Sigmund Freud (1856—1939)

freud Sigmund Freud, the father of psychoanalysis, was a physiologist, medical doctor, psychologist and influential thinker of the early twentieth century. Working initially in close collaboration with Joseph Breuer, Freud elaborated the theory that the mind is a complex energy-system, the structural investigation of which is the proper province of psychology. He articulated and refined the concepts of the unconscious, infantile sexuality and repression, and he proposed a tripartite account of the mind’s structure—all as part of a radically new conceptual and therapeutic frame of reference for the understanding of human psychological development and the treatment of abnormal mental conditions. Notwithstanding the multiple manifestations of psychoanalysis as it exists today, it can in almost all fundamental respects be traced directly back to Freud’s original work.

Freud’s innovative treatment of human actions, dreams, and indeed of cultural artifacts as invariably possessing implicit symbolic significance has proven to be extraordinarily fruitful, and has had massive implications for a wide variety of fields including psychology, anthropology, semiotics, and artistic creativity and appreciation. However, Freud’s most important and frequently re-iterated claim, that with psychoanalysis he had invented a successful science of the mind, remains the subject of much critical debate and controversy.

Life
Backdrop to His Thought
The Theory of the Unconscious
Infantile Sexuality
Neuroses and the Structure of the Mind
Psychoanalysis as a Therapy
Critical Evaluation of Freud
References and Further Reading
1. Works by Freud
2. Works on Freud and Freudian Psychoanalysis

1. Life

Freud was born in Frieberg, Moravia in 1856, but when he was four years old his family moved to Vienna where he was to live and work until the last years of his life. In 1938 the Nazis annexed Austria, and Freud, who was Jewish, was allowed to leave for England. For these reasons, it was above all with the city of Vienna that Freud’s name was destined to be deeply associated for posterity, founding as he did what was to become known as the first Viennese school of psychoanalysis from which flowed psychoanalysis as a movement and all subsequent developments in this field. The scope of Freud’s interests, and of his professional training, was very broad. He always considered himself first and foremost a scientist, endeavoring to extend the compass of human knowledge, and to this end (rather than to the practice of medicine) he enrolled at the medical school at the University of Vienna in 1873. He concentrated initially on biology, doing research in physiology for six years under the great German scientist Ernst Brücke, who was director of the Physiology Laboratory at the University, and thereafter specializing in neurology. He received his medical degree in 1881, and having become engaged to be married in 1882, he rather reluctantly took up more secure and financially rewarding work as a doctor at Vienna General Hospital. Shortly after his marriage in 1886, which was extremely happy and gave Freud six children—the youngest of whom, Anna, was to herself become a distinguished psychoanalyst—Freud set up a private practice in the treatment of psychological disorders, which gave him much of the clinical material that he based his theories and pioneering techniques on.

In 1885-86, Freud spent the greater part of a year in Paris, where he was deeply impressed by the work of the French neurologist Jean Charcot who was at that time using hypnotism to treat hysteria and other abnormal mental conditions. When he returned to Vienna, Freud experimented with hypnosis but found that its beneficial effects did not last. At this point he decided to adopt instead a method suggested by the work of an older Viennese colleague and friend, Josef Breuer, who had discovered that when he encouraged a hysterical patient to talk uninhibitedly about the earliest occurrences of the symptoms, they sometimes gradually abated. Working with Breuer, Freud formulated and developed the idea that many neuroses (phobias, hysterical paralysis and pains, some forms of paranoia, and so forth) had their origins in deeply traumatic experiences which had occurred in the patient’s past but which were now forgotten—hidden from consciousness. The treatment was to enable the patient to recall the experience to consciousness, to confront it in a deep way both intellectually and emotionally, and in thus discharging it, to remove the underlying psychological causes of the neurotic symptoms. This technique, and the theory from which it is derived, was given its classical expression in Studies in Hysteria, jointly published by Freud and Breuer in 1895.

Shortly thereafter, however, Breuer found that he could not agree with what he regarded as the excessive emphasis which Freud placed upon the sexual origins and content of neuroses, and the two parted company, with Freud continuing to work alone to develop and refine the theory and practice of psychoanalysis. In 1900, after a protracted period of self-analysis, he published The Interpretation of Dreams, which is generally regarded as his greatest work. This was followed in 1901 by The Psychopathology of Everyday Life; and in 1905 by Three Essays on the Theory of Sexuality. Freud’s psychoanalytic theory was initially not well received—when its existence was acknowledged at all it was usually by people who were, as Breuer had foreseen, scandalized by the emphasis placed on sexuality by Freud. It was not until 1908, when the first International Psychoanalytical Congress was held at Salzburg that Freud’s importance began to be generally recognized. This was greatly facilitated in 1909, when he was invited to give a course of lectures in the United States, which were to form the basis of his 1916 book Five Lectures on Psycho-Analysis. From this point on Freud’s reputation and fame grew enormously, and he continued to write prolifically until his death, producing in all more than twenty volumes of theoretical works and clinical studies. He was also not averse to critically revising his views, or to making fundamental alterations to his most basic principles when he considered that the scientific evidence demanded it—this was most clearly evidenced by his advancement of a completely new tripartite (id, ego, and super-ego) model of the mind in his 1923 work The Ego and the Id. He was initially greatly heartened by attracting followers of the intellectual caliber of Adler and Jung, and was correspondingly disappointed when they both went on to found rival schools of psychoanalysis—thus giving rise to the first two of many schisms in the movement—but he knew that such disagreement over basic principles had been part of the early development of every new science. After a life of remarkable vigor and creative productivity, he died of cancer while exiled in England in 1939.

2. Backdrop to His Thought

Although a highly original thinker, Freud was also deeply influenced by a number of diverse factors which overlapped and interconnected with each other to shape the development of his thought. As indicated above, both Charcot and Breuer had a direct and immediate impact upon him, but some of the other factors, though no less important than these, were of a rather different nature. First of all, Freud himself was very much a Freudian—his father had two sons by a previous marriage, Emmanuel and Philip, and the young Freud often played with Philip’s son John, who was his own age. Freud’s self-analysis, which forms the core of his masterpiece The Interpretation of Dreams, originated in the emotional crisis which he suffered on the death of his father and the series of dreams to which this gave rise. This analysis revealed to him that the love and admiration which he had felt for his father were mixed with very contrasting feelings of shame and hate (such a mixed attitude he termed ambivalence). Particularly revealing was his discovery that he had often fantasized as a youth that his half-brother Philip (who was of an age with his mother) was really his father, and certain other signs convinced him of the deep underlying meaning of this fantasy—that he had wished his real father dead because he was his rival for his mother’s affections. This was to become the personal (though by no means exclusive) basis for his theory of the Oedipus complex.

Secondly, and at a more general level, account must be taken of the contemporary scientific climate in which Freud lived and worked. In most respects, the towering scientific figure of nineteenth century science was Charles Darwin, who had published his revolutionary Origin of Species when Freud was four years old. The evolutionary doctrine radically altered the prevailing conception of man—whereas before, man had been seen as a being different in nature from the members of the animal kingdom by virtue of his possession of an immortal soul, he was now seen as being part of the natural order, different from non-human animals only in degree of structural complexity. This made it possible and plausible, for the first time, to treat man as an object of scientific investigation, and to conceive of the vast and varied range of human behavior, and the motivational causes from which it springs, as being amenable in principle to scientific explanation. Much of the creative work done in a whole variety of diverse scientific fields over the next century was to be inspired by, and derive sustenance from, this new world-view, which Freud with his enormous esteem for science, accepted implicitly.

An even more important influence on Freud however, came from the field of physics. The second fifty years of the nineteenth century saw monumental advances in contemporary physics, which were largely initiated by the formulation of the principle of the conservation of energy by Helmholz. This principle states, in effect, that the total amount of energy in any given physical system is always constant, that energy quanta can be changed but not annihilated, and that consequently when energy is moved from one part of the system, it must reappear in another part. The progressive application of this principle led to monumental discoveries in the fields of thermodynamics, electromagnetism and nuclear physics which, with their associated technologies, have so comprehensively transformed the contemporary world. As we have seen, when he first came to the University of Vienna, Freud worked under the direction of Ernst Brücke who in 1873-4 published his Lecture Notes on Physiology (Vorlesungen über Physiologie. Vienna: Wilhelm Braumüller), setting out the view that all living organisms, including humans, are essentially energy-systems to which, no less than to inanimate objects, the principle of the conservation of energy applies. Freud, who had great admiration and respect for Brücke, quickly adopted this new dynamic physiology with enthusiasm. From there it was but a short conceptual step—but one which Freud was the first to take, and on which his claim to fame is largely grounded—to the view that there is such a thing as psychic energy, that the human personality is also an energy-system, and that it is the function of psychology to investigate the modifications, transmissions and conversions of psychic energy within the personality which shape and determine it. This latter conception is the very cornerstone of Freud’s psychoanalytic theory.

3. The Theory of the Unconscious

Freud’s theory of the unconscious, then, is highly deterministic—a fact which, given the nature of nineteenth century science, should not be surprising. Freud was arguably the first thinker to apply deterministic principles systematically to the sphere of the mental, and to hold that the broad spectrum of human behavior is explicable only in terms of the (usually hidden) mental processes or states which determine it. Thus, instead of treating the behavior of the neurotic as being causally inexplicable—which had been the prevailing approach for centuries—Freud insisted, on the contrary, on treating it as behavior for which it is meaningful to seek an explanation by searching for causes in terms of the mental states of the individual concerned. Hence the significance which he attributed to slips of the tongue or pen, obsessive behavior and dreams—all these, he held, are determined by hidden causes in the person’s mind, and so they reveal in covert form what would otherwise not be known at all. This suggests the view that freedom of the will is, if not completely an illusion, certainly more tightly circumscribed than is commonly believed, for it follows from this that whenever we make a choice we are governed by hidden mental processes of which we are unaware and over which we have no control.

The postulate that there are such things as unconscious mental states at all is a direct function of Freud’s determinism, his reasoning here being simply that the principle of causality requires that such mental states should exist, for it is evident that there is frequently nothing in the conscious mind which can be said to cause neurotic or other behavior. An unconscious mental process or event, for Freud, is not one which merely happens to be out of consciousness at a given time, but is rather one which cannot, except through protracted psychoanalysis, be brought to the forefront of consciousness. The postulation of such unconscious mental states entails, of course, that the mind is not, and cannot be, either identified with consciousness, or an object of consciousness. To employ a much-used analogy, it is rather structurally akin to an iceberg, the bulk of it lying below the surface, exerting a dynamic and determining influence upon the part which is amenable to direct inspection—the conscious mind.

Deeply associated with this view of the mind is Freud’s account of instincts or drives. Instincts, for Freud, are the principal motivating forces in the mental realm, and as such they energise the mind in all of its functions. There are, he held, an indefinitely large number of such instincts, but these can be reduced to a small number of basic ones, which he grouped into two broad generic categories, Eros (the life instinct), which covers all the self-preserving and erotic instincts, and Thanatos (the death instinct), which covers all the instincts towards aggression, self-destruction, and cruelty. Thus it is a mistake to interpret Freud as asserting that all human actions spring from motivations which are sexual in their origin, since those which derive from Thanatos are not sexually motivated—indeed, Thanatos is the irrational urge to destroy the source of all sexual energy in the annihilation of the self. Having said that, it is undeniably true that Freud gave sexual drives an importance and centrality in human life, human actions, and human behavior which was new (and to many, shocking), arguing as he does that sexual drives exist and can be discerned in children from birth (the theory of infantile sexuality), and that sexual energy (libido) is the single most important motivating force in adult life. However, a crucial qualification has to be added here—Freud effectively redefined the term sexuality to make it cover any form of pleasure which is or can be derived from the body. Thus his theory of the instincts or drives is essentially that the human being is energized or driven from birth by the desire to acquire and enhance bodily pleasure.

4. Infantile Sexuality

Freud’s theory of infantile sexuality must be seen as an integral part of a broader developmental theory of human personality. This had its origins in, and was a generalization of, Breuer’s earlier discovery that traumatic childhood events could have devastating negative effects upon the adult individual, and took the form of the general thesis that early childhood sexual experiences were the crucial factors in the determination of the adult personality. From his account of the instincts or drives it followed that from the moment of birth the infant is driven in his actions by the desire for bodily/sexual pleasure, where this is seen by Freud in almost mechanical terms as the desire to release mental energy. Initially, infants gain such release, and derive such pleasure, from the act of sucking. Freud accordingly terms this the oral stage of development. This is followed by a stage in which the locus of pleasure or energy release is the anus, particularly in the act of defecation, and this is accordingly termed the anal stage. Then the young child develops an interest in its sexual organs as a site of pleasure (the phallic stage), and develops a deep sexual attraction for the parent of the opposite sex, and a hatred of the parent of the same sex (the Oedipus complex). This, however, gives rise to (socially derived) feelings of guilt in the child, who recognizes that it can never supplant the stronger parent. A male child also perceives himself to be at risk. He fears that if he persists in pursuing the sexual attraction for his mother, he may be harmed by the father; specifically, he comes to fear that he may be castrated. This is termed castration anxiety. Both the attraction for the mother and the hatred are usually repressed, and the child usually resolves the conflict of the Oedipus complex by coming to identify with the parent of the same sex. This happens at the age of five, whereupon the child enters a latency period, in which sexual motivations become much less pronounced. This lasts until puberty when mature genital development begins, and the pleasure drive refocuses around the genital area.

This, Freud believed, is the sequence or progression implicit in normal human development, and it is to be observed that at the infant level the instinctual attempts to satisfy the pleasure drive are frequently checked by parental control and social coercion. The developmental process, then, is for the child essentially a movement through a series of conflicts, the successful resolution of which is crucial to adult mental health. Many mental illnesses, particularly hysteria, Freud held, can be traced back to unresolved conflicts experienced at this stage, or to events which otherwise disrupt the normal pattern of infantile development. For example, homosexuality is seen by some Freudians as resulting from a failure to resolve the conflicts of the Oedipus complex, particularly a failure to identify with the parent of the same sex; the obsessive concern with washing and personal hygiene which characterizes the behavior of some neurotics is seen as resulting from unresolved conflicts/repressions occurring at the anal stage.

5. Neuroses and the Structure of the Mind

Freud’s account of the unconscious, and the psychoanalytic therapy associated with it, is best illustrated by his famous tripartite model of the structure of the mind or personality (although, as we have seen, he did not formulate this until 1923). This model has many points of similarity with the account of the mind offered by Plato over 2,000 years earlier. The theory is termed tripartite simply because, again like Plato, Freud distinguished three structural elements within the mind, which he called id, ego, and super-ego. The id is that part of the mind in which are situated the instinctual sexual drives which require satisfaction; the super-ego is that part which contains the conscience, namely, socially-acquired control mechanisms which have been internalized, and which are usually imparted in the first instance by the parents; while the ego is the conscious self that is created by the dynamic tensions and interactions between the id and the super-ego and has the task of reconciling their conflicting demands with the requirements of external reality. It is in this sense that the mind is to be understood as a dynamic energy-system. All objects of consciousness reside in the ego; the contents of the id belong permanently to the unconscious mind; while the super-ego is an unconscious screening-mechanism which seeks to limit the blind pleasure-seeking drives of the id by the imposition of restrictive rules. There is some debate as to how literally Freud intended this model to be taken (he appears to have taken it extremely literally himself), but it is important to note that what is being offered here is indeed a theoretical model rather than a description of an observable object, which functions as a frame of reference to explain the link between early childhood experience and the mature adult (normal or dysfunctional) personality.

Freud also followed Plato in his account of the nature of mental health or psychological well-being, which he saw as the establishment of a harmonious relationship between the three elements which constitute the mind. If the external world offers no scope for the satisfaction of the id’s pleasure drives, or more commonly, if the satisfaction of some or all of these drives would indeed transgress the moral sanctions laid down by the super-ego, then an inner conflict occurs in the mind between its constituent parts or elements. Failure to resolve this can lead to later neurosis. A key concept introduced here by Freud is that the mind possesses a number of defense mechanisms to attempt to prevent conflicts from becoming too acute, such as repression (pushing conflicts back into the unconscious), sublimation (channeling the sexual drives into the achievement socially acceptable goals, in art, science, poetry, and so forth), fixation (the failure to progress beyond one of the developmental stages), and regression (a return to the behavior characteristic of one of the stages).

Of these, repression is the most important, and Freud’s account of this is as follows: when a person experiences an instinctual impulse to behave in a manner which the super-ego deems to be reprehensible (for example, a strong erotic impulse on the part of the child towards the parent of the opposite sex), then it is possible for the mind to push this impulse away, to repress it into the unconscious. Repression is thus one of the central defense mechanisms by which the ego seeks to avoid internal conflict and pain, and to reconcile reality with the demands of both id and super-ego. As such it is completely normal and an integral part of the developmental process through which every child must pass on the way to adulthood. However, the repressed instinctual drive, as an energy-form, is not and cannot be destroyed when it is repressed—it continues to exist intact in the unconscious, from where it exerts a determining force upon the conscious mind, and can give rise to the dysfunctional behavior characteristic of neuroses. This is one reason why dreams and slips of the tongue possess such a strong symbolic significance for Freud, and why their analysis became such a key part of his treatment—they represent instances in which the vigilance of the super-ego is relaxed, and when the repressed drives are accordingly able to present themselves to the conscious mind in a transmuted form. The difference between normal repression and the kind of repression which results in neurotic illness is one of degree, not of kind—the compulsive behavior of the neurotic is itself a manifestation of an instinctual drive repressed in childhood. Such behavioral symptoms are highly irrational (and may even be perceived as such by the neurotic), but are completely beyond the control of the subject because they are driven by the now unconscious repressed impulse. Freud positioned the key repressions for both, the normal individual and the neurotic, in the first five years of childhood, and of course, held them to be essentially sexual in nature; since, as we have seen, repressions which disrupt the process of infantile sexual development in particular, according to him, lead to a strong tendency to later neurosis in adult life. The task of psychoanalysis as a therapy is to find the repressions which cause the neurotic symptoms by delving into the unconscious mind of the subject, and by bringing them to the forefront of consciousness, to allow the ego to confront them directly and thus to discharge them.

6. Psychoanalysis as a Therapy

Freud’s account of the sexual genesis and nature of neuroses led him naturally to develop a clinical treatment for treating such disorders. This has become so influential today that when people speak of psychoanalysis they frequently refer exclusively to the clinical treatment; however, the term properly designates both the clinical treatment and the theory which underlies it. The aim of the method may be stated simply in general terms—to re-establish a harmonious relationship between the three elements which constitute the mind by excavating and resolving unconscious repressed conflicts. The actual method of treatment pioneered by Freud grew out of Breuer’s earlier discovery, mentioned above, that when a hysterical patient was encouraged to talk freely about the earliest occurrences of her symptoms and fantasies, the symptoms began to abate, and were eliminated entirely when she was induced to remember the initial trauma which occasioned them. Turning away from his early attempts to explore the unconscious through hypnosis, Freud further developed this talking cure, acting on the assumption that the repressed conflicts were buried in the deepest recesses of the unconscious mind. Accordingly, he got his patients to relax in a position in which they were deprived of strong sensory stimulation, and even keen awareness of the presence of the analyst (hence the famous use of the couch, with the analyst virtually silent and out of sight), and then encouraged them to speak freely and uninhibitedly, preferably without forethought, in the belief that he could thereby discern the unconscious forces lying behind what was said. This is the method of free-association, the rationale for which is similar to that involved in the analysis of dreams—in both cases the super-ego is to some degree disarmed, its efficiency as a screening mechanism is moderated, and material is allowed to filter through to the conscious ego which would otherwise be completely repressed. The process is necessarily a difficult and protracted one, and it is therefore one of the primary tasks of the analyst to help the patient recognize, and overcome, his own natural resistances, which may exhibit themselves as hostility towards the analyst. However, Freud always took the occurrence of resistance as a sign that he was on the right track in his assessment of the underlying unconscious causes of the patient’s condition. The patient’s dreams are of particular interest, for reasons which we have already partly seen. Taking it that the super-ego functioned less effectively in sleep, as in free-association, Freud made a distinction between the manifest content of a dream (what the dream appeared to be about on the surface) and its latent content (the unconscious, repressed desires or wishes which are its real object). The correct interpretation of the patient’s dreams, slips of tongue, free-associations, and responses to carefully selected questions leads the analyst to a point where he can locate the unconscious repressions producing the neurotic symptoms, invariably in terms of the patient’s passage through the sexual developmental process, the manner in which the conflicts implicit in this process were handled, and the libidinal content of the patient’s family relationships. To create a cure, the analyst must facilitate the patient himself to become conscious of unresolved conflicts buried in the deep recesses of the unconscious mind, and to confront and engage with them directly.

In this sense, then, the object of psychoanalytic treatment may be said to be a form of self-understanding—once this is acquired it is largely up to the patient, in consultation with the analyst, to determine how he shall handle this newly-acquired understanding of the unconscious forces which motivate him. One possibility, mentioned above, is the channeling of sexual energy into the achievement of social, artistic or scientific goals—this is sublimation, which Freud saw as the motivating force behind most great cultural achievements. Another possibility would be the conscious, rational control of formerly repressed drives—this is suppression. Yet another would be the decision that it is the super-ego and the social constraints which inform it that are at fault, in which case the patient may decide in the end to satisfy the instinctual drives. But in all cases the cure is created essentially by a kind of catharsis or purgation—a release of the pent-up psychic energy, the constriction of which was the basic cause of the neurotic illness.

7. Critical Evaluation of Freud

It should be evident from the foregoing why psychoanalysis in general, and Freud in particular, have exerted such a strong influence upon the popular imagination in the Western World, and why both the theory and practice of psychoanalysis should remain the object of a great deal of controversy. In fact, the controversy which exists in relation to Freud is more heated and multi-faceted than that relating to virtually any other post-1850 thinker (a possible exception being Darwin), with criticisms ranging from the contention that Freud’s theory was generated by logical confusions arising out of his alleged long-standing addiction to cocaine (see Thornton, E.M. Freud and Cocaine: The Freudian Fallacy) to the view that he made an important, but grim, empirical discovery, which he knowingly suppressed in favour of the theory of the unconscious, knowing that the latter would be more socially acceptable (see Masson, J. The Assault on Truth).

It should be emphasized here that Freud’s genius is not (generally) in doubt, but the precise nature of his achievement is still the source of much debate. The supporters and followers of Freud (and Jung and Adler) are noted for the zeal and enthusiasm with which they espouse the doctrines of the master, to the point where many of the detractors of the movement see it as a kind of secular religion, requiring as it does an initiation process in which the aspiring psychoanalyst must himself first be analyzed. In this way, it is often alleged, the unquestioning acceptance of a set of ideological principles becomes a necessary precondition for acceptance into the movement—as with most religious groupings. In reply, the exponents and supporters of psychoanalysis frequently analyze the motivations of their critics in terms of the very theory which those critics reject. And so the debate goes on.

Here we will confine ourselves to: (a) the evaluation of Freud’s claim that his theory is a scientific one, (b) the question of the theory’s coherence, (c) the dispute concerning what, if anything, Freud really discovered, and (d) the question of the efficacy of psychoanalysis as a treatment for neurotic illnesses.

a. The Claim to Scientific Status

This is a crucially important issue since Freud saw himself first and foremost as a pioneering scientist, and repeatedly asserted that the significance of psychoanalysis is that it is a new science, incorporating a new scientific method of dealing with the mind and with mental illness. There can, moreover, be no doubt but that this has been the chief attraction of the theory for most of its advocates since then—on the face of it, it has the appearance of being not just a scientific theory but an enormously strong one, with the capacity to accommodate, and explain, every possible form of human behavior. However, it is precisely this latter which, for many commentators, undermines its claim to scientific status. On the question of what makes a theory a genuinely scientific one, Karl Popper’s criterion of demarcation, as it is called, has now gained very general acceptance: namely, that every genuine scientific theory must be testable, and therefore falsifiable, at least in principle. In other words, if a theory is incompatible with possible observations, it is scientific; conversely, a theory which is compatible with all possible observations is unscientific (see Popper, K. The Logic of Scientific Discovery). Thus the principle of the conservation of energy (physical, not psychic), which influenced Freud so greatly, is a scientific one because it is falsifiable—the discovery of a physical system in which the total amount of physical energy was not constant would conclusively show it to be false. It is argued that nothing of the kind is possible with respect to Freud’s theory—it is not falsifiable. If the question is asked: “What does this theory imply which, if false, would show the whole theory to be false?,” the answer is “Nothing” because the theory is compatible with every possible state of affairs. Hence it is concluded that the theory is not scientific, and while this does not, as some critics claim, rob it of all value, it certainly diminishes its intellectual status as projected by its strongest advocates, including Freud himself.

b. The Coherence of the Theory

A related (but perhaps more serious) point is that the coherence of the theory is, at the very least, questionable. What is attractive about the theory, even to the layman, is that it seems to offer us long sought-after and much needed causal explanations for conditions which have been a source of a great deal of human misery. The thesis that neuroses are caused by unconscious conflicts buried deep in the unconscious mind in the form of repressed libidinal energy would appear to offer us, at last, an insight in the causal mechanism underlying these abnormal psychological conditions as they are expressed in human behavior, and further show us how they are related to the psychology of the normal person. However, even this is questionable, and is a matter of much dispute. In general, when it is said that an event X causes another event Y to happen, both X and Y are, and must be, independently identifiable. It is true that this is not always a simple process, as in science causes are sometimes unobservable (sub-atomic particles, radio and electromagnetic waves, molecular structures, and so forth), but in these latter cases there are clear correspondence rules connecting the unobservable causes with observable phenomena. The difficulty with Freud’s theory is that it offers us entities (for example repressed unconscious conflicts), which are said to be the unobservable causes of certain forms of behavior But there are no correspondence rules for these alleged causes—they cannot be identified except by reference to the behavior which they are said to cause (that is, the analyst does not demonstratively assert: “This is the unconscious cause, and that is its behavioral effect;” rather he asserts: “This is the behavior, therefore its unconscious cause must exist”), and this does raise serious doubts as to whether Freud’s theory offers us genuine causal explanations at all.

c. Freud’s Discovery

At a less theoretical, but no less critical level, it has been alleged that Freud did make a genuine discovery which he was initially prepared to reveal to the world. However, the response he encountered was so ferociously hostile that he masked his findings and offered his theory of the unconscious in its place (see Masson, J. The Assault on Truth). What he discovered, it has been suggested, was the extreme prevalence of child sexual abuse, particularly of young girls (the vast majority of hysterics are women), even in respectable nineteenth century Vienna. He did in fact offer an early seduction theory of neuroses, which met with fierce animosity, and which he quickly withdrew and replaced with the theory of the unconscious. As one contemporary Freudian commentator explains it, Freud’s change of mind on this issue came about as follows:

Questions concerning the traumas suffered by his patients seemed to reveal [to Freud] that Viennese girls were extraordinarily often seduced in very early childhood by older male relatives. Doubt about the actual occurrence of these seductions was soon replaced by certainty that it was descriptions about childhood fantasy that were being offered. (MacIntyre).

In this way, it is suggested, the theory of the Oedipus complex was generated.

This statement begs a number of questions, not least, what does the expression extraordinarily often mean in this context? By what standard is this being judged? The answer can only be: By the standard of what we generally believe—or would like to believe—to be the case. But the contention of some of Freud’s critics here is that his patients were not recalling childhood fantasies, but traumatic events from their childhood which were all too real. Freud, according to them, had stumbled upon and knowingly suppressed the fact that the level of child sexual abuse in society is much higher than is generally believed or acknowledged. If this contention is true—and it must at least be contemplated seriously—then this is undoubtedly the most serious criticism that Freud and his followers have to face.

Further, this particular point has taken on an added and even more controversial significance in recent years, with the willingness of some contemporary Freudians to combine the theory of repression with an acceptance of the wide-spread social prevalence of child sexual abuse. The result has been that in the United States and Britain in particular, many thousands of people have emerged from analysis with recovered memories of alleged childhood sexual abuse by their parents; memories which, it is suggested, were hitherto repressed. On this basis, parents have been accused and repudiated, and whole families have been divided or destroyed. Unsurprisingly, this in turn has given rise to a systematic backlash in which organizations of accused parents, seeing themselves as the true victims of what they term False Memory Syndrome, have denounced all such memory-claims as falsidical — the direct product of a belief in what they see as the myth of repression. (see Pendergast, M. Victims of Memory). In this way, the concept of repression, which Freud himself termed the foundation stone upon which the structure of psychoanalysis rests, has come in for more widespread critical scrutiny than ever before. Here, the fact that, unlike some of his contemporary followers, Freud did not himself ever countenance the extension of the concept of repression to cover actual child sexual abuse, and the fact that we are not necessarily forced to choose between the views that all recovered memories are either veridical or falsidical are frequently lost sight of in the extreme heat generated by this debate, perhaps understandably.

d. The Efficacy of Psychoanalytic Therapy

It does not follow that, if Freud’s theory is unscientific, or even false, it cannot provide us with a basis for the beneficial treatment of neurotic illness because the relationship between a theory’s truth or falsity and its utility-value is far from being an isomorphic one. The theory upon which the use of leeches to bleed patients in eighteenth century medicine was based was quite spurious, but patients did sometimes actually benefit from the treatment! And of course even a true theory might be badly applied, leading to negative consequences. One of the problems here is that it is difficult to specify what counts as a cure for a neurotic illness as distinct, say, from a mere alleviation of the symptoms. In general, however, the efficiency of a given method of treatment is usually clinically measured by means of a control group—the proportion of patients suffering from a given disorder who are cured by treatment X is measured by comparison with those cured by other treatments, or by no treatment at all. Such clinical tests as have been conducted indicate that the proportion of patients who have benefited from psychoanalytic treatment does not diverge significantly from the proportion who recover spontaneously or as a result of other forms of intervention in the control groups used. So, the question of the therapeutic effectiveness of psychoanalysis remains an open and controversial one.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Freud

The Standard Edition of the Complete Psychological Works of Sigmund Freud (Ed. J. Strachey with Anna Freud), 24 vols. London: 1953-1964.

b. Works on Freud and Freudian Psychoanalysis

Abramson, J.B. Liberation and Its Limits: The Moral and Political Thought of Freud. New York: Free Press, 1984.
Bettlelheim, B. Freud and Man’s Soul. Knopf, 1982.
Cavell, M. The Psychoanalytic Mind: From Freud to Philosophy. Harvard University Press, 1993.
Cavell, M. Becoming a Subject: Reflections in Philosophy and Psychoanalysis. New York: Oxford University Press, 2006.
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Author Information

Stephen P. Thornton
University of Limerick
Ireland

Elizabeth Cady Stanton (1815—1902)

Elizabeth Cady Stanton was one of the most influential public figures in nineteenth-century America. She was one of the nation’s first feminist theorists and certainly one of its most productive activists. She was in the tradition of Abigail Adams, who implored her husband John to “remember the ladies” as he helped form the new American nation. Along with Susan B. Anthony, Stanton fueled the movement for women’s suffrage. She advocated for change in both the public and private lives of women–regarding property rights, equal education, employment opportunity, more liberal divorce provisions, and child custody rights. By addressing such a wide range of women’s issues, she laid down the foundation for the three main branches of feminism that are in existence today: liberal feminism, which focuses on women’s similarities to men and emphasizes equality; cultural feminism, which celebrates women’s differences from men and aims for gender equity; and dominance feminism, which focuses on male power / female submission and aims to overturn all forms of gender hierarchy.

Stanton was motivated by liberal humanist ideals of egalitarianism and individual autonomy, which were an outgrowth of the Enlightenment. She was familiar with the philosophical thinkers whose works and ideas were discussed among American intellectuals at the time: Jean-Jacques Rousseau, Immanuel Kant, Mary Wollstonecraft, Johann Wolfgang Goethe, Alexis de Tocqueville, and later John Stuart Mill and Harriet Taylor Mill. Stanton’s writings and speeches demonstrate this. In addition, her years of studying and bantering with the apprentices in her father’s law office ensured that she was acquainted with the works of English legal theorists Edward Coke, William Blackstone, and Jeremy Bentham, as well as with those of her father’s influential colleagues, Joseph Story and James Kent.

Although she was theoretically minded, Stanton had no interest in living the life of an intellectual, removed from the hubbub of social and political life. In fact, her feminist theory grew out of the real-life problems women faced in her age and was developed to solve them. This places her squarely in the American tradition established by Benjamin Franklin, of developing philosophical thought that can be applied to everyday life. Stanton, then, could be termed an applied philosopher or a philosopher-practitioner. She did not seek out theory for theory’s sake, but instead put theory into practice for the purpose of improving social and political life.

Early Life and Education
Marriage and Family in an Activist World
Women’s Rights Activism
Writings and Influence
1. The Woman’s Bible
Conclusion
References and Further Reading

1. Early Life and Education

Elizabeth Cady, the third surviving child and second of the five daughters of Margaret (formerly Livingston) and Daniel Cady (1773-1859), was born November 12, 1815, in Johnstown, New York. Her mother was from a well-to-do family with ties to the American Revolution. Margaret Livingston’s father had been a colonel in the Continental Army, assisting in the capture of John Andre, one of Benedict Arnold’s co-conspirators. Daniel Cady was a prominent lawyer and politician in the state of New York. He became a member of the New York State Assembly (1808-13), held office as a member of Congress (1815-17), and served on the New York Supreme Court (1847-54).

From a young age, Elizabeth was keenly aware of the gender-based power imbalances that were in place in her day. With bitterness, she later recounted the many times her father responded to her aspirations and achievements by declaiming that she should have been born a boy. After the death of her older brother, the only boy in the family to have reached adulthood, she resolved to do her best to fill the void his death left in her father’s life. She learned to play chess and ride a horse. She studied Greek with the family’s minister, the Rev. Simon Hosack. She entered Johnstown Academy and won prizes and awards. Though still unable to please and impress her father to her satisfaction, these moments clearly motivated her to achieve. In all likelihood, Daniel Cady was not quite as indifferent to his daughter’s achievements, nor as hostile to feminism as her memoir sometimes suggests. His laments that she was not a boy were perhaps more a recognition of the social constraints she would face as a grown woman than an expression of his own need for a son.

When Elizabeth was a child, she overheard a conversation her father had with a woman, a would-be client for whom the law provided no remedy. She voiced her dismay to her father, and this is the counsel he gave her: “When you are grown up, and able to prepare a speech, you must go down to Albany and talk to the legislators; tell them all you have seen in this office–the sufferings of these Scotchwomen . . . if you can persuade them to pass new laws, the old ones will be a dead letter” (Eighty Years, pp. 31-32). Prior to their conversation, young Elizabeth’s plan had been to destroy all the laws that were unjust to women by cutting them out of his law books! His advice gave her an alternative and foreshadowed the career she would make for herself as a reformer.

Born into a world of wealth and privilege, Elizabeth benefited from a better education than most girls were granted in her day. After attending Johnstown Academy, she entered the Troy Female Seminary. She felt it unjust that she was barred from attending the more academically rigorous Union College, then an all-male institution. While she gained greater understanding of women and feminine culture at Troy, overall her experience there convinced her that male-female co-education is superior to single-sex education. Seeing and visiting with men was such a novelty at Troy that it created an almost unnatural obsession with the other sex. In Elizabeth’s view it also exaggerated any differences between the genders and intensified the deficiencies of each.

Elizabeth did not complete a degree at Troy. In part this was because of the influence of the evangelist Charles Finney, a pivotal regional figure in America’s “Second Great Awakening”. Attendance at Finney’s revival sessions was mandatory at Troy, and several of her classmates were readily converted by his “fire and brimstone” sermons. Yet his preaching left Elizabeth terrified and perplexed. She considered his calls to give her heart to Jesus irrational, if not incomprehensible, and she refused to repent. Even so, she was still disturbed by the images of hell and damnation Finney had planted in her mind. Her parents, like many traditional Protestants, rejected the heightened emotionalism of Finney’s evangelical fervor and allowed her to withdraw from Troy. They treated her to a retreat in Niagara where all talk of religion was forbidden, so that she could settle herself and regain her spiritual bearings. After this exposure to Protestant revivalism, Elizabeth remained a religious skeptic for the rest of her life.

Elizabeth continued to study on her own after her time at Troy Seminary. She read the moral philosophy of George Combe and discussed the novels of Sir Walter Scott, James Fenimore Cooper, and Charles Dickens with her brother-in-law Edward Bayard. She also spent time with her intellectual and reform-minded cousins in nearby Peterboro, New York. These were the children of her mother’s sister Elizabeth (Livingston) and her husband Peter Smith.

In the Smith household, Elizabeth was exposed to a number of new people as well as to new social and political ideas. Her aunt and uncle were egalitarians not only in the ideal, but in the everyday, sense. Their home was open to African Americans on their way to freedom in Canada as well as to Oneida Indians they had befriended. It also teemed with activists and intellectuals who discussed, debated and strategized about the social and political events of the day–chief among them abolition. Her uncle, Peter Smith, was a staunch advocate of racial equality who sought an end to American slavery. Her cousin Gerrit Smith followed closely in his father’s footsteps. Gerrit and his friends in the abolition movement would not only influence Elizabeth, but introduce lifelong challenges as she and other social reformers sought to bring full equality to all people, regardless of color, creed, or gender.

2. Marriage and Family in an Activist World

It was at the home of her cousin, Gerrit Smith, that Elizabeth Cady met Henry Stanton, a man ten years her senior. He was already an extremely prominent and influential abolitionist orator. Beginning his career as a journalist, Stanton met Theodore Weld while attending the Rochester Manual Labor Institute and Weld was touring the country to learn more about manual labor schools. Both were compelling public speakers. Both were committed to social and political reform. And both had been influenced by Charles Finney. In Rochester, Stanton first met Finney when he was serving as replacement pastor at a local church. Like Weld–and in stark contrast to his future wife–Stanton was thoroughly impressed by Finney as an orator and theological thinker. In contrast to Elizabeth Cady’s response, the excesses of Finney’s fire and brimstone approach were of no concern to Stanton. He was simply full of awe and admiration for the man.

Stanton and Weld became lifelong friends, and at Weld’s behest, Stanton began attending the newly-established Lane Theological Seminary in 1832. Lane was based on the manual labor model and initially was a great success. In 1834 however, a student-sponsored debate over slavery raised the ire of the institution’s board of trustees, and a gag order was issued: Henceforth, no events related to political issues were to be held without prior approval from the board. Nearly half the students at the seminary–Stanton and Weld among them–withdrew from the institution in protest. Stanton then began working alongside Weld, first as an agent of the American Anti-Slavery Society, then as an officer of the organization. Studying law under Daniel Cady after he and Elizabeth married, Henry then became a lawyer and a political operative. He aspired to hold office himself, and succeeded in doing so for a short time in the early 1850s. However, he was mostly known as an orator, a social/political activist, and a journalist, writing for the Anti-Slavery Standard, The Liberator, The New York Tribune, and The New York Sun.

In the 1830s, Stanton was a frequent visitor to the Smith household and a chief contributor to their many discussions about social and political issues. When Elizabeth and Stanton met in 1839, she was under the illusion that he was already married. So her earliest interactions with him were as simply an acquaintance who shared his interest in abolition, not as a potential love interest. Once the two discovered the misunderstanding, they began courting against the wishes of Elizabeth’s father. Daniel Cady was no more fond of abolitionism than he was of social reformers in general, and Stanton’s personal cause with Cady was not helped by his questionable financial viability.

After succumbing to family pressure and breaking her engagement to Stanton, Elizabeth had a change of heart, and the two married hastily in May 1840. They then went to London, where Henry was due to serve as a delegate at the World Antislavery Convention. Well-known within women’s rights history is the fact that none of the female delegates at the meeting were allowed to take a seat on the convention floor, but were segregated behind a screen in the balcony. This enraged Elizabeth as well as other American women present, such as Lucretia Mott, Abby Southwick, and Elizabeth Neal. Significantly, Henry gave a speech in favor of full participation by the women present, but his support stopped there. He did not join William Lloyd Garrison and a handful of other male delegates when they sat in the women’s section as an act of protest against such overt inequality.

Henry Stanton’s moderate support of women’s rights in London signaled an ongoing point of disconnect between Elizabeth and her husband. His passion was for abolition. The suffragists and feminists argued that women needed more social and political freedom than they currently had. For Henry, however, the plight of slaves held in bondage, abused, oppressed, and murdered at their masters’ whim was a far greater concern than women’s liberty to fill out a ballot or to hold office. Elizabeth’s passion was for women’s rights. Certainly American slavery was cruel and unjust, but the system of oppression that permitted it was the same system that allowed men to rule over women with arbitrary and capricious authority. A woman who was married to a kind and egalitarian man was simply lucky. The legal system still maintained the power of all men over their wives, no matter how cruel and unkind they may be.

Biographers have debated whether Henry was truly an advocate of Elizabeth’s quest for women’s rights, merely moderately supportive, or actually antagonistic to both her quest and her stature as a suffragist. Like both Henry Blackwell and Theodore Weld, Stanton accepted Elizabeth’s decision to excise the word “obey” from the vows she spoke at their wedding. The minister performing the ceremony was troubled by this detour from convention, and Elizabeth was convinced that the lengthy prayer he offered after the ceremony–lasting nearly an hour–was payback for this crucial omission from their marriage vows. There is no evidence that the matter troubled her husband. Even so, others in their reform-minded circles went further to advance equality in marriage. Theodore Weld, who wed the feminist and abolitionist Angelina Grimke in 1838, vowed to treat his wife as an equal partner in their marriage. Marrying in 1855, Henry Blackwell went much further, denouncing marriage as an institution that enforced male dominance over women. In addition, Blackwell accepted Lucy Stone’s decision to keep her own surname after marriage, the first woman on record in America to have done so. Other male reformers supported or worked alongside their wives in the suffrage struggle. For example, Henry Blackwell spoke on behalf of women’s suffrage and essentially co-edited The Woman’s Journal with Stone. Clearly, Henry Stanton did not match this level of commitment to his wife’s suffrage work.

Yet the level of support that Henry Stanton gave to Elizabeth’s work as a women’s rights advocate must also be measured by the standard set by her father. Daniel Cady repeatedly lamented the fact that Elizabeth was female because he believed her intellect and forceful personality would go to waste in a woman. Women in the world they lived in were meant to attend to the hearth and home, not to go out into the world to become intellectuals or, worse still, rabble-rousing activists. At the same time, her father was not completely unmoved by seeing Elizabeth act on her convictions. After she read one of her upcoming women’s rights speeches to him, he asked if she–a woman of position, privilege, and relative power–genuinely believed that she was at a disadvantage as a woman. When Elizabeth responded by reminding him of all the laws that privileged men and harmed women, her father turned to his law books to provide her with another example that would help further illustrate her point. While never more than outwardly lukewarm to her feminist efforts, Daniel Cady often provided support in this way–giving her legal ammunition to use in her writings and speeches.

Elizabeth was accustomed to receiving only the dimmest signs of approval from her father. So as an adult, she neither expected nor needed the motivation of resounding applause for her suffrage work from Henry Stanton. She had found her calling as a women’s rights advocate, and though she was a formidable force at the podium, Henry was always able to write to his “Dear Lizzie” when the two were apart. Though not a proponent of women’s rights himself, he does not appear to have been hostile to her leadership role in the women’s movement. It simply seems that, like her father, he found it difficult to fully comprehend Elizabeth’s passion for women’s rights when he saw her as a woman of considerable privilege. Because both Elizabeth and Henry were fairly protective of their private life together, it may be impossible to know for certain how each felt about the other’s reform work. Each seems to have been impressed by the other’s achievements in their chosen reform efforts, though neither was exactly a cheerleader for the other’s cause.

After the London antislavery convention, Elizabeth and Henry toured Europe for six months, returning home in the winter and settling with Elizabeth’s parents. During this period, Henry studied law under Daniel Cady, before taking up a position in Boston in 1843. In Boston Elizabeth met prominent reformers and intellectuals, among them Lydia Maria Child, Frederick Douglass, Ralph Waldo Emerson, Margaret Fuller, Nathaniel Hawthorne, Robert Lowell, Abby Kelly, Elizabeth Palmer Peabody, John Greenleaf Whittier, and Paulina Wright. She regularly listened to the sermons of the radical Unitarian and abolitionist minister, Theodore Parker, and was eager to attend the “conversations” of Amos Bronson Alcott and Margaret Fuller. She also visited the utopian Brook Farm community, admiring its idealism, though not the spartan way of life of its inhabitants.

Elizabeth loved Boston, and the art, culture, and intellectual life it had to offer. The loss of all this made the adjustment to rural life difficult for her when, in 1847, the couple moved to Seneca Falls in upstate New York. But with a house generously provided by Daniel Cady for his daughter’s growing family, there was really no way the couple could refuse. By 1847 they had three children, and there would be more–each named in honor of a beloved family member or friend: David Cady (born 1842), Henry Brewster (1844), Gerrit Smith (1845), Theodore Weld (1851), Margaret Livingston (1852), Harriot Eaton (1856) and Robert Livingston (1859).

3. Women’s Rights Activism

Elizabeth Cady Stanton became acquainted with women’s rights activists for the first time at the antislavery convention in London. Women’s abilities, achievements, and rights had been of concern to her since her youth, when she bantered with boys at Johnstown Academy and with the young men apprenticing at her father’s law office. Yet it was her experience as a housewife in Seneca Falls that prompted her to take action on behalf of women’s rights.

In her earliest years as a wife and mother, Cady Stanton found fulfillment in managing a household. In fact, she thrived on the day-to-day challenge to do so with order and efficiency. After a time, the novelty had worn off, and she found housework mundane and depressing. She also found herself sympathizing with everyday women who did not have the same access to power and privilege that she had. Assisting victims of domestic abuse in the area on several occasions, Cady Stanton saw how the same unjust laws that she had intuitively resented and wanted to change as a child were especially burdensome to women without means. Just at this point in her life, an invitation for a visit came from Lucretia Mott, who was only eight miles away in Waterloo. Cady Stanton eagerly took the trip to meet with Mott and other reformers in the community, and the idea was born to hold a convention to discuss women’s rights. In one afternoon, the group planned and announced the two-day meeting, the first of its kind. It was to be held only five days later. The event was a success that far exceeded the expectations of Cady Stanton and her convention co-planners. While a group of about fifty devoted social reformers from nearby Rochester and Syracuse were expected to participate, over two hundred people attended. Nearly seventy signed the Declaration of Sentiments, which Cady Stanton had authored, modeling it after the American Declaration of Independence.

The Seneca Falls Women’s Rights Convention was followed a month later by another such meeting in Rochester, thus setting in motion a tradition that was to shape the nineteenth century women’s movement. Conventions to discuss women’s rights were held annually between 1850 and 1860, with Elizabeth Cady Stanton and her good friend and colleague, Susan B. Anthony, playing complementary roles. Anthony was the strategist, tactician, and all-round logistics coordinator. Cady Stanton was the philosophical thinker, writer, and theoretician. Anthony sometimes chastised Cady Stanton for letting family obligations, namely childrearing, get in the way of her women’s rights work. At the same time, however, she was known to Elizabeth’s children as “Aunt Susan”. After they had turned seven they often went on extended visits to Anthony’s home in Rochester, a landmark in their lives later described with awe and wonder.

A network of countless brilliant and talented women worked to advance women’s rights in nineteenth-century America, among them Amelia Bloomer, Olympia Brown, Paulina Wright Davis, Abby Foster, Matilda Joslyn Gage, Frances Watkins Harper, Isabella Beecher Hooker, Julia Ward Howe, Mary Ashton Rice Livermore, Lucreita Mott, Ernestine Rose, Caroline Severance, Anna Howard Shaw, Lucy Stone, Sojourner Truth, Frances Willard and Victoria Woodhull. The lifelong friendship of two of them, Elizabeth Cady Stanton and Susan B. Anthony, makes for a unique and compelling story. On the surface, the two could not have been more different. Cady Stanton was born of privilege, had a forceful and sometimes challenging personality, was fond of luxury, was a religious skeptic, and refused to believe that women had to choose between motherhood and public activism. Anthony was not born into wealth, had a quiet and calm demeanor, eschewed self-indulgence, was a devout Quaker who later converted to Unitarianism, and felt strongly that domesticity seriously compromised women’s participation in public life. But for some reason, the contrasts between Cady Stanton and Anthony served to complement, rather than to compete with, each other. Anthony had a room in Cady Stanton’s home where she was welcome to stay at any time. When Cady Stanton was unable to attend a convention, Anthony would often read the speech Elizabeth had written. Writing with eloquence, Cady Stanton could pen an essay or speech with ease, an ability that Anthony greatly admired.

While the relationship between Stanton and Anthony remained stable, the movement they were part of was not always placid. During the Civil War, suffrage leaders agreed to focus on supporting the war effort, forming the Women’s Loyal League. Once the war had ended and slavery had been abolished, Stanton and Anthony joined Frederick Douglass and others to form the American Equal Suffrage Association. This organization was devoted to securing voting rights for newly-freed African Americans and for all women simultaneously. However, when the fifteenth amendment to the Constitution was being ratified without the word “sex” included in the text, the branch of the women’s suffrage movement that was led by Stanton and Anthony was outraged. The text read: “The right of citizens of the United States to vote shall not be denied or abridged by the United States or by any state on account of race, color, or previous condition of servitude”. It was inconceivable to Stanton and her colleagues that their male advocates had failed to bring women along in the struggle for voting rights. In response Stanton and her white female colleagues made arguments on behalf of women that today smack of elitism, if not outright racism. How, they asked, could persons who were uneducated and lacking autonomy while held for years in bondage be given the right to vote when well-educated and “cultured” white women continued to be treated like children at best, chattel at worst? In their anger, they allied themselves with race-baiters in the months prior to the amendment’s passage. Stanton, Anthony, and others felt strongly that any change to the constitution involving voting rights simply must be universal–it must include African American males and females, as well as white women and others who did not yet hold the franchise. Yet clearly the pair of activists were willing to turn a blind eye to the ways in which their arguments fueled the fires of race-hate across the nation.

The race issue contributed to a schism in the women’s movement that would last for two decades. Some women, led by Lucy Stone and joined by Julia Ward Howe and Caroline Severance, formed a new organization based in Boston, the American Woman’s Suffrage Association. The AWSA ultimately endorsed the amendment giving only African American males the vote, believing that their good will and co-operative spirit would be rewarded in time. Unfortunately the NWSA and the AWSA had to struggle to distinguish themselves from each other to the rank and file of women’s rights supporters. They printed rival publications to promote women’s rights from the perspective of the leaders of each organization. Stanton and Anthony published The Revolution (1868-1872) and Stone The Woman’s Journal (1870-1917). They also competed for members and political support. It was not until 1890 that the divided movement reunited and was renamed the National American Suffrage Association, continuing the voting rights struggle for another thirty years.

4. Writings and Influence

As noted, Elizabeth Cady Stanton was an eloquent and prolific writer. While she served as the philosopher of the suffrage movement, Susan B. Anthony served as its strategist. Historians have noted that their respective strengths complemented each other. Equally significant is the different approaches they took to securing rights for women. Anthony was single-minded in her quest for the vote as the stepping stone that would provide women access to all other rights. If only women could vote and hold public office, they would then be able to self-advocate: Women could vote for candidates with policies that empower and support women and their families. They could press for changes to laws related to marriage, divorce, and custody for children. Women could help enact any number of provisions that would give them more power and influence in society. If only they had the vote.

Stanton also believed in the power of voting rights, but she also saw no reason not to carry on the battle for women’s equality on all fronts at once. Women had needed property rights when legislatures began to pass them in the 1830s and ‘40s. They continued to need and deserve other rights related to property and financial self-determination in the 1860s, ‘70s, and ‘80s, and Stanton spoke out about how and why these rights should be granted. Similarly, laws dealing with the most intimate aspects of women’s lives–marriage, divorce, and child custody–merited attention in Stanton’s “here and now,” not at some future time when women would hold the power of the franchise.

Stanton’s published works addressed four main areas of feminist concern: personal/social freedom, marriage/family matters, legal/political rights and religion’s role and influence. Chief among the social constraints that restricted women’s freedom in Stanton’s day was access to education. She began discussing this subject early in her work as a reformer. Prohibitions against rigorous academic training for girls and women thwarted their intellectual growth and thus the levels of personal and social development they could achieve. The tradition of single-sex education further exacerbated this problem. The respective weaknesses of men and women (which Stanton believed were not natural to each gender but nurtured by social norms and values) were reinforced when they were deprived of interaction. This perpetuated the imbalance of power based on gender. The inferior education women received when Stanton began her work also had the potential to contribute to women’s moral inferiority. Without properly exercising their intellectual powers and being challenged to make difficult academic and moral distinctions, women were unable to function as independent decision-makers. This harmed not only women as individuals, but also the social institutions they are a part of: The family, the local community, and the state. In this sense, Stanton laid the foundation for what would later be called liberal feminism, a school of feminist thought which maintains that women are more similar to men than they are different from them. Thus, it aims for equal treatment of men and women, particularly in matters related to education, employment, pay equity and political participation.

Stanton was among the more bold women’s rights advocates in her era in that she took on issues relating to marriage that other suffragists considered off-limits. She and Anthony both referred to the institution of marriage as it existed in their time as “male marriage”, that is, a civil union made for and by men, which was used to perpetuate male power and authority. Among the most controversial was divorce. She was under none of the popular illusions that marriage was a blessed institution that, fairytale-like, brought out the best in people. She resented the suggestion that a virtuous and patient woman could persuade–through her love, faith or virtue–a domineering, alcoholic or abusive man to become a more kind and considerate husband. Women were only and always harmed by their relationships with such men in Stanton’s view. Their own moral character was compromised, as was the overall moral tone of their home and family. Speaking in favor of pending legislation in New York that would liberalize divorce policies, Stanton said that rather than prevent a woman from leaving an abusive and alcoholic husband, the law should prohibit such men from getting married. Such a policy would go much farther toward protecting the institution of marriage than the laws that prevailed in the day were able to do. Here we see in Stanton’s thought a kernel of what would later become dominance feminism. This is a branch of feminist thought that focuses on the differences between men and women. It concludes that, whether natural or socially constructed, gender distinctions are used to reinforce male dominance and female submission. Like Stanton, today’s dominance feminists are concerned with marriage and divorce. They also venture into territory that Stanton and her contemporaries only dared to hint at in the age of Victorian propriety: Domestic violence, rape, incest, pornography, and prostitution. The aim of dominance feminism is to overturn the male power structure that makes these abuses of women possible.

Stanton’s discussion of the legal and political rights of women is the best known within popular discussions of women’s history today. Women’s right to participate fully in public, political life was certainly of paramount importance to her. Over and over in her lectures and essays, Stanton emphasized the ways in which men’s dominance in public life disabled and disgraced women. With men as the chief arbiters of legal and political right, women were rendered “civilly dead” as Stanton so eloquently termed it at the Seneca Falls convention. Women were powerless to stop their husbands if they chose to squander the family’s resources, even if the source of those resources was the savings or inheritance that women themselves had brought into their households. Men made all the laws regarding education, employment, marriage, divorce, child custody, property, inheritance, breaches of the civil and the criminal codes–every aspect of life that could and did affect women’s lives, but over which women were powerless to effect change. Men thus became like monarchs ruling over all classes of society, who could readily wield tyrannical force, if they willed to do so. All the other social inequalities that concerned Stanton trickled down from this one arena–that of legal and political rights.

Significantly, when Stanton spoke in favor of universal suffrage–that is, of extending voting rights to not only all African American males but also to all women–after the Civil War, she cautioned against maintaining distinctions among the various classes of people in society. The entire class of African Americans held in slavery had been prohibited from voting since the founding of the country. As legislators considered extending the franchise, Stanton implored them to erase all similar social distinctions. Women should no longer be treated as a separate class of individuals who are prohibited from voting any more than newly freed African Americans should. On American soil, Stanton said, all citizens were to be granted equal consideration in this way.

This stance, too, created some friction for Stanton as the post-Civil War discourse on voting rights got underway. She and Anthony were absolutely unyielding in their call for women’s full political equality. While other suffragists, like Lucy Stone, were willing to consider partial suffrage, which would allow women to vote on local issues of concern to them, like education or municipal budgets, Stanton and Anthony held firm: Women are equal in all ways to men and should be treated as such. At times they displayed their own class biases on this point. Why should an ignorant and uneducated man of any race be granted the right to vote in all matters when well-educated and cultured women were allowed to vote only about matters like school policies and local road construction? Most critically, as the post-War discussion advanced and feminists were being urged to accept this as “the Negro’s hour” (as Frederick Douglass so famously put it), Lucy Stone and others were willing to surrender women’s voting rights for the time being to appease their allies in Congress. Stone and others assumed the discussion of women’s voting rights would be resumed in a timely fashion, but they believed that, for the peace of the nation, they needed to step aside temporarily. Stanton and Anthony saw the writing on the wall, as such, and held to insisting on female suffrage until the very last legislators had cast their vote. Ultimately, the controversy over universal suffrage resulted in the schism between Stone and her camp and the Stanton-Anthony coalition discussed above.

a. The Woman’s Bible

Stanton had always been critical of the ways in which the Christian churches contributed to women’s oppression, but she addressed this topic head-on in the last decade of her life. In publishing The Woman’s Bible, Stanton was far ahead of the feminist curve. Biblical criticism of any sort was relatively new, having been initiated in mid-nineteenth-century Germany by thinkers like Johann Gottfried Eichhorn (1752–1827), Wilhelm Martin Leberecht de Wette (1780–1849) and Julius Wellhausen (1844–1918). The idea of a largely secular examination of the Bible that investigated its implications, flaws and shortcomings as related to women was virtually unthought of.

The Woman’s Bible consists of a collection of essays by a committee of women intellectuals on passages of the Judeo-Christian scriptures that discuss women. Stanton and her colleagues took a critical approach to the story of Eve in the Garden of Eden, for instance. First of all, the story is deemed an allegory, not a factual account. Darwin’s theory of evolution provides us with a more plausible account of the development of human beings over time, not in one act of creation. Secondly, Eve is praised, rather than blamed, for taking the fruit, because this act demonstrates her thirst for knowledge. As one contributor stated it, “Fearless of death if she can gain wisdom [she] takes of the fruit” (The Woman’s Bible, p. 26). The work takes a similar realist approach to the story of Jesus’ life. Cady Stanton and her contributors readily write about him as a man, not as God nor even as God’s Son. Stanton’s view on the miracles he performed is that human development is such that any human being could perform miracles, if only they have the will to make themselves as pure and good as Jesus was.

Other passages, such as those that recount the marriages of the patriarchs, are discussed so as to reify ideals of marital love. In both the Old and New Testament passages, Stanton and her contributors highlight and heighten the role of the women in question. They put particular emphasis on Miriam’s role in the quest for Jewish freedom, for instance. They also discuss the important work of Deborah the judge, as well as of female disciples in the early Christian church, noting that they were committed to their cause and were conveyors of God’s word. In this sense, Stanton sowed the seed of cultural feminism–the ideal that women bring a special perspective and set of values to their participation in society. Therefore they bring a special set of values that needs to be recognized, understood, and appreciated.

The overall objective of The Woman’s Bible was to use textual analysis and historical criticism to dismantle the traditional interpretation of any one biblical passage and replace it with a feminine, if not a feminist, perspective. The effort was a success on this level. Though it went into additional printings, The Woman’s Bible brought Elizabeth Cady Stanton a great deal of criticism, more for her audacity in taking on the project than in what she actually said about the Bible or its merits.

Although Stanton’s efforts in The Woman’s Bible did not match the increasingly rigorous standards of her contemporaries in theology who were beginning their own critical examinations of the Jewish and Christian scriptures, neither did it fail as an intellectual exercise. This was simply a groundbreaking work, which called into question a number of widely accepted claims about the nature of God, God’s esteem for and relation to women, and women’s place within faith communities. It also paved the way for future work for and by women in religion in the twentieth century. Second wave feminists in the 1960s and 1970s, who were struggling for the full ordination of women in the Christian and Jewish traditions, relied heavily on this early work of early feminist criticism by Stanton. Academic women in the same era were inspired by her example and produced more modern and academically rigorous works that scrutinized sacred texts and religious traditions from a feminist perspective as well. Despite her own religious skepticism, Stanton would have been heartened to have seen a future in which over half of the students in mainstream Protestant seminaries are women, and the ordination of women is commonplace in liberal Protestant and Jewish traditions.

5. Conclusion

Certainly Elizabeth Cady Stanton had an immense amount of influence in her day; her influence and her legacy continue even if she is not always an overtly recognized source by today’s feminists. At the heart of her ideals and advocacy lies a blurring of the distinction between the “public” world of law and politics, and the “private” world of home and family–a distinction that held sway through so much of the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries. Feminists in the 1970s and ‘80s would craft a mantra of sorts that got to the heart of this distinction-blurring: “The personal is political”. Cady Stanton’s work is truly the source of such thinking. Stanton wanted the “public” realm, particularly law and politics, to be imported into the home. She wanted to bring an end to the abuse and neglect men were allowed to impose on women because the law turned a blind eye to domestic violence as a “private” matter. Other women activists of the day, such as Frances Willard the temperance activist, wanted to see women’s “private” virtues exported into the public realm: Give us access to the vote, and we will clean up the crime and corruption of the “public” political realm. Susan B. Anthony’s position represented a middle ground. She rejected the public/private distinction as much as Cady Stanton did, but she did so from a different angle and for different reasons. Access to the vote and the ability to hold public office would allow women to speak for themselves and act on their own behalf. If they are dissatisfied with the laws governing marriage and divorce, then give them voting rights and let them change such laws.

Fond of luxury and susceptible to self-indulgence all her life, Elizabeth Cady Stanton became obese late in life and suffered from maladies that were related to her overall poor health: Fading eyesight, decreased mobility and chronic fatigue. Even so she remained active and engaged in life, and optimistic that women would indeed succeed in winning the vote in the twentieth century. At the very least she could rest knowing that she had passed on the legacy of the suffrage struggle to her daughter’s generation of women’s rights activists. Stanton’s daughter, Harriot Stanton Blatch, was a feminist activist in her own right who helped compile the six-volume History of Woman’s Suffrage, which Stanton, Anthony, Matilda Joslyn Gage and others had begun in 1881. While her daughter was able to vote for the last twenty years of her life, Elizabeth Cady Stanton was never able to register a ballot. She died October 26, 1902, in New York City, just shy of eighteen years before the passage of the nineteenth amendment.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Elizabeth Cady Stanton

“Address of Mrs. Elizabeth Cady Stanton”, delivered at Seneca Falls and Rochester (July and August, 1848).
“It is so Unladylike” (1853).
“I Have all the Rights I Want” (1858).
“The Slave’s Appeal” (1860).
“Appeal to the Women of New York” (1860).
“Address of Elizabeth Cady Stanton on the Divorce Bill”, before the Judiciary Committee of the New York Senate (February 1861).
“Free Speech” (1861).
“Address in Favor of Universal Suffrage” before the Judiciary Committees of the Legislature of New York (January 1867).
“Marriage/Divorce” (1871).
- A memorial for Victoria Woodhull, so later than 1871 in actuality.
“Woman Suffrage,” delivered to the Judiciary Committee of the House of Representatives (1890).
“Patriotism and chastity” (1891).
“Solitude of Self,” delivered to the Judiciary Committee of the United States Congress (January 1892).
“Suffrage, a Natural Right” (1894).
The Woman’s Bible (1895). New York: European Publishing Company.
“Bible and Church Degrade Woman” (1898).
Eighty Years and More (1898). New York: European Publishing Company.
Elizabeth Cady Stanton Papers, Rutgers University Archives.

b. Biographical and Historical Works Relating to Elizabeth Cady Stanton

Baker, Jean (2005). Sisters: The Lives of America’s Suffragists. New York: Hill and Wang.
Davis, Sue (2009). The Political Thought of Elizabeth Cady Stanton. New York: New York University Press.
DuBois, Ellen Carol (1981). Elizabeth Cady Stanton, Susan B. Anthony: Correspondence, Writings, Speeches. Boston: Northeastern University Press.
Gage, Matilda Joslyn, and others. A History of Woman Suffrage (in six volumes, 1881-1922). New York: C. Mann.
Ginzberg, Lori D. (2009). Elizabeth Cady Stanton: An American Life. New York: Hill and Wang.
Griffith, Elisabeth (1984). In Her Own Right: The Life of Elizabeth Cady Stanton. New York: Oxford University Press.
Matthews, Jean V. (1997). Women’s Struggle for Equality: The First Phase, 1828-1876. Lanham, MD: Ivan R. Dee Pub.
Stanton, Henry B. (1885). Random Recollections. New York: Harper & Bros.
Stanton, Theodore and Harriot Stanton Blatch (1922). Elizabeth Cady Stanton. New York: Harper & Bros.

c. Papers and Articles Relating to Daniel Cady

Cady, Daniel. Letters and Papers at Syracuse University Library.
- Also includes some of Elizabeth Cady Stanton’s letters to her relatives.
“Retirement of Judge Daniel Cady,” New York Times (January 25, 1855).
“Daniel Cady”, in Biographical Directory of the United States Congress. Washington, DC: United States Government Printing Office.
Raymond, William (1851). “Daniel Cady,” in Biographical Sketches of Distinguished Men of Columbia County (New York). Albany, NY: Weed, Parsons, & Co.

Author Information

Dorothy Rogers
Email: rogersd@mail.montclair.edu
Montclair State University
U.S.A.

Relational Models Theory

Relational Models Theory is a theory in cognitive anthropology positing a biologically innate set of elementary mental models and a generative computational system operating upon those models. The computational system produces compound models, using the elementary models as a kind of lexicon. The resulting set of models is used in understanding, motivating, and evaluating social relationships and social structures. The elementary models are intuitively quite simple and commonsensical. They are as follows: Communal Sharing (having something in common), Authority Ranking (arrangement into a hierarchy), Equality Matching (striving to maintain egalitarian relationships), and Market Pricing (use of ratios). Even though Relational Models Theory is classified as anthropology, it bears on several philosophical questions.

It contributes to value theory by describing a mental faculty which plays a crucial role in generating a plurality of values. It thus shows how a single human nature can result in conflicting systems of value. The theory also contributes to philosophy of cognition. The complex models evidently result from a computational operation, thus supporting the view that a part of the mind functions computationally. The theory contributes to metaphysics. Formal properties posited by the theory are perhaps best understood abstractly, raising the possibility that these mental models correspond to abstract objects. If so, then Relational Models Theory reveals a Platonist ontology.

The Theory
Philosophical Implications
References
1. Specifically Addressing Relational Models Theory
2. Related Issues

1. The Theory

a. The Elementary Models

The anthropologist Alan Page Fiske pioneered Relational Models Theory (RMT). RMT was originally conceived as a synthesis of certain constructs concerning norms formulated by Max Weber, Jean Piaget, and Paul Ricoeur. Fiske then explored the theory among the Moose people of Burkina Faso in Africa. He soon realized that its application was far more general, giving special insight into human nature. According to RMT, humans are naturally social, using the relational models to structure and understand social interactions, the application of these models seen as intrinsically valuable. All relational models, no matter how complex, are, according to RMT, analyzable by four elementary models: Communal Sharing, Authority Ranking, Equality Matching, Market Pricing.

Any relationship informed by Communal Sharing presupposes a bounded group, the members of which are not differentiated from each other. Distinguishing individual identities are socially irrelevant. Generosity within a Communal Sharing group is not usually conceived of as altruism due to this shared identity, even though there is typically much behavior which otherwise would seem like extreme altruism. Members of a Communal Sharing relationship typically feel that they share something in common, such as blood, deep attraction, national identity, a history of suffering, or the joy of food. Examples include nationalism, racism, intense romantic love, indiscriminately killing any member of an enemy group in retaliation for the death of someone in one’s own group, sharing a meal.

An Authority Ranking relationship is a hierarchy in which individuals or groups are placed in relative higher or lower relations . Those ranked higher have prestige and privilege not enjoyed by those who are lower. Further, the higher typically have some control over the actions of those who are lower. However, the higher also have duties of protection and pastoral care for those beneath them. Metaphors of spatial relation, temporal relation, and magnitude are typically used to distinguish people of different rank. For example, a King having a larger audience room than a Prince, or a King arriving after a Prince for a royal banquet. Further examples include military rankings, the authority of parents over their children especially in more traditional societies, caste systems, and God’s authority over humankind. Brute coercive manipulation is not considered to be Authority Ranking; it is more properly categorized as the Null Relation in which people treat each other in non-social ways.

In Equality Matching, one attempts to achieve and sustain an even balance and one-to-one correspondence between individuals or groups. When there is not a perfect balance, people try to keep track of the degree of imbalance in order to calculate how much correction is needed. “Equality matching is like using a pan balance: People know how to assemble actions on one side to equal any given weight on the other side” (Fiske 1992, 691). If you and I are out of balance, we know what would restore equality. Examples include the principle of one-person/one-vote, rotating credit associations, equal starting points in a race, taking turns offering dinner invitations, and giving an equal number of minutes to each candidate to deliver an on-air speech.

Market Pricing is the application of ratios to social interaction. This can involve maximization or minimization as in trying to maximize profit or minimize loss. But it can also involve arriving at an intuitively fair proportion, as in a judge deciding on a punishment proportional to a crime. In Market Pricing, all socially relevant properties of a relationship are reduced to a single measure of value, such as money or pleasure. Most utilitarian principles involve maximization. An exception would be Negative Utilitarianism whose principle is the minimization of suffering. But all utilitarian principles are applications of Market Pricing, since the maximum and the minimum are both proportions. Other examples include rents, taxes, cost-benefit analyses including military estimates of kill ratios and proportions of fighter planes potentially lost, tithing, and prostitution.

RMT has been extensively corroborated by controlled studies based on research using a great variety of methods investigating diverse phenomena, including cross-cultural studies (Haslam 2004b). The research shows that the elementary models play an important role in cognition including perception of other persons.

b. Resemblance to Classic Measurement Scales

It may be jarring to learn that intense romantic love and racism are both categorized as Communal Sharing or that tithing and prostitution are both instances of Market Pricing. These examples illustrate that a relational model is, at its core, a meaningless formal structure. Implementation in interpersonal relations and attendant emotional associations enter in on a different level of mental processing. Each model can be individuated in purely formal terms, each elementary model strongly resembling one of the classic scale types familiar from measurement theory. (Strictly speaking, it is each mod which can be individuated in purely formal terms. This finer point will be discussed in the next section.)

Communal Sharing resembles a nominal (categorical) scale. A nominal scale is simply classifying things into categories. A questionnaire may be designed to categorize people as theist, atheist, agnostic, and other. Such a questionnaire is measuring religious belief by using a nominal scale. The groups into which Communal Sharing sorts people is similar. One either belongs to a pertinent group or one does not, there being no degree or any shades of gray. Another illustration of nominal scaling is the pass/fail system of grading. Authority Ranking resembles an ordinal scale in which items are ranked. The ranking of students according to their performance is one example. The ordered classification of shirts in a store as small, medium, large, and extra large is another. Equality Matching resembles an interval scale. On interval scales , any unit measures the same magnitude on any point in the scale. For example, on the Celsius scale the difference between 1 degree and 2 degrees is the same as the difference between 5 degrees and 6 degrees. Equality Matching resembles an interval scale insofar as one can measure the degree of inequality in a social relationship using equal intervals so as to judge how to correct the imbalance. It is by use of such a scale that people in an Equality Matching interaction can specify how much one person owes another. However, an interval scale cannot be used to express a ratio because it has no absolute zero point. For example, the zero point on the Celsius scale is not absolute so one cannot say that 20 degrees is twice as warm as 10 degrees while on a Kelvin scale because the zero point is absolute one can express ratios. Given that Market Pricing is the application of ratios to social interactions, it resembles a ratio scale such as the Kelvin scale. One cannot, for example, meaningfully speak of the maximization of utility without presupposing some sort of ratio scale for measuring utility. Maximization would correspond to 100 percent.

c. Self-Organization and Natural Selection

The four measurement scales correspond to different levels of semantic richness and precision. The nominal scale conveys little information, being very coarse grained. For example, pass/fail grading conveys less information than ranking students. Giving letter grades is even more precise and semantically rich, conveying how much one student out-performs another. This is the use of an interval scale. The most informative and semantically rich is a percentage grade which illustrates the ratio by which one student out-performs another, hence a ratio scale. For example, if graded accurately a student scoring 90 percent has done twice as well as a student scoring 45 percent. Counterexamples may be apparent: two students could be ranked differently while receiving the same letter grade by using a deliberately coarse-grained letter grading system so as to minimize low grades. To take an extreme case, a very generous instructor might award an A to every student (after all, no student was completely lost in class) while at the same time mentally ranking the students in terms of their performance. Split grades are sometimes used to smooth out the traditional coarse-grained letter grading system . But, if both scales are as sensitive as possible and based on the same data, the interval scale will convey more information than the ordinal scale. The ordinal ranking will be derivable from the interval grading, but not vice versa. This is more obvious in the case of temperature measurement, in which grade inflation is not an issue. Simply ranking objects in terms of warmer/colder conveys less information than does Celsius measurement.

One scale is more informative than another because it is less symmetrical; greater asymmetry means that more information is conveyed. On a measurement scale, a permutation which distorts or changes information is an asymmetry. Analogously, a permutation in a social-relational arrangement which distorts or changes social relations is an asymmetry. In either case, a permutation which does not carry with it such a distortion or change is symmetric. The nominal scale type is the most symmetrical scale type, just as Communal Sharing is the most symmetrical elementary model. In either case, the only asymmetrical permutation is one which moves an item out of a category, for example, expelling someone from the social group. Any permutation within the category or group makes no difference; no difference to the information conveyed, no difference to the social relation. In the case of pass/fail grading, the student’s performance could be markedly different from what it actually was. So long as the student does well enough to pass (or poorly enough to fail), this would not have changed the grade. Thanks to this high degree of symmetry, the nominal scale conveys relatively little information.

The ordinal scale is less symmetrical. Any permutation that changes rankings is asymmetrical, since it distorts or changes something significant. But items arranged could change in many respects relative to each other while their ordering remains unaffected, so a high level of symmetry remains. Students could vary in their performance, but so long as their relative ranking remains the same, this would make no difference to grades based on an ordinal scale.

An interval scale is even less symmetrical and hence more informative, as seen in the fact that a system of letter grades conveys more information than does a mere ranking of students. An interval scale conveys the relative degrees of difference between items. If one student improves from doing C level work to B level work, this would register on an interval scale but would remain invisible on an ordinal scale if the change did not affect student ranking. Analogously, in Equality Matching, if one person, and one person only, were to receive an extra five minutes to deliver their campaign speech, this would be socially significant. By contrast, in Authority Ranking, the addition of an extra five minutes to the time taken by a Prince to deliver a speech would make no socially significant difference provided that the relative ranking remains undisturbed (for example, the King still being allotted more time than the Prince, and the Duke less than the Prince).

In Market Pricing, as in any ratio scale, the asymmetry is even greater. Adding five years to the punishment of every convict could badly skew what should be proportionate punishments. But giving an extra five minutes to each candidate would preserve balance in Equality Matching.

The symmetries of all the scale types have an interesting formal property. They form a descending symmetry subgroup chain. In other words, the symmetries of a ratio scale form a subset of the symmetries of a relevant interval scale, the symmetries of that scale form a subset of the symmetries of a relevant ordinal scale, and the symmetries of that scale form a subset of the symmetries of a relevant nominal scale. More specifically, the scale types form a containment hierarchy. Analogously, the symmetries of Market Pricing form a subset of the symmetries of Equality Matching which form a subset of the symmetries of Authority Ranking which form a subset of the symmetries of Communal Sharing. Descending subgroup chains are common in nature, including inorganic nature. The symmetries of solid matter form a subset of the symmetries of liquid matter which form a subset of the symmetries of gaseous matter which form a subset of the symmetries of plasma.

This raises interesting questions about the origins of these patterns in the mind: could they result from spontaneous symmetry breakings in brain activity rather than being genetically encoded? Darwinian adaptations are genetically encoded, whereas spontaneous symmetry breaking is ubiquitous in nature rather than being limited to genetically constrained structures. The appeal to spontaneous symmetry breaking suggests a non-Darwinian approach to understanding how the elementary models could be “innate” (in the sense of being neither learned nor arrived at through reason). That is, are the elementary relational models results of self-organization rather than learning or natural selection? If they are programmed into the genome, why would this programming imitate a pattern in nature which usually occurs without genetic encoding? The spiral shape of a galaxy, for example, is due to spontaneous symmetry breaking, as is the transition from liquid to solid. But these transitions are not encoded in genes, of course. Being part of the natural world, why should the elementary models be understood any differently?

d. Compound Models

While all relational models are analyzable into four fundamental models, the number of models as such is potentially infinite. This is because social-relational cognition is productive; any instance of a model can serve as a constituent in an even more complex instance of a model. Consider Authority Ranking and Market Pricing; an instance of one can be embedded in or subordinated to an instance of the other. When a judge decides on a punishment that is proportionate to the crime, the judge is using a ratio scale and hence Market Pricing. But the judge is only authorized to do this because of her authority, hence Authority Ranking. We have here a case of Market Pricing embedded in a superordinate (as opposed to subordinate) structure of Authority Ranking resulting in a compound model. Now consider ordering food from a waiter. The superordinate relationship is now Market Pricing, since one is paying for the waiter’s service. But the service itself is Authority Ranking with the customer as the superior party. In this case, an instance of Authority Ranking is subordinate to an instance of Market Pricing. This is also a compound model with the same constituents but differently arranged. The democratic election of a leader is Authority Ranking subordinated to Equality Matching. An elementary school teacher’s supervising children to make sure they take turns is Equality Matching subordinated to Authority Ranking.

A model can also be embedded in a model of the same type. In some complex egalitarian social arrangements, one instance of Equality Matching can be embedded in another. Anton Pannekoek’s proposed Council Communism is one such example. The buying and selling of options is the buying and selling of the right to buy and sell, hence recursively embedded Market Pricing. Moose society is largely structured by a complex model involving multiple levels of Communal Sharing. A family among the Moose is largely structured by Communal Sharing, as is the village which embeds it, as is the larger community that embeds the village, and so on. In principle, there is no upper limit on the number of embeddings in a compound model. Hence, the number of potential relational models is infinite.

e. Mods and Preos

A model, whether elementary or compound, is devoid of meaning when considered in isolation. As purely abstract structures, models are sometimes known as “mods” , which is an abbreviation of, “cognitively modular but modifiable modes of interacting” (Fiske 2004, 3). (This may be a misnomer, since, as purely formal structures devoid of semantic content, mods are not modes of social interaction any more than syntax. is a communication system.) In order to externalize models, that is, in order to use them to interpret or motivate or structure interactions, one needs “preos,” these being “socially transmitted prototypes, precedents, and principles that complete the mods, specifying how, when and with respect to whom the mods apply” (2004, 4). Strictly speaking, a relational model is the union of a mod with a preo. A mod has the formal properties of symmetry, asymmetry, and in some cases embeddedness. But a mod requires a preo in order to have the properties intuitively identifiable as meaningful, such as social application, emotional resonance, and motivating force.

The notion of a preo updates and includes the notion of an implementation rule, from an earlier stage of relational-models theorizing. Fiske has identified five kinds of implementation rules (1991, 142). One kind specifies the domain to which a model applies. For example, in some cultures Authority Ranking is used to structure and give meaning to marriage. In other cultures, Authority Ranking does not structure marriage and may even be viewed as immoral in that context. Another sort of implementation rule specifies the individuals or groups which are to be related by the model. Communal Sharing, for example, can be applied to different groups of people. Experience, and sometimes also agreement, decides who is in the Communal Sharing group. In implementing Authority Ranking, it is not enough to specify how many ranks there are. One must also specify who belongs to which rank. A third sort of implementation rule defines values and categories. In Equality Matching, each participant must give or receive the same thing. But what counts as the same thing? In Authority Ranking, a higher-up deserves honor from a lower-down, but what counts as honor and what constitutes showing honor? There are no a priori or innate answers to these questions; culture and mutual agreement help settle such matters. Consider the principle of one-person/one-vote, an example of Equality Matching. Currently in the United States and Great Britain, whoever gets the most votes wins the election. But it is also possible to have a system in which a two-thirds majority is necessary for there to be a winner. Without a two-thirds majority, there may be a coalition government, a second election with the lowest performing candidates eliminated, or some other arrangement. These are different ways of determining what counts as treating each citizen as having an equal say. A fourth determines the code used to indicate the existence and quality of the relationship. Authority Ranking is coded differently in different cultures, as it can be represented by the size of one’s office, the height of one’s throne, the number of bars on one’s sleeve, and so forth. A fifth sort of implementation rule concerns a general tendency to favor some elementary models over others. For example, Market Pricing may be highly valued in some cultures as fair and reasonable while categorized as dehumanizing in others. The same is clearly true of Authority Ranking. Communal Sharing is much more prominent and generally valued in some cultures than in others. This does not mean that any culture is completely devoid of any specific elementary model but that some models are de-emphasized and marginalized in some cultures as compared to others. So the union of mod and preo may even serve to marginalize the resulting model in relation to other models.

The fact that the same mod can be united with different preos is one source of normative plurality across cultures, to be discussed in the next section. Another source is the generation of distinct compound mods. Different cultures can use different mods, since there is a considerable number of potential mods to choose from.

2. Philosophical Implications

a. Moral Psychology

Each elementary model crucially enters into certain moral values. An ethic of service to one’s group is a form of Communal Sharing. It is an altruistic ethic in some sense, but bear in mind that all members of the group share a common identity. So, strictly speaking, it is not true altruism. Authority Ranking informs an ethic of obedience to authority including respect, honor, and loyalty. Any questions of value remaining to be clarified are settled by the authority; subordinates are expected to follow the values thus dictated. Fairness and even distribution are informed by Equality Matching. John Rawls’ veil of ignorance exemplifies Equality Matching; a perspective in which one does not know which role one will play guarantees that one aim for equality. Gregory Vlastos has even attempted to reduce all distributive justice to a framework that can be identified with Equality Matching. Market Pricing informs libertarian values of freely entering into contracts and taking risks with the aim of increasing one’s own utility or the utility of one’s group. But this also includes suffering the losses when one’s calculations prove incorrect. Utilitarianism is a somewhat counterintuitive attempt to extend this sort of morality to all sentient life, but is still recognizable as Market Pricing. It would be too simple, however, to say that there are only four sorts of values in RMT. In fact, combinations of models yield complex models, resulting in a potential infinity of complex values. Potential variety is further increased by the variability of possible preos. This great variety of values leads to value conflicts most noticeably across cultures.

RMT strongly suggests value pluralism, in Isaiah Berlin’s sense of “pluralism”. The pluralism in question is a cultural pluralism, different traditions producing mutually incommensurable values. Berlin drew a distinction between relativism and pluralism, even though there are strong similarities between the two. Relativism and pluralism both acknowledge values which are incommensurable, meaning that they cannot be reconciled and that there is no absolute or objective way to judge between them. Pluralism, however, acknowledges empathy and emotional understanding across cultures. Even if one does not accept the values of another culture, one still has an emotional understanding of how such values could be adopted. This stands in contrast to relativism, as defined by Berlin. If relativism is true, then there can be no emotional understanding of alien values. One understands the value system of an alien culture in essentially the same manner as one understands the behavior of ants or, for that matter, the behavior of tectonic plates; it is a purely causal understanding. It is the emotionally remote understanding of the scientist rather than the empathic understanding of someone engaging, say, with the poetry and theatre of another culture. Adopting RMT, pluralism seems quite plausible. Given that one has the mental capacity to generate the relevant model, one can replicate the alien value in oneself. One is not simply thinking about the foreigner’s relational model, but using one’s shared human nature to produce that same model in oneself. This does not, however, mean that one adopts that value, since one can also retain the conflicting model characteristic of one’s own culture. One’s decisive motivation may still flow wholly from the latter.

But the significance of RMT for the debate over pluralism and absolutism may be more complex than indicated above. Since RMT incorporates the view that people perceive social relationships as intrinsic values, this may indicate that a society which fosters interactions and relationships is absolutely better than one which divides and atomizes, at least along that one dimension. This may be an element of moral absolutism in RMT, and it is interesting to see how it is to be reconciled with any pluralism also implied.

b. Computational Conceptions of Cognition

The examples of embedding in Section 1.d. not only illustrate the productivity of social-relational cognition, but also its systematicity. To speak of the systematicity of thought means that the ability to think a given thought renders probable the ability to think a semantically close thought. The ability to conceive of Authority Ranking embedding Market Pricing makes it highly likely that one can conceive of Market Pricing embedding Authority Ranking. One finds productivity and systematicity in language as well. Any phrase can be embedded in a superordinate phrase. For example, the determiner phrase [the water] is embedded in the prepositional phrase [in [the water]], and the prepositional phrase [in [the water]] is embedded in the determiner phrase [the fish [in [the water]]]. The in-principle absence of limit here means that the number of phrases is infinite. Further, the ability to parse (or understand) a phrase renders very probable the ability to parse (or understand) a semantically close phrase. For example, being able to mentally process Plato did trust Socrates makes it likely that one can process Socrates did trust Plato as well as Plato did trust Plato and Socrates did trust Socrates. Productivity and systematicity, either in language or in social-relational cognition, constitute a strong inductive argument for a combinatorial operation that respects semantic relations. (The operation respects semantic relations, given that the meaning of a generated compound is a function of the meanings of its constituents and their arrangement.) In other words, it is an argument for digital computation.

This is essentially Noam Chomsky’s argument for a computational procedure explaining syntax (insofar as syntax is not idiomatic). It is also essentially Jerry Fodor’s argument for computational procedures constituting thought processes more generally. That digital computation underlies both complex social-relational cognition and language raises important questions. Are all mental processes largely computational or might language and social-relational cognition be special cases? Do language and social-relational cognition share the same computational mechanism or do they each have their own? What are the constraints on computation in either language or social-relational cognition?

c. Platonism

Chomsky has noted the discrete infinity of language. Each phrase consists of a number of constituents which can be counted using natural numbers (discreteness), and there is no longest phrase meaning that the set of all possible phrases is infinite. Analogous points apply to social-relational cognition. The number of instances of an elementary mod within any mod can be counted using natural numbers. In the case discussed earlier in which a customer is ordering food from a waiter, there is one instance of Authority Ranking embedded in one instance of Market Pricing. The total number of instances is two, a natural number. There is no principled upper limit on the number of embeddings, hence infinity. The discrete infinity of language and social-relational cognition is tantamount to their productivity.

However, some philosophers, especially Jerrold Katz, have argued that nothing empirical can exhibit discrete infinity. Something empirical may be continuously infinite, such as a volume of space containing infinitely many points. But the indefinite addition of constituent upon constituent has no empirical exemplification. Space-time, if it were finite in this sense, would contain only finite energy and a finite number of particles. There are not infinitely many objects, as discrete infinity would imply. On this reasoning, the discrete infinity of an entity can only mean that the entity exists beyond space and time, still assuming that space-time is finite. This would mean that sentences, and by similar reasoning compound mods as well, are abstract objects rather than neural features or processes. This would mean that mods and sentences are abstract objects like numbers. One finds here a kind of Platonism, Platonism here defined as the view that there are abstract objects.

As a tentative reply, one could say that the symbols generated by a computational system are potentially infinite in number, but this raises questions about the nature of potentiality. What is a merely potential mod or a merely potential sentence? It is not something with any spatiotemporal location or any causal power. Perhaps it is sentence types (as contrasted with tokens) that exhibit discrete infinity. And likewise with mods, it is mod types that exhibit discrete infinity. But here too, one is appealing to entities, namely types, that have no spatiotemporal location or causal power. By definition, these are abstract objects.

The case for Platonism is perhaps stronger for compound mods, but one could also defend the same conclusion with regard to the elementary mods. Each elementary mod, as noted earlier, corresponds to one of the classic measurement scales. Different scale types are presupposed by different logics. Classical two-valued logic presupposes a nominal scale, as illustrated by the law of excluded middle: a statement is either on the truth scale, in which case it is true, or off the scale, in which case it is false. Alternatively, one could posit two categories, one for true and one for false, and stipulate that any statement belongs on one scale or the other. Fuzzy logics conceive truth either in terms of interval scales, for example, it is two degrees more true that Michel is bald than that Van is bald, or in terms of ratio scales, for example, it is 80 percent true that Van is bald, 100 percent true that Michel is bald. Even though it has perhaps not been formalized, there is intuitively a logic which presupposes an ordinal scale. A logic, say, in which it is more true that chess is a game than that Ring a Ring o’ Roses is a game, even though it would be meaningless to ask how much more. If nominal, ordinal, interval, and ratio scales are more basic than various logics, then the question arises as to whether they can seriously be considered empirical or spatiotemporal. If anything is Platonic, then something more basic than logic is likely to be Platonic. And what is an elementary mod aside from the scale type which it “resembles”? Is there any reason to distinguish the elementary mod from the scale type itself? If not, then the elementary mods themselves are abstract objects, at least on this argument.

Does reflection upon language and the relational models support a Platonist metaphysic? If so, what is one to make of the earlier discussion of RMT appealing, as it did, to neural symmetry breakings and mental computations? If mods are abstract objects, then the symmetry breakings and computations may belong to the epistemology of RMT rather than to its metaphysics. In other words, they may throw light on how one knows about mods rather than actually constituting the mods themselves. Specifically, the symmetry breaking and computations may account for the production of mental representations of mods rather than the mods themselves. But whether or not there is a good case here for Platonism is, no doubt, open to further questioning.

3. References

a. Specifically Addressing Relational Models Theory

Bolender, John. (2010), The Self-Organizing Social Mind (Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press).
- Argues that the elementary relational models are due to self-organizing brain activity. Also contains a discussion of possible Platonist implications of RMT.
Bolender, John. (2011), Digital Social Mind (Exeter, UK: Imprint Academic).
- Argues that complex relational models are due to mental computations.
Fiske, Alan Page. (1990), “Relativity within Moose (‘Mossi’) culture: four incommensurable models for social relationships,” Ethos, 18, pp. 180-204.
- Fiske here argues that RMT supports moral relativism, although his “relativism” may be the same as Berlin’s “pluralism.”
Fiske, Alan Page. (1991), Structures of Social Life: The Four Elementary Forms of Human Relations (New York: The Free Press).
- The classic work on RMT, containing the first full statement of the theory and a wealth of anthropological illustrations.
Fiske, Alan Page. (1992), “The Four Elementary Forms of Sociality: Framework for a Unified Theory of Social Relations,” Psychological Review, 99, 689-723.
- Essentially, a shorter version of Fiske’s (1991). Nonetheless, this is a detailed and substantial introduction to RMT.
Fiske, Alan Page. (2004), “Relational Models Theory 2.0,” in Haslam (2004a).
- An updated introduction to RMT.
Haslam, Nick. ed. (2004a), Relational Models Theory: A Contemporary Overview (Mahwah, New Jersey and London: Lawrence Erlbaum).
- An anthology containing an updated introduction to RMT as well as discussions of controlled empirical evidence supporting the theory.
Haslam, Nick. ed. (2004b), “Research on the Relational Models: An Overview,” in Haslam (2004a).
- Reviews controlled studies corroborating that the elementary relational models play an important role in cognition including person perception.
Pinker, Steven. (2007), The Stuff of Thought: Language as a Window into Human Nature (London: Allen Lane).
- Argues that Market Pricing, in contrast to the other three elementary models, is not innate and is somehow unnatural.

b. Related Issues

Berlin, Isaiah. (1990), The Crooked Timber of Humanity: Chapters in the History of Ideas. Edited by H. Hardy (London: Pimlico).
- A discussion of value pluralism in the context of history of ideas.
Fodor, Jerry A. (1987), Psychosemantics: The Problem of Meaning in the Philosophy of Mind (Cambridge, Mass. and London: MIT Press).
- The Appendix argues that systematicity and productivity in thought require a combinatorial system. The point, however, is a general one, not specifically focused on social-relational cognition.
Katz, Jerrold J. (1996), “The unfinished Chomskyan revolution,” Mind & Language, 11 (3), pp. 270-294.
- Argues that only an abstract object can exhibit discrete infinity.
Rawls, John. (1971), A Theory of Justice (Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press).
- The veil of ignorance illustrates Equality Matching.
Szpiro, George G. (2010), Numbers Rule: The Vexing Mathematics of Democracy, from Plato to the Present (Princeton: Princeton University Press).
- Illustrates various ways in which Equality Matching can be implemented.
Stevens, S. S. (1946), “On the Theory of Scales of Measurement,” Science 103, pp. 677-680.
- A classic discussion of the types of measurement scales.
Vlastos, Gregory. (1962), “Justice and Equality,” in Richard B. Brandt, ed. Social Justice (Englewood Cliffs, New Jersey: Prentice-Hall).
- An attempt to understand all distributive justice in terms of Equality Matching.

Author Information

John Bolender
Email: bolender@metu.edu.tr
Middle East Technical University
Turkey

Global Ethics: Capabilities Approach

The capabilities approach is meant to identify a space in which we can make cross-cultural judgments about ways of life. The capabilities approach is radically different from, yet indebted to, traditional ethical theories such as virtue ethics, consequentialism and deontology.

This article begins with a background on global ethics. This situates the capabilities approach as a possible solution to the problems that arise from globalization. The second section provides Amartya Sen’s account of the basic framework of the capabilities approach. That section also shows how Martha Nussbaum develops the approach. The third section describes Nussbaum’s list of ten central capabilities. This list has been viewed by some philosophers as a definitive list, while others, notably Sen, have argued that no list is complete, because a list should always be subject to revision. The fourth section shows how the approach is similar to, yet very different from, traditional ethical theories such as virtue ethics, consequentialism and deontology. The capabilities approach is shown to add to the approaches of global ethics such as communitarianism, human rights, and the approach of John Rawls. The section compares Michael Boylan’s table of embeddedness with Nussbaum’s capabilities list. The fifth section discusses two main philosophical critiques of the capabilities approach. First, and most notably, Alison Jaggar criticizes Nussbaum for not paying closer attention to asymmetrical power relations. Second, Bernard Williams raises questions about what constitutes a capability. The sixth section shows how the capabilities approach has been applied to advance various areas of applied philosophy including the environment and disability ethics. The final section explains how the capabilities approach has been undertaken as a global endeavor by the United Nations Development Program to fight poverty and illiteracy and to empower women.

Background of Global Ethics
The Capabilities Approach
1. Sen
2. Nussbaum
Nussbaum’s List of Central Capabilities
The Relationship between the Capabilities Approach and Other Ethical Theories
Philosophical Criticisms of the Capabilities Approach
1. Illiberal and Neo-Colonialist
2. What Is a Capability?
Philosophical Applications
1. The Environment
2. Disability Ethics
United Nations Development Program
References and Further Reading

1. Background of Global Ethics

Issues of globalization have sparked great controversy since the 1980s. Globalization, broadly construed, is manifested in various forms of social activity including economic, political and cultural life. Practicing global ethics entails moral reasoning across borders. Borders can entail culture, religion, ethnicity, gender, race, class, sexuality, global location, historical experience, environment, species and nations. Ethicists ask how we best address issues of globalization–that is, how we begin to address conflicts that arise when vastly different cultural norms, values, and practices collide.

There have been two broad philosophical approaches to address cross-border moral disagreement and conflict. The dominant approach aims to develop moral theories that are not committed to a single metaphysical world-view or religious foundation, but are compatible with various perspectives. In other words, it is a goal to develop a theory that is both ‘thick’ (that is, it has a robust conception of the good embedded within a particular context, and respects local traditions) and ‘thin’ (that is, it embraces a set of universal norms). These universalists include human rights theorists, Onora O’Neill’s deontology, Seyla Benhabib’s discourse ethics and Martha Nussbaum’s capabilities approach. They tend to be associated with constructing ‘thin’ theories of morality. The other approach, most notably advocated by Michael Walzer, is communitarianism. Communitarians deny the possibility of developing a single universal standard of flourishing that is both thick enough to be useful and thin enough to support reasonable pluralism.

The debate between these two approaches to global ethics has reached an impasse. Since communitarians hold that moral norms are always local and valid internal to a particular community, universalists charge the communitarians with relativism. Moreover, universalists argue that communitarians fail to provide useful methods for addressing cross-border moral conflict. However, the communitarians charge the universalists with either positing theories that are too thin to be useful or advancing theories that are substantive but covertly build in premises that are not universally shared, and so risk cultural imperialism.

Martha Nussbaum believes her capabilities theory resolves the impasse and offers a viable approach to global ethics that provides a universal measure of human flourishing while also respecting religious and cultural differences. The capabilities approach, she argues, is universal, but ‘of a particular type.’ That is, it is a thick (or substantive) theory of morality that accommodates pluralism. Thus, she argues that her theory avoids criticisms applied to other universalists and communitarians. Before examining her theory, we must address her predecessor, Amartya Sen.

2. The Capabilities Approach

a. Sen

Amartya Sen, an economic theorist and founder of the capabilities approach, developed his theory in order to identify a space in which we can make cross cultural judgments on the quality of life. To best understand how these judgments can be passed, we must investigate a critical distinction made by proponents of the capabilities approach–between function and capability. A function, on the one hand, according to Sen, is an achievement, but this should be broadly understood to include any ‘state of being.’ Let’s examine Sen’s bike-riding example to shed light on a ‘function.’ He says a bicyclist has achieved the purpose of what one does with a bike–namely, ride it. From this example, clearly the choice to ride a bike is a function of a human being, however, the scope of functioning is not merely limited to a person’s intention to ride the bike. A ‘function’ entails any ‘state of being’ which includes excitement, happiness and fear. For example, a child who first begins to ride her bike may display a great amount of fear as she wobbles down the road, but once she understands how to ride the bike smoothly, she can enjoy (or perhaps become excited) riding her bike. Thus, when the child rides her bike (and is excited from doing so), she has performed the functions of riding a bike, and having the emotions associated with doing so, while partaking in the capability of play.

A capability, on the other hand, is a possibility, not just any possibility, but a real one. For example, we can talk about the possibility of a person in a deeply poverty-stricken area to find employment and support a family. However, such a possibility may not be real considering external circumstances–for example, no clothing, food or shelter. Put differently, a ‘capability set’ (as Sen calls it) is the total functions available for a person to perform. By describing it in such a way, Sen places a deep correlation between freedom and function. That is to say, the more limited one’s freedom, the less opportunities one has to fulfill one’s functions. In sum, Crocker (2008) says succinctly that, according to Sen, a capability X entails (1) having the real possibility for X which (2) depends on my powers and (3) and no external circumstances preventing me from X.

A capability and function should not be understood as mutually exclusive or completely paralleling one another. Let’s consider two people with the same capabilities. Even though they have same capabilities, they may participate in radically different functions. For example, two people may both have the opportunity to engage in play, but do so in radically different ways (for example, one may swim while the other volunteers at a homeless shelter). Proponents of the capabilities approach argue this makes the theory most attractive, that is, it accommodates various ways of life even though it puts forth a conception of the good. Now, let’s consider a situation in which people participate in the same functions, but possess different capabilities set. Consider Sen’s example of hunger. Two people may be hungry, but for radically different reasons. Consider, on the one hand, a person who seeks to fulfill her desire to eat, but cannot because of socio-economic circumstances. On the other, a person may be hungry because she is fasting for religious reasons or protesting an injustice. In both examples, the person suffers from starvation, but for radically different reasons.

b. Nussbaum

Nussbaum begins her capabilities approach by noting her indebtedness to Aristotle and Karl Marx (and to a lesser extent, J.S. Mill). Like Sen, she embraces the capabilities/function distinction. However, she begins to part ways with Sen’s philosophy when she grounds her theory in Marx and Aristotle. In doing so she argues that a function must not be performed in just any way, but in a ‘truly human way.’ That is to say, if a person lives a life where she is unable to exercise her human powers (for example, self-expressive creativity) then she is living her life in more of an animalistic manner than as a human being.

Nussbaum seeks a capabilities approach that can fully express human powers and not just provide (real) opportunities for people to perform certain functions. In other words, she does not deny, as Sen argues, that a capability is a real possibility or opportunity for an individual to perform certain actions, but that is merely necessary and not sufficient for the capabilities approach. Sen is missing, according to Nussbaum, aspects of what is particularly unique to human beings, that is, human powers. Nussbaum understands the capabilities/function distinction as multiply realized–that is, while the capabilities are the space for the opportunity for particular actions, the way in which that space is manifested, via different actions, is a person’s functioning.

Nussbaum notes that there are three specific differences that sets her capabilities approach apart from Sen. First, Nussbaum (2000) charges Sen with not explicitly rejecting cultural relativism. She agrees with his sympathies for universal norms, she also, criticizes his inability to completely reject cultural relativism. Second, Nussbaum criticizes Sen for not grounding his theory in a Marxian/Aristotelian idea of true human functioning. This is not to say that he would reject Nussbaum’s conclusions drawn from Marx and Aristotle, but rather he is not specifically indebted to (and does not ground his theory in) them. Third, Sen does not provide an explicit list of central capabilities As a matter of fact, Sen has been critical of attempting to provide a list of central capabilities. Nonetheless, these three points of division seem to separate Sen and Nussbaum.

Nussbaum’s two philosophical justifications are the non-Platonic substantive good approach (that is, intuitionism) and a limited role of proceduralism (that is, discourse ethics)–which are a point of contention amongst critics. According to the former, the primary justification for the capabilities approach, we test various ethical theories against our fixed intuitions and decide which theory best matches them. Nussbaum contends that the theory that best represents our intuitions is the capabilities approach. The intuition that grounds the capabilities, according to Nussbaum, is the intuition of a dignified human life whereby people have the capability to pursue their conception of the good in cooperation with others. Consider her example of a person’s fixed intuition that rape is damaging to human dignity. She claims if one matches that intuition against all ethical theories that it will be best represented by the capabilities approach.

One may have reservations for this justification in situations where a person has underdeveloped (that is, intuitions that have not been challenged by competing intuitions) or mistaken intuitions. In response, Nussbaum argues that underdeveloped and mistaken intuitions must be rejected, and replaced with diversely experienced people who have tested their intuitions against competing beliefs. Although Nussbaum notes the primacy of intuitionism, she also argues that proceduralism has an ancillary justification for the capabilities approach.

Nussbaum’s proceduralism begins not with an intuition, but with a decision procedure, and it is the procedure that confers justification on the outcome. She is sympathetic to this form of proceduralism since it is rooted in Kantian discourse ethics (adopted by Jean Hampton), and has accordingly built into it a conception of equal human worth. In that sense proceduralism is similar to the intuitionist justification. However, there are stark contrasts. What is proceduralism, then? The version Nussbaum is concerned with claims that one consults the desires or preferences of another who is impacted by the outcome of the decision at hand. Similar to the concern above, Nussbaum fears that many people’s desires (like intuitions) will be corrupt, and thus produce a morally repugnant conclusion. Therefore, she seeks not just any desires, but ‘informed desires,’ that is, desires constructed by treating people with dignity. However, because not all desires are informed, and yet proceduralism calls for us to consult all desires affected by the decision, the capabilities approach would be placed on too weak of a foundation. Thus, in virtue of all the mistaken desires, proceduralism merely plays an ancillary role. Yet, it’s fair to say that if everyone had informed desires, then Nussbaum would grant proceduralism as a primary justification for the capabilities approach.

These two justifications are meant to be mutually reinforcing. They are meant to justify both the capabilities approach qua theory and the particular list of central capabilities put forth by Nussbaum. However, due to the limitations Nussbaum places on proceduralism, we must rely on intuitionism as the main justification.

3. Nussbaum’s List of Central Capabilities

There is much debate over whether Nussbaum’s list of central capabilities is revisable, and thus subject to change, or whether it is a fixed set of capabilities that cannot be compromised. Earlier in her career, Nussbaum (1995) argued that her list was static, however, she has since backed off such a claim and acknowledged the possibility that they could be altered. From her book, Women and Human Development: The Capabilities Approach (WHD hereafter), here is her list of capabilities, along with a brief description of each.

1. Life – Able to live to the end of a normal length human life, and to not have one’s life reduced to not worth living.

2. Bodily Health – Able to have a good life which includes (but is not limited to) reproductive health, nourishment and shelter.

3. Bodily Integrity – Able to change locations freely, in addition to, having sovereignty over one’s body which includes being secure against assault (for example, sexual assault, child sexual abuse, domestic violence and the opportunity for sexual satisfaction).

4. Senses, Imagination and Thought – Able to use one’s senses to imagine, think and reason in a ‘truly human way’–informed by an adequate education. Furthermore, the ability to produce self-expressive works and engage in religious rituals without fear of political ramifications. The ability to have pleasurable experiences and avoid unnecessary pain. Finally, the ability to seek the meaning of life.

5. Emotions – Able to have attachments to things outside of ourselves; this includes being able to love others, grieve at the loss of loved ones and be angry when it is justified.

6. Practical Reason – Able to form a conception of the good and critically reflect on it.

7. Affiliation

A. Able to live with and show concern for others, empathize with (and show compassion for) others and the capability of justice and friendship. Institutions help develop and protect forms of affiliation.

B. Able to have self-respect and not be humiliated by others, that is, being treated with dignity and equal worth. This entails (at the very least) protections of being discriminated on the basis of race, sex, sexuality, religion, caste, ethnicity and nationality. In work, this means entering relationships of mutual recognition.

8. Other Species – Able to have concern for and live with other animals, plants and the environment at large.

9. Play – Able to laugh, play and enjoy recreational activities.

10. Control over One’s Environment

A. Political – Able to effectively participate in the political life which includes having the right to free speech and association.

B. Material – Able to own property, not just formally, but materially (that is, as a real opportunity). Furthermore, having the ability to seek employment on an equal basis as others, and the freedom from unwarranted search and seizure.

Even though Nussbaum claims each of the ten capabilities is equally important, she places special emphasis on two of them–namely, practical reason and affiliation. We see the importance when she explicitly says the core behind the intuition of human functioning is that of a dignified free person who constructs her way of life in reciprocity with others, and not merely following, or being shaped by, others. Furthermore, Nussbaum notes that these two capabilities suffuse all the others, and this in turn, constitutes a truly human pursuit.

Furthermore, Nussbaum argues that the list is ‘thick,’ but ‘vague.’ It is thick because it provides a specific conception of the good life (that is, human flourishing), however, it is not thick enough that it mandates how one ought to live one’s life. Thus, the capabilities list is ‘thick’ enough to allow us to make cross-cultural judgments (for example, identifying areas where an individual or groups of people are unable to actualize a capability), and yet ‘vague’ enough for an individual to choose whether or not (or how) she wishes to participate in a capability.

Finally, Nussbaum says that citizens should be guaranteed a social minimum whereby capabilities can be realized. It is the role of institutions to ensure that a threshold level of central capabilities is achieved. Institutions (for example, religious, labor, government, and so forth) come in many forms, and protect various interests. For example, the Self Employed Women’s Association (SEWA) helps women provide protection and benefits for work in which they have been traditionally underappreciated. However, as Nussbaum notes, achieving the threshold may not be enough for justice.

4. The Relationship between the Capabilities Approach and Other Ethical Theories

The ethical theories that have dominated Western philosophy include (in one form or another) virtue ethics, consequentialism and deontology. The capabilities cannot be reduced to any of those ethical theories, however, it is indebted more or less to each of them. This section will review Rawls and human rights, both of which have numerous deontological underpinnings, and communitarianism which is closely linked with ethics. Finally, this section will include a section on Michael Boylan’s ‘table of embeddedness’ in order to see the challenges and parallels between it and Nussbaum’s list of capabilities. This section will explore parallels and differences between the capabilities approach and the above ethical theories.

a. Virtue Ethics

Even though there are clear differences between the virtue tradition (specifically, Aristotle) and the capabilities approach, Nussbaum uses the former as a point of departure. That is, Aristotle is the foundation for the capabilities approach because Nussbaum seeks a theory that provides the opportunity for human beings to use their powers to flourish in a truly human way.

Virtue ethics, broadly speaking, like the capabilities approach, claims human beings should exercise their powers qua human in attempt in order to live well. Contemporary neo-Aristotelians strive to explicate an account of flourishing which may entail providing a naturalistic account of flourishing or through empirical psychology. Nussbaum, however, interprets Aristotle’s account of functioning as merely a moral concept and not naturalistic). However, unlike other neo-Aristotelians (and Aristotle himself), Nussbaum has no intention of providing a comprehensive doctrine of human flourishing, although, as noted above, she believes she is providing a tentatively comprehensive list of capabilities.

There is another stark contrast between virtue ethics and the capabilities approach–namely, character building and motivation. Nussbaum is less concerned with why people perform certain actions, and building one’s character over a period of time through proper motivations, and more concerned with providing the proper space that allows an individual to use her powers to fulfill a capability, if she chooses. One should not mistake this claim to mean that Nussbaum is not concerned with motivation at all, but rather this should be viewed as a shift in emphasis. Nussbaum argues in WHD that informed desires (that is, the justification for the capabilities approach) cannot be any desire, but those which contribute to living well. For example, even though one may fulfill the capability of practical reason through education, one should not use it in such a way that coerces others. Such a desire would be condemned by Nussbaum since, on the one hand, it prevents the coerced person from participating in all the capabilities, and on the other, it does not reflect an informed one.

b. Communitarianism

Communitarianism is a critique of liberal theory, and, on the other, emphasizes the importance of political norms within a community. In brief, liberal theorists contend that a self is ahistorical, asocial and apolitical. Thus it is not necessarily the case that it will be burdened by the practices and beliefs of its community. Michael Sandel, a nationalist-communitarian, explains that a liberal self is ‘unencumbered’–that is, it is not wedded to a particular conception of the good not of its choosing. This abstract ontology allows liberals to make certain moves in the political sphere. For example, the concept of ‘justice’ entails universal normative claims since all human beings are ontologically the same.

In contrast, Alasdair MacIntyre, a communitarian indebted to Aristotle, argues against liberal political theory beginning with their conception of the self. He says a self is embedded within a particular set of cultural beliefs, practices and history. MacIntyre, following Aristotle, claims that in order for one to live a good life, one must be virtuous. A virtue, according to MacIntyre (2007), is a character trait that allows us to achieve goods that are internal to one’s practices By ‘practice,’ he is referring to a “socially established cooperative human activity through which goods internal to that form of activity are realized in the course of trying to achieve those standards of excellence….” Thus, living a good life entails being virtuous within the context of a given practice (or community).

Furthermore, communitarians believe justice is limited to communities rather than human beings at large. This, in turn, allows them to reject the notion that we can make universal normative judgments. Finally, MacIntyre believes we need extend our conception of virtue from the individual to the community. It’s a bit unclear what a virtuous community would look like exactly, however, we know that it would have a conception of the good life in which people strive. This is clearly contrary to the liberal project in which, , individuals pursue whatever conception of the good they wish as long as they do not interfere or harm another.

Nussbaum is sympathetic to communitarianism insofar as it acknowledges the importance of local traditions and practices that shape our lives. For example, a Hindi woman in India will have a set of beliefs that shape who she is that differs from a Protestant male in the United States. However, Nussbaum ultimately rejects communitarianism. In her section entitled “Defending Universal Values” from WHD, she says communitarians fail to recognize that there is a conception of the individual that is not indebted to a particular metaphysical tradition. She argues that each person should be treated as an end, worthy of respect, dignity and honor. As mentioned in section II, Nussbaum believes the capabilities is founded on the intuition that each person is worthy of a dignified life, and this intuition holds irrespective of one’s community.

c. Deontology

In putting forth her ancillary justification for the capabilities, Nussbaum is indebted to Jean Hampton’s Kantian proceduralism. Nussbaum (2000) believes we need a “Kantian conception of human worth that prominently includes the ideas of equal worth and nonaggregation” (Nussbaum’s italics,). There are two points to take from this claim. First, she is indebted to the Kantian notion that all human beings have intrinsic worth, and as a result, they should always be treated as an end and never merely as a means. Second, she is critiquing the consequentialist argument for aggregate utility. We saw her specific problems with this argument immediately above.

Although Nussbaum is clearly indebted to deontology since it is a justification (albeit auxiliary) for the capabilities, there remains questions to what extent Kant plays a role. David Crocker (2008) argues that her Kantian equal-worth commitment is nothing more than an addition onto her Aristotelianism since the latter justifies moral and political inequality.

d. Rawls’ The Law of Peoples

John Rawls uses the same methodology (and preserves the liberal ontological framework of ‘autonomy’ and ‘reason’) in The Law of Peoples as in A Theory of Justice however, he has extended justice to a global scale rather than merely nationally. Beginning with the ‘global original position,’ Rawls argues that all reasonable (or decent) persons would construct political ideals that benefit all liberal peoples; these ideals would be reached via overlapping consensus. See Daniels (1989) and Pogge (1989) for further discussion on Rawls’ original position. A liberal, democratic society, according to Rawls (1999), would include the following benefits: (1) fair equality of opportunity–including, education, (2) a decent distribution of income, (3) society as employer of last resort through general or local government, (4) basic health care for all citizens and (5) public financing of elections (p. 50).

Rawls (1999) claims that the policies constructed by liberal peoples should direct non-liberal societies to (ideally) all become liberal. Rawls deems an illiberal society which rejects the possibility of becoming liberal (for example, abiding by human rights regulations) as an ‘outlaw state.’ While liberal societies should attempt to tolerate illiberal societies initially, he contends an outlaw state eventually subjects itself to severe sanctions and possible intervention

Nussbaum is indebted to not only Rawls specifically, but often praises the values of liberalism. First, she is committed to Rawls’ method of ‘overlapping consensus’ insofar as it is politically advantageous to perform such tasks as fairly distributing primary goods. Furthermore, Nussbaum (2000) respects Rawls attentiveness to “pluralism and paternalism” while remaining committed to the importance of basic liberties Finally, Nussbaum agrees with Rawls (and liberalism more generally) that we should treat people as dignified human beings, and respect their autonomy qua individual.

Nussbaum is also critical of Rawls beginning with his reluctance to make comparisons of well-being. Rawls refuses to make comparisons since each person constructs their conception of the good, so a person may be satisfied with their way of life even though another may find it unsatisfactory. While there may be fears of paternalism, Nussbaum is clear that we should make comparisons of well-being in order to grant certain areas as needing more resources than others. From this, Nussbaum (2000) criticizes Rawls for not taking seriously enough how greatly individuals vary in their needs. Consider her example. If we are concerned with spending resources on increasing literacy rates around the world, we will have to spend much more on women than men given the discrepancy between them. However, Nussbaum argues that Rawls’ approach could not properly address the obstacles when distributing resources since he is merely concerned with resource-distribution, and not cognizant of the variations of distribution within a particular region.

e. Human Rights

The rhetoric of human rights has arguably been more powerful than any other approach to global justice. There is debate amongst human rights advocates in regards to the origin of rights, how they are manifested (that is, who possess them), their possibility of group distribution and how they ought to be enforced. Nonetheless, human rights are universal political norms that belong to every individual simply in virtue of being human. It does not matter whether one belongs to one affiliation or another; but merely in virtue of being a human being, she is guaranteed minimal norms (for example, the right to life or liberty). These are minimal insofar as they are not connected with any conception of the good life, and thus, do not preclude any groups of people (or communities). For further discussion on the nature of human rights see Griffin (2008) and Donnelly (2003).

Alan Gewirth, in The Community of Rights, attempts to make human rights compatible with communities. We can see the difficulty of such a task given the commitment the communitarianism theorists have to a common good, on the one hand, and a value-neutral approach from rights, on the other. Nonetheless, Gewirth argues that if a community does not uphold a doctrine of human rights, then it ought to be rejected as a legitimate community. Gewirth puts forth a theory of human rights while respecting the role communities play in our lives. Furthermore, Will Kymlicka (1989) extends the concept of rights by constructing a theory of rights that considers communities or group rights.

In WHD, Nussbaum directly addresses the “very close” relationship between human rights and the capabilities approach. She believes the capabilities approach has advantages over human rights insofar as it can take a clear position on issues the latter cannot in addition to providing a clear goal. For example, human rights theorists often disagree on the origin and foundation of rights, whereas the capabilities approach, according to Nussbaum, is not plagued by such criticisms. She raises two concerns for why we should reject human rights in favor of the capabilities approach, and then provides four key roles for human rights.

Nussbaum first claims that human rights proponents often make rights claims in regards to property or economic advantage (for example, they have a right to shelter). However, in converting a language of rights to capabilities, she explains that this statement becomes problematic insofar as it can be understood in many ways including resources, utility and capabilities. The human rights tradition would discuss it in terms of resources; however, merely providing resources does not necessarily raise everyone to the same level of capability in order to allow them to fulfill their function. Second, the language of capability ethics does not contain all the baggage that pertains to human rights. Although Nussbaum rejects the understanding that human rights are often characterized as simply being Western, she also says the capabilities approach avoids the troubles surrounding this debate.

Even though Nussbaum is critical of human rights, she believes is plays an essential role in global ethics. She presents the following four roles (or advantages) of human rights. First, human rights have the advantage of showing the urgency to claims of injustice. Second, human rights (as of now) have rhetorical power. Third, human rights place value on people’s autonomy. Finally, human rights preserve a sense of agreement insofar as it purports norms that apply to everyone.

f. Consequentialism

It would be easy to mistake the capabilities approach as a consequentialist argument to increase the overall utility in the world, where ‘utility’ can be understood in many ways–including ‘happiness.’ Peter Singer (1972), in his influential work, “Famine, Affluence and Morality,” puts forth arguments fighting global poverty from a consequentialist standpoint. In sum, he argues through a series of objections and replies that those in positions of material power should donate to those in less favorable conditions in order to increase the overall utility (and ultimately decrease poverty) throughout the world. It can be said that that Singer’s consequentialism and the capabilities approach are similar insofar as they both more or less seek to directly reduce poverty, and furthermore, provide more opportunities for those who have few or none.

However, Nussbaum (2000) provides three reasons for why consequentialism is different from the capabilities approach. First, one major difference is for whom the ethical theory accounts. On the one hand, consequentialism is interested in maximizing the utility of everyone (that is, the aggregate). On the other, the capabilities approach is interested in the individual. For example, Nussbaum says that the aggregative solution does not tell us who are the bottom and top, that is, who has control over material goods and whether or not someone else deserves a share of it. Thus, by focusing on the individual, we are able to best identify who needs resources and how much.

Second, related to the above point, consequentialism tends to ignore cross-cultural differences, that is, ignoring the fact that people live vastly different lives. As consequentialism is concerned with overall utility (and not merely particular persons or groups of people), it may ignore a particular good that is minimized in one culture, but widely present in another. Put differently, there are many goods–including education and religion–that are highly important to some and relatively unimportant to others. Consequentialism aggregates all goods under the heading of ‘utility,’ and thus, we are unable to identify which goods must be properly distributed to a particular region. The capabilities approach, however, is not only interested in allowing groups of people to use their power to fulfill a capability, but in each individual person to partake in a capability.

Finally, consequentialism ignores relevant aspects of individuals including emotions (that is, how individuals feel about what is happening to them) and what they are able to do or be (that is, fulfill a capability). This critique tends to be associated with consequentialism at large (and not specifically from the capabilities approach), but it is still worth noting. Since the capabilities strive for human flourishing, which entails the ability to express emotions without fear, we can understand why Nussbaum reiterates this critique.

g. Boylan’s Table of Embeddedness

Michael Boylan, in A Just Society, presents a ‘table of embeddedness,’ which is meant to describe a hierarchy of goods. Boylan’s argument for the table can be seen as follows: if people desire to be good, and becoming good requires action, then all people desire to act; the following table presents the interconnectedness between Boylan’s preconditions for actions and a hierarchy of goods.

Boylan (2004) splits the table into two levels–basic goods and secondary goods. The former, on the one hand, is broken further into ‘most deeply embedded’ goods (for example, food, clothing, shelter and free from being harmed) and ‘deeply embedded’ goods (for example, literate, basic math skills, treated with self-respect, and so forth). On the other hand, Boylan divides the latter into ‘life enhancing’ goods (for example, societal respect, equal opportunity and equal political participation), ‘useful’ goods (for example, property, gain from one’s labor and pursue goods owned by the general public such as a cell phone) and ‘luxurious’ goods (for example, pursue pleasant goods such as vacationing and use one’s will to possess a large portion of society’s resources). Even though society has no duty to provide ‘useful’ or ‘luxurious’ goods, it has an obligation to provide basic goods and life enhancing goods (from the secondary goods) to its members. Finally, in striving for equal respect, Boylan claims society may have to spend greater resources on those who are disadvantaged; in doing so Nussbaum would be sympathetic to Boylan’s claim that some groups of people require disproportionally more resources given their unfortunate circumstances than another. This was her critique of Rawls–namely, that he did not account for the varying needs of individuals. Furthermore, Nussbaum would also grant that society has an obligation to provide its citizens with Boylan’s basic goods such as food, shelter and water. However, the roles in which each list plays will be different given how their respective authors understand its purpose.

Nussbaum’s list, unlike Boylan’s, is not hierarchal, but rather everyone ought to have equal opportunity to perform a function that fulfills a capability. In other words, no capability, according to Nussbaum, is more essential than another. Marcus Düwell (2009) provides two criticisms of this view. First, he claims a lack of hierarchy of goods (or capabilities) raises concerns about its practical guidance in “morally contested topics.” Even though Nussbaum argues that no primacy should be given to a particular capability, it’s worth noting that it would be difficult to fulfill the capability of ‘bodily integrity,’ for example, if one’s capability of life is taken away. Second, it also raises concerns to what extent the capabilities are “foundational moral obligations for others.”

5. Philosophical Criticisms of the Capabilities Approach

The capabilities approach has endured many criticisms since its inception. The primary critique is constructed from the feminist and non-Western perspective. This entry will focus on Alison Jaggar’s critique since it embodies many concerns of power relations. Meanwhile, the latter critique can be found in many theorists, but the focus of this entry will be limited to Bernard Williams since he puts forth two challenges in attempt to seek the nature of a capability. Jaggar’s criticisms are limited to Nussbaum, and Williams’ critique is directed primarily towards Sen. This will provide a greater array of criticisms for the capabilities theory in general.

a. Illiberal and Neo-Colonialist

Alison Jaggar criticizes both Nussbaum’s justifications for the capabilities approach and her list. Jaggar believes Nussbaum may have ignored power asymmetries that exist between not only men and women, but also Western and non-Western peoples. She argues that the intuitionist and proceduralist justifications seem to be neo-colonialist and illiberal.

First, Jaggar (2006) argues that Nussbaum’s theory appears to be neo-colonialist insofar as those in power have the “final authority…to assess the moral worth of…[other’s] voices”. This is problematic for the intuitionist justification since those who possess intuitions that do not match the capabilities list, for example, will be interpreted and possibly jettisoned. Put differently, there are no mechanisms in Nussbaum’s approach that allow us to encourage self-criticism from those who possess the list. Furthermore, Jaggar emphasizes that Nussbaum is committed to a politically liberal project (that is, considering everyone’s intuitions), however, the intuitionist justification paradoxically dismisses ideas that do not match the theory put forth by Nussbaum, and thus, it illiberally disregards others. In order for Nussbaum’s theory to encourage self-criticism, she must include all intuitions.

Second, the capabilities list seems to be illiberal since “other voices” (that is, mistaken or uninformed desires) are not ready for a proceduralist justification. Since Nussbaum demands only informed desires participate in the proceduralist justification for the list, desires that do not match the list will be unable to partake in the discourse. Furthermore, because these voices are silenced, there may be capabilities missing from the list or capabilities on the list that ought to be challenged. Regardless, they will be left untouched.

In sum, Jaggar criticizes Nussbaum’s justifications for the capabilities approach since they ignore asymmetrical power relationships. Jaggar believes that even though Nussbaum claims to be paying attention to such relations, she paradoxically fails to produce a theory that yields an outcome that is cognizant of power. It’s worth noting, though, that Jaggar does not believe these criticisms ultimately entail rejecting the capabilities. Rather, she believes that placing discourse ethics as the main justification for the capabilities may allow the theory to be self-critical, and thus, fully aware of power dynamics.

b. What Is a Capability?

Williams’ (1987) primary concern of the capabilities approach is trying to understand what is meant by a ‘capability.’ In pursuing this inquiry, he believes Sen in particular, but capabilities proponents in general, are unclear on the relationship between ‘choice’ and ‘capability.’ Williams does not provide knock-down arguments against the capabilities, but rather poses two challenges for the capabilities theorist to consider.

First, Williams asks what it means to have the capability to do X? Consider his example. If a person is posted once a year to a desirable holiday resort, does she have the capability to go? In a trivial sense, “yes,” but not in a meaningful way (that is, in a way that contributes to the well-being of an individual). If the term ‘capability’ is understood merely as ‘possibility,’ then it could be granted that she has the capability to go, although, there is still something missing–namely, the ability to choose whether or not to go. This example is meant to illustrate the correlation between capabilities and choice. That is, according to Williams, in this case a capability cannot exist without the option to choose it. However, consider Sen’s example where a capability exists without the ability to choose it. Sen, in his Tanner Lectures, notes that the life expectancy is higher in China than India. He believes this example shows that the higher one’s life expectancy the higher the capability of a standard of living. In response to this claim William asks, what capability is increased by a greater life expectancy? He poses this question since it might be the case that living longer only contributes to one having more time to contemplate whether to commit suicide. In this example, Williams is pointing out the problems with the relationship of a capability that completely lacks choice.

Second, and related to the above challenge, William questions the relationship of the capability of doing X to the actual ability to do X here and now. He notes that the ‘actual ability to do X’ can be understood as ‘can do X.’ In other words, if a person possesses the capability to do X, then it must be the case that she can do X. Consider Sen’s example of the capability of breathing unpolluted air. He would argue that if a person has the capability to breathe unpolluted air, then she can do so. Williams grants that a person living in Los Angeles cannot breathe unpolluted air here and now, however, that is not to say she cannot do so at all. In other words, this person has the capability to breathe unpolluted air, but she cannot do it here and now; this position is contrary, though, to Sen’s claim above that if one has the capability to do X, she can do X. Because she has the capability to breathe unpolluted air, she should move to a place where it is possible to do so. Williams argues, though, that there are large costs associated with moving to a place where she can breathe unpolluted air. Let’s assume that person does not have the economic means to do so. Does this person really have the capability, then, to breathe unpolluted air?–logically speaking, “yes,” however, certainly not in any meaningful sense. By considering the opportunity costs associated with a capability such as breathing unpolluted air, some capabilities may become nearly impossible for many to acquire. Thus, Williams argues it is not simply because one can do X that one has the capability to do X.

6. Philosophical Applications

The capabilities approach is often discussed in terms of providing opportunities (Sen) and using human powers (Nussbaum). More often than not it is an argument to reduce poverty or increase the well-being of people around the globe. Recently, it has provided the framework to further advance arguments in other areas of applied ethics including business ethics, the environment, disability ethics and animal ethics. This entry will merely focus on the environment and disability ethics because it calls attention to how far the capabilities approach can be extended.

a. The Environment

The biggest challenge facing capabilities theorists in regards to the environment is on the area of emphasis. The goal of the capabilities–whether Sen or Nussbaum–is human flourishing or well-being. It is never simply understood as non-human or ecological flourishing. Of course, this is not to say that the capabilities approach has nothing to say about the environment, or worse, that it must harm it in order for human beings to flourish, although, there are obstacles standing in the way when putting forth not only an environmentally friendly capabilities approach, but one in which environmental flourishing is taken just as seriously as human flourishing.

There seems to be two ways in which we can approach environmental ethics from a capabilities perspective. By briefly examining each solution, we will have a broader perspective of how the capabilities approach begins to asses environmental concerns. First, one may begin with the capabilities list, and show how environmental values relate to human flourishing. Recall Nussbaum’s eighth capability (out of ten): Other species have the ability to have a concern for and live with others animals, plants and the environment at large. There are two points we can take from this capability. First, Nussbaum believes the environment clearly plays a role in human flourishing otherwise she would not have included it as a capability. Even though the environment seems to be playing an instrumental role insofar as it contributes to human flourishing, it is nonetheless an essential capability. Furthermore, Nussbaum’s list is beneficial because she believes it should be implemented as public policy which would force countries that do not take the environmental capability seriously to reconsider their current policies. Second, however, Victoria Kamsler (2006) recalls that she places it eighth on the list which, she argues, is hard to deny that it is given less emphasis than on almost all the other capabilities. In defense of Nussbaum, she notes that all the capabilities are meant to be mutually reinforcing, and thus, the dignity of a human being as truly human cannot be met without taking environment flourishing seriously.

Second, rather than starting with the list and placing instrumental value on the environment, one may begin with a general account of flourishing that can be applied to non-human beings such as animals and the environment. Here, the environment is understood as being intrinsically valuable (that is, valuable independent of human beings). Kamsler notes that Nussbaum believes the “most basic intuition behind [the] capability theory… ‘wants to see each thing flourish as the sort of thing that it is'”. In other words, the environment qua capability must be treated as an entity that must flourish in its own right, and not merely for the value it provides human beings.

There still remains a lingering question about the relationship between the environment and the capabilities approach. If the capability is understood as anthropocentric insofar as it is concerned with human flourishing, what should we do when the environment impedes such flourishing? In other words, there seem to be cases in which being concerned with the environment’s flourishing will directly conflict with human flourishing (for example, the capability of work and protecting forests). Kamsler addresses this conflict when she says that the only way to overcome this seemingly tragic dilemma is through technological and political means. This is not to say that it will not be costly or conflict with other capabilities, but it is a solution that goes beyond being complacent with the dilemma.

b. Disability Ethics

A person cannot be said to flourish, according to the capabilities approach, if she is unable to perform functions that partake in the capabilities. This raises interesting questions with people who have disabilities insofar as they may be either physically or mentally impaired from having the ability to perform many functions. Nussbaum has given this topic ample discussion through her Tanner Lectures and various publications.

Nussbaum addresses the question of disabilities via the capabilities approach through her list. Her early formulation of the capabilities list excluded many people from the ability to live a truly human life since she required such a life to include using all five senses, for example. She has since retracted from such bold statements. However, Nussbaum (1995) does note that it would be difficult to imagine a person living a truly human life with total lack of the senses, imagination and reasoning.

Nussbaum (2002) has extended her account of functioning in a truly human way (that is, for human dignity) “as containing many different types of animal dignity, all of which deserve respect and even wonder”. In other words, she believes the mentally disabled can gain dignity not merely from rationality, but also through support for the “capabilities of life, health, and bodily integrity. It will also provide stimulation for senses, imagination and thought” This passage indicates a clear responsibility on the state to not only allow for such stimulation of the senses to occur, but to actually provide the resources for such stimulation to occur.

There are interesting questions about how to implement policies that provide the best opportunity for disabled peoples to perform functions that fulfill capabilities. Nussbaum heralds the Individuals with Disabilities Education Act (IDEA) as a way to understand how the capabilities can be manifested in the current education system. IDEA is a disabilities act that begins with the idea of human individuality. Instead of lumping all disabled students into one group, each student is taken on a case-by-case basis. This approach in turn, allows for each student to receive the proper care she needs. This Act does not focus on education being a ‘human right’ because that would entail the goal of merely providing an education to the student, that is, ensuring she receives an education in one form or another. What makes this Act uniquely indebted to the capabilities is its commitment to providing the opportunity for the students to use their powers qua human beings to fulfill their functions in a truly human way–for example, via their senses, imagination and thought.

7. United Nations Development Program

The UNDP is an organization built on the theoretical principles of the capabilities approach. Its goals include helping countries best address solutions pertaining to democratic governance, poverty reduction, crisis prevention and recovery, environment and energy and HIV/AIDS. The organization is clear that none of these solutions will ever come at the expense of women since they are an advocate of empowering women. The four solutions listed here are designed to assist the various challenges facing nations. However, there are eight concrete goals the UNDP is interested in achieving.

The UNDP has put forth eight Millennium Development Goals (MDGs). The MDGs include the following: (1) eradicate extreme poverty and hunger, (2) achieve universal primary education, (3) promote gender equality and empower women, (4) reduce child mortality, (5) improve maternal health, (6) combat HIV/AIDS, malaria and other diseases, (7) ensure environmental sustainability and (8) develop a global partnership for development. The success or failure of achieving these goals is based on a measurement from the Human Development Report (HDR).

The HDR is designed to measure the ways in which people can live up to their full potential in accordance with their desires and interests. Mahbub ul Haq, founder of the HDR, says “the basic purpose of development is to enlarge people’s choices…[which include] greater access to knowledge, better nutrition and health services, more secure livelihoods, security against crime and physical violence, satisfying leisure hours, political and cultural freedoms and sense of participation in community activities.” There are two points to take from this. First, it is clear that the theoretical aspects of the capabilities approach have been preserved upon measuring the MDGs. Second, the HDR is not committed to merely measuring wealth, but rather providing the opportunities for a person to fulfill any of the capabilities she is interested in pursuing.

8. References and Further Reading

Appiah, Kwame A. (2006) Cosmopolitanism: Ethics in a World of Strangers, W.W. Norton: NY.
Benhabib, Seyla (1995) “Cultural Complexity, Moral Interdependence, and the Global Dialogical Community” in Women, Culture and Development, Martha C. Nussbaum and Jonathan Glover (eds.), Clarendon Press: Oxford.
Boylan, Micahel (2004) A Just Society, Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc: Lanham, MD.
Crocker, David (2008) Ethics of Global Development: Agency, Capability and Deliberative Democracy, Cambridge University Press: NY.
Daniels, Norman (1989) Reading Rawls: Critical Studies on Rawls’ “A Theory of Justice,” Stanford University Press: Stanford, CA.
Donnelly, Jack (2003) Universal Human Rights in Theory and Practice, Cornell University Press: Ithaca.
Düwell, Marcus (2009) “On the Possibility of a Hierarchy of Moral Goods,” in Morality and Justice: Reading Boylan’s A Just Society, John-Steward Gordon (ed.), Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc: Lanham, MD.
Gewirth, Alan (1978) Reason and Morality, The University of Chicago Press: Chicago, IL.
Gewirth, Alan (1996) The Community of Rights, The University of Chicago Press: Chicago, IL.
Griffin, James (2008) On Human Rights, Oxford University Press, Oxford.
Jaggar, Alison (2006) “Reasoning About Well-Being: Nussbaum’s Methods of Justifying the Capabilities,” The Journal of Political Philosophy, 14:3, 301-322.
Kymlicka, Will (1989) Liberalism, Community and Culture, Oxford University Press, Oxford.
MacIntyre, Alasdair (1988) Whose Justice? Which Rationality?, University of Notre Dame Press, Notre Dame, IN.
MacIntyre, Alasdair (2007) After Virtue, Notre Dame University Press: Notre Dame, IN.
Nussbaum, Martha (1995), “Human Capabilities, Female Human Beings,” in Women, Culture, and Development: A Study of Human Capabilities, Martha C. Nussbaum and Jonathan Glover (eds.), Clarendon Press: Oxford.
Nussbaum, Martha (2000) Women and Human Development: The Capabilities Approach, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, MA.
Nussbaum, Martha (2002) “Capabilities and Disabilities: Justice for Mentally Disabled Citizens,” Philosophical Topics, 30:2, 133-165.
O’Neill, Onora (1996) Towards Justice and Virtue: A Constructive Account of Practical Reason, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, MA.
Pogge, Thomas W. (1989) Realizing Rawls, Cornell University Press, Ithaca.
Rawls, John (1999) A Theory of Justice, Harvard University Press: Cambridge, MA.
Rawls, John (1999) The Law of Peoples, Harvard University Press: Cambridge, MA.
Sandel, Michael (1996) Democracy’s Discontent: America in Search of a Public Philosophy, Harvard University Press: Cambridge, MA.
Sandel, Michael J. (1982) Liberalism and the Limits of Justice, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge.
Sen, A. K. (1985) “Well-being, Agency and Freedom: the Dewey Lectures,” Journal of Philosophy, 82:4, 169-221.
Sen, Amartya K. (1987) The Standard of Living: The Tanner Lectures, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Sen, Amartya (2009) The Idea of Justice, Harvard University Press: Cambridge, MA.
Singer, Peter (1972) “Famine, Affluence, and Morality,” Philosophy and Public Affairs, 1:1, 229-243.
Kamsler, Victoria (2006) “Attending to nature: capabilities and the environment,” in Capabilities Equality: Basic issues and problems (ed.) Alexander Kaufman, Routledge: NY, 198-213.
Williams, Bernard (1987), “The Standard of Living: Interests and Capabilities,” in The Standard of Living (ed.), Geoffrey Hawthorn, Cambridge University Press: Cambridge, 94-102.

Author Information

Chad Kleist
Email: chad.kleist@marquette.edu
Marquette University
U. S. A.

Autonomy: Normative

Autonomy is variously rendered as self-law, self-government, self-rule, or self-determination. The concept first came into prominence in ancient Greece (from the Greek auto-nomos), where it characterized city states that were self governing. Only later–during the European Enlightenment–did autonomy come to be widely understood as a property of persons. Today the concept is used in both senses, although most contemporary philosophers deal with autonomy primarily as a property of persons. This orientation will be maintained here.

Most people would agree that autonomy is normatively important. This agreement is reflected both in the presence of broad assent to the principle that autonomy deserves respect, and in the popular practice of arguing for the institution (or continuation, or discontinuation) of public policy based in some way on the value of self-determination. Many also believe that developing and cultivating autonomy is an important–indeed, on some accounts, an indispensable–part of living a good life. But although the claim that autonomy is normatively significant in some way is intuitively compelling, it is not obvious why autonomy has this significance, or what weight autonomy-based considerations should be given in relation to competing normative considerations. In order to answer these questions with sufficient rigor, it is necessary to have a more detailed understanding of what autonomy is.

This article will be devoted to canvassing the leading work done by philosophers on these two issues, beginning with the question of the nature of autonomy, and then moving to the question of the normative significance of autonomy. It will be seen that autonomy has been understood in several different ways, that it has been claimed to have normative significance of various kinds, and that it has been employed in a wide range of philosophical issues. Special attention will be paid to the question of justification of the principle of respect for autonomous choice.

History of the Concept of Autonomy
Conceptions of Autonomy
The Normative Roles of Autonomy
Warrant for the Principle of Respect for Autonomous Choice
References and Further Reading

1. History of the Concept of Autonomy

The concept of autonomy first came into prominence in ancient Greece, where it characterized self-governing city-states. Barring one exception (mentioned below), autonomy was not explicitly predicated of persons, although there is reason to hold that many philosophers of that time had something similar in mind when they wrote of persons being guided or ruled by reason. Plato and Aristotle, for example–as well as many of the Stoics–surely would have agreed that a person ruled by reason is a properly self-governing or self-ruling person. What one does not find, however, are ancient philosophers speaking of the ideal of autonomy as that of living according to one’s unique individuality. The one exception to this appears to be found in the thinker and orator Dio of Prusa (ca. 50–ca. 120), who, in his 80^th Discourse, clearly seems to predicate autonomy of individual persons in roughly the sense in which it has come to be understood in our own day (see Cooper 2003).

Medieval philosophers made no use of the concept of autonomy that is worthy of note, although once again, many medieval philosophers would have doubtless agreed that those who live in accordance with right reason and the will of God are properly self-governing. The concept of autonomy wouldn’t be circulated in learned circles again until the Renaissance and early modern times, when it was employed both in the traditional political sense, and in an ecclesiastical sense, to refer to churches that were–or at least claimed to be –independent of the authority of the Roman Catholic Pope (see Pohlmann 1971).

The concept of autonomy came into philosophical prominence for the first time with the work of Immanuel Kant. Kant’s work on autonomy, however, was strongly influenced by the writings of Jean-Jacques Rousseau, so a brief word on Rousseau is in order. Although Rousseau did not use the term ‘autonomy’ in his writings, his conception of moral freedom–defined as “obedience to the law one has prescribed to oneself”– has a clear relation to Kant’s understanding of autonomy (as will be shown below). Moreover, Rousseau wrote of moral freedom as a property of persons, thus presaging Kant’s predication of autonomy of persons. The connections between Rousseau and Kant cannot be taken too far, however; for Rousseau was primarily concerned with the question of how moral freedom can be achieved and sustained by individuals within society given the presence of relations of social dependency and the possibility of domination, whereas Kant was primarily concerned with the place of autonomy in accounts of the subjective conditions requisite for, and the nature of, morality. Because of the connections Kant drew between autonomy and morality, Kant’s conception of autonomy is sometimes referred to as ‘moral autonomy’.

In the nineteenth century, John Stuart Mill contributed to the discussion on the normative significance of autonomy in his work On Liberty. Although Mill did not use the term ‘autonomy’ in this work, he is widely understood as having had self-determination in mind. Mill’s work continues to have considerable influence on discussions on the normative significance of autonomy in relation to paternalism of various kinds.

A tremendous amount of research on autonomy has taken place in the last several decades in both the analytic and continental traditions. Continental philosophers speak more often of authenticity than of autonomy, but there are clear connections between the two, insofar as the ‘self’ in ‘self-determination’ is plausibly understood as the authentic self. Philosophers working in the analytic tradition have gone into great detail attempting to discern necessary and sufficient conditions for the presence of autonomy, as well as to uncover the ground and implications of its normative significance.

2. Conceptions of Autonomy

There are several different conceptions of autonomy, all of which are loosely based upon the core notions of self-government or self-determination, but which differ considerably in the details.

a. Moral Autonomy

As mentioned, moral autonomy is associated with the work of Kant, and is also referred to as ‘autonomy of the will’ or ‘Kantian autonomy.’ This form of autonomy consists in the capacity of the will of a rational being to be a law to itself, independently of the influence of any property of objects of volition. More specifically, an autonomous will is said to be free in both a negative and a positive sense. The will is negatively free in that it operates entirely independently of alien influences, including all contingent empirical determinations associated with appetite, desire-satisfaction, or happiness. The will is positively free in that it can act in accordance with its own law. Kant’s notion of autonomy of the will thus involves, as Andrews Reath has written, “not only a capacity for choice that is motivationally independent, but a lawgiving capacity that is independent of determination by external influence and is guided by its own internal principle–in other words, by a principle that is constitutive of lawgiving” (Reath 2006). Now, because the lawgiving of the autonomous will contains no content given by contingent empirical influences, this lawgiving must be universal; and because these laws are the product of practical reason, they are necessary. Insofar, then, as Kant understood moral laws as universal and necessary practical laws, it can be seen why Kant posited an essential connection between the possession of autonomy and morality: the products of the autonomous will are universal and necessary practical laws–that is, moral laws. It is thus by virtue of our autonomy that we are capable of morality, and we are moral to the extent that we are autonomous. It is for this reason that Kant’s conception of autonomy is described as moral autonomy. Moral autonomy refers to the capacity of rational agents to impose upon themselves–to legislate for themselves–the moral law.

Furthermore, the capacity for autonomy, according to Kant, is “the basis of the dignity of human and of every rational nature;” and in accordance with this rational nature, is an end in itself. Furthermore, it “restricts freedom of action, and is an object of respect”. Many thinkers have followed Kant in grounding the dignity of persons (and respect for persons generally) in our capacity for autonomy (although it should be noted that not all of these thinkers have accepted Kant’s conception of autonomy). More will be said on this below.

Moral autonomy is said to be a bivalent property possessed by all rational beings by virtue of their rationality–although according to Kant, it is certainly possible not to live in accordance with its deliverances in practice (for more on Kant’s conception of autonomy, see Hill 1989, Guyer 2003, and Reath 2006).

One of the most common objections to this conception of autonomy is that such a robust form of independence from contingent empirical influences is not possible. Kant defended the possibility of such robust independence by arguing that human agents inhabit two realms at once: the phenomenal realm of experience, in relation to which we are determined; and a noumenal or transcendental realm of the intellect, in relation to which we are free. Given the further claim that our noumenal self can exercise efficient causality in the phenomenal realm, Kant held that our autonomy is in large part constituted by our noumenal freedom. The postulation of such a form of freedom may be criticized as metaphysically extravagant, however; and if such freedom is not possible, then neither is moral autonomy in Kant’s strict sense. Some thinkers have argued that Kant’s theorization on the noumenal realm was not meant to have metaphysical significance. Thomas Hill has argued, for example, that Kant may have been merely elaborating on the practical conditions in which we must understand ourselves insofar as we conceive ourselves as free. Objectors have insisted, however, that Kant intended to assert the more robust form of metaphysical freedom. Indeed, it could be pressed, he must have; for without this sense of freedom being operative, actual autonomy–and hence morality, by Kant’s lights–would not be possible.

b. Existentialist Autonomy

Existentialist autonomy is an extreme form of autonomy associated principally with the writings of Jean Paul Sartre. It refers to the complete freedom of subjects to determine their natures and guiding principles independently of any forms of social, anthropological or moral determination. To possess existentialist autonomy is thus to be able to choose one’s nature without constraint from any principles not of one’s own choosing. Sartre held this radical freedom to be entailed by the truth of atheism. According to Sartre, God’s nonexistence entails two key conclusions: firstly, humans cannot have a predetermined nature; and secondly, there cannot exist a realm of values possessing independent validity. Taken together, this entails that human beings are radically free: “For if indeed existence precedes essence, one will never be able to explain one’s action by reference to a given and specific human nature; in other words, there is no determinism–man is free, man is freedom. Nor, on the other hand, if God does not exist, are we provided with any values or commands that could legitimize our behavior. Thus we have neither behind us, nor before us in a luminous realm of values, any means of justification or excuse.” Fettered neither by a predetermined nature nor by an independently existing order of values, “[m]an is nothing else but what he makes of himself” (Sartre 1946).

Like moral autonomy, existentialist autonomy is a bivalent property which all human persons are said to possess (although possibly without being aware of this). Unlike moral autonomy, however, existentialist autonomy has no necessary connections to morality or to rationality as traditionally conceived.

The primary objection to existentialist autonomy is that it is too radical to be plausible. Even if God does not exist, it is argued, it does not follow that humans lack a nature that determines–at least to some extent–their choices, tendencies, proclivities, and guiding principles. A thoroughly naturalistic conception of human nature, informed by an understanding of the evolutionary forces operative in human psychology, seems to militate against the notion that humans are as unbounded as existentialist autonomy suggests we are. At the very least, it could be argued that empirical evidence does not speak in favor of the existence of existentialist autonomy in any robust form.

c. Personal Autonomy

Without question, the majority of contemporary work on autonomy has centered on analyses of the nature and normativity of personal autonomy. Personal autonomy (also referred to as ‘individual autonomy’) refers to a psychological property, the possession of which enables agents to reflect critically on their natures, preferences and ends, to locate their most authentic commitments, and to live consistently in accordance with these in the face of various forms of internal and external interference. Personally autonomous agents are said to possess heightened capacities for self-control, introspection, independence of judgment, and critical reflection; and to this extent personal autonomy is often put forth as an ideal of character or a virtue, the opposite of which is blind conformity, or not ‘being one’s own person.’

As mentioned above, personal autonomy has an essential relation to authenticity: the personally autonomous agent is the agent who is effective in determining her life in accordance with her authentic self. Personal autonomy is thus constituted, on the one hand, by a cluster of related capacities (often termed ‘authenticity conditions’), centered on identifying one’s authentic nature or preferences and, on the other hand, by a cluster of capacities (often termed ‘competency conditions’) that are centered on being able effectively to live in accordance with these throughout one’s life in the face of various recalcitrant foreign influences. These capacities may be possessed singly or in unison, and often require a considerable amount of life experience to assume robust forms.

One of the most intractable problems surrounding personal autonomy concerns the analysis of the authentic self (the ‘self’ in ‘self-determination’, as it were). Some philosophers have claimed that no such self exists; and indeed, some philosophers claim that no self exists at all (for an overview of these problems, see Friedman 2003 and Mackenzie & Stoljar 2000). Most philosophers accept the possibility of the authentic self at least as a working hypothesis, however, and concentrate attention on the question of how authenticity is secured by an agent. The most popular and influential account is based on the work of Harry Frankfurt and Gerald Dworkin. According to their ‘hierarchical’ account, agents validate the various commitments (beliefs, values, desires, and so forth) that constitute their selves as their own by a process of reflective endorsement. On this account, agents are said to possess first-order and second-order volitions. Our first-order volitions are what we want; and our second-order volitions are what we want to want. According to the hierarchical model, our first-order desires, commitments, and so on are authentic when they are validated by being in harmony with our second-order volitions: that is, when we want what we want to want. Following from this model, an agent is autonomous in relation to a given object when the agent is able to determine her first-order volitions (and corresponding behavior) by her second-order volitions. A simple example may help to illustrate the model. Say that I am a smoker. Although I enjoy lighting up, I do not reflectively endorse my smoking; I desire it, but I do not want to desire it. On the hierarchical model, smoking is not an aspect of my authentic self, because I do not reflectively endorse it; and to the extent that I am unable to change my habits, I am not autonomous in relation to smoking. Conversely, if I can bring my first-order volitions into harmony (or identity) with my second-order volition, then my desire is authentic because it is reflectively endorsed; and to the extent that I can mold my behavior in accordance with my reflective will, I am autonomous in relation to smoking. Persons who possess the requisite capacities to form authentic desires and effectively to generally live in accordance with them are autonomous agents according to this model (see Frankfurt 1971, 1999 and Dworkin 1988).

The hierarchical model remains–in outline, at least–the leading account of authenticity undergirding most contemporary accounts of personal autonomy, although it has been attacked on many fronts. The primary objection tendered against this account is ‘the problem of origins.’ As we have seen, authentic selfhood as reflective endorsement holds that my authentic self is the self that I reflectively ratify: the self that I endorse as expressing, in a deep sense, who I fundamentally am or wish to be. The problem of origins arises when one attempts to explain how this act of reflective endorsement actually constitutes a break from other-determination (that is, from foreign influence). For, could it not be the case that what appears to me to be an independent act of reflective endorsement is itself conditioned by other-determining factors and therefore ultimately an other-determined act? If this is the case, then it doesn’t seem that the possession of autonomy or the making of autonomous choices is possible. In short, the problem is how to sustain an account of self-determination that is not threatened by the pervasive effects of other-determination (see Taylor 2005 for elaboration on the problem of origins and related sub-problems). Much work on theories of personal autonomy has been explicitly devoted to addressing precisely these sorts of difficulties.

Besides analyzing and clarifying the authenticity conditions necessary for autonomy, philosophers have also worked on providing a thorough account of the competency conditions necessary for the presence of autonomy (see Meyers 1989, Mele 1993, and Berofsky 1995). Competency conditions, as we have seen, are those capacities or conditions that need to be present in order for one to be effective in living according to one’s authentic self-conception in the face of various kinds of interference to that end. Examples of competency conditions include self-control, logical aptitude, instrumental rationality, resolve, temperance, calmness, and a good memory.

In addition to authenticity and competency conditions, many theories of personal autonomy require the presence of certain external enabling conditions: that is, external or environmental (social, legal, familial, and so forth) conditions which are more than less out of the agent’s control, but which must be in place in order for fully autonomous living to be possible. Such enabling conditions include, for example, a modicum of social freedom, an array of substantive options for choice, the presence of authenticity-oriented social relations, and autonomy-supporting networks of social recognition and acknowledgment (see Raz 1986 and Anderson & Honneth 2005). Without these conditions, effective autonomous living is said by some to be impossible, even where authenticity and competency conditions are robustly satisfied. Different autonomy theorists place different emphases on external enabling conditions. Some contend that external enabling is a necessary condition for autonomy (see Oshana 1998). Others hold that autonomy more properly concerns agential satisfaction of authenticity and competency conditions, regardless of whether the external environment allows for actual autonomous expression (see Christman 2007). Both views can claim some intuitive support. On the one hand, it is reasonable to hold that it is only fitting to call a person ‘autonomous’ if that person is in fact effective in living according to her authentic self-conception. Yet, it also makes sense to call persons ‘autonomous’ who have formed an authentic self-conception and possess the requisite competency conditions effectively to express that self-conception, but happen to lack the contingent socio-relational conditions that allow for the expression of that authentic self. A possible solution to this impasse may be to avoid seeking hard and fast borders to the existence of autonomy, and say that autonomy is present in both cases, but is more robust where the proper external enabling conditions are in place.

The question of normative commitments associated with personal autonomy possession has also been a matter of some dispute. Many philosophers hold that autonomy is normatively content-neutral. According to this account, one (or one’s commitments) can be autonomous regardless of the values one endorses. On this account, one could commit to any kind of life–even the life of a slave–and still be autonomous (see, for example, Friedman 2003). Other philosophers hold that autonomy possession requires substantive normative constraints of some kind or other–at the very least, it is argued that one must value autonomy in order to be truly autonomous (see Oshana 2003). As with the debate just mentioned, both sides of this debate can claim some intuitive support; this can be shown through the asking of opposing but seemingly equally compelling (apparently rhetorical) questions; namely, ‘Can’t one autonomously choose whatever one wants?’, and, ‘How can we call someone autonomous who doesn’t value or seek autonomous living?’ One possible solution to this debate is to say that while almost any individual choice can be autonomous, persons cannot live autonomous lives as a whole without some commitment to the value of autonomy.

Unlike moral and existentialist autonomy, personal autonomy is possessed in degrees, depending on the presence and strength of the constellation of internal capacities and external enabling conditions that make it possible. While not all persons possess personal autonomy, it is commonly claimed that virtually everyone–with the exception of the irredeemably pathological and the handicapped–possesses the capacity for personal autonomy. In addition, the links between personal autonomy possession and moral agency are usually said to be thin at best. Even those who hold that personal autonomy possession requires substantive normative commitments of some kind (such as, for example, a commitment to the value of autonomy itself), they usually hold that it is quite possible to be an autonomous villain. Some philosophers have argued that personal autonomy possession requires the presence of normative competency conditions that effectively provide agents with the capacity to distinguish right from wrong (see Wolf 1990), but this strong account is in general disfavor, and even if the account is correct, few would argue that this means that personally autonomous agents must also always act morally. In the face of this, one may wonder why autonomy-based claims are said to generate demands of respect upon others. This question will be dealt with in more detail in section 4 below.

Lastly, a word should be given on the relation between personal autonomy and freedom (or liberty, which is here taken to be synonymous with freedom). Although it is not uncommon to find the terms ‘(personal) autonomy’ and ‘freedom’ used essentially synonymously, there are some important differences between them.

More often than not, to claim that a person is free is to claim that she is negatively free in the sense that she is not constrained by internal or external forces that hinder making a choice and executing it in action. There is a clear distinction between autonomy and negative freedom, however, given that autonomy refers to the presence of a capacity for effective authentic living, and negative freedom refers to a lack of constraints on action. It is entirely possible for a person to be free in this negative sense but nonautonomous, or–on accounts that do not require the presence of external enabling conditions for autonomy to be present–for a person to be autonomous but not (negatively) free.

Some writers also speak of positive freedom, and here the connections with autonomy become much deeper. Speaking very generally, to be free in this sense is to possess the abilities, capacities, knowledge, entitlements or skills necessary for the achievement of a given end. For example, I am only (positively) free to win an Olympic gold medal in archery if I am extremely skilled in the sport. Here it should be clear that one can be positively free in many ways and yet not be autonomous. Some philosophers, however, following Isaiah Berlin (Berlin 1948), have described positive freedom in such a way that it becomes basically synonymous with personal autonomy. Like autonomy, the conception of freedom that is operative in a given discussion can vary considerably; but more often than not personal autonomy is distinguished from freedom by the necessary presence, in the former, of a connection to the authenticity of the agent’s self-conception and life-plan–a connection that is usually not found in conceptions of freedom.

d. Autonomy as a Right

Lastly, autonomy is sometimes spoken of in a manner that is more directly normative than descriptive. In political philosophy and bioethics especially, it is common to find references to persons as autonomous, where the autonomy referred to is understood principally as a right to self-determination. In these contexts, to say that a person is autonomous is largely to say that she has a right to determine her life without interference from social or political authorities or forms of paternalism. Importantly, this right to self-directed living is often said to be possessed by persons by virtue either of their potential for autonomous living or of their inherent dignity as persons, but not by virtue of the presence of a developed and active capacity for autonomy (see Hill 1989). Some have argued that political rights (Ingram 1994) and even human rights generally (Richards 1989) are fundamentally based upon respect for the entitlements that attend possessing the capacity for autonomy.

3. The Normative Roles of Autonomy

Although disagreements concerning the nature of autonomy are rife, almost no one disagrees that autonomy has normative significance of some kind; and this agreement is found both in relation to the claim that autonomy is normatively significant for the autonomous agent and to the claim that autonomy is normatively significant for the addressees of autonomy-based demands. Following from this, autonomy plays an important normative role in a variety of philosophical areas.

a. Autonomy in Ethical Theory

Autonomy is referenced or invoked in a number of key ways in ethical theory:

(i) Autonomy serves as a ground for the claims that persons have dignity and inherently deserve basic moral respect

(ii) Autonomy is said to have a value that grounds the claim that persons deserve to be told the truth

(iii) Autonomy is referenced as a fundamental principle of ethics in Kantian deontology

(iv) Autonomy is commonly viewed as a key component of human well-being (and is therefore significant for utilitarianism)

(v) Autonomy is defended as an important virtue

(vi) Autonomy is said to be necessary for moral responsibility

(vii) Autonomy is said to have a value that grounds the claim that autonomy-based demands are worthy of special respect

(i) Ever since Kant, autonomy (or the capacity for autonomy) has been referenced by some philosophers as that property of human beings by virtue of which they possess inherent dignity and therefore inherently deserve to be treated with basic moral respect. Kant’s justification for the claim that autonomy grounds the inherent dignity of persons was based on the view that it is by virtue of our autonomy that we are ends-in-ourselves. Beings that lack autonomy are, precisely because of this lack, essentially at the mercy of the determinism that characterizes the phenomenal realm: they are controlled by forces that have nothing to do with their own will. Beings that possess autonomy on the other hand, are, precisely because of this possession, free from this determination; they have the capacity for freedom through the active exercise of their autonomous wills, which allows for the legislation of universal law. Autonomous agents are not passive players in life; they are active agents, determining themselves by their own will, the authors of the laws that they follow (see Guyer 2003). As such, they are not passive means towards nature’s determined ends, but are ends-in-themselves, by virtue of which they possess inherent dignity and deserve basic moral respect. Many have followed Kant in referencing autonomy as the ground of human dignity and as the basis of the basic moral respect owed to persons, although not all have followed Kant in the details of his account (for a recent account that moves away from Kant’s conception of noumenal freedom, see Korsgaard 1996). The most common objection leveled against this account is that it runs into problems involving exclusion. Most would argue that the mentally handicapped, for example, are owed basic moral respect, even if they do not possess (even the capacity for) autonomy. And if human dignity is indexed to the presence of autonomy, it is argued, this would entail, counter-intuitively, that those who are more autonomous have more dignity, and are more worthy of respect. It may also be argued that the capacity for autonomy is a poor ground for human dignity (and respect for persons) for other reasons–for example, because autonomy has no essential connection to morality, or because better grounds are available, or because the very project of grounding human dignity on a property of some kind is ill-conceived. Despite these worries, however, appeals to autonomy as a basis for human dignity and basic moral respect remain quite popular.

(ii) Some philosophers have argued that a proper appreciation for others as autonomous (or as possessing the capacity for autonomy) requires that one not seek to deceive them. Respect for autonomy is thus said to have an important relation to truthfulness. In Thomas Hill’s words, “Lies often reflect inadequate respect for the autonomy of the person who is deceived.” (Hill 1991) We saw above that autonomy’s value has been used to ground the basic moral respect owed to persons; and the present injunction against deception may be viewed as a specific form that autonomy-based respect for persons may take. It is easy to see why a connection between respect for autonomy and truthfulness (or what comes to the same thing–an injunction against deception) has been attractive to some philosophers, especially those in the Kantian tradition. When we deceive others for our own purposes, we bypass their reflective abilities and make them instruments in the achievement of our own ends, and in doing this we fail to treat them as persons capable and deserving of self-determination. Proper respect for persons as autonomous thus requires a commitment to truthfulness. It has been argued, however, that one may respect and value the autonomy of another while deceiving them at the same time (Buss 2005). One may, for example, use forms of deception so that another’s capacity for autonomy may flourish. The basic idea here is that one may still reason for oneself despite being deliberately influenced by the deceptive behavior of others. As Sarah Buss writes, “To put it somewhat crudely, whether an instance of practical reasoning is self-determined is a matter of whether it is really the agent herself who is doing the reasoning. And this would seem to depend on whether she determines her response to the considerations that figure in her reasoning–not on how the considerations to which she responds relate to reality, nor on how she came to be aware of these considerations.” It may be argued, however, that the conception of autonomy underlying this claim is too thin to be acceptable, and that a better conception would contain the resources necessary to judge self-determining reasoning influenced by the deliberate deception of another as nonautonomous. In this vein, some have argued that a person is autonomous in relation to a given desire or choice only if that person would not feel alienated from the causal process that gave rise to that desire or choice (Christman 2007). On the assumption that persons would feel alienated from deceptive desire- or choice-forming processes, the associated desires or choices would not count as autonomous. In response to this, however, it may be argued that autonomous agents may not feel alienated from all (or many) deceptive forms of influence upon the formation of their desires and choices, depending on the circumstances (Buss 2005). If this were the case, then a commitment to the value of autonomy may not be inconsistent with certain forms of deception or manipulation. Yet, given the traditional opposition between autonomous self-determination and agential determination rooted in deceit and manipulation, it is to be expected that resistance to the notion that they are not incompatible will continue.

(iii) Autonomy plays a key role in Kant’s deontological ethics. We have already seen this in the way in which Kant grounds human dignity in autonomy. But autonomy plays a further (and closely related) normative role for Kant. It is often said that Kant held that the Categorical Imperative can be expressed in three closely related formulas: the Formula of Universal Law, the Formula of Humanity, and the Formula of the Kingdom of Ends. It has also been claimed, however, that Kant defended a fourth formula, which may be called the Formula of Autonomy. Although Kant did not state this formula explicitly, it has been argued that it can be plausibly derived from his description of the Categorical Imperative as “the idea of the will of every rational being as a will that legislates universal law.” The corresponding Formula of Autonomy could then be expressed as an imperative in this way: act so that the maxims you will could be the legislation of universal law. According to this formula, we should act according to principles that express the autonomy of the will. This formulation is important, firstly because it suggests that Kant conceived autonomy as a normative principle (and not merely as a condition of the will that makes morality possible), and secondly because it further reinforces Kant’s claim that humans, as autonomous law-givers, are the source of the universal law that guarantees their freedom and hence marks them out as possessing inherent dignity (see Reath 2006).

(iv) Autonomy is commonly held to be a core component of well-being. This view goes back at least to Mill’s On Liberty, and has been accepted by many contemporary philosophers as well (see for example Griffin 1986 and Sumner 1996). In this connection, some argue that autonomy is an intrinsic part of well-being, and others argue that being autonomous reliably leads to well-being (and hence has instrumental prudential value). Although thus far, the normative importance of autonomy has been described as being associated primarily with deontology, the claim that autonomy is a core component of well-being shows that it can play a key role in consequentialist moral theories as well. Indeed, as will be discussed in greater detail below (section 4), although most defenses of the principle of respect for autonomy are deontological in nature, it is also possible to defend the principle on consequentialist grounds. From this point of view, it can be argued that autonomy deserves respect because respecting autonomy is reliably conducive to well-being.

(v) Autonomy has been claimed to be an important virtue to possess. It is not difficult to see why this is the case. The autonomous person is a person possessing a constellation of widely desirable qualities such as self-control, self-knowledge, rationality and reflective maturity. To be autonomous is to be self-governing; to be free from domination by foreign influences over one’s character and values; to ‘be one’s own person’. Following from this, it is claimed by some that autonomy is a great virtue to possess – one which constitutes an important part of human flourishing. It may be objected, however, that an excessive concern with autonomy can be at odds with virtue, especially if robust autonomy entails an inability to exhibit loyalty or fidelity to projects, other persons or communities. Recent work on personal autonomy, however, has tended to support the notion that autonomy possession is not incompatible with these and similar forms of attachment (Friedman 2003).

(vi) Autonomy has been seen by some thinkers as having implications for a correct account of moral responsibility. Some accounts hold that autonomy is a necessary condition for moral responsibility. The basic defense of this claim is that it makes little sense to say that someone is morally responsible for her actions if she is not the author of those actions; and since one is the author of one’s actions only if one is autonomous, autonomy possession is necessary for moral responsibility. According to this account, the class of actions that are autonomous and the class of actions for which we are morally responsible are identical, or at least almost so (see Fischer and Ravizza 1998). Other accounts hold that although persons are certainly morally responsible for their autonomous actions, they are also morally responsible for a wider range of actions as well. An account of this sort is often made by those who hold a more demanding conception of autonomy; and defenders of this account argue that we still want to hold persons morally responsible for the many actions that do not satisfy robust autonomy conditions on the one hand, but are not constituted of sheer heteronomy (brainwashing, psychosis, coercion, and so forth) on the other (see Arpaly 2005).

(vi) Many thinkers believe that autonomous claims or demands are worthy of special normative uptake–special respect–by virtue of the fact that they are autonomous. It is important to see how this claim is different from the first point given above (viz., that autonomy is said to ground basic moral respect for persons). The former claim is that the fact that persons are autonomous (or have the capacity for autonomy) is what grounds their special dignity, by virtue of which they are owed basic moral respect. Now, it is possible to owe someone basic moral respect, but not to owe special respect to a subset of their choices. Imagine that someone is brainwashed, for example. Many would argue that although we owe that person basic moral respect (for example, we are obligated, say, not to harm them or to lie to them), we do not owe special respect to that person’s demands (say, to promote or not interfere with those demands). The current claim holds, however, that the fact that a person’s choices are autonomous generates special demands of respect for those choices over and above the basic respect owed to the chooser (whether this be conceived as being by virtue of their capacity for autonomy or not). This principle–that autonomous choice deserves special respect–may be justified in either a deontological or consequentialist manner. Because of the considerable importance of this principle, however, it deserves a more detailed discussion, which is provided in section 4 below.

b. Autonomy in Applied Ethics

The principle of respect for autonomy has had a considerable influence on applied ethics largely because of its versatility: it can be invoked in any applied ethics debate that bears (even remotely) on morally significant situations that involve the demands of self-determination, free choice, authenticity or independence. Seven of the most important of these debates–certainly not an exhaustive list–will be briefly canvassed below:

(i) Autonomy and informed consent

(ii) Autonomy and abortion

(iii) Autonomy and end-of-life decisions

(iv) Autonomy and same-sex marriage

(v) Autonomy and just war theory

(vi) Autonomy and advertising

(vii) Autonomy and environmental ethics

(i) Respect for autonomy has had a major influence on debates in medical ethics, especially those concerning the constraints that should be in place within the physician-patient relationship. Perhaps the most important such constraint is that of informed consent. According to this principle, a patient should not receive medical treatment of any sort unless she is well-informed enough as to the treatment’s nature and effects to be able to make an informed decision about it. The patient must agree to the treatment on the basis of this information. Many have argued that the requirement of informed consent is necessitated as part and parcel of a more basic imperative to respect patient autonomy (Dworkin 2006). Few argue that respecting patient autonomy has no weight at all; more commonly, objectors argue that there are cases in which overriding patient autonomy is sometimes justified by the good consequences that will likely result from doing so.

(ii) Autonomy is also referenced as an important value to be taken into consideration in the abortion debate, although it is referenced in different ways. On the one hand, it is argued that some abortions are justified as an expression of a woman’s reproductive autonomy (see Overall 1990 and Fischer 2003). On the other hand, it could be argued that abortion is morally unacceptable, among other reasons, because it fails to respect the potential future autonomy of the aborted (for a related argument, see Marquis 1989). Assuming that both of these autonomy-based arguments have weight, adjudicating this dispute requires–among other things–establishing and defending the relative weights of actual and potential autonomy, both in relation to particular choices and in relation to lives as wholes.

(iii) Many argue that considerations of respect for autonomy are also decisive in the debates concerning the moral acceptability of euthanasia and suicide. Respect for autonomy can be viewed as a reason for accepting voluntary euthanasia. The basic argument here is one of consistency: if respect for others’ autonomy requires respecting others’ self-determining life-choices (at least when these are competently made), and if end-of-life decisions are placed within the ambit of life-choices, then end-of-life decisions made by competent, autonomous persons should be respected, even if these decisions involve voluntary euthanasia (for a related argument, see Brock 1993). Some have cast doubt, however, on whether a decision to die can be an autonomous decision at all, given the likely presence of psychological factors such as fear, hopelessness, and despair–factors which would undermine careful introspection and critical thought (Hartling 2006). Respect for autonomy can also be seen as a reason for respecting the decision to end one’s life, even when reasons of mercy are not in play–that is, in cases of suicide–at least where there is reason to hold that the agent is sufficiently competent and rational (Webber & Shulman 1987). Some argue, however, that autonomy-based defenses of voluntary euthanasia and suicide involve a contradiction insofar as they invoke the value of autonomy to justify an act that destroys autonomy (Safranak 1988 and Doerflinger 1989). If correct, these arguments do not show that voluntary euthanasia or suicide are unacceptable; they show rather that arguments to establish their acceptability cannot be based on respect for autonomy. It may be a cause of worry, however, that such arguments prove too much by rendering unacceptable autonomy-based respect for any decision that involves a subsequent lessening of free choice.

(iv) Autonomy also carries normative weight in a number of applied ethics debates relating to public policy. Respect for autonomy can be straightforwardly referenced, for example, as an argument in favor of the acceptability of same-sex marriage: respect for others’ autonomy entails respect for their autonomous decisions, and decisions regarding marriage–even same-sex marriage–fall within these parameters (when autonomous). Objectors might argue, however, that homosexual marriage is immoral, and that the right to noninterference with autonomous choice does not exist where the object of the choice is immoral. Few would argue, for example, that there exists an obligation to respect someone’s autonomous decision to embezzle money, given that that act is immoral. The question then becomes whether same-sex marriage is morally acceptable.

(v) Respect for autonomy also plays a role in discussions of a just-war theory. Specifically, it has been referenced as the key principle determining the proper constraints and limitations that should be in place if we wish our prosecution of war to be just. It has been argued, for example–and in partial conjunction with what has been said above–that possession of autonomy (or the existence of a capacity for it) is the ground of human dignity, and hence the actions which appreciate that dignity must center on respect for autonomy. In relation to war, this suggests that while war may sometimes be morally permissible (in cases of self-defense, for example), wartime actions cannot involve violations of others’ autonomy, especially that of noncombatants (for an extended discussion, see Zupan 2004).

(vi) In business ethics, respect for autonomy has been identified as a key reason why persuasive advertising practices are morally unacceptable (Crisp 1987). The arguments given in support of this claim largely follow those mentioned above in relation to truthfulness–viz. that respect for others’ autonomy is incompatible with deception or manipulation–combined with the claim that persuasive advertising practices constitute deception or manipulation. In this vein it has also been argued that persuasive advertising undermines consumer autonomy by creating foreign desires and wants and by producing compulsive behavior in consumers. Some have argued, however, that persuasive advertising practices do not threaten consumers’ autonomy, at least not necessarily or intrinsically (Arrington 1982). From this point of view, although such deception may occur, this is the exception; usually it provides consumers with the information necessary for making informed decisions. It has also been argued that, even if persuasive advertising thwarts autonomy, it is still in consumers’ interests to be exposed to it, given that companies would likely only go to such trouble for products that will be market-winners, and hence that consumers would have desired and bought those products anyway, even after careful consideration (Nelson 1978). One obvious problem with this argument is that it assumes that heavy persuasive marketing is a sign of product quality, which is certainly debatable; but even if that premise is granted, it may still be argued that rhetorical device laden advertising, by attempting to bypass consumers’ critical thinking abilities, violates their autonomy.

(vii) Respect for autonomy has even been referenced in relation to issues in environmental ethics. Eric Katz has argued, for example, that nature as a whole constitutes an ‘autonomous subject’, which therefore deserves moral respect and should not be treated as a mere means to the satisfaction of human ends (Katz 1997). Critics of this view may wonder whether the notion of an autonomous subject operative here has been stretched to breaking point, or rendered hollow. If correct, this criticism does not, of course, entail that prohibitions against using nature as a mere means to human ends cannot be provided; it simply means that an acceptable defense cannot be based on autonomy-related considerations.

It should be clear from the breadth and diversity of the employment of the principle of respect for autonomy that it is both, extremely versatile and a mainstay of applied ethics debates. The brief sketches given above concern some of the more prominent autonomy-related discussions in applied ethics, but other debates in applied ethics–relating, for example, to injunctions against discrimination (Gardner 1992 and Doyle 2007) or against domestic abuse (Friedman 2003), to name a couple–have been approached and adjudicated in reference to the importance of respecting autonomy as well.

More often than not, however, those who reference the principle of respect for autonomy in applied ethics either take its normative force for granted, or only devote passing attention to the question of its justification. Yet, given that the principle is neither self-evident nor immune to challenge, it is very important that those who reference the principle be able to provide a robust justification of its normative weight. Because of its fundamentality, this issue will be considered separately and in more detail in section 4 below.

c. Autonomy in Political Philosophy

Autonomy is considered normatively significant for issues in political philosophy, primarily in relation to discussions of social justice and rights. It is particularly important for political liberalism (see, for example, Christman and Anderson 2005); and some have argued that autonomy is the core value of liberalism (see White 1991 and Dagger 2005). Four of the most important issues in political philosophy that invoke the normative significance of autonomy include:

(i) The establishment and validation of just social and political principles

(ii) The legitimation of political power

(iii) The justification of political rights (both specific and general)

(iv) The acceptability of political paternalism

(i) A conception of the autonomous individual provides the perspective from which social and political principles are formulated, and validated as just, in several contractarian political theories. A classic example is provided in Rawls’ A Theory of Justice (1971). According to Rawls, principles of social justice are best conceived and validated based on what would be acceptable to (representatives of) members of society gathering together in an ‘original position’ behind a ‘veil of ignorance’. Rawls argued that the conditions that constrain this process will ensure that those taking part in it are acting autonomously (that is, according to Rawls, as free and rational). Of key importance is the veil of ignorance because, by preventing any detailed knowledge of one’s condition or place in society, it “deprives the persons in the original position of the knowledge that would enable them to choose heteronomous principles”. Rawls concludes: “[W]e can say that by acting from these principles persons are acting autonomously: they are acting from principles that they would acknowledge under conditions that best express their nature as free and equal rational beings.” Given these key constraints in the contracting process, it results, according to Rawls, in valid principles of social justice. Here it can be seen that autonomy has double (and mutually supporting) normative significance: it characterizes members of society in an idealized way in order to form the normatively privileged perspective from which to establish principles of social justice; and it provides the standard that validates those principles as just (viz., by being accepted by autonomous agents). One can see the influence of Kant’s conception of autonomy and its normative significance in this doctrine. Roughly put, Kant held that moral principles are those that would be accepted by persons within an idealized constraint–viz., insofar as they are autonomous. Similarly, Rawls argued that the principles of social justice are those that would be accepted by persons within an idealized constraint–viz., insofar as they are conceived as autonomous (free and rational) agents behind a veil of ignorance in the original position. Rawls explicitly acknowledged his indebtedness to Kant in this regard.

(ii) In relation, a cornerstone of political liberalism is the view that political power is legitimized by its free acceptance by a state’s subjects who are conceived (at least minimally) as autonomous persons. John Locke is recognized as one of the key progenitors of this view of the legitimation of political power. In Two Treatises on Government (1689), he wrote: “Men being, as has been said, by nature all free, equal, and independent, no one can be put out of his estate, and subjected to the political power of another, without his own consent, which is done by agreeing with other men to join and unite into a community for their comfortable, safe, and peaceable living one amongst another…” That which secures the legitimacy of government on such a view is precisely the agreement to do so amongst those who are not only naturally equal in standing, but also free and independent–that is, self-directing. The tradition of placing crucial normative weight on the autonomy of the contracting parties has continued to the present. Referring to liberalism in political philosophy in general, John Christman has written (2005), “Liberal legitimacy…assumes that autonomous citizens can endorse the principles that shape the institutions of political power….In this way, political power is an outgrowth of autonomous personhood and choice.” As before, autonomy is fulfilling two (mutually supporting) roles: it is being used to delimit the normatively privileged perspective from which judgment is authoritative regarding political legitimacy, and it is informing (at least partly) the standard in relation to which that judgment (viz., the acceptance of a political power) is made.

(iii) Autonomy is referenced as a core ground in the justification of political rights in a broadly liberal political framework. It is argued, for example, that a theory of autonomy has to be presupposed to achieve agreement with a theory of rights that in principle is acceptable to all. It is also argued that autonomy is absolutely central in views of rights that enshrine the idea that people have the freedom equally to conceive and enjoy widely different forms of meaningful life. Attracta Ingram (Ingram 1994) provides a clear articulation of the view that autonomy deserves a central place in the defense of a scheme of political rights: “I think that the most compelling answer is that people’s most vital human interest is in living meaningful lives. This interest cannot be secured while they are at risk of slavery, social subordination, repression, persecution, and grinding poverty – conditions that history shows to be the lot of many in societies which do not recognize the value of individual freedom. So it is rational for people to want to develop the mental capacities and social environment necessary to living independent lives. Since what is at stake is the proper distribution of human freedom, we have here matters of justice and rights; the province of political morality.” (112-3) Autonomy is thus said by some to be a–or the–core unifying value in a conception of rights that is liberal (and hence pluralistic) in tenor (see also Richards 1989). In addition, the value of autonomy is referenced to justify particular rights such as the right to free speech (Brison 2000) or the right to privacy (Kupfer 1987).

(iv) Autonomy is referenced by many as the core value that militates against the acceptability of political (and informal) paternalism. According to a widely-accepted conception, an act is paternalistic if it involves direct interference with another’s actions and will for the purpose of advancing (what the interferer takes to be) that person’s own good. Paternalism bypasses the agent’s capacity to be self-directing and ignores the agent’s wishes regarding the way she would like to live her own life; and it is these factors that constitute a violation of the autonomy of the one suffering paternalistic influence. It is commonly held that possession of the capacity for autonomy gives the agent a right and an authority–at least in relation to minimally voluntary, self-regarding choices (all else being equal)–to be self-determining without interference (for a detailed account of paternalism and the defense of the claims of autonomy, see VanDeVeer 1986; see also Mill’s classic argument against paternalism in On Liberty). Supporters of paternalistic doctrines tend to argue that paternalism is justified based either on the highly beneficial consequences of such interference, or on the ground that a policy of paternalism could be hypothetically accepted by autonomous agents when the possible related consequences are severe enough (on the latter see Rawls 1999). It has also been argued that a certain degree of paternalism is unavoidable, but that such paternalism should be constrained by the goal of leading persons to welfare-promoting choices while not threatening freedom of choice (Sunstein and Thaler 2003).

It is worth mentioning in passing that J.S. Mill, who is often referenced as a champion of individual liberty and a firm critic of paternalistic policy, endorsed a strong version of paternalism, but only in relation to “those backward states of society in which the race itself may be considered as in its nonage.” In relation to these, Mill (1971) claimed that “Despotism is a legitimate mode of government in dealing with barbarians, provided the end be their improvement and the means justified by actually effecting that end.” Although these claims of Mill’s would find few supporters today, it is worth adding that the standard that Mill employed to ground the distinction between unjustified and justified paternalism was the presence of a kind of maturity of thought and judgment that is not greatly dissimilar to autonomy: “[A]s soon as mankind have attained the capacity of being guided to their own improvement by conviction or persuasion…compulsion, either in the direct form or in that of pains and penalties for noncompliance, is no longer admissible as a means to their own good, and justifiable only for the security of others.”

d. Autonomy in Philosophy of Education

Several philosophers have argued that autonomy development is the most important goal (or at least one of the most important goals) of a liberal education. Reasoning in support of this claim usually takes two forms. Firstly, some argue that autonomy should be the primary goal of liberal education because autonomy enhancement is the most important goal of the liberal state, and hence an education in such a state should be an education for autonomy (see White 1991, and compare with Raz 1986, ch. 14). Secondly, some argue that autonomy should be the goal of liberal education because it should be a key goal of any form of education, largely because an education for autonomy is crucial for human well-being across the board.

The latter position has been challenged by communitarians, however, who argue that there is no justification for the claim that autonomy is universally valuable, and who see autonomy as at best a parochial (Western) value (see MacIntyre 1981, White 1991, and Raz 1986). The communitarian argument has been challenged in various ways. It has been directly counter-argued, for example, that autonomy is universally intrinsic to well-being (see Norman 1994 and Ishtiyaque & Cuypers 2008). In addition, the epistemic benefits of autonomy development for forming rational judgments about one’s life have been cited as reason for allowing the state to mandate education for autonomy, even over the protests of more traditionally-minded parents (MacMullen 2007). Although communitarians continue to be suspicious of the claim that autonomy should be a goal of all education, it is widely agreed that education for autonomy is central to an education in a liberal society.

4. Warrant for the Principle of Respect for Autonomous Choice

As mentioned above (in section 3a), the idea that autonomy gives rise to demands of respect can take two forms. On the one hand, it is argued that the possession of autonomy or the capacity for it grounds human dignity and the basic moral respect for persons that attends that dignity. On the other hand, it is argued that the fact that a choice or demand is autonomous is reason to give special or added normative uptake to that choice or demand. For clarity, one might refer to the former as the principle of respect for autonomy and the latter as the principle of respect for autonomous choice. The principle of respect for autonomy has already been examined in connection with Kant’s moral philosophy, and it was shown that although this principle has been popular, it is also quite controversial, largely because of problems involving exclusion. The principle of respect for autonomous choice will be examined in the present section. As shown above, this principle plays a key role in a variety of normative debates, especially debates in applied ethics. As has been mentioned, however, the principle is often either invoked without supporting argument or is given thin justification at best. The principle is therefore worthy of further discussion, especially with regard to its normative warrant. What is the warrant for the claim that autonomous choices give rise to special demands of respect? Two views have emerged on this question. Unsurprisingly, these views can be delineated along deontological and consequentialist lines.

Firstly, many philosophers following Kant (often only roughly), contend that autonomous choices deserve special respect because persons, as capable of self-determination, are entitled, all else being equal, to be self-determining without interference. This may be termed the authority view of the justification for the principle of respect for autonomous choice. The authority view is most often allied to the view that respect for autonomy functions primarily as a side-constraint which forbids paternalistically-motivated interference in the self-regarding, minimally voluntary choices of others, even if such interference would be prudentially best for the choosing persons.

Secondly, some philosophers following Mill, contend that autonomous choices deserve special respect because a policy of such respect conduces to desirable prudential consequences, either for the choosing agent, or aggregately. On this view, autonomous choices are not to be respected merely because they are autonomous, or because those making them have a capacity for self-determination, but rather because doing so will lead to the most beneficial prudential results. This more consequentialist view of the normative warrant for the principle of respect for autonomous choice may be termed the benefit view.

Based on the literature, it is quite clear that the authority view is the dominant view in the field, and has been for some time. Many philosophers hold that persons have a right to have their self-determining choices respected even in cases where there is good reason to think that the fulfillment of their autonomous choices would lead to bad prudential results (see Wellman 2003 and Darwall 2006). Against this it may be argued that where the prudential results of respecting a person’s autonomous choice are disastrous enough, interference may be justified, thus opening the door to the salience of consequentialist considerations bearing upon the principle (see Young 1982 and Wellman 2003). It has also been argued that the relation between the fulfillment of at least minimally robust autonomous choice and the resulting expression of authentic selfhood (conceived as highly prudentially significant) suggests that the benefit view deserves to be given closer attention (Piper 2009). Given the great popularity and wide employment of the principle of respect for autonomous choice, it is safe to say that the question of its normative warrant deserves far greater attention than it has thus far received.

5. References and Further Reading

Anderson, Joel and Axel Honneth. “Autonomy, Vulnerability, Recognition, and Justice.” In Autonomy and the Challenges to Liberalism: New Essays, eds. John Christman and Joel Anderson, 127-149. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
Arpaly, Nomy. “Responsibility, Applied Ethics, and Complex Autonomy Theories.” In Personal Autonomy: New Essays in Personal Autonomy and Its Role in Contemporary Moral Philosophy, ed. James Stacey Taylor, 162-180. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
Arrington, Robert L. “Advertising and Behavior Control.” Journal of Business Ethics 1, no. 1 (Feb. 1982): 3-12.
Berlin, Isaiah. Two Concepts of Liberty. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1958.
Berofsky, Bernard. Liberation from Self: A Theory of Personal Autonomy. Cambridge; Cambridge University Press, 1995.
Brison, Susan J. “Relational Autonomy and the Freedom of Expression.” In Relational Autonomy: Feminist Perspectives on Autonomy, Agency, and the Social Self, eds. Catriona Mackenzie and Natalie Stoljar, 280-299. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
Brock, D. “Voluntary Active Euthanasia.” The Hastings Center Report 22, no. 2 (1993): 10-22.
Buss, Sarah. “Valuing Autonomy and Respecting Persons: Manipulation, Seduction, and the Basis of Moral Constraints.” Ethics 115, no. 2 (Jan 2005): 195-235.
Christman, John and Joel Anderson, eds. Autonomy and the Challenges to Liberalism: New Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
Christman, John. “Autonomy, History, and the Subject of Justice.” Social Theory and Practice 33, no. 1 (January 2007): 1-26.
Christman, J. “Autonomy, Self-Knowledge, and Liberal Legitimacy.” In Autonomy and the Challenges to Liberalism: New Essays, eds. John Christman and Joel Anderson, 330-357. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
Cooper, John. “Stoic Autonomy.” In Autonomy, eds. Ellen Frankel Paul, Fred Miller, and Jeffrey Paul: 1-29. Cambridge: University of Cambridge Press, 2003.
Crisp, Roger. “Persuasive Advertising, Autonomy, and the Creation of Desire.” Journal of Business Ethics 6, no. 5 (July 1987): 413-418.
Dagger, Richard. “Autonomy, Domination, and the Republican Challenge to Liberalism.” In Autonomy and the Challenges to Liberalism: New Essays, eds. John Christman and Joel Anderson, 177-203. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
Darwall, Stephen. “The Value of Autonomy and Autonomy of the Will.” Ethics 116, no. 2 (January 2006): 263-284.
Doerflinger, Richard. “Assisted Suicide: Pro-Choice or Anti-Life?” The Hastings Center Report 19, no. 1 (Jan-Feb 1989): 16-19.
Doyle, Oran. “Direct Discrimination, Indirect Discrimination, and Autonomy.” Oxford Journal of Legal Studies 27, no. 3 (2007): 537-553.
Dworkin, Gerald. The Theory and Practice of Autonomy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
Dworkin, Gerald. “Autonomy and Informed Consent.” In Ethical Health Care, eds. Patrician Illingworth and Wendy Parmet, 79-91. Upper Saddle River, NJ: Pearson Prentice-Hall, 2006.
Fischer, John Martin. “Abortion, Autonomy, and Control Over One’s Body.” Social Philosophy and Policy 20, no. 2 (2003): 286-306.
Fischer, John Martin and Mark Ravizza. Responsibility and Control: A Theory of Moral Responsibility. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Frankfurt, Harry. “Freedom of the Will and the Concept of a Person.” In The Importance of What We Care About by Harry Frankfurt, 11-25. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
Frankfurt, Harry. Necessity, Volition, and Love. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
Friedman, Marilyn. Autonomy, Gender, Politics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2003.
Gardner, John. “Private Activities and PersonalAutonomy: At the Margins of Anti-discrimination Law.” In Discrimination: The Limits of the Law, eds.Bob Hepple and Erika Szyszczak, 148-171. London: Mansell, 1992.
Griffin, James. Well-Being: Its Meaning, Measurement, and Moral Importance. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.
Guyer, Paul. “Kant on the Theory and Practice of Autonomy.” In Autonomy, eds. Ellen Frankel Paul, Fred Miller, and Jeffrey Paul: 70-98. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
Hartling, O.J. “Euthanasia–the Illusion of Autonomy.” Medicine and Law 25, no. 1 (2006): 189-99.
Hill, Thomas. “The Kantian Conception of Autonomy.” In The Inner Citadel: Essays on Individual Autonomy, ed. John Christman, 91-105. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1989.
Hill, Thomas. “Autonomy and Benevolent Lies.” In Autonomy and Self-Respect by Thomas Hill, 25-42. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
Ingram, Attracta. A Political Theory of Rights. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1994.
Ishtiyaque, Haji and Stefaan Cuypers. “Authenticity-Sensitive Preferentism and Educating for Well-Being and Autonomy.” Journal of Philosophy of Education 42, no. 1 (February 2008): 85-106.
Kant, Immanuel, trans. Mary Gregor. Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
Katz, Eric. Nature As Subject. New York: Rowman & Littlefield, 1997.
Korsgaard, Christine. Creating the Kingdom of Ends. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Kupfer, Joseph. “Privacy, Autonomy, and Self-Concept.” American Philosophical Quarterly 24, no. 1 (January 1987): 81-9.
MacIntyre, Alasdair. After Virtue: A Study in Moral Theory. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1981.
Mackenzie, Catriona and Natalie Stoljar, eds. Relational Autonomy: Feminist Perspectives on Autonomy, Agency, and the Social Self. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
MacMullen, Ian. Faith in Schools? Autonomy, Citizenship and Religious Education in the Liberal State. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 2007.
Marquis, Don. “Why Abortion is Immoral.” Journal of Philosophy 86 (April 1989): 183-202.
Mele, Alfred. Autonomous Agents: From Self-Control to Autonomy. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Meyers, Diana. Self, Society, and Personal Choice. New York: Columbia University Press, 1989.
Mill, John Stuart. On Liberty. Edited by Curran V. Shields. New Jersey: Prentice-Hall Inc., 1997.
Nelson, Philip. “Advertising and Ethics.” In Ethics, Free Enterprise, and Public Policy: Original Essays on Moral Issues in Business, eds. Robert T. De George and Joseph A. Pichler. New York: Oxford University Press, 1978.
Norman, Richard. “‘I Did It My Way’: Some Thoughts on Autonomy.” Journal of Philosophy of Education 28, no. 1 (1994): 25-34.
Oshana, Marina. “Personal Autonomy and Society.” Journal of Social Philosophy 29, no. 1 (Spring 1998): 81-102.
Oshana, Marina. “How Much Should We Value Autonomy?” In Autonomy, eds. Ellen Frankel Paul, Fred Miller, and Jeffrey Paul, 99-126. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
Overall, Christine. “Selective Termination of Pregnancy and Women’s Reproductive Autonomy.” The Hastings Center Report 20, no. 3 (May-June 1990): 6-11.
Piper, Mark. “On Respect for Personal Autonomy and the Value Instantiated in Autonomous Choice.” Southwest Philosophy Review 25, no. 1 (January 2009): 189-198.
Pohlmann, R. “Autonomie.” In Historisches Wörterbuch der Philosophie, ed. J. Ritter, 1: 701-719. Basel: Schwabe, 1971.
Rawls, John. A Theory of Justice, rev. ed. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1999.
Raz, Joseph. The Morality of Freedom. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1986.
Reath, Andrews. “Autonomy of the Will as the Foundation of Morality.” In Agency and Autonomy in Kant’s Moral Theory by Andrews Reath, 121-172. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2006.
Richards, David A.J. “Rights and Autonomy.” In The Inner Citadel: essays on Individual Autonomy, ed. John Christman, 203-220. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1989.
Safranek, John. “Autonomy and Assisted Suicide: the Execution of Freedom.” The Hastings Center Report 28, no. 4 (July-Aug. 1998): 32-36.
Sartre, Jean-Paul, trans. Bernard Frechtman. Existentialism is a Humanism. New York: Philosophical Library, 1946.
Sumner, L.W. Welfare, Happiness, and Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
Sunstein, Cass and Richard Thaler. “Libertarian Paternalism is Not an Oxymoron.” The University of Chicago Law Review 70, no. 4 (Fall 2003): 1159-1202.
Taylor, James Stacey. “Introduction.” In Personal Autonomy: New Essays on Personal Autonomy and Its Role in Contemporary Moral Philosophy, ed. James Stacey Taylor, 1-29. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
VanDeVeer, Donald. Paternalistic Intervention: The Moral Bounds of Benevolence. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1986.
Webber, May and Ernest Shulman. “Personal Autonomy and Rational Suicide.” Paper given at the Annual Convention of the American Association of Suicidology/International Association for Suicide Prevention (1987).
Wellman, Christopher Heath. “The Paradox of Group Autonomy.” In Autonomy, eds. Ellen Frankel Paul, Fred Miller, and Jeffrey Paul, 265-285. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
White, John. Education and the Good Life: Autonomy, Altruism, and the National Curriculum. New York: Teachers College Press, 1991.
Wolf, Susan. Freedom and Reason. New York: Oxford University Press, 1990.
Young, Robert. “The Value of Autonomy.” The Philosophical Quarterly 32, no. 126 (January 1982): 35-44.
Zupan, Daniel S. War, Morality, and Autonomy: An Investigation in Just War Theory. Hampshire, England: Ashgate Publishing Ltd., 2004.

Author Information

Mark Piper
Email: pipermc@jmu.edu
James Madison University
U. S. A.

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Cloning

In biology, the activity of cloning creates a copy of some biological entity such as a gene, a cell, or perhaps an entire organism. This article discusses the biological, historical, and moral aspects of cloning mammals. The main area of concentration is the moral dimensions of reproductive cloning, specifically the use of cloning in order to procreate.

The article summarizes the different types of cloning, such as recombinant DNA/molecular cloning, therapeutic cloning, and reproductive cloning. It explores some classic stereotypes of human clones, and it illustrates how many of these stereotypes can be traced back to media portrayals about human cloning. After a brief history of the development of cloning technology, the article considers arguments for and against reproductive cloning.

One of the most predominate themes underlying arguments for reproductive cloning is an appeal to procreative liberty. Because cloning may provide the only way for some individuals to have a child that is genetically their own, a ban on cloning interferes with their reproductive autonomy.

Arguments against cloning appeal to concerns about a clone’s lack of genetic uniqueness and what may be implied because of this. Human cloning is of special interest. There are concerns that cloned humans would lack individuality, that they would be treated in undignified ways by their creators, or that they would be damaged by society’s expectations that they should be more like those from whom they were cloned. Because they would essentially be facsimiles of the original person, there is concern that the clones might possess less moral worth. The predominate theme underlying arguments against human cloning is that the cloned child would undergo some sort of physical, social, mental, or emotional harm. Because of these and other concerns, the United Nations and many countries have banned human cloning. An important philosophical issue is whether such a response against human cloning is warranted.

Types of Cloning
Misconceptions About Cloning and Their Sources
Cloning Mammals: A Brief History
Arguments in Favor of Reproductive Cloning and Responses
Arguments Against Reproductive Cloning and Responses
References and Further Reading

1. Types of Cloning

a. Recombinant DNA Technology / Molecular Cloning

DNA/Molecular cloning has been in use by molecular biologists since the early 1960s. When scientists wish to replicate a specific gene to facilitate more thorough study, molecular cloning is implemented in order to generate multiple copies of the DNA fragment of interest. In this process, the specific DNA fragment is transferred from one organism into a self-replicating genetic element, e.g., a bacterial plasmid (Allison, 2007).

Because this kind of cloning does not result in the genesis of a human organism, it has no reproductive intent or goals, and it does not result in the creation and destruction of embryos, there is little to no contention regarding its use.

b. Therapeutic Cloning

Embryonic stem cells are derived from human embryos at approximately five days post-fertilization, in the blastocyst stage of development. Because of their plasticity, embryonic stem cells can be manipulated to become any cell in the human body, e.g., neural cells, retinal cells, liver cells, pancreatic cells, or heart cells. Many scientists hope that, with proper research and application, embryonic stem cells can be used to treat a wide variety of afflictions, e.g., tissue toxicity resulting from cancer therapy (National Cancer Institute, 1999) Alzheimer’s disease (Gearhart, 1998), Parkinson’s disease (Freed et al, 1999; National Institute of Neurological Disorders and Strokes, 1999; Wager et al. 1999; Gearhart, 1998), diabetes (Voltarelli et al, 2007; Shapiro et al., 2000), heart disease (Lumelsky, 2001; Zulewski, 2001), and limb paralysis (Kay and Henderson, 2001).

One current obstacle for the successful use of embryonic stem cells for disease therapy concerns immunological rejection. If a patient were to receive stem cell therapy in order to treat some affliction, her body may reject the stem cells for the same reason human bodies have a tendency to reject donated organs: the body tends to not recognize, and therefore reject, foreign cells. One way to overcome stem cell rejection is by creating embryos through somatic cell nuclear transfer with the patient’s own DNA. In 2008, a California research team succeeded in creating embryos via SCNT and growing them to the blastocyst stage (French et al., 2008). In SCNT, an ovum is emptied of its own nucleus, its DNA, and the chromosomal DNA from another person (in the case, a patient’s) is inserted. The ovum is then artificially induced to begin dividing as if it had been naturally fertilized (usually via the use of an electrical current). Once the embryo is approximately five days old, the stem cells are removed, cultured, differentiated to the desired type of body cell, and inserted back into the patient (the genetic donor in this case). Since the embryo was a genetic duplicate of the patient, there would be no immunological rejection. One use of this technology, for example, is to help treat individuals in the aftermath of a heart attack. Using SCNT to create a genetically identical blastocyst, new healthy cells could be derived and inserted back into the genetic donor’s heart in order to replace the damaged cardiac cells (Strauer, 2009).

It may also be possible to use therapeutic cloning to repair defective genes by homologous recombination (Doetschman et al., 1987). Cellular models of diseases can be developed as well, along with the ability to test drug efficacy: “cloning a single skin cell from a patient with a disease could be used to produce inexhaustible amounts of cells and tissue with that disease. The tissue could be experimented upon to understand why disease occurs. It could be used to understand the genetic contribution to disease and to test vast arrays of new drugs which could not be tested in human people” (Savulescu, 2007, 1-2). Pluripotent stem cells can also be used to test drug toxicity which could also diminish the chances of drug-related birth defects (Boiani and Schöler, 2002, 124).

Therapeutic cloning is controversial because isolating the stem cells from the embryo destroys it. Many individuals regard the human embryo as a person with moral rights, and so they consider its destruction to be morally impermissible. Moreover, because the embryos are created with the explicit intention to destroy them, there are concerns that this treats the embryos in a purely instrumental manner (Annas et al.,, 1996). Although some ethicists are in favor of using surplus embryos from fertility treatments for research (since the embryos were slated for destruction in any case), they are simultaneously against creating embryos solely for research due to the concern that doing so treats the embryos purely as means (Outka, 2002; Peters, 2001). Indeed, it is precisely because of these ethical issues that some individuals object to the positive connotations of the term “therapeutic” and refer to this work, instead, as “research cloning.” The term “therapeutic cloning” is, however, more widely used.

c. Reproductive Cloning

SCNT can also be used for reproductive purposes. Unlike therapeutic cloning, the cloned embryo is transferred into a uterus of a female of the same species and would be, upon successful implantation, allowed to gestate as a naturally fertilized egg would. The cloned embryo would possess identical chromosomal DNA as its genetic predecessor, but, because of the use of a different ovum, its mitochondrial DNA (the genetic material inhabiting the cytoplasm of the enucleated ovum) would differ, and, consequently, it would not be 100% genetically identical (unlike monozygotic multiples who, because they are derived from the same ovum, share identical chromosomal and mitochondrial DNA). In addition to its slight genetic difference, the cloned embryo would likely be gestated in a different uterine environment, which can also have an effect in ways that may serve to distinguish it from its genetic predecessor. For example, a cloned entity’s phenotype (its appearance) may look very different than that of its genetic predecessor because the embryo can undergo epigenetic reprogramming, where nongenetic (i.e., environmental) causes influence genes to manifest themselves differently. The result is that the genes behave in ways that may lead to a difference in appearance.

In addition to somatic cell nuclear transfer, there is another, less controversial and less technologically complex, manner of reproductive cloning: artificial embryo twinning. Here, an embryo is created in a Petri dish via In Vitro Fertilization (IVF). The embryo is then induced to divide into genetic copies of itself, thereby artificially mimicking what happens when monozygotic multiples are formed (Illmensee et al., 2009). The embryos are then transferred into a womb and, upon successful implantation and gestation, are born as identical multiples. If implantation is unsuccessful, the process is repeated.

One argument in favor of artificial embryo twinning is that it provides an infertile couple, who may not have been able to produce many viable embryos through IVF, with more embryos that they can then implant for an increased chance at successful reproduction (Robertson, 1994). Because some of the embryos may be saved and implanted later, it is possible to create identical multiples who are not born at the same time. One advantage to doing this is that the later born twin could serve as a blood or bone marrow donor for her older sibling should the need arise; because they are genetically identical, the match would be guaranteed (the converse could also hold, that is, the older individual could serve as a donor for the clone should the latter ever need it. The existence of a cloned person, therefore, could be mutually beneficial, rather than asymmetrical). However, some concerns have been raised. For example, it has been argued that artificially dividing the embryo constitutes an immoral manipulation of it and that, as much as possible, a unique embryo should be allowed to develop without interference (McCormick, 1994). Concerns over individuality have also been raised; whereas naturally occurring twins are valued as individuals, one worry is that embryos created through artificial twinning, precisely because of the synthetic nature of their genesis, may not be as valued (McCormick, 1994).

2. Misconceptions About Cloning and Their Sources

The general public still seems to regard human reproductive cloning as something that can occur only in the realm of science fiction. The portrayal of cloning in movies, television, and even in journalism has spanned from comedic to dangerous. Human clones have often been depicted in movies as nothing but carbon copies of their genetic predecessor with no minds of their own (e.g., Multiplicity and Star Wars: Attack of the Clones), as products of scientific experiments that have gone horribly wrong, resulting in deformed quasi-humans (Alien Resurrection) or murderous children (Godsend), as persons created simply for spare parts for their respective genetic predecessor (The Island), or as deliberate recreations of famous persons from the past who are expected to act just like their respective predecessor (The Boys from Brazil). Even when depicting nonhuman cloning, films (such as Jurassic Park) tend to portray products of cloning as menacing, modern-day Frankensteinian monsters of sorts, which serve to teach humans a lesson about the dangers of “playing God.”

Many other media outlets, although usually shying away from the ominous representation of clones so prevalent in the movies, have usually portrayed clones as, essentially, facsimiles of their genetic predecessor. On the several occasions which Time Magazine has addressed the issue of cloning, the cover illustrates duplicate instances of the same picture. For example, the February 19, 2001 cover shows two mirror image infants staring at each other, the tagline suggesting that cloning may be used by grieving parents who wish to resurrect their dead child. Even a Discovery Channel program, meant to educate its viewers on the nature of cloning, initially portrays a clone as nothing more than a duplicate of the original person. Interestingly enough, however, a few minutes into the program, the narrator, speaking over a picture of two identical cows, says: “But even if a clone person is created, that doesn’t mean it would be an exact copy of the original.” Yet almost immediately afterwards, the same narrator calls a clone “You, version 2.0.”

As philosopher Patrick Hopkins has pointed out, media conceptions about what human cloning entails, and the type of offspring that will arise from cloning, employ the tacit premise that clones are nothing but copies. The predominate belief that fuels this conception is that genetic determinism is true, i.e., that a person’s genes are the sole determining factor of her behavior and physical appearance; essentially, that a person’s identity is solely determined by her genetic constitution. If a person were to believe that genetic determinism is true, then it follows that she believes that a cloned person would be psychologically identical with her genetic predecessor because they are (almost) genetically identical. Hopkins also points out that, like the narrator in the Discovery Channel program, many media outlets “engage in confusing, contradictory bits of double-talk (or double-show). The images and not-very-clever headlines all convey unsettling messages that clones will be exact copies, while inside the stories go to some effort to educate us that clones will not in fact be exact copies” (1998, 129-130).

3. Cloning Mammals: A Brief History

In 1894, Hans Driesch cloned a sea urchin through inducing twinning by shaking an embryonic sea urchin in a beaker full of sea water until the embryo cleaved into two distinct embryos. In 1902, Hans Spemann cloned a salamander embryo through inducing twinning as well, using a hair from his infant son as a noose to divide the embryo. In 1928, Spemann successfully cloned a salamander using nuclear transfer. This involved enucleating a single-celled salamander embryo and inserting it with the nucleus of a differentiated salamander embryonic cell. In 1951, Robert Briggs and Thomas Kling, using Spemann’s methods of embryonic nucleus transfer, successfully cloned frogs. In 1962, John Gurdon announced that he too had successfully cloned frogs but, unlike Briggs and Kling’s method, he did so by transferring differentiated intestinal nuclei from feeding tadpoles (Wilmut et al., 2000). Gurdon’s successful use of differentiated nuclei, rather than the embryonic nuclei used by Briggs and Kling, was particularly surprising to the scientific community. Because embryonic cells are undifferentiated, and therefore extremely malleable, it was not too surprising that transferred embryonic nuclei produced distinct embryos when inserted into an enucleated oocyte. However, inciting differentiated nuclei to behave as undifferentiated nuclei was thought to be impossible, since the conventional wisdom at the time was that once a cell was differentiated (e.g., once it became a cardiac cell, a liver cell, or a blood cell) it could never reverse into an undifferentiated state. It was for this reason that, for a long time, creating a cloned embryo from adult somatic cells was thought to be impossible – it would require taking long-time differentiated cells and getting them to behave like the totipotent cells (cells that are able to differentiate into any cell type, including the ability to form an entirely distinct organism) found in newly fertilized eggs.

In 1995, Dr. Ian Wilmut and Dr. Keith Campbell successfully cloned two mountain sheep, Megan and Morag, from embryonic sheep cells. One year later, in 1996, Wilmut and Campbell successfully cloned the first mammal to be born from an adult somatic cell, specifically an udder cell (a sheep’s mammary gland): Dolly the sheep (Wilmut et al., 1997). In other words, Wilmut and Campbell were able to take a fully differentiated adult cell and revert it back to an undifferentiated, totipotent, state. This was the first time the process had been accomplished for mammalian reproduction. Furthermore, they were able to create a viable pregnancy and produce from it a healthy lamb (however, there were 276 failed attempts before Dolly was created, which, as it will be discussed below, creates concerns over the safety and efficacy of the procedure). Dolly the sheep died in 2003 after having been euthanized due to her suffering from pulmonary adenomatosis, a disease fairly common in sheep that are kept indoors; indeed, many members of Dolly’s flock had succumbed to the same disease. Additionally, she suffered from arthritis. Before she died, she produced six healthy lambs through natural reproduction. Since Dolly, many more mammals have been cloned through the use of SCNT. Some examples are deer, ferrets (Li et al., 2006), mules (Lovgren, 2003), other sheep, goats, cows, mice, pigs, rabbits, a gaur, dogs, and cats. One possible use of reproductive cloning technology is to help save endangered species (Lanza et al., 2000). In 2005, two endangered gray wolves were cloned in Korea (Oh et al., 2008).

The successful cloning of household pets holds special significance in that, when discussing the circumstances that led to their cloning, we can begin to discuss the ethical issues that arise in human reproductive cloning. In 2001, the first feline created via somatic cell nuclear transfer was born. She was named CC, short for “Copy Cat,” and was born at the College of Veterinary Medicine at Texas A&M University. The research that led to her creation was funded by the California based company “Genetic Savings and Clone,” who, between 2004 and 2006, offered grieving pet owners a chance to clone their sick or deceased pets (they closed their doors in 2006 due to the unsustainability of their business). What is most striking about CC is not simply her mere existence, but also that CC does not look nor act like her feline progenitor, Rainbow. Whereas Rainbow, a calico, is stocky and has patches of tan, orange, and white throughout her body, CC barely resembles a calico at all. Not only is she lanky and thin, she has a grey coat over a white body and is lacking the patches of orange or tan typical to calicos. There are personality differences between Rainbow and CC as well; whereas Rainbow is described as a shy, reticent, and a more “hands-off” kind of cat, CC is described as more playful, inquisitive, and affectionate (Hays, 2003).

“Genetic Savings and Clone” was founded by Lou Hawthorne, who was seeking a means to clone his family’s beloved dog Missy. Although Missy died before she was successfully cloned, Hawthorne banked her DNA in the hopes of ultimately succeeding in this endeavor. In 2004, a Texas woman paid $50,000 to clone her deceased Maine Coone Nicky and, as a result, Little Nicky, the world’s first commercially cloned cat, was born. This was followed, in 2005, by the birth of Snuppy, the world’s first cloned dog. In 2007, three clones from Missy’s DNA were created and returned to the Hawthorne family. All this has incited some pet owners to pay large sums of money to clone their beloved deceased pets. Alan and Kristine Wolf paid thousands of dollars to have their deceased cat, Spot, cloned from skin cells they had preserved. According to the Wolfs, preserving Spot’s skin cells, in their mind, was almost equivalent to having Spot himself preserved. In other words, the Wolfs (and the woman who cloned Nicky) were willing to spend an exorbitant amount of money to clone their pets not just in order to receive another pet, but to, rather, receive what was, in their eyes, the same pet that they had lost (Masterson, 2010).

This allows us to begin exploring the ethical issues in the reproductive cloning debate. Some questions that arise are: Why did these individuals regard the recreation of the same DNA to equate to the recreation of the same entity that had died? Will these expectations transfer over to human cloning, where people will regard cloned children as the same individuals as their genetic predecessors, and therefore treat them with this expectation in mind? Will cloning, thus, compromise a child’s identity? Are such concerns grave enough to permanently ban reproductive cloning altogether?

4. Arguments in Favor of Reproductive Cloning and Responses

a. Reproductive Liberty: The Only Way to Have a Genetically Related Child

The Argument.

Procreative liberty is a right well established in Western political culture (Dworkin, 1994). However, not everyone is physically capable of procreating through traditional modes of conception. Cloning may be the only way for an otherwise infertile couple to have a genetically related child. Therefore, providing cloning as an option contributes to a greater scope of procreative liberty (Häyry, 2003; Harris, 2004; Robertson, 1998). For example, a couple may be able to generate only a few embryos from IVF procedures; cloning via artificially induced twinning would increase the number of embryos to a quantity that is more likely to result in a live birth. In another case, the male partner in a relationship may be unable to produce viable sperm and, instead of seeking a sperm donor, the couple can choose to use SCNT in order to produce a genetic copy of the prospective father. Since the prospective mother would use her own ova, they would both contribute genetically to the child (albeit with a different proportion than a couple who conceived using gamete cells). In yet another example, neither parent may have usable gametes, so they employ a donor ovum, clone one of the two parents, and gestate the fetus in the female’s uterus. Or, perhaps one of the prospective parents is predisposed to certain genetic disorders and, in order to completely avoid their offspring inheriting these disorders, they decide to clone the other prospective parent. A single woman may want to have a baby, and would rather clone herself instead of using donated sperm. Also, cloning may give homosexual couples the opportunity to have genetically related children (this is especially true for homosexual women where one partner provides the mitochondrial DNA and the other partner provides the chromosomal DNA). These are a few examples of how cloning may provide a genetically related child to a person otherwise unable to have one. Because cloning may be the only way some people can procreate, to deny cloning to these people would be a violation of procreative liberty (Robertson, 2006).

Response 1: Negative vs. positive right to procreate.

One response is to distinguish between a positive right to procreate and a negative right to procreate (Pearson, 2007), and argue that reproductive liberty can be fully respected in the latter sense, and only conditionally respected in the former sense. This conditional respect may support the permissibility of prohibiting human cloning for reproductive purposes.

A negative right to x means that no one has the prima facie right to interfere in your request to fulfill x. If you possess a negative right to x, this entails only one obligation on the behalf of others: the obligation to not obstruct your obtainment of x. For example, if I have a negative right to life, what this entails is that others have an obligation to not kill me, since this obstructs or hinders my right. Another way to regard it is that a negative right only requires passive obligations (the obligation to not do something or to refrain from acting).

A positive right requires more from obligation-bearers; it requires that active steps be taken in order to provide the right-bearers with the means to fulfill that right. If I have a positive right to life, for instance, it is not just that others have an obligation to not kill me; they have a further obligation to provide me with any services that I would need to ensure my survival. That is, the obligation becomes an active one as well as a passive one: an obligation to not destroy my life and also to provide services that enable me to preserve my life.

Keeping this distinction in mind, it is possible to deny that the right to reproduce is a positive right in the first place. That is, while we ought not to prevent anyone from procreating, we are not required to provide them with any technology whatsoever in order to enable them to procreate if they cannot do so by their own means. Hence, limiting access to certain types of assisted reproductive technologies to an otherwise infertile couple would not necessarily infringe on their (negative) right to procreate (Courtwright and Doron, 2007). Some have argued the opposing side, however, and have maintained that respect for procreative liberty not only entails access to artificial reproductive technology, but also the right to employ gamete donors and surrogate mothers (Ethics Committee of the American Fertility Society, 1985).

Response 2: Procreative liberty is not categorical.

Another possible response is to stress that, even if there is a positive right to procreate, the right is a prima facie, rather than a categorical, one and it is not the case that any step taken to combat infertility is in itself ethical (McCormick, 1993). Therefore, determining what types of services can be offered to infertile couples must be tempered with certain considerations, e.g., the safety of the offspring born as a result of these services must be taken into account. If a particular type of reproductive technology poses a health risk to the resulting children, this is grounds enough to prevent the use of that technology (Cohen, 1996). In other words, even granting that individuals have a positive right to procreate, it does not follow from this alone that they should be provided with any means necessary for successful procreation. They may not be entitled to the use of a certain technological advancement (e.g., SCNT) if that advancement is deemed to pose a danger to the resulting offspring. Robertson concedes this objection, but he responds that “if a ban on cloning is justified, then a ban on many other forms of assisted reproduction and genetic selection should be as well, yet few persons are prepared to go that far” (2006, 206). That is, in order for advocates of this objection to be consistent, they should be equally willing to ban other forms of reproductive technology that may result in harm to potential offspring.

b. Cloning and Savior Siblings

The Argument.

The concept of a “savior sibling,” a child that is deliberately conceived so that she could provide a means (through the donation of bodily fluids, umbilical cord blood, a non-vital organ, or tissue) to save an older sibling from illness or death is not new. What is new is that cloning would ensure that the new child is an appropriate match for the existing ailing person, since they would be genetically identical. Permitting cloning, therefore, would allow for a more expedient means of creating a savior sibling, since the alternatives (using preimplantation genetic diagnosis to screen embryos to determine which are genetically compatible with the sibling, implanting into a womb only the ones that are a match and discarding the others, or creating an embryo through natural reproduction and terminating the pregnancy if it is not a genetic match) are more involved and more time consuming. Of course, the rights of the new child would have to be respected; tissue, organs, or bodily fluids should only be removed given her consent (although this would not apply to umbilical cord blood banking, since the infant lacks the capacity for giving consent) (Robertson, 2006).

Response: Violating Kant’s formula of humanity.

Such a prospect raises concerns that cloning would facilitate viewing the resulting children as objects of manufacture, rather than as individuals with value and dignity of their own. The prospect of creating a child, solely to meet the needs of another child and not for her own sake, reduces the created child to a mere means to achieve the ends of the parents and the sick child. While it is admirable that the parents wish to save their existing child, it is not ethically permissible to create another child solely as an instrument to save the life of her sibling (Quintavalle, 2001).

Another way of explaining it is that creating a child solely for the purposes of providing life-saving aid for another child violates Immanuel Kant’s second principle formulation of the categorical imperative. Kant proscribes treating persons as a mere means, rather than as ends in themselves, maintaining that persons should “act in such a way that [humanity is treated] always at the same time as an end and never simply as a means” (1981, 36). Creating a child for the sole purpose of saving another child violates the formula of humanity because the child is created specifically for this end.

It should be noted, however, that such an objection would apply to any method that is used to create a child for similar reasons, including any other type of reproductive technology or even natural procreation. It is the intention with which a child is created that is in question here, not the method that is used in order to create the child. Another response is that Kant’s dictum is misapplied. A child who is created as a “savior sibling” may still, also, be loved and respected as an individual in her own right, and therefore may not necessarily be treated solely as a means (Boyle and Savulescu, 2001).

c. Cloning In Order to “Replace” a Deceased Child

The Argument.

In his article “Even If It Worked, Cloning Won’t Bring Her Back”, ethicist Thomas Murray recounts a letter he heard read at a congressional hearing regarding human reproductive cloning. A chemist, who was presenting her views in support of reproductive cloning, read a letter by a father grieving the death of his infant son. Murray recounts as follows:

Eleven days ago, as I awaited my turn to testify at a congressional hearing on human reproductive cloning, one of five scientists on the witness list took the microphone. Brigitte Boisselier, a chemist working with couples who want to use cloning techniques to create babies, read aloud a letter from “a father (Dada).” The writer, who had unexpectedly become a parent in his late thirties, describes his despair over his 11-month-old son’s death after heart surgery and 17 days of “misery and struggle.” The room was quiet as Boisselier read the man’s words: “I decided then and there that I would never give up on my child. I would never stop until I could give his DNA – his genetic make-up – a chance” (2001).

Depriving grieving parents of this unique opportunity, the only opportunity “to get back the child that they lost,” would be morally wrong. Cloning would provide such an opportunity to grieving parents.

Response 1: Assuming genetic determinism.

Like many of the arguments against reproductive cloning listed below, this argument in favor of cloning, despite its emotional appeal, erroneously assumes that genetic determinism is true. The grieving father’s letter maintained that he would never “give up on my child”, and that the way he would achieve this is to “give his DNA – his genetic make-up – a chance.” In other words, the father equated his son as an individual person to his genetic make-up; because he could recreate his son’s genes, he could recreate his son as a person. The tacit implication here is that cloning is desirable because it somehow presents a way to cheat death. It is through cloning that his son could be, in some sense, resurrected.

Given that individuals have sought to clone their deceased pets, the idea that grieving parents would seek to clone a deceased child is not far-fetched. Thomas Murray continues his article by disclosing that he too is a grieving father, having suffered the death of his twenty-year-old daughter who was abducted from her college campus and shot. Yet cloning, Murray continues, “can neither change the fact of death nor deflect the pain of grief” (2001). Murray goes on to stress that, due to varying other influences outside of genetic duplication, a clone would not, in fact, be a mere copy of its genetic predecessor. One interesting point is that both detractors of cloning (e.g., Kass and Callahan, whose views are explored below) and supporters of cloning (like the researcher that read this letter at the congressional hearing) find convergence in committing the same fallacy. Both assume that cloning recreates identity, and they differ only as to the desirability of that consequence. Yet, given that we have evidence that the robust form of genetic determinism these arguments assume is false (Resnik and Vorhaus, 2006; Elliot, 1998), both detractors and supporters of cloning who rely on it produce faulty arguments.

Response 2: A child is not replaceable.

Given the evidence that genetic determinism is false, Murray further stresses that using cloning as a method of replacing a dead child “is unfair. No child should have to bear the oppressive expectation that he or she will live out the life denied to his or her idealized genetic avatar…. Cloning a child to be a reincarnation of someone else is a grotesque, fun-house mirror distortion of parental expectations” (2001). Dan Brock further supports the contention that cloning in order to replace a deceased child is misguided (Brock, 1997). Moreover, because parents have cloned this child with the expressed purpose of replacing a deceased child, the expectations that the new child will be just like the deceased one would be overwhelming and impede the child’s ability to develop her own individuality (Levick, 2004). It should be stressed, however, that this response targets a particular use of cloning (one based on faulty assumptions), not the actual cloning procedure.

d. The Resultant Loss of Therapeutic Cloning for Stem Cell Research and Treating Diseases

The Argument.

Although SCNT is used to create embryos for therapeutic cloning, there is no intent to implant them in order to create children. Rather, the intent is to use the cells of the embryo in order to further research that may ultimately lead to treatments or cures for certain afflictions. Therefore, a categorical ban on SCNT affects not just the prospect of reproductive cloning, but also the research that could be done with cloned embryos. At the very least, the argument concludes, SCNT should be allowed for research and therapeutic purposes (Devolder and Savulescu, 2006; American Medical Association, 2003; Maas, 2001). This was the position presented by Senator Arlen Specter in his proposed Senate Bill 2439, called the “Human Cloning Prohibition Act of 2002: A Bill to Prohibit Human [Reproductive] Cloning While Preserving Important Areas of Medical Research, Including Stem Cell Research.”

Response 1: Therapeutic cloning leads to reproductive cloning.

The first response maintains that, because therapeutic cloning and reproductive cloning both implement SCNT, allowing the procedure to be perfected for therapeutic cloning makes it more likely that it will later be used for reproductive purposes (Rifkin, 2002; Kass, 1998)

Response 2: Embryo experimentation is unethical.

The second response applies not just to therapeutic cloning, but to any type of embryo experimentation. From the time that an ovum is fertilized and syngamy (the fusion of two gametes to form a new and distinct genetic code) has successfully taken place, there exists a subject, the embryo, which is a bearer of dignity, moral status, and moral rights. It is unethical to experiment on an embryo for the same reason it is unethical to experiment on any human being and since embryo experimentation often results in the destruction of the embryo, this equates to murdering the embryo (Deckers, 2007; Oduncu, 2003; Novak, 2001). Typically, those who offer the second response (e.g., the Catholic Church) regard the human embryo as a complete moral subject upon conception (Pope John Paul II, 1995; Pope Paul VI, 1968), and therefore any experiment that harms them or destroys them is morally tantamount to any experiment that would destroy a person.

5. Arguments Against Reproductive Cloning and Responses

a. The Right to an Open Future

The Argument.

According to some ethicists who oppose human cloning, a cloned child’s identity and individuality will be compromised given that she will be “saddled with a genotype that has already lived” (Kass, 1998, 56; see also Annas, 1998 and Kitcher, 1997). Because of the expectations that the cloned child will re-live the life of her genetic predecessor, the child would necessarily be deprived of her right to an open future. Because all children deserve to have a life and a future that is completely open to them in terms of its prospects (Feinberg, 1980), and because being the product of cloning would necessarily deprive the resulting child of these prospects, cloning is seriously immoral. In a sense, this objection maintains that a cloned child would either lack the free will to live her life according to her own desire and goals or that, at the very least, her free will would be severely restricted by her parents or the society that has certain expectations of her given her genetic lineage. The child would be destined to live in the shadows of her genetic predecessor (Holm, 1998).

Response 1: Faulting cloning for the misconceptions of others.

This argument is unsuccessful in illustrating that there is something intrinsically morally wrong with cloning. The subject of this objection is not cloning itself, but rather the erroneous attitude that parents will have in regard to their cloned child. The child’s very desire to be different from her predecessor illustrates that she is not destined to be like her predecessor. Once prospective parents, and society in general, come to understand that cloned children will possess just as much individuality as any other person, it is possible that these fears, and the attempts to control the child’s future, will largely abate (Wachbroit, 1997). Additionally, if the reason people treat cloned children unfavorably is due to their misconceptions about cloning, then the proper response is not to ban cloning at the expense of compromising procreative liberty, but rather work to rectify these prejudices and misconceptions (Burley and Harris, 1999).

Moreover, it is not just parents of cloned children that may be guilty of violating the child’s right to an open future; many parents are, to varying degrees of severity, already guilty of violating such a right with their naturally created children, and often times those attempts are subject to failure (see Agar, 2004, 106 for such an example). If such parents are not deprived of their opportunity to have children out of concern that they will violate their child’s right to an open future, then we seem hard pressed to find a reason to deprive couples who would turn to cloning for reproductive purposes of a similar opportunity.

Response 2: Assuming genetic determinism (again).

At its core, however, this objection assumes the very controversial thesis that either a person’s genes play an almost fatalistic role in her life decisions, or that individuals in society will assume some robust version of genetic determinism to be true and will treat cloned children according to that assumption. As abovementioned, there is much evidence to suggest that genetic determinism is not true. In their article “Genetic Modification and Genetic Determinism,” David Resnik and Daniel Vorhaus state that, when it comes to genetic modification, “even if a desired trait is successfully expressed it may not actually restrict options for the child… the open future critique paints with a far broader brush, alleging that the act of modification per se impacts the child’s right to an open future. And it is this claim that we reject…” (2006, 9). The same can be said about cloning (Pence, 1998 and 2008; Wachbroit, 1997). Even if a cloned child did display certain behavioral traits belonging to her genetic predecessor, it is unclear whether the similarity in traits entails that a child’s future would be closed off. Moreover, there is much evidence that, usually, the general public rejects genetic determinism (Hopkins, 1998).

There is evidence, however, that some would regard cloning as a method for resuscitating the dead (the grieving father in Murray’s article attests to this, as well as the individuals who are willing to pay thousands of dollars in order to clone a deceased pet). This supports Kass’ claim that many people may expect a cloned child to be like her genetic predecessor. However, this misconception may quickly be rectified simply by observing the unique personality of the cloned child, especially since her experiences and her nurture, removed by at least a generation, will be substantially different than that of her genetic predecessor (Dawkins, 1998; Pence, 1998).

b. The Right to a Unique Genetic Identity

The Argument.

Because cloning entails recreating an existing person’s genetic code (with the exception of the difference in mitochondrial DNA), some argue that cloning would, necessarily, entail a violation of the cloned child’s right to a distinctive genetic identity (European Parliament, 1998). According to this objection, our DNA is what endows each human being with uniqueness and dignity (Callahan, 1993). Because cloning recreates a pre-existing DNA sequence, the cloned child would be denied that uniqueness and, therefore, her dignity would be compromised. This objection appears to be an incarnation of the objection from the Right to an Open Future. Certainly the concerns are similar: that a cloned child would be deprived of her own individual identity because of her genetic origins. However, whereas in the objection from the Right to an Open Future, the cloned child is deprived of individuality based on the perception of others (and, as is developed above, this does not seem to really be an objection to the practice of cloning simpliciter), this objection indicates that there is something inherently individuality-compromising, and therefore dignity-compromising, in recreating an existing genetic code. If this objection is successful, if recreating a pre-existing genetic code is intrinsically morally objectionable, then it would seem to present an objection to the actual cloning process.

Response 1: Genetic duplication and identical multiples.

Callahan argues that there is something intrinsically identity-depriving, and therefore dignity-depriving, in duplicating a genetic code. However, there is much evidence to counter this claim. As abovementioned, CC the cat neither looks nor acts like Rainbow, her genetic predecessor. However, the strongest evidence against this claim is the existence of identical multiples, who are, in essence, clones of nature (Pence, 2004; Gould, 1997). No one claims that identical multiples’ right to a unique genetic identity was compromised simply in virtue of their creation, which calls into question whether such a right exists in the first place (Silver, 1998; Tooley, 1998; Rhodes, 1995). If Callahan’s concerns were accurate, identical multiples would fail to be individuals in their own right, and, consequently, be harmed because of this. However, there is no evidence that identical multiples feel this way, and there does not seem to be anything inherent about sharing a genetic code that compromises individuality (Elliot, 1998). The fact that identical multiples do not seem harmed or deprived of individuality merely by virtue of not possessing a unique genetic code is evidence that Callahan’s concern against cloning in this regard is misguided.

Response 2: Forgetting nurture.

Lastly, proponents of this objection ignore the very important role that nurture has in shaping a person’s identity. A cloned child would be gestated in a different uterine environment. She would be born into either the same family, but with a different dynamic, as her genetic predecessor, or be born into a different family altogether. She would also likely be raised in a much different society (e.g., a child born in 2010 would have vastly different social influences than a child born in the 1960s or 1970s). She would have different friends, attend different schools, play different games, watch different television shows, listen to different music. The generational and historical differences between a clone and her genetic predecessor would undoubtedly go a long way when it comes to shaping the personality of the former (Pence, 1998; Dawkins, 1998; Harris, 1997; Bor, 1997).

What forms or shapes each person’s individual identity is an intricate interaction of genetics and nurture (Ridley, 2003). While being genetically identical to a pre-existing person will most likely result in some similarities, it will certainly not be strong enough to deprive a cloned child of her individuality or dignity. A cloned child’s future would remain open, and there is no evidence that she is denied something irreplaceably unique by not having a unique genetic code. Moreover, concerns that genetic duplication compromises dignity overemphasize the role that genetics has as the source of human dignity. Human dignity, some philosophers have argued, has its source in virtue of our being persons and autonomous rational beings. Since, presumably, a clone would still be a person and an autonomous rational being, a clone would certainly retain her human dignity (Glannon, 2005; Elliot, 1998).

c. Cloning is Wrong because it is “Playing God” or because it is “Unnatural”

The Argument.

Another common concern is that cloning is morally wrong because it oversteps the boundaries of humans’ role in scientific research and development. These boundaries are set by either God (and therefore cloning is wrong because it is “playing God”) or nature (and therefore cloning is wrong because it is “unnatural”). Any method of procreation that does not implement traditional modes of conception, i.e., not involving the union of sperm and ova, is guilty of one (or both) of these infractions (Goodman, 2008; Tierney, 2007). Moreover, advocates of this objection caution against removing God from the process of creation altogether, which, it is argued, is what reproductive cloning achieves (Rikfin, 2000).

Response 1: Clarifying the meaning of “playing God.”

Advocates of the “playing God” objection have the onus to define exactly what “playing God” means. One possible definition of “playing God” is that anything that interferes with nature, or the natural progression of life, interferes with God’s plan for humanity, and is therefore morally wrong. But this is too vague; humans constantly interfere with nature in ways that are not morally criticized. Almost all instances of medical advancements in the past 100 years (e.g., vaccines against diseases, respirators, incubators for preterm infants, pacemakers, etc.) interfere with nature in the sense that they prevent otherwise harmful or fatal afflictions from taking their toll on a human body. Would the same advocates of this objection against cloning object to artificial insulin injections to treat diabetes? (Glannon, 2005). To be more extreme, almost everything humans engage in, from wearing clothing, to using phones and computers, to indoor plumbing, all, in some sense, interfere with some aspect of nature.

Perhaps the more charitable understanding is that “playing God” is morally wrong when it comes to cloning because it is a process that artificially creates life, outside of the practice of sexual intercourse (Meilaender, 1997). Adhering to this definition of “playing God”, however, would condemn any form of artificial reproductive technology, as well as cloning, e.g., IVF, artificial insemination, or intrauterine insemination. In addition, anything that thwarts the natural process of conception (i.e., birth control) may also be morally condemned. In the “Instruction on Respect for Human Life in Its Origin and on the Dignity of Procreation,” the Catholic Church denounces all forms of reproductive technology on the grounds that reproductive creation is strictly God’s domain (Congregation for the Doctrine of the Faith, 1987). However, most people who denounce human cloning on the grounds that it “plays God” do not denounce other forms of artificial reproduction on similar grounds.

Response 2: Knowing God’s will.

Yet another response is that this objection purports to know what God’s will is in regards to technological advancements such as cloning. However, since key religious texts (e.g., The Bible, The Torah, or the Qu’ran) make no mention of such advancements, it is presumably impossible to determine what God would have to say about them. In other words, inferences about God’s will on such matters are tenuous because we have little basis from which to draw these purported moral inferences (Pence, 2008).

Response 3: Biologism Fallacy.

One response to the “unnatural” objection is similar to the first response to the “playing God” objection; most everything humans do, from medicine to modern forms of sanitation, are “unnatural”, and most are not considered morally objectionable as a consequence. A second response is that such an objection commits what philosopher Daniel Maguire calls the “Biologism Fallacy”: “the fallacious effort to wring a moral mandate out of raw biological facts” (1983, 148). In other words, “unnatural” is not synonymous with “immoral” (and conversely, “natural” is not synonymous with “moral”). While it is true that cloning (along with other types of reproductive technologies) is not the “natural” way of conceiving a child, this alone does not render cloning immoral.

d. The Dangers of Cloning

The Argument.

Many philosophers and ethicists who would otherwise support reproductive cloning concede that concern for the safety of children born via cloning is reason to caution against its use (Harris, 2004; Glannon, 2005). The claim is that a cloned child would be in danger of suffering from severe genetic defects as a result of being a clone, or that cloning would result in a high number of severely defective embryos before one healthy human embryo is developed. Ian Wilmut, Dolly’s creator, has denounced human reproductive cloning as too dangerous to attempt (Travis, 2001). According to Wilmut, “Dolly was derived from 277 embryos, so the other 276 didn’t make it. The previous year’s work, which led to the birth and survival of Megan and Morag, used more than 200 embryos. We have success rates of roughly one in a hundred or less” (Klotzko, 1998, 134). Even if a clone were to appear healthy at birth, there are concerns about health problems arising later in life. For example, while there is no evidence that Dolly’s respiratory issues were due to her being a clone, questions remain whether her arthritis, which is uncommon among sheep her age, could have resulted because of the nature of her genesis (Williams, 2003). Even attempting to perfect human reproductive cloning would entail a trial and error approach that would lead to the destruction of many embryos, and may produce severely disabled children before a healthy one is born.

Response 1: The nonidentity problem.

One response typically given by philosophers when concerning the ethics of preconception decisions that may lead to the birth of a disabled child involves an appeal to Derek Parfit’s nonidentity problem (Parfit, 1984, though Parfit himself does not apply this to cloning). Applied to preconception choices, Parfit’s argument can be applied as follows. Suppose I desire to get pregnant, but am currently suffering from a physical ailment that would result in conceiving and birthing an infant with developmental impairments. Yet, if I were to wait two months, my ailment would pass and I would conceive a perfectly healthy baby. Most people would agree that I should wait those two months; and, indeed, if I do not wait, many people would say that I acted wrongly. The resulting child, moreover, would most likely be identified as the victim of my actions. This intuitive response, however, is surprisingly tricky to defend. If harm is defined as making someone worse off than she otherwise would have been, it is difficult to maintain that I harmed the resulting child by my actions, even if she were impaired. For the child that would have been born two months later would not have been the same child that is born if I do not wait; the impaired child would never have existed had I waited those two months. Unless the child’s life is so bad that her nonexistence would be preferable, I did not make the child worse off by conceiving her and giving birth to her with those impairments, and thus I did not harm her. Because I did not harm her, I did not do anything morally wrong in this circumstance. The argument can best be standardized as follows:

1. I have only harmed an individual if I had made her worse off than she otherwise would have been had it not been for my actions.

2. Only if I have harmed someone can my action be deemed morally wrong.

3. A child born with mental, physical, or developmental impairments usually does not have a life that is so bad that it renders nonexistence preferable.

4. Therefore, a child born with mental, physical or developmental impairments is not made worse off by being brought into existence.

5. Therefore, deliberate conception, gestation, and birthing of a child with mental, physical, or developmental impairments does not, usually, harm the child (unless the impairments are so bad that they make the child’s life worse than not having existed at all).

6. Therefore, I have (usually) done nothing morally wrong by deliberately bringing into existence a child who suffers from mental, physical, or developmental impairments.

Using the nonidentity problem in the context of the reproductive cloning debate yields the following result: The alternative to being born a clone is not to be born at all. Unless the cloned child’s life is made so horrible by her disabilities that it would have been better that she not been born at all, she was not harmed by being brought into existence via cloning, even if she is born with genetic defects as a result. As long as the cloned child has a life that, despite her genetic defect, is still worth living, then it would still be permissible to use cloning to bring her into being (Lane, 2006).

It is important to note, however, that the nonidentity problem is controversial, and that not all philosophers and ethicists agree with its conclusion (Weinberg, 2008; Cohen, 1996). Indeed, many argue that it would be morally impermissible to bring a child into the world who suffers, even if the child’s life has a net value that renders it worth living (Steinbock and McClamrock, 1994).

Response 2: The dangers of natural reproduction.

Natural reproduction can itself produce dangerous results. Women dispose of fertilized eggs during their menstrual cycle more often than they are aware; one study claims that as many as 73% of fertilized eggs do not survive to 6 weeks gestation (Boklage, 1990). From the ones that do implant, approximately 2% to 3% of newborn infants suffer from congenital abnormities of varying degrees of severity (Kumar et al., 2004). If safety concerns about cloning are severe enough to ban its practice, this can only be justified if cloning were more risky (that is, resulted in the birth of more children with more severe abnormalities) than natural reproduction. Some couples choose to reproduce in full knowledge that one or both of them harbor genetic disorders that may be passed along to their offspring, and some of these are rather severe, such as Huntington’s disease. Yet these parents are not prohibited from procreating because of this. Therefore, if parents are not prohibited from procreating on the grounds that they may pass along a severe genetic defect to their children, then it is difficult to deny a set of parents who can only rely on cloning for procreation the chance to do so based on safety reasons alone (unless the abnormalities that may result from cloning are more severe than the abnormalities that may result from natural conception) (Brock, 1997). Similarly, objecting to cloning on the grounds that embryos are sacrificed in order to achieve a live birth is only a valid objection if the number of embryos lost are greater in cloning than in natural reproduction.

Finally, even if safety concerns are sufficient to warrant a current ban on human reproductive cloning, such concerns would be temporary, and would abate as cloning becomes safer. Indeed, safety concerns led the National Bioethics Advisory Commission (1997) to recommend a temporary, rather than permanent, moratorium on human reproductive cloning.

e. Cloning Entails the Creation of Designer Children, or it Turns Children into Commodities

The Argument.

If we engage in cloning, this objection goes, we run the risk of inserting our will too much into our procreative decisions; we would get to choose not just to have a child, but what kind of child to have. In doing so, we run the risk of relegating children to the status of mere possessions or commodities, rather than regarding them as beings with their own intrinsic worth (Harakas, 1998; Kass, 1998; Meilaender, 1997). When a couple engages in sexual intercourse and produces a baby, the child is an “offspring of a man and woman, but a replication of neither; their offspring but not their product whose meaning and destiny they might determine” (Meilaender, 1997, 42). Because cloning involves the artificial process of recreating a pre-existing genetic code, prospective parents could, first, choose their child’s DNA (thereby creating a “designer child”), and, second, because they are creating a “replica” of an existing person, they will consider the child more akin to property than an individual in her own right. These factors will contribute to viewing and treating the child as a mere commodity. The more “artificial” conception becomes, the more the resulting children will be seen as the possessions of the parents, rather than as persons in their own right. Rev. Stanley Harakas puts this point as follows: “Cloning would deliberately deny by design the cloned human being a set of loving and caring parents. The cloned human being would not be the product of love, but of scientific procedures. Rather than being considered persons, the likelihood is that these cloned human beings would be considered ‘objects’ to be used” (1998, 89).

Although he rejects the contention that clones would not be considered persons, Thomas Shannon expresses concerns that the increasing artificiality of conception, not just via the use of cloning, but via the use of all forms of artificial reproductive technologies, will “transform our thinking about ourselves, and the transformation will be in a mechanistic direction” (Shannon and Walter, 2003, 134). That is, the move away from natural conception towards artificial conception will lead to humans collectively regarding themselves as more machine-like rather than as organic beings.

Response 1: Cloning is not genetic modification.

Cloning does not necessarily entail the creation of “designer” children because cloning recreates a pre-existing DNA; it does not involve modifying or enhancing DNA in order to produce a child with certain desired traits. Cloning is not to be equated with genetic modification or enhancement (Wachbroit, 1997; Strong, 1998).

Response 2: Natural vs. artificial conception.

Advocates of the objection that cloning results in the transformation of procreation into manufacture seem to assume that, whereas we do not consider children that arise from natural reproduction as ours to do what we wish with, we would if they arise from artificial conception. That is, the tacit premise is that there is some trait inherent in artificial (i.e., non-sexual) conception that necessitates parents regarding their children as mere objects, and this trait is not found in “natural” conception. Yet, we can look towards the children who are products of modern day artificial reproduction in order to see that such a concern is not supported by the evidence. There are many children who are products of artificial reproductive technologies (IVF, intrauterine insemination, gender selection, and gamete intrafallopian transfer, among others) and there does not seem to be an increase of despotic control over these children on behalf of their parents. One study found that children born from IVF and DI (donor insemination) are faring as well as children born via natural conception. More importantly, given Meilaender’s concern that the quality of parenting is compromised in tandem with the artificiality of conception, the study found that “the quality of parenting in families with a child conceived by assisted conception is superior to that shown by families with a naturally conceived child, even when gamete donation is used in the child’s conception” (Golombok et al., 1995, 295; also see Golombok, 2003 and Golombok et al., 2001).

Meilaender may respond that, in these cases, the children are still a product of a unification of sperm and ovum, whereas this is not the case with cloning. However, it is unclear why generating a child via somatic cells is more likely to foster despotism than when the child is generated using germ cells. Some have argued that, on the contrary, a cloned child would feel even closer to the parent from whom she was cloned, given that they would share all their genetic information, rather than just half (Pence, 2008). Moreover, the findings of the study supported the thesis that “genetic ties are less important for family functioning than a strong desire for parenthood” (Golombok et al., 1995, 296), which suggests that the parents of cloned children would not be as caught up with the genetic origins of their offspring, and so their parenting would not be as affected by it, as Meilaender contends. According to the study, the quality of parenting increased in tandem with the amount of effort it took to achieve parenthood. It could be argued, therefore, that the quality of parenting for cloned children would be just as good, if not superior, to that of naturally conceived children.

Response 3: Clones would not be loveless creations.

Harakas claims that cloned children will be deprived of loving parents because their genesis will be one of science, rather than love. The studies conducted by Golombok certainly seem to provide evidence to the contrary. Intentionally taking steps to create a child via cloning (or any other kind of reproductive technology) could be seen, instead, as a mutual affirmation of love on behalf of the prospective parents and clear evidence that they really desired the resulting child. Whereas in sexual reproduction the child may be a product of chance, a cloned child would be a product of deliberate choice, which, according to some philosophers, could be a superior method of creation in some respects (Buchanan et al. 2000). Creating a child via cloning does not entail that there is a lack of mutual love between the parents, or that the resulting child would be any less loved (Strong, 1998). Genesis via sexual reproduction is neither a necessary nor a sufficient condition for being born to a set of loving parents and in a nurturing environment.

f. Cloning and the Ambiguity of Familial Roles

The Argument.

Genetically speaking, a cloned child would be her genetic predecessor’s identical twin sibling. If the child is cloned with the intent to serve as the social child of her genetic predecessor, she would be, genetically, her social mother’s twin sister (or his social father’s twin brother), and her social grandparents’ genetic daughter. The concern is that such a radical alteration of familial relationships would be detrimental to the cloned child (Kass, 1998; O’Neil, 2002). As Paul Ramsey puts it: “To mix the parental and the twin relation might well be psychologically disastrous for the young” (Ramsey, 1970). Wide-spread cloning would exacerbate the problem by distorting generational boundaries, which would add a layer of confusion to society’s conception of the nature of the family, and the roles of its individual members (Kass, 1998).

Response 1: No such confusion is likely to arise.

There are two responses to this response. First, doubts can be cast as to whether this confusion would really ensue. Second, even if such confusion did result, it is questionable whether it would be any more detrimental to the child than any confusion that currently exists about parental roles given certain reproductive technologies. For example, it is physically possible for a child to have as many as six distinct “parents”: three genetic parents (the mitochondrial DNA donor, the somatic cell donor used to re-nucleate an enucleated ovum, and the sperm donor), one gestational parent, and two (perhaps even more) social parents. If a cloned child would not experience any less confusion than a child in such a situation, then we would be hard pressed to show why the prospective parents of the former ought to be denied the opportunity to have a genetically related child based on these grounds alone (Harris, 2004). Moreover, doubts can be cast as to whether the ambiguity of genetic lineage caused by the cloning relationship will really result in the consequences Kass and O’Neil are fretting. A social father, for example, is not likely to suddenly rescind his responsibilities toward his daughter because the child is, genetically, his wife’s twin sister (Wachbroit, 1997). Finally, as is evident from children raised by adoptive parents, social parents usually retain the honorific role as the child’s “real” parents, even though there are no genetic ties between them and the adopted child. In other words, what defines a parent seems to have less to do with genetics and more to do with who performs the social role of mother and father (Purdy, 2005).

Response 2: Such confusion would not warrant a prohibition on cloning.

Even if there were such confusion, however, would it be so detrimental as to warrant banning reproductive cloning altogether? Moreover, even if there were a detriment, it is unclear whether that would be a result of society’s prejudice and fear of human cloning, or a result that inherently comes with being a clone. Finally, it would have to be clear that being the genetic twin to a social parent is so detrimental that it would warrant interfering with the prospective parents’ reproductive liberty. Indeed, for any purported harm that may come from cloning (whether physical, psychological, or emotional), it must be argued why those harms are sufficient for banning reproductive cloning if comparable harm would not be sufficient for banning any other kind of reproductive method, whether natural or artificial (Harris, 2004; Robertson, 2006).

6. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Bertha Alvarez Manninen
Email: bertha.manninen@asu.edu
Arizona State University at the West Campus
U. S. A.

Sigmund Freud (1856—1939)

Table of Contents

1. Life

2. Backdrop to His Thought

3. The Theory of the Unconscious

4. Infantile Sexuality

5. Neuroses and the Structure of the Mind

6. Psychoanalysis as a Therapy

7. Critical Evaluation of Freud

a. The Claim to Scientific Status

b. The Coherence of the Theory

c. Freud’s Discovery

d. The Efficacy of Psychoanalytic Therapy

8. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Freud

b. Works on Freud and Freudian Psychoanalysis

Author Information

Elizabeth Cady Stanton (1815—1902)

Table of Contents

1. Early Life and Education

2. Marriage and Family in an Activist World

3. Women’s Rights Activism

4. Writings and Influence

a. The Woman’s Bible

5. Conclusion

6. References and Further Reading

a. Works by Elizabeth Cady Stanton

b. Biographical and Historical Works Relating to Elizabeth Cady Stanton

c. Papers and Articles Relating to Daniel Cady

Author Information

Relational Models Theory

Table of Contents

1. The Theory

a. The Elementary Models

b. Resemblance to Classic Measurement Scales

c. Self-Organization and Natural Selection

d. Compound Models

e. Mods and Preos

2. Philosophical Implications

a. Moral Psychology

b. Computational Conceptions of Cognition

c. Platonism

3. References

a. Specifically Addressing Relational Models Theory

b. Related Issues

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Global Ethics: Capabilities Approach

Table of Contents

1. Background of Global Ethics

2. The Capabilities Approach

a. Sen

b. Nussbaum

3. Nussbaum’s List of Central Capabilities

4. The Relationship between the Capabilities Approach and Other Ethical Theories

a. Virtue Ethics

b. Communitarianism

c. Deontology

d. Rawls’ The Law of Peoples

e. Human Rights

f. Consequentialism

g. Boylan’s Table of Embeddedness

5. Philosophical Criticisms of the Capabilities Approach

a. Illiberal and Neo-Colonialist

b. What Is a Capability?

6. Philosophical Applications

a. The Environment

b. Disability Ethics

7. United Nations Development Program

8. References and Further Reading

Author Information

Autonomy: Normative

Table of Contents

1. History of the Concept of Autonomy

2. Conceptions of Autonomy

a. Moral Autonomy

b. Existentialist Autonomy

c. Personal Autonomy

d. Autonomy as a Right

3. The Normative Roles of Autonomy

a. Autonomy in Ethical Theory