyer 2002, 93).

Further, scientists in many fields typically infer the causal activity of intelligent agents from the occurrence of information content. As Meyer rightly observes by way of example, “[a]rcheologists assume a mind produced the inscriptions on the Rosetta Stone” (Meyer 2002, 94).

Meyer’s reasoning appears vulnerable to the same objection to which the argument from biochemical complexity is vulnerable. In all of the contexts in which we legitimately make the design inference in response to an observation of information, we already know that there exist intelligent agents with the right sorts of motivations and abilities to produce information content; after all, we know that human beings exist and are frequently engaged in the production and transmission of information. It is precisely because we have this background knowledge that we can justifiably be confident that intelligent design is a far more probable explanation than chance for any occurrence of information that a human being is capable of producing. In the absence of antecedent reason for thinking there exist intelligent agents capable of creating information content, the occurrence of a pattern of flowers in the shape of “Welcome to Victoria” would not obviously warrant an inference of intelligent design.

The problem, however, is that it is the very existence of an intelligent Deity that is at issue. In the absence of some antecedent reason for thinking there exists an intelligent Deity capable of creating biological information, the occurrence of sequences of nucleotides that can be described as “representing information” does not obviously warrant an inference of intelligent design—no matter how improbable the chance explanation might be. To justify preferring one explanation as more probable than another, we must have information about the probability of each explanation. The mere fact that certain sequences take a certain shape that we can see meaning or value in, by itself, tells us nothing obvious about the probability that it is the result of intelligent design.

It is true, of course, that “experience affirms that information content not only routinely arises but always arises from the activity of intelligent minds” (Meyer 2002, 92), but our experience is limited to the activity of human beings—beings that are frequently engaged in activities that are intended to produce information content. While that experience will inductively justify inferring that some human agency is the cause of any information that could be explained by human beings, it will not inductively justify inferring the existence of an intelligent agency with causal powers that depart as radically from our experience as the powers that are traditionally attributed to God. The argument from biological information, like the argument from biochemical complexity, seems incapable of standing alone as an argument for God’s existence.

c. The Fine-Tuning Arguments

Scientists have determined that life in the universe would not be possible if more than about two dozen properties of the universe were even slightly different from what they are; as the matter is commonly put, the universe appears “fine-tuned” for life. For example, life would not be possible if the force of the big bang explosion had differed by one part in 10⁶⁰; the universe would have either collapsed on itself or expanded too rapidly for stars to form. Similarly, life would not be possible if the force binding protons to neutrons differed by even five percent.

It is immediately tempting to think that the probability of a fine-tuned universe is so small that intelligent design simply must be the more probable explanation. The supposition that it is a matter of chance that so many things could be exactly what they need to be for life to exist in the universe just seems implausibly improbable. Since, on this intuition, the only two explanations for the highly improbable appearance of fine-tuning are chance and an intelligent agent who deliberately designed the universe to be hospitable to life, the latter simply has to be the better explanation.

This natural line of argument is vulnerable to a cogent objection. The mere fact that it is enormously improbable that an event occurred by chance, by itself, gives us no reason to think that it occurred by design. Suppose we flip a fair coin 1000 times and record the results in succession. The probability of getting the particular outcome is vanishingly small: 1 in 2¹⁰⁰⁰ to be precise. But it is clear that the mere fact that such a sequence is so improbable, by itself, does not give us any reason to think that it was the result of intelligent design. As intuitively tempting as it may be to conclude from just the apparent improbability of a fine-tuned universe that it is the result of divine agency, the inference is unsound.

i. The Argument from Suspicious Improbabilitys

George N. Schlesinger, however, attempts to formalize the fine-tuning intuition in a way that avoids this objection. To understand Schlesinger’s argument, consider your reaction to two different events. If John wins a 1-in-1,000,000,000 lottery game, you would not immediately be tempted to think that John (or someone acting on his behalf) cheated. If, however, John won three consecutive 1-in-1,000 lotteries, you would immediately be tempted to think that John (or someone acting on his behalf) cheated. Schlesinger believes that the intuitive reaction to these two scenarios is epistemically justified. The structure of the latter event is such that it is justifies a belief that intelligent design is the cause: the fact that John got lucky in three consecutive lotteries is a reliable indicator that his winning was the intended result of someone’s intelligent agency. Despite the fact that the probability of winning three consecutive 1-in-1,000 games is exactly the same as the probability of winning one 1-in-1,000,000,000 game, the former event is of a kind that is surprising in a way that warrants an inference of intelligent design.

Schlesinger argues that the fact that the universe is fine-tuned for life is improbable in exactly the same way that John’s winning three consecutive lotteries is improbable. After all, it is not just that we got lucky with respect to one property-lottery game; we got lucky with respect to two dozen property-lottery games—lotteries that we had to win in order for there to be life in the universe. Given that we are justified in inferring intelligent design in the case of John’s winning three consecutive lotteries, we are even more justified in inferring intelligent design in the case of our winning two dozen much more improbable property lotteries. Thus, Schlesinger concludes, the most probable explanation for the remarkable fact that the universe has exactly the right properties to sustain life is that an intelligent Deity intentionally created the universe such as to sustain life.

This argument is vulnerable to a number of criticisms. First, while it might be clear that carbon-based life would not be possible if the universe were slightly different with respect to these two-dozen fine-tuned properties, it is not clear that no form of life would be possible. Second, some physicists speculate that this physical universe is but one material universe in a “multiverse” in which all possible material universes are ultimately realized. If this highly speculative hypothesis is correct, then there is nothing particularly suspicious about the fact that there is a fine-tuned universe, since the existence of such a universe is inevitable (that is, has probability 1) if all every material universe is eventually realized in the multiverse. Since some universe, so to speak, had to win, the fact that ours won does not demand any special explanation.

Schlesinger’s fine-tuning argument also appears vulnerable to the same criticism as the other versions of the design argument (see Himma 2002). While Schlesinger is undoubtedly correct in thinking that we are justified in suspecting design in the case where John wins three consecutive lotteries, it is because—and only because—we know two related empirical facts about such events. First, we already know that there exist intelligent agents who have the right motivations and causal abilities to deliberately bring about such events. Second, we know from past experience with such events that they are usually explained by the deliberate agency of one or more of these agents. Without at least one of these two pieces of information, we are not obviously justified in seeing design in such cases.

As before, the problem for the fine-tuning argument is that we lack both of the pieces that are needed to justify an inference of design. First, the very point of the argument is to establish the fact that there exists an intelligent agency that has the right causal abilities and motivations to bring the existence of a universe capable of sustaining life. Second, and more obviously, we do not have any past experience with the genesis of worlds and are hence not in a position to know whether the existence of fine-tuned universes are usually explained by the deliberate agency of some intelligent agency. Because we lack this essential background information, we are not justified in inferring that there exists an intelligent Deity who deliberately created a universe capable of sustaining life.

ii. The Confirmatory Argument

Robin Collins defends a more modest version of the fine-tuning argument that relies on a general principle of confirmation theory, rather than a principle that is contrived to distinguish events or entities that are explained by intelligent design from events or entities explained by other factors. Collins’s version of the argument relies on what he calls the Prime Principle of Confirmation: If observation O is more probable under hypothesis H1 than under hypothesis H2, then O provides a reason for preferring H1 over H2. The idea is that the fact that an observation is more likely under the assumption that H1 is true than under the assumption H2 is true counts as evidence in favor of H1.

This version of the fine-tuning argument proceeds by comparing the relative likelihood of a fine-tuned universe under two hypotheses:

The Design Hypothesis: there exists a God who created the universe such as to sustain life;
The Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis: there exists one material universe, and it is a matter of chance that the universe has the fine-tuned properties needed to sustain life.

Assuming the Design Hypothesis is true, the probability that the universe has the fine-tuned properties approaches (if it does not equal) 1. Assuming the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis is true, the probability that the universe has the fine-tuned properties is very small—though it is not clear exactly how small. Applying the Prime Principle of Confirmation, Collins concludes that the observation of fine-tuned properties provides reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis.

At the outset, it is crucial to note that Collins does not intend the fine-tuned argument as a proof of God’s existence. As he explains, the Prime Principle of Confirmation “is a general principle of reasoning which tells us when some observation counts as evidence in favor of one hypothesis over another” (Collins 1999, 51). Indeed, he explicitly acknowledges that “the argument does not say that the fine-tuning evidence proves that the universe was designed, or even that it is likely that the universe was designed” (Collins 1999, 53). It tells us only that the observation of fine-tuning provides one reason for accepting the Theistic Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis—and one that can be rebutted by other evidence.

The confirmatory version of the fine-tuning argument is not vulnerable to the objection that it relies on an inference strategy that presupposes that we have independent evidence for thinking the right kind of intelligent agency exists. As a general scientific principle, the Prime Principle of Confirmation can be applied in a wide variety of circumstances and is not limited to circumstances in which we have other reasons to believe the relevant conclusion is true. If the observation of a fine-tuned universe is more probable under the Theistic Hypothesis than under the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis, then this fact is a reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis to Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis.

Nevertheless, the confirmatory version of the argument is vulnerable on other fronts. As a first step towards seeing one worry, consider two possible explanations for the observation that John Doe wins a 1-in-7,000,000 lottery (see Himma 2002). According to the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis, God wanted John Doe to win and deliberately brought it about that his numbers were drawn. According to the Chance Lottery Hypothesis, John Doe’s numbers were drawn by chance. It is clear that John’s winning the lottery is vastly more probable under the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis than under the Chance Lottery Hypothesis. By the Prime Principle of Confirmation, then, John’s winning the lottery provides a reason to prefer the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis over the Chance Lottery Hypothesis.

As is readily evident, the above reasoning, by itself, provides very weak support for the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis. If all we know about the world is that John Doe won a lottery and the only possible explanations for this observation are the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis and the Chance Lottery Hypothesis, then this observation provides some reason to prefer the former. But it does not take much counterevidence to rebut the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis: a single observation of a lottery that relies on a random selection process will suffice. A single application of the Prime Principle of Confirmation, by itself, is simply not designed to provide the sort of reason that would warrant much confidence in preferring one hypothesis to another.

For this reason, the confirmatory version of the fine-tuning argument, by itself, provides a weak reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single Universe Hypothesis. Although Collins is certainly correct in thinking the observation of fine-tuning provides a reason for accepting the Design Hypothesis and hence rational ground for belief that God exists, that reason is simply not strong enough to do much in the way of changing the minds of either agnostics or atheists.

3. The Scientifically Legitimate Uses of Design Inferences

It is worth noting that proponents are correct in thinking that design inferences have a variety of legitimate scientific uses. Such inferences are used to detect intelligent agency in a large variety of contexts, including criminal and insurance investigations. Consider, for example, the notorious case of Nicholas Caputo. Caputo, a member of the Democratic Party, was a public official responsible for conducting drawings to determine the relative ballot positions of Democrats and Republicans. During Caputo’s tenure, the Democrats drew the top ballot position 40 of 41 times, making it far more likely that an undecided voter would vote for the Democratic candidate than for the Republican candidate. The Republican Party filed suit against Caputo, arguing he deliberately rigged the ballot to favor his own party. After noting that the probability of picking the Democrats 40 out of 41 times was less than 1 in 50 billion, the court legitimately made a design inference, concluding that “few persons of reason will accept the explanation of blind chance.”

What proponents of design arguments for God’s existence, however, have not noticed is that each one of these indubitably legitimate uses occurs in a context in which we are already justified in thinking that intelligent beings with the right motivations and abilities exist. In every context in which design inferences are routinely made by scientists, they already have conclusive independent reason for believing there exist intelligent agents with the right abilities and motivations to bring about the apparent instance of design.

Consider, for example, how much more information was available to the court in the Caputo case than is available to the proponent of the design argument for God’s existence. Like the proponent of the design argument, the court knew that (1) the relevant event or feature is something that might be valued by an intelligent agent; and (2) the odds of it coming about by chance are astronomically small. Unlike the proponent of the design argument, however, the court had an additional piece of information available to it: the court already knew that there existed an intelligent agent with the right causal abilities and motives to bring about the event; after all, there was no dispute whatsoever about the existence of Caputo. It was that piece of information, together with (1), that enabled the court to justifiably conclude that the probability that an intelligent agent deliberately brought it about that the Democrats received the top ballot position 40 of 41 times was significantly higher than the probability that this happened by chance. Without this crucial piece of information, however, the court would not have been so obviously justified in making the design inference. Accordingly, while the court was right to infer a design explanation in the Caputo case, this is, in part, because the judges already knew that the right kind of intelligent beings exist—and one of them happened to have occupied a position that afforded him with the opportunity to rig the drawings in favor of the Democrats.

In response, one might be tempted to argue that there is one context in which scientists employ the design inference without already having sufficient reason to think the right sort of intelligent agency exists. As is well-known, researchers monitor radio transmissions for patterns that would support a design inference that such transmissions are sent by intelligent beings. For example, it would be reasonable to infer that some intelligent extraterrestrial beings were responsible for a transmission of discrete signals and pauses that effectively enumerated the prime numbers from 2 to 101. In this case, the intelligibility of the pattern, together with the improbability of its occurring randomly, seems to justify the inference that the transmission sequence is the result of intelligent design.

As it turns out, we are already justified in thinking that the right sort of intelligent beings exist even in this case. We already know, after all, that we exist and have the right sort of motivations and abilities to bring about such transmissions because we send them into space hoping that some other life form will detect our existence. While our existence in the universe—and this is crucial—does not, by itself, justify thinking that there are other intelligent life forms in the universe, it does justify thinking that the probability that there are such life forms is higher than the astronomically small probability (1 in 2¹¹³⁶ to be precise) that a sequence of discrete radio signals and pauses that enumerates the prime numbers from 2 to 101 is the result of chance. Thus, we would be justified in inferring design as the explanation of such a sequence on the strength of three facts: (1) the probability of such a chance occurrence is 1 in 2¹¹³⁶; (2) there exist intelligent beings in the universe capable of bringing about such an occurrence; and (3) the sequence of discrete signals and pauses has a special significance to intelligent beings. In particular, (2) and (3) tell us that the probability that design explains such an occurrence is significantly higher than 1 in 2¹¹³⁶—though it is not clear exactly what the probability is.

Insofar as the legitimate application of design inferences presupposes that we have antecedent reason to believe the right kind of intelligent being exists, they can enable us to distinguish what such beings do from what merely happens. If we already know, for example, that there exist beings capable of rigging a lottery, then design inferences can enable us to distinguish lottery results that merely happen from lottery results that are deliberately brought about by such agents. Similarly, if we already have adequate reason to believe that God exists, then design inferences can enable us to distinguish features of the world that merely happen from features of the world that are deliberately brought about by the agency of God. Indeed, to the extent that we are antecedently justified in believing that God exists, it is obviously more reasonable to believe that God deliberately structured the universe to have the fine-tuned properties than it is to believe that somehow this occurred by chance.

If this is correct, then design inferences simply cannot do the job they are asked to do in design arguments for God’s existence. Insofar as they presuppose that we already know the right kind of intelligent being exists, they cannot stand alone as a justification for believing that God exists. It is the very existence of the right kind of intelligent being that is at issue in the dispute over whether God exists. While design inferences have a variety of scientifically legitimate uses, they cannot stand alone as arguments for God’s existence.

4. References and Further Reading

Michael J. Behe, Darwin’s Black Box: The Biochemical Challenge to Evolution (New York: Touchstone Books, 1996)
Richard Bentley, A Confutation of Atheism from the Origin and Frame of the World (London: H. Mortlock, 1692-1693)
Robin Collins, “A Scientific Argument for the Existence of God,” in Michael J. Murray (ed.), Reason for the Hope Within (Grand Rapids, MI: William B. Eerdmans Publishing Co., 1999)
Charles Darwin, The Origin of Species, Everyman’s Library (London: J.M. Dent, 1947)
Richard Dawkins, The Blind Watchmaker: Why the Evidence of Evolution Reveals a Universe without Design (New York: Norton Publishing, 1996; originally published in 1986)
William Dembski, The Design Inference (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998)
William Dembski, No Free Lunch: Why Specified Complexity Cannot Be Purchased without Intelligence (Rowman & Littlefield, 2002)
William Derham, Physico-theology, or, A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God from his Works of Creation Being the Substance of XVI Sermons Preached in St. Mary le Bow-Church, London, at the Hon’ble Mr. Boyle’s Lectures in the Years 1711 and 1712 (London: W. Innys, 1713)
William Derham, Astro-theology, or, A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God: From a Survey of the Heavens (London: W. Innys, 1715)
Kenneth Einar Himma, “Prior Probabilities and Confirmation Theory: A Problem with the Fine-Tuning Argument,” International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, vol. 51, no. 4 (June 2002)
Kenneth Einar Himma, “The Application-Conditions for Design Inferences: Why the Design Arguments Need the Help of Other Arguments for God’s Existence,”International Journal for Philosophy of Religion., vol. 57, no. 1 (February 2005).
David Hume, Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, edited with an introduction by Norman Kemp Smith, (New York: Social Sciences Publishers, 1948)
Julian Huxley, Evolution as Process (New York: Harper and Row, 1953).
Stephen C. Meyer, “DNA by Design: An Inference to the Best Explanation,” Rhetoric and Public Affairs, vol. 1, no. 4 (Winter 1998)
Stephen C. Meyer, “Evidence for Design in Physics and Biology: From the Origin of the Universe to the Origin of Life,” in Behe, Dembski, and Meyer (eds.), Science and Evidence for Design in the Universe (San Francisco: Ignatius Press, 2002)
William Paley, Natural Theology: Or Evidences of the Existence and Attributes of the Deity Collected from the Appearances of Nature (Boston: Gould and Lincoln, 1867)
Del Ratzsch, Nature, Design, and Science: The Status of Design in Natural Science (Albany, NY: SUNY Press, 2001)
John Ray, The Wisdom of God Manifested in the Works of the Creation Being the Substance of Some Common Places Delivered in the Chappel of Trinity-College, in Cambridge (London: Printed for Samuel Smith, 1691)
Hugh Ross, Beyond the Cosmos: What Recent Discoveries in Astronomy and Physics Reveal about the Nature of God (Colorado Springs: Nav Press, 1996)
George N. Schlesinger, New Perspectives on Old-time Religion (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1988)
Frederick Robert Tennant, Philosophical Theology, Volume 2 (1928-30)

Author Information

Kenneth Einar Himma
Email: himma@spu.edu
Seattle Pacific University
U. S. A.

Naturalism

Table of Contents

1. Introduction

2. Basic Elements of Naturalism Concerning Reality and Knowledge

a. What There Is

b. How We Know

3. Naturalism in Various Versions and Various Contexts

a. Naturalism in Ethics

b. Naturalism in the Philosophy of Mind

4. Overview of the Debate About Naturalism

a. Conclusion

5. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Philosophy of Law

Table of Contents

1. Analytic Jurisprudence

a. Natural Law Theory

b. Legal Positivism

i. The Conventionality Thesis

ii. The Social Fact Thesis

iii. The Separability Thesis

c. Ronald Dworkin’s Third Theory

2. Normative Jurisprudence

a. Freedom and the Limits of Legitimate Law

i. Legal Moralism

ii. Legal Paternalism

iii. The Offense Principle

b. The Obligation to Obey Law

c. The Justification of Punishment

3. Critical Theories of Law

a. Legal Realism

b. Critical Legal Studies

c. Law and Economics

d. Outsider Jurisprudence

4. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Feminist Jurisprudence

Table of Contents

1. Responding to Liberalism: Questions of Perspective

2. Central Concerns: Questions of Theory and Practice

a. Equality and Rights

b. Understanding Harm

c. The Processes of Adjudication

3. Trajectories

4. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Animal Minds

Table of Contents

1. The Problems of Animal Thought and Reason

a. Hume’s Argument for Animal Thought and Reason

b. Descartes’ Two Arguments Against Animal Thought and Reason

i. The Language-Test Argument

ii. The Action-Test Argument

c. Davidson’s Arguments Against Animal Thought and Reason

i. The Intensionality Test

ii. The Argument from Holism

iii. Davidson’s Main Argument

d. Contemporary Philosophical Arguments on Animal Reason

e. Contemporary Philosophical Arguments for Animal Thought and Reason

i. The Intentional Systems Theory Argument

ii. The Argument from Common-Sense Functionalism

iii. The Argument from Biological Naturalism

iv. The Argument from Science

2. The Problems of Animal Consciousness

a. Higher-Order Theories of Consciousness

i. Inner-Sense Theories

ii. Higher-Order Thought Theories

b. First-Order Theories

3. Other Issues

4. References and Further Reading

a. References

b. Suggested Further Readings

Recent Volumes of New Essays in the Philosophy of Animal Mind

Articles and Books on Contemporary Issues in Philosophy of Mind

Author Information

Buddha (c. 500s B.C.E.)

Table of Contents

1. Interpreting the Historical Buddha

a. Dates

b. Sources