Maimonides (1138—1204)

MaimonidesMaimonides is a medieval Jewish philosopher with considerable influence on Jewish thought, and on philosophy in general. Maimonides also was an important codifier of Jewish law. His views and writings hold a prominent place in Jewish intellectual history.

His works swiftly caused considerable controversy, especially concerning the relations between reason and revelation. Indeed, scholarly debates continue on Maimonides’ commitments to philosophy and to Judaism as a revealed religion. However, there is no question that his philosophical works have had a profound impact extending beyond Jewish philosophy. For instance, Aquinas and Leibniz are among the non-Jewish philosophers influenced by Maimonides.

This discussion of his philosophy focuses on some key features and themes rather than aiming to be a comprehensive survey. In particular, attention is drawn to ways in which Maimonides’ philosophical and religious thought were intertwined, focusing on the role of reason and intellectual perfection. In addition, the article highlights some of the significant ways he departs from Aristotle, while also borrowing from him. Maimonides was influenced by Aristotelian and Neoplatonic thought, and both of them have a significant presence, modified by his own original contributions.

Table of Contents

  1. Some Context and Biography
  2. Judaism and Philosophy
  3. The Relation to Aristotle’s Philosophy
  4. Some Fundamental Metaphysical and Epistemological Issues
  5. Maimonides on the Limits of Knowledge
  6. Philosophical Anthropology, Prophecy, and Perfection
  7. Maimonides on Ethical and Intellectual Virtue
  8. Some Key Elements of Moral Epistemology and Moral Psychology
  9. Freedom of the Will, Repentance, and Covenant
  10. The Issue of Esotericism
  11. Conclusion
  12. References and Further Reading

1. Some Context and Biography

After the destruction of the Second Temple by the Romans in 70 C.E., the Talmud became vitally important to Jewish life, both ritually and intellectually. The continuity and coherence of Jewish national life, their life as a people, was largely grounded in the fact that Jewish law bound them together despite diaspora and lack of political self-rule. Talmud was studied intensively, its contents being elaborated and developed to meet the varied conditions of economic, social, and political life. Talmud constitutes the most central collection of interpretation, explication, and commentary on the commandments in Torah, traditionally held to be six hundred and thirteen in number. Knowledge of Talmud, study of it, commentary upon it, and following its guidance bound Jews together as a people in covenant with God.

In addition to being an expert on scripture and Talmud, Maimonides was an important judge and legal official in the Jewish community in Egypt.  He was a physician in the Muslim court in Egypt and had extensive correspondence with Jews far and wide, writing detailed responses to questions of Jewish law and scriptural interpretation. Those of his works that are categorized as ‘philosophy’ reflect interests he had in addition to his religious commitments.

The prospects of medieval Jewish communities often depended upon the disposition of the Christian or Islamic rulers of the areas in which Jews lived. As is the case for several other important medieval Jewish philosophers, the larger intellectual culture in which Maimonides lived and worked was Islamic rather than Christian.

Maimonides (Moses ben Maimon)was born in Cordoba, Spain, and within a few years his family felt the need to flee persecution. They led a wandering life for several years and then settled in North Africa. They had fled the Iberian Peninsula after an especially intolerant Islamic dynasty came to power. Maimonides visited the Holy Land briefly and was distressed at the condition of Jews living there. He then spent much of his adult life in Fostat, the Old City of Cairo, near modern-day Cairo.

Maimonides and others in his family depended to a large extent on his younger brother, a successful merchant. His brother was lost at sea during a journey across the Indian Ocean, and Maimonides wrote that the loss of his brother pained him profoundly, leading him into depression. No longer having the support of his brother’s commercial successes, Maimonides made his living as a physician. In the latter part of his life he was physician to a Grand Vizier who was ruling Egypt for the Sultan Saladin. Though he wrote enormously important works on Jewish law he did not believe that one should be paid for being a teacher of Torah and Talmud.

He also wrote works on medicine and diseases, on various sciences, and other subjects. He conducted extensive correspondence with Jewish communities far and wide on diverse matters, from details of religious observance to how to respond when confronted with a choice between death and conversion. (See, for example, his Epistle to Yemen in Halkin and Hartman.) His codification of Jewish law, Mishneh Torah, remains a much studied and important work in the lives of Orthodox Jewish communities to this day. He led an almost breathlessly busy life as physician, judge, codifier of Jewish law, philosopher, scientist, and teacher. The rigors of his responsibilities are described in a letter to Samuel ben Judah ibn Tibbon, the man who translated Guide of the Perplexed from its original Arabic into Hebrew. Maimonides became quite widely known and respected by Jews and Muslims alike. He died in 1204 and his death was felt as a considerable loss.

Maimonides remains an important philosopher and key figure in Jewish religious tradition, offering extensive guidance on matters of Jewish law and Jewish life. Though there is a longstanding debate within Judaism over whether the central role ascribed to reason by Maimonides is in tension with Judaism as a revelation-based religious tradition it is difficult to imagine Judaism without his influence. Also, as noted above, he was an important influence on non-Jewish philosophers, such as Aquinas, Leibniz, and also on Spinoza, who had his own controversial place in Jewish thought.

Maimonides had encyclopedic knowledge of Jewish law and one of his main projects was to try to organize the massive, complex body of interpretation, argument, and elaboration in a systematic, orderly manner. By doing this, he intended to obviate the need for further codification and interpretation. He sought to provide a normatively authoritative presentation of Jewish law. His aim was to articulate what he took to be the correct interpretation of the law without also including the argumentation that yielded his interpretation. The aim was to make the law accessible, to make it easier to find and follow what the law required. The work that resulted, the Mishneh Torah, was a formidable achievement. While it did not bring interpretation and codification of Jewish law to closure, it has remained throughout the centuries a vitally important guide to Jewish law for large numbers of Orthodox Jews. In that respect, it has more than just historical importance.

Maimonides’ most famous philosophical work, Guide of the Perplexed, was written to a former student as a series of letters. The student, a young man named Joseph, had written to ask how to reconcile his commitment to Judaism and Jewish tradition on the one hand with his commitment to reason and demonstrative science on the other. Joseph was himself a very capable and learned individual, and the Guide is the subtle, complex, layered series of letters written by Maimonides in reply.

2. Judaism and Philosophy

 

During the period when Maimonides lived, a small number of Islamic thinkers were attached to sultanates in something like a position of ‘court philosopher,’ to build libraries, increase knowledge, and preserve the ancient inheritance. In the Christian world there were cathedral schools and, by the twelfth and thirteenth centuries, a number of universities. In contrast, Jews were scattered and the Temple in Jerusalem, formerly the locus of priestly ritual, had been destroyed centuries earlier. Following that destruction and the huge wave of killing by the Romans, Judaism survived in large measure through the development of the rabbinic tradition, to which Talmud was crucial. This is relevant to Maimonides as a philosopher because so much of his work was the project of articulating what he took to be the philosophical wisdom in Scripture and Jewish law. There is a powerful rationalistic disposition in Maimonides’ thought, and this included the way he understood religious texts.

In the tenth century Saadia Gaon set much of the agenda of medieval Jewish philosophy in The Book of Beliefs and Opinions. A ‘gaon’ is a head of one of the great Talmudic academies; Saadia was head of the academy in Sura, in present-day Iraq. Saadia’s thought was not clearly Neoplatonic, nor was it clearly Aristotelian. Nonetheless, he was a sophisticated thinker, and one of the main themes of his great work is that Judaism is vindicated by reason. The Book of Beliefs and Opinions opens with an extensive discussion of epistemological issues in which Saadia was anxious to show how Judaism is a religion of reason. He argued that, while revelation is real, much of the substance of what is revealed can be understood in rational terms and is not ultimately a matter of mystery. Saadia was influenced by kalam, (Islamic dialectical theology, and Maimonides criticized him for it. Maimonides regarded kalam as less rationally rigorous than philosophy. Nevertheless, Saadia’s work is important as background and intellectual context. Maimonides saw himself as improving upon the theses Saadia defended and the arguments Saadia developed. In addition, the intellectual context included some important Neoplatonic Jewish thinkers, such as Isaac Israeli and Solomon ibn Gabirol, and some sharp critics of rationalism, such as Judah Halevi.

For a thinker like Maimonides it is very difficult, and in some ways artificial, to separate his philosophical thought from his religious thought. An unhelpful way of looking at this is to believe his religious commitments unduly bias his philosophy or make his philosophical conclusions only valuable to those who share his religious beliefs. It is better to recognize that the sorts of intellectual motivations and presuppositions that influence a thinker’s philosophy can illuminate its claims and commitments. Moreover, many medieval philosophers were very rigorous thinkers, bold in argumentation and in critiquing predecessors, and they departed from predecessors in important ways. Many exhibited a high level of analytical acuity. That is certainly true of Maimonides.

Maimonides did not write purely philosophical works. His works that are regarded as philosophical address issues motivated by religious ideas and concerns. However, Maimonides held that reason and revelation concern one body of truth; each is a mode of access to truth, and he thought there was significant philosophical wisdom in revelation. This is a theme that will run through the rest of this discussion.

Maimonides’ negative theology, his intellectualist conception of human virtue, and his conception of the epistemological role of tradition—to pick just a few examples—are philosophically significant despite the very numerous differences between his time and ours.

As noted above, Maimonides’s great philosophical work, Guide of the Perplexed, was written to a young man who was both a committed Jew and strongly interested in philosophy and the authority of rational understanding. He wrote to Maimonides for guidance on how to reconcile, or not, those two commitments. It is a very challenging work. Maimonides himself notes that it contains obscurities and contradictions, in large part on account of the need to reach different audiences with different levels of philosophical understanding. There is a scholarly debate about whether Maimonides was ultimately ‘loyal’ to philosophy or to Judaism.The debate concerns the degree to which Maimonides’ thought involves an esoteric message threatening to religious orthodoxy but likely not to be grasped by non-philosophers.

The present discussion does not examine that debate directly. Instead, it focuses on what appear to be the chief philosophical conceptions shaping his thought. To be sure, even if the debate about esotericism is not taken up explicitly, the views presented are relevant at least by implication; complete neutrality on the issue is not possible. Still, the main aim here is to survey the content and character of key elements of Maimonides’ philosophy without also examining and evaluating recent scholarly debates about it.

3. The Relation to Aristotle’s Philosophy

 

There are many respects in which Maimonides’ philosophy borrows from Aristotle. Maimonides noted that he esteemed Aristotle’s philosophical achievement as the pinnacle of unaided reason. In addition, Islamic philosophers, much of whose thought owed a great deal to Aristotle, influenced Maimonides (see Ibn Rush (Averroes), Avicenna (Ibn Sin)). Their Aristotelianism often involved elements of Platonism, interwoven in often complex ways. Still, it is clear that from metaphysics to logic to philosophical anthropology to ethics, Maimonides used many of Aristotle’s concepts and philosophical categories. However, he often used them in un-Aristotelian ways, ways shaped by Maimonides’ guiding concerns, which were not always shared by Aristotle. For instance, freedom of the will was vitally important to Maimonides because of its significance in regard to following, or not following, the commandments. Maimonides’ conception of the virtues differed from Aristotle’s in many respects on account of Maimonides’ concern with holiness.

Maimonides’ views on creation, revelation, and redemption depart from Aristotle’s views, even though they are joined to Aristotelian conceptions and insights. Tracing out the implications of creation, revelation, and redemption is a way of understanding many of the differences between Maimonides and the ancient inheritance. To a large extent, that inheritance had been modified by commentators on the ancients and by successors to the ancients. As such, the Aristotelianism Maimonides encountered had already been modified to some degree by Arabic commentators. Some of the commentators, Al-Farabi for example, made little distinction between Plato and Aristotle. Much of the philosophy in the few centuries before Maimonides was what we might call ‘Neoplatonic Aristotelianism.’ In Maimonides’ works there are quite evident Platonic, as well as Aristotelian, influences.

Maimonides argued that Torah contained philosophical wisdom and that the most complete understanding of Torah is philosophical understanding.Thus, creation, revelation, and redemption are at the very core of Maimonides’ understanding of all of reality. In The Guide of the Perplexed Maimonides argues that the eternity of the world is not demonstrable. He undertook a detailed analysis of the reasoning in favor of the world’s eternity and concluded that it could be neither proved nor disproved. In that situation, we are to rely on what is made known to us by revelation but not by a simple, dogmatic assertion of faith. Rather, close study of Torah on the basis of epistemically and explanatorily sound principles leads us to belief in a First Cause as creator, which providentially governs the world with concern for the beings created in its image, that is, rational beings. Thus, the relationship between human beings and the First Cause is understood in a significantly different way than in Aristotle’s philosophy.

One of the chief differences is that the world is the result of a free act of creation, rather than a necessary emanation, as in many Neoplatonic conceptions, involving no volitional element. Emanation appears to have a role in Maimonides’ conception of the world order, though he emphasizes the significance of creation ex nihilo by God as bringing the world order into existence. That there is a world is not to be explained by it processing by necessity, from the First Cause. Thus, the very existence of things is seen as reflecting God’s graciousness rather than metaphysical necessitation. The relations between the several intellects ordering the different spheres that constitute the world are sometimes described by Maimonides as being related by a process of overflow, each emanating from the one immediately superior to it. The relations between causality, agency, emanation, and overflow are complex and perplexing. It is very difficult to sort them out definitively in Maimonides’ thought. Nonetheless, he does appear to have held that God is First Cause, God freely created the world, and God sustains the world in existence.

Aristotle understood the existence of the world as necessary, given the essence of the First Cause. According to him, God does not make the world and does not will a created order into existence. The causality of the First Cause is not exercised by, for instance, creating the world ex nihilo or even creating it out of a formless pre-existing material substratum. Aristotle, in contrast to some Neoplatonic Aristotelians, did not regard the world as emanating from the First Cause. He also did not regard the world as existing contingently, based on volition of the First Cause.

For Maimonides creation is so important because the First Cause is understood to have brought the world into existence through benevolence and wisdom, reflected in the created order. Through study of the created order we can enlarge our understanding of God. Revelation is so important because it means that human beings receive help through divine graciousness. Through the giving of Torah human beings are provided with direction to perfection. This includes guidance regarding repentance and how to return to God when one sins. Redemption—understood here as the culmination of providence—is important because it means that the created order is under divine governance. That means that there is what we might call ‘ultimate’ or ‘cosmic’ justice. Human beings may not fully understand the wisdom and goodness of the created order, consider Job for example, but they can be confident that it is indeed governed by divine reason and justice.

4. Some Fundamental Metaphysical and Epistemological Issues

Because creation has implications for a great many issues in Maimonides’ philosophy, it is suitable as a starting point for discussing some main elements of Maimonides’ metaphysical views.

Maimonides examined what he took to be the three main approaches to accounting for the world. They are (i) a free act of creation ex nihilo, (ii) imposition of form on pre-existing matter, (iii) eternal emanation. In this last approach the world did not come into being ex nihilo or de novo. Maimonides did not claim to have demonstrative proof that God created the world ex nihilo and de novo. Neither did he claim that he could conclusively refute the second and third approaches. Among Jewish thinkers there were some who accepted a Platonist view that God imposed form on pre-existent matter. However, Maimonides held that we should accept the Biblical story of creation, suitably interpreted in philosophical terms. There is nothing inconsistent or incoherent in it, and we have the authority of the Bible with which to support it.

Maimonides held that God so far exceeds our capacity to have knowledge of the divine nature that we are severely limited in how we are able to describe or comprehend God. Even substance cannot be predicated of God in the sense with which we use the word to express knowledge of entities in the created order. In the terms of Maimonides’ negative theology, we would not describe God as the most powerful, all-knowing, incorruptible substance at the top of a hierarchy of substances. That is a positive conception. However, we can say things about God on the basis of what we can know about the effects of divine activity, not the activity itself. “Every attribute that is found in the books of the deity…is therefore an attribute of His action and not an attribute of His essence”(Guide of the Perplexed, I, 53, p. 121).

We can say that God is gracious or that God is powerful or merciful as long as we remain mindful that these phrases describe attributes of the world and do not directly refer to God.  Thus, we can speak of features of God’s actions but not God’s attributes. To speak of attributes would be to speak of properties of God, something God’s transcendence makes impossible. Still, we are not limited to utter silence regarding God. There is much we can say about the created order and about the effects of God’s causal activity though we cannot understand divine activity in its own right. God’s unity, the simplicity of the divine nature, is not a unity of parts, properties, or powers. It is beyond our capacity of positive comprehension though we see the benevolence and wisdom of the created order. Our use of language in speaking of God is equivocal in relation to its use in speaking of other things. That is, it is neither univocal with its use in other contexts, nor is it analogical to use in other contexts. (There is a helpful discussion of approaches to religious language in the article on that topic in this encyclopedia.)

Maimonides’ denial that in talk of God terms are used with meanings that are univocal with or analogous to their use in other contexts may seem to undermine our ability to use language to say anything at all when speaking of God. It may seem to cut us off from any grounding of semantic meaning in that context. Still, Maimonides held that negative theology was needed in order not to misrepresent divine simplicity and that speaking of what God causes is a meaningful way to speak of God.

Maimonides argued that our comprehension of God is limited to negations, for example negations of finitude, ignorance, plurality, corporeal existence, and so forth. Our use of terms such as ‘knowledge,’ ‘justice,’ ‘benevolence,’ and ‘will’ in speaking of God is equivocal. Such terms do not have the same meaning when predicated of human beings as they do when applied to God.

In the Guide, in regard to the application of predicates to God, Maimonides wrote:

[B]etween our knowledge and His knowledge there is nothing in common, as there is nothing in common between our essence and His essence. With regard to this point, only the equivocality of the term “knowledge” occasions the error; for there is a community only in the terms, whereas in the true reality of the things there is a difference. It is from this that incongruities follow necessarily, as we imagine that things that obligatorily pertain to our knowledge pertain also to His knowledge (Guide, III, 20, p. 482).

It is not simply that we lack the concepts with which to represent God’s power, knowledge, benevolence, and so forth; it is that God so completely transcends every created entity and conception available to human reason that in attempting to describe God we are silenced. We know that God exists, is a unity, and is eternal. We know this via revelation. Anything else to be said of God can only be said by describing the effects of God’s activity.

Maimonides wrote, “It has also become clear in metaphysics that by our intellects we are unable to attain perfect comprehension of His existence, may He be exalted. This is due to the perfection of His existence and the deficiency of our intellects. His existence has no causes by which He could be known” (Maimonides, “Eight Chapters,” in Ethical Writings of Maimonides, Ch. VIII, pp. 94-5). Thus, in Maimonides’ view, “It therefore follows that we do not know His knowledge either, nor do we comprehend it in any way, since He is His knowledge and His knowledge is He” (“Eight Chapters,” p. 95).

It would be a serious error to think that God’s knowledge is the same kind of knowledge as human knowledge only more complete. It would also be erroneous to think that God’s volitional power is the same type of power as human volition, only without the limitations to which humans are subject. Maimonides’ negative theology was a strategy for preserving the utter and complete uniqueness of God while also not being rendered utterly silent and inarticulate in regard to God and divine attributes. Through the created order we understand that God is wise, benevolent, all-powerful, eternal, one, and unchanging. However, we must be careful in how we use language about God because the unity of God’s nature implies that predicating multiple attributes of God is already an error unless it is understood through negative theology.

Maimonides’ approach had to come to grips with Scripture’s extensive use of descriptive terms in speaking of God. We are told that God is forgiving and merciful, long-suffering and patient, that God is generous and loving, that God becomes angry, and that God is jealous and insists on being the unique object of worship. For a great many people the understanding of God, the commandments, and human beings’ relationship to God depends heavily on the use of descriptively rich language. Like some other medieval philosophers, Maimonides held that the same truths could be represented and conveyed by different means, in accord with different levels of sophistication of understanding. For those not capable of philosophical understanding metaphysical principles and demonstrative proofs would be inscrutable and uninformative. They needed to hear truths about God in an idiom accessible to them. The same truths could be articulated and explicated in terms of philosophical understanding.

The anthropomorphic language of Scripture is suited to convey important truths to ‘ordinary,’ non-philosophical understanding. Philosophical understanding can interpret the idiom of Scripture in a way that ascertains its metaphysical meaning. Maimonides concurred with many Jewish thinkers in holding that “[t]he Torah speaks in accordance with the language of the children of Man.” That language is sufficiently rich to speak to the ‘plain person’ and the philosopher.

The sort of negation intended by Maimonides’ negative theology reflects the fact that language cannot capture and express God’s nature. Kenneth Seeskin illustrates this:

If I say that this horse does not lack the ability to run, you would be justified in concluding that its running ability is unimpaired….this cannot be what Maimonides says about God because even if God is superlatively powerful, we would still be assigning God to the class of powerful things. Instead what Maimonides means is that God is not in the class of things that are either powerful or weak in the normal sense of the term. God does not lack power, but neither is God’s power comparable with other things (Kenneth Seeskin, p. 89).

As Seeskin puts the point, “God falls under no description” (Seeskin, p.88). How then are we to imitate God by being righteous, showing loving kindness, and exercising judgment? As noted above, Maimonides’ solution is that we can comprehend and describe features of the created order, features of what God has brought about or what God has done. What we predicate of the world is not also to be predicated of God. Rather, we find that the created order reflects graciousness and benevolence, which is something distinct from God, who is the cause of it.

However, it was crucial to show that the language of the Torah did not mean literally that God is corporeal. Indeed, that would be the profoundest error of all. Nor did the fact that the Israelites were commanded to perform sacrifices mean that idolatry was acceptable. Such matters reflect the fact that truths need to be expressed in ways that are accessible to ordinary persons. Moreover, with time and the discipline of practice, it is possible for understanding to be deepened and enlarged. Sacrifice is, as it were, a stage on the way to a religion of prayer, which is a stage on the road to a religion of understanding. The commandments, in their complex wisdom regarding human nature, guide in the direction of increasingly rational religion. Maimonides maintained that there is no distinct religious understanding or faculty of religious knowledge. All cognition is intellectual cognition. That is true of prophecy as well as metaphysics. Moreover, Maimonides interpreted religious practice in a way that highlights God’s wisdom concerning what is needed to help human beings do and understand the things that will perfect them.

An important element of Maimonides’ view is that philosophical wisdom and fundamental truths about reality contained in Scripture and Jewish tradition  were known to a much earlier age but have since been lost and need to be retrieved. He held that those parts of Scripture concerning “the account of the beginning” contain fundamental truths about the natural world, or physics, and those concerning “the account of the chariot” in Ezekiel contain fundamental truths of metaphysics. One must master a very difficult process of learning to ascertain those truths. For example, Scripture contains a great deal of anthropomorphism, but Abraham and the patriarchs, Maimonides argued, understood that the existence of an eternal, incorporeal God could be demonstrated.

While we cannot have a positive conception of God’s nature, we can know that metaphysically a First Cause must exist, and through study of the created order, we can have knowledge of the effect of divine activity. Maimonides’ negative theology is a barrier to ascribing anthropomorphisms to God but it is not a barrier to knowledge of God’s existence or knowledge of features of the world God made. This is a strongly philosophical conception of religion. According to it, fulfilling the commandments is the way to develop one’s capacities and dispositions so that it is possible to come to understand the philosophical truths of the Hebrew Bible.

Maimonides’ insistence on the integral place of philosophy in Judaism was highly objectionable to many traditionalists though Maimonides understood his own work as explicating the truths of tradition rather than rejecting tradition or suggesting that it is anachronistic. He did not seek to replace tradition with philosophy but to articulate the rationality of tradition and show the ways in which philosophical depth and truth are present in Jewish thought and tradition. His thought resonated with Platonic and Aristotelian ideas in the respect that he regarded human beings as having a rational nature, most completely realized in intellectual perfection. The intellect in act is the actualization proper to a human being. Scripture and tradition are guides to attaining that actualization. They do not concern some other sort of truth or end.

5. Maimonides on the Limits of Knowledge

Maimonides’ negative theology is complemented by other elements of his epistemology. For example, he held that there are significant limitations on what human beings can demonstrate scientifically. We cannot, he thought, have demonstrative knowledge of astronomy though we can have demonstrable knowledge of sublunar physics. Recall that many ancient and medieval thinkers held that there is a real difference between the sublunar and supralunar realms. It was thought that the two realms are intelligible through different principles because the natures of the entities in them are different. Aristotle had held that, though the two realms are different, it is possible to have demonstrative knowledge of each of them.

Maimonides rejected this on the basis of empirical considerations, but the rejection had more than empirical implications. He argued that the motions of several celestial bodies were not in accord with what Aristotelian science held in regard to the motions of the spheres. If indeed there are exceptions to what should be necessities of physics, this shows that there are ‘particularities’ among heavenly phenomena, and that is evidence in favor of God as a creator who has made the heavens such as to show the particularities of the created order. In this way, what may look like an argument within physics is connected in a significant way with the dispute concerning whether the world is eternal and necessary or is the work of a creating God.

Maimonides accepted a great deal of Aristotle’s science, both in regard to its overall epistemology and in regard to many of its specific explanations. In Part II of the Guide Maimonides presented twenty-five postulates of Aristotelian physics, and he went on to argue for their indisputable role in scientific explanation. However, there were respects in which astronomy seemed problematic with regard to Aristotelian physics. The complex systems of motion developed to account for astronomical phenomena and the arrangement of celestial bodies could be shown to make mathematical sense but did not fully cohere with some substantive commitments of Aristotelian-Ptolemaic science. Chief among these is that mathematical astronomy did not consistently show that the earth is the fixed center of the celestial order. Maimonides thus distinguished between mathematical astronomy—which exhibited a systematic, if quite complex, order including eccentric spheres and epicycles—and physical reality, with particular features that cannot be demonstrated.

Overall, a number of scientific issues supplied a basis for Maimonides to claim that neither eternity nor creation is demonstrable. However, we are not forced into a suspension of judgment regarding the matter. As indicated above, there is another source of knowledge, namely, authentic tradition. This would seem very ad hoc and quite unconvincing if Maimonides did not develop a sophisticated conception of tradition as a source of knowledge. Earlier Jewish thinkers made important contributions to this issue. Saadia Gaon’s The Book of Belief and Opinions is especially important in this regard. What is striking about Maimonides’ approach is the manner in which it is related to other elements of his philosophy such as his negative theology.

Negative theology is a basis for an interpretation of Scripture, especially its anthropomorphisms, and is consistent with Maimonides’ conception of demonstrative science, prophecy understood in cognitive terms, and his intellectualist conception of human perfection. The negative theology enabled him to explain Scripture without being confined to literalism. Understanding of the text needs to cohere strongly with scientific and metaphysical—rational—understanding. That is what Maimonides tries to show. The oneness and incorporeality of God are truths of reason, and a sound interpretation of Scripture must preserve those truths. When Genesis (1:26) says that man is created in the likeness of God that does not mean that God has a body. Again, this is not to say that we have a complete comprehension of God, but metaphysical reasoning eliminates the hypothesis that God is a material being. Thus, what Genesis says should be interpreted to mean that man has a rational, indeed intellectual, form. This is a good illustration of how Maimonides interpreted Scripture as containing philosophical content in ways that may not be explicit but can be recognized and elaborated by human reason.

6. Philosophical Anthropology, Prophecy, and Perfection

The notion of the world as a created order and an order reflecting, in sometimes very complex, unobvious ways, divine goodness and wisdom is crucial for Maimonides. It is the foundation for the account of human nature, the human predicament, and the help that God gives to human beings. We can gain some additional insight into this by considering Maimonides’ interpretation of the Garden and of Adam and Eve eating of the tree of knowledge of good and evil after having been warned against doing so.

It is essential to Maimonides’ philosophical anthropology that human beings have an intellectual essence, a rational nature capable of comprehending intelligible features of reality. Again, to say that man is created in God’s image is to say that a human being has a rational soul. In Maimonides’ view Adam and Eve could have led untroubled lives guided exclusively by clear intellectual conceptions of the true and the false, without concern with good and evil. Such lives would have been free of frustration, pain, anxiety, and fear. All that was required was that Adam and Eve heed the injunction not to eat of the tree of the knowledge of good and evil. In eating of the tree they yielded to distraction from intellectual activity and sought satisfaction in the lesser objects of the imagination. Good and evil are not, in Maimonides’ view, demonstrable or intuited intelligibles. Our conceptions of good and evil involve the imagination.

In his treatment of Adam and Eve Maimonides is presenting key elements of his anthropology rather than exploring details of a particular episode of human history. His primary concern is to explicate basic features of human nature and the human condition and to make fundamental points about human intellectual capacities and the aspects of human nature as the basis of an ethical life. In the Guide Maimonides writes of Adam:

For the intellect that God made overflow unto man and that is the latter’s ultimate perfection, was that which Adam had been provided with before he disobeyed. It was because of this that it was said of him that that he was created in the image of God and in His likeness. It was likewise on account of it that he was addressed by God and given commandments, as it says: And the Lord God commanded, and so on (Guide, I, 2, p. 24).

In addition

Now man in virtue of his intellect knows truth from falsehood; and this holds good for all intelligible things. Accordingly when man was in his most perfect and excellent state, in accordance with his inborn disposition and possessed of his intellectual cognitions—because of which it is said of him: Thou has made him but little lower than Elohim—he had no faculty that was engaged in any way in the consideration of generally accepted things, and he did not apprehend them(Guide, I, 2, p. 25).

In failing to heed the warning not to eat of the tree of knowledge of good and evil, Adam “disobeyed the commandment that was imposed upon him on account of his intellect and, becoming endowed with the faculty of apprehending generally accepted things, he became absorbed in judging things to be bad or fine” (Guide, I, 2, p. 25). It is notable that the view that imagination can be a source of error and can lead us away from clear understanding has ancient roots. The ancient and medieval conceptions of how imagination compares unfavorably with intellect contrast sharply with many modern conceptions of the role and importance of imagination.

Adam’s and Eve’s error persists as a feature of our nature. Human beings are susceptible to distraction from the truth and from contemplation of the intelligible. We concern ourselves with other things and often with an urgency of desire. Maimonides did not interpret the story of Adam and Eve in the Garden in the way it is understood through the Christian notion of ‘The Fall’ or ‘Original Sin.’ According to Christianity only the supernatural agency of Christ, making a human reborn through the grace of Christ’s Passion, can restore the integrity of human nature. Judaism does not include such a conception. Maimonides held that God’s grace is exhibited through the giving of Torah, which is a guide to a virtuous and holy life, and by fulfilling the commandments through both understanding and action, a person can return to God, become close to God. This is explicable in terms of ethical and intellectual virtue without an additional supernatural agency. Judaism does not share the Christian conception of a profoundly wounded human nature, incapable of repairing itself. There is, though, a role for grace in Judaism; the giving of Torah reflects divine graciousness.

To Maimonides Adam’s and Eve’s sin of indulgence indicates that human beings can be distracted from truth. Human beings are creatures with passions and desires,  not only intellect. One epistemological implication of this anthropology is that moral judgments are non-demonstrable. Morality reflects the fact that human beings are not purely intellectual beings, something highlighted in Maimonides’ interpretation of the Garden.

Maimonides had a complex view of the rationality of the commandments and the relation between ethical virtue and intellectual virtue. Before going directly into that topic, it is important to comment on some key features of Maimonides’ conception of prophecy. His account of prophecy has deep connections with his metaphysics and epistemology. Maimonides conceptualized revelation and prophecy in rationalistic terms. He explicated prophecy as an emanation, ultimately from God, transmitted to human beings via the causality of the Agent Intellect. In Maimonides’ view there is no role for mystery in prophecy. Like Saadia before him, he did not regard Judaism as involving any fundamentally mysterious doctrines. Prophecy is understood in terms of emanation of intelligible form to an individual especially apt to receive it on account of their strength of rational and imaginative faculties.

The prophet has an ability to receive a more than ordinary extent of intellectual emanation. He also has an imagination of sufficient power to represent concretely what has been intellectually received. The chief point is that prophecy belongs on the same epistemological spectrum as other types of rational knowledge, such as science and metaphysics. In fact, Maimonides was a severe critic of many types of mysticism and was especially harsh in his objections to astrology. In part, that was because he thought that the determinism associated with astrology was in conflict with the compelling case for freedom of the will, an issue discussed below. Knowledge—understood as comprehension of intelligible forms—requires a causal agency to actualize it in an individual with the potentiality to acquire knowledge. The Agent Intellect actualizes knowledge in human beings. This is true in general and prophecy is, in principle, no different.

With respect to the emanation of intelligible form Maimonides held that if a person is such that only the person’s rational faculty is affected, then that is a speculative person. If the rational and imaginative faculties are affected, then that person is a prophet. If only the imagination is affected, the individual is a lawgiver. Imagination is crucial because of how it makes it possible to give concrete representation to intelligible knowledge, a representation by which the prophetic message is accessible to the great majority of people.

This element of Maimonides’ view is similar in some important respects to Alfarabi’s view. The prince needs wisdom and persuasive skill so that the great majority of people—who can be led by persuasion and compulsion but not by demonstration of the relevant truths—can be effectively led in a way that is oriented to the good. In Alfarabi’s view the ruler needs multiple virtues including theoretical virtue, deliberative virtue, moral virtue, and practical art. The ‘elect’ have knowledge that is demonstrated; they have an intellectual grasp of principles, and they can see what follows from them by necessity. They have rational understanding. The vulgar are reached by persuasion, and they have a grasp of things through imaginative representation rather than demonstration.

Maimonides’ view is, in a broad sense, a naturalistic conception of prophecy. The connection between the prophet and the Agent Intellect is not made by an act of God; God can block prophecy but an individual meets the conditions for prophecy on epistemological terms, so to speak, not through divine intervention. In Maimonides’ view the prophet does not have a mysterious experience or an extraordinary faculty. Still, to be effective as a prophet, the person must also be able to apply their higher understanding effectively and that involves the kind of concrete detail that can only come from imagination.In discussing prophecy Maimonides presented three main positions on the issue. They are:

  1. God can make anyone a prophet. (This is the vulgar view.)
  2. Prophecy is a perfection involving the height of intellectual, imaginative capacities, and moral character. (This is the philosophical view.)
  3. Prophecy is as the philosophical view maintains, but God, through performance of a miracle, can prevent a suitably virtuous person from becoming a prophet. (This, Maimonides says, is the Jewish view.)

No one lacking virtue can be a prophet. Only a person with the relevant perfections will become a prophet; however, because the performance of divine miracles is possible, God can prevent even a person with the relevant perfections from becoming a prophet. Because Maimonides acknowledges the possibility of miracles, he allows that God can prevent prophecy. Overall, this is a naturalistic conception, though it is couched in language suitable to non-philosophical persons’ beliefs in the importance of miracles.

Also, it should be noted that there is one exception to the typology above. Maimonides held that in Moses’ case, prophecy was entirely intellectual. Moses was capable of a uniquely complete comprehension of intelligibles.

Maimonides’ philosophy shows the influence of Aristotle, Islamic commentaries on Aristotle, kalam, and Neoplatonism. Aristotelianism and Neoplatonism intersect in his view that the further away from the ground and source of being—the further from God in the created order—the less perfect are beings and the more susceptible they are to degeneration, change, and ceasing to be. The more fully a human being actualizes the intellect, the more like God that individual becomes inasmuch as actuated intellect has no tendency to corruption or change. A human being whose intellect is actualized as fully as possible is able to come closer to God. That striving involves the exercise of ethical virtue and intellectual virtue. This is an intellectualized conception of imitatio dei. The created order is a series of levels of reality, each more remote from and less like the ground and source of being, but human beings are capable of being close to God through understanding.

Maimonides says of man that “[h]is ultimate perfection is to become rational in actu, I mean to have an intellect in actu” (Guide, III, 27, p. 511). In addition, , “[i]t is clear that to this ultimate perfection there do not belong either actions or moral qualities and that it consists only of opinions toward which speculation has led and that investigation has rendered compulsory” (Guide, III, 27, p. 511).

The more one’s intellect is actualized, the more one is protected by providence in the metaphysical sense that one is less liable to corruption and ceasing to be. In short, Maimonides held that a person is immortal, capable of surviving bodily death, to the extent that one’s intellect is actualized. There are then, degrees of immortality and degrees of being protected by providence. Prophecy, providence, and immortality are all explicated along these Aristotelian/Neoplatonic lines.

Maimonides was criticized for not clearly and emphatically asserting that resurrection of the dead is a fundamental principle of Judaism. It was really not until the medieval era and the deadly pressures on Jews caught between Islam and Christianity during the Crusades that Jewish thinkers formulated a dogma for Judaism. The formulation of dogma could be helpful to Jews pressured to defend their religion and needing to have ready replies to theological attacks on it. Maimonides formulated Thirteen Fundamental Principles of Jewish Faith, the last of which is belief that the dead will be brought back to life when God wills it. Apart from a small number of passages in the Prophets, the resurrection of the dead does not figure in the Hebrew Bible. Nevertheless, by the thirteenth century it was becoming a more accepted, shared element of Judaism, and Maimonides included it among his Thirteen Principles. The doctrine is in tension with the intellectualistic Aristotelianism of Maimonides’ anthropology, and scholarly debate over whether he genuinely accepted the doctrine continues.

A significant respect in which his anthropology differs from Aristotle’s is connected with creation, revelation, and redemption. Aristotle’s Metaphysics opens with “All men by nature desire to know.” This is not an ordinary empirical claim; it states something Aristotle took to be fundamental to human nature, namely, that our telosis intellectual. A human being’s nature is most completely realized in intellectual activity, and multiple features of human nature are to be understood in terms of how they are related to that telos. Thus far, the agreement between Aristotle and Maimonides is quite close.

However, for Aristotle, a human being’s most fundamental orientation to the world is wonder. That reflects our telos, and it is motivationally important to the activities through which our telos can be realized. Maimonides would agree that wonder is a basic feature of our rational nature but, given the fact of creation and revelation and God’s justice and mercy, it can be said that a human being’s most basic orientation to reality is gratitude or a combination of gratitude and humility. This is because gratitude is owed to God for the very existence of the world and for the wisdom of the created order. Our highest end is a loving cognition of God. The fact that human beings have been given aid through revelation of Torah reshapes the Aristotelian conception of both human beings and the world overall. Creation, revelation, and redemption are not just ‘accessories’ to what is otherwise an unchanged Aristotelian philosophy. Gratitude includes an aspiration to holiness, a resolve to fulfill the commandments so that one imitates God, to the extent possible for a human being, through attaining understanding and acting in ways informed by understanding.

Humility has a place in a person’s fundamental orientation at least in the respect that perhaps the most compelling and evident conception a person can have is the conception of all things being dependent upon God. Even in striving for virtue and perfection of one’s nature through one’s own voluntary activity, humility is appropriate because of the contrast between human beings and God and because of the divine graciousness in giving help to human beings via revelation. We will see below, in the discussion of ethics, how Maimonides’ view of pride and humility is strikingly different from Aristotle’s.

Given the central role of the commandments in regard to human perfection, we are in position now to address some of the specific features of Maimonides’ conception of the relation between the ethical and the intellectual and how they are mutually reinforcing.

7. Maimonides on Ethical and Intellectual Virtue

As a pathway into Maimonides’ account of the virtues, it will be helpful to begin with the issue of ‘the reasons for the commandments’ (t’amei ha-mitzvot). While there is some disagreement over the precise number of commandments in Torah, Maimonides concurred with the most widely shared view, holding that they number six hundred thirteen. (Three hundred sixty-five are prohibitions and two hundred forty-eight are positive injunctions.) Along with some other medieval Jewish philosophers Maimonides held that fulfilling the commandments is not only a matter of practice but also study. Jews are to enlarge and deepen their understanding by striving to comprehend the reasons for the commandments, which is itself commanded. Jewish thinkers often quoted Deuteronomy as a locus of the commandment to seek understanding by reflecting upon the rational justifications of the commandments.  For example, Deuteronomy 4, 5-8, reads, ‘for this is your wisdom and your understanding in the sight of the peoples, that, when they hear all these statutes, shall say: “Surely this great nation is a wise and understanding people.”’

Maimonides held that there are reasons for all of the commandments. None is simply an arbitrary test of obedience. Moreover, he thought it an offense against divine wisdom that any commandment should be without reason. Some philosophers of the period argued for divine voluntarism, often as a way of preserving God’s sovereignty and power. Voluntarism had numerous highly influential Islamic proponents, but very few Jewish philosophers endorsed it. Scotus and Ockham are often described as propounding divine voluntarism, though their views are complex in ways that the ‘voluntarist’ label does not accurately apply.

Numerous Jewish thinkers distinguished between mishpatim and hukkim, that is, between judgments and statutes. The former are those commandments the reasons for which are ascertainable by human beings, and the latter are those commandments whose justifications are more opaque but, in the view of some, still rational. Saadia had distinguished between ‘laws of reason’ and ‘laws of revelation’ as a way of making the distinction. There was debate over whether some mishpatim (judgments) are fully evident to reason. Saadia held that view; Maimonides did not. Saadia’s view was very much like an intuitionist view regarding at least some of the commandments. The chief point here is that, in Maimonides’ view, all commandments are supported by rational justification, though none are rationally self-evident.

He wrote:

[E]very commandment from among these six hundred and thirteen commandments exists either with a view to communicating a correct opinion, or to putting an end to an unhealthy opinion, or to communicating a rule of justice, or to warding off an injustice, or to endowing men with a noble moral quality, or to warning them against an evil moral quality. Thus all [the commandments] are bound up with three things: opinions, moral qualities, and political civic actions (Guide, III, 31, p. 524).

He criticized voluntarism harshly, calling it a “sickness” of soul to think that lacking any rational purpose should be a mark that a law has a divine origin. Maimonides wrote, “It is, however, the doctrine of all of us—both of the multitude and of the elite—that all the Laws have a cause, though we ignore the causes for some of them and we do not know the manner in which they conform to wisdom” (Guide, III, 26, p. 507). In the midst of a discussion of the matter (chapter 31 of the Guide) he quotes the passage from Deuteronomy 4.  The ultimate, overall purpose “of the Law as a whole is to put an end to idolatry” (Guide, III, 29, p. 517). The purpose is realized through individuals acquiring good moral habits, seeking and preserving justice, and attaining understanding. Radical voluntarism would leave the commandments without purpose or point, when we can see that “all the commandments are bound up with three things: opinions, moral qualities, and political civic actions” (Guide, III, 31, p. 524). Sometimes he reduces the purpose of the Law overall to two ends, “the welfare of the soul and the welfare of the body” (Guide, III, 27, p. 510).

 

Maimonides held that fulfilling the commandments could help a person attain more understanding of the reasons for the commandments. He developed a complex, subtle view of the relations between ethical and intellectual virtue while endorsing an intellectualist conception of human perfection. He held that the more fully one understands the rational justifications for the commandments, the more one will be motivated to fulfill them. The motivation is increased by appreciation of the commandments’ wisdom. Thus, it is also part of his view that tradition is important not just as a way of sustaining ancient practices but also as transmitting understanding that can be enlarged and deepened.  There are several respects in which Maimonides’ thought has rationalistic tendencies, and this point about tradition as having authority because of its relation to reason and not just the authority of antiquity is a good example.

Maimonides did not acknowledge an intellectual virtue of practical wisdom. One important difference between Maimonides and Aristotle is that Maimonides regarded all virtues, apart from intellectual virtue, as choiceworthy only because they serve intellectual virtue. Preserving health and wellbeing and composing the soul are conditions for intellectual perfection. The virtues, other than intellectual virtue, are not in Maimonides’s view choice-worthy in their own right, independent of their relation to intellectual virtue. As David Shatz writes of Maimonides’ view:

His writings contain extensive discussion of ridding oneself of bad ethical traits and acquiring good ones, and of the attempt to “quell the impulses” of matter that distract people from intellectual pursuits and impede cognition of what is not physical. The quelling of such impulses is associated with the attainment of holiness (GP 3.8, 3.33). Morality is a preparation for contemplation and constitutes no trivial task (Shatz, p. 169).

In Chapter 54, which is the final chapter of the Guide, Maimonides distinguishes four species of perfection relevant to human beings. They are “the perfection of possessions” (material goods and resources), “the perfection of bodily constitution and shape” (such things as corporeal strength and temperament, which “[do] not belong to man qua man, but qua animal”), “the perfection of the moral virtues” (which he says is “preparation for something else and not an end in itself”), and finally, intellectual perfection, “[t]he true human perfection; it consists in the acquisition of the rational virtues… [T]hrough it man is man” (Guide, III, 54, p. 635).

The first three species of human virtue are conditions for the fourth species, which is the virtue by which one’s essence is actualized. Health, strength, and at least a modicum of material means are needed in order to engage in morally virtuous activity. The moral virtues are conditions for the composure and focus of mind required for intellectual virtue. Intellectual virtue is the individual’s true perfection, and it brings with it enduring permanence without corruption. Yet soon after making the pronounced case for human perfection as intellectual perfection, Maimonides concludes the Guide with a statement about how we imitate God to the fullest through loving-kindness, righteousness, and judgment. Unsurprisingly, there is considerable debate among scholars regarding just how Maimonides’ view is to be interpreted. One way to understand his view is that the first three perfections are choiceworthy as conditions and support for intellectual perfection, and to the extent to which one attains intellectual perfection, it will inform and be reflected in how one acts, and the activity mentioned at the conclusion of the Guide is imitation of God insofar as it is care for the created order, and finally, care is inseparable from the understanding of that order. In this view, the first three perfections of a human being are necessary for intellectual perfection, but intellectual perfection is then itself actualized in ethically excellent human action.

This may still seem to be problematically related to Maimonides’ statements about intellectual perfection as the distinctive and highest perfection of a human being. However, it suggests a way in which that notion of perfection can be in agreement with the significance Maimonides attaches to imitatio dei. In any case, the issue is an excellent example of the complexity of Maimonides’ thought and the subtlety and care with which he articulated it. His complex view cannot be dismissed as a clumsy lapse in consistency or the effect of inattention to what he said elsewhere.

Yet the Guide is also the work in which Maimonides explains Job’s suffering on the basis of the fact that, while Job was ethically virtuous, he was not said to excel in intellectual virtue. His imperfect understanding was at the root of Job’s perplexity over what befell him. If he had more perfect understanding, he would have understood that all is ordered for the best by divine providence. Maimonides connected intellectual virtue with providence in just that way; the more perfect one’s understanding, the more complete one’s protection from evil. Human beings mistakenly think that God’s knowledge is like our knowledge and that God’s purposes are like our own. That is, on our part, the error of displacing intellect with our imagination.

If man knows this, every misfortune will be borne lightly by him. And misfortunes will not add to his doubts regarding the deity and whether He does or does not know and whether He exercises providence or manifests neglect, but will, on the contrary, add to his love, as is said in the conclusion of the prophetic revelation in question: Wherefore I abhor myself, and repent of dust and ashes (Guide, III, 23, p. 497).

It is also a crucial part of Maimonides’ view of intellectual perfection that the love of God “is proportionate to apprehension” (Guide, III, 51, p. 621). The intellect emanating from God is the “bond” between God and human beings and “You have the choice: if you wish to strengthen and fortify this bond, you can do so; if, however, you wish gradually to make it weaker and feebler until you cut it, you can also do that” (Guide, III, 51, p. 621). Happiness is ultimately and essentially intellectual, even if in the aspiration to be holy and to imitate God, we act in the world in ways we understand to be God’s ways.

8. Some Key Elements of Moral Epistemology and Moral Psychology

The Law supplies the guidance for virtuous activity. We need to be careful in regard to this point. It is not Maimonides’ view that a person is to follow the law mechanically or without reflection or criticism. We saw above the central importance of seeking to enlarge and deepen understanding of the commandments. That involves questioning, dialectic, elaboration, and extending judgment to new sorts of cases. Thus, even though Maimonides’ ethics lacks a virtue of practical wisdom, reason and reasoning had a vital, extensive role in it.

Recall, also, that Maimonides held that good and evil relate to the imagination rather than the intellect. Again, it is important to be careful; this does not mean that Maimonides thought that good and evil are subjective or that there is no objective difference between being correct and being mistaken about them. He did not think that good and evil were objects of the intellect, but he did think that judgments of good and evil could be, or could fail to be, supported by reasons. The key contrast here is not between the rational and the conventional, or subjective, but between the demonstrable and the not demonstrable. Judgments of good and evil are not demonstrable but neither are they conventional. It is in the sciences that demonstration is possible, but that does not relegate ethical judgment to the sphere of the merely conventional, expressive, or subjective.

We can attain further clarity concerning this matter by considering Maimonides’ use of, what is translated as, the “generally accepted.” Maimonides uses the notion of the “generally accepted” in a number of places in the Guide. (See, for example, I, 2; also III, 29; III, 31; III, 32; and in “Eight Chapters,” Ch. VIII, p. 87) He seems to use it in two ways. In one sense, “generally accepted” refers to beliefs and practices widely held, whether or not they are true or supported by good reasons. For example, we might say that in ancient times it was generally accepted that the stars exercised causal power over the actions of human beings, causing them to do what they do (a view Maimonides opposed). That is a belief that was widely held, though it was false.

In the second sense, something may be said to be generally accepted insofar as it is widely held on the basis of good reasons, though not demonstrable. The matter in question is not known by intuition or demonstration, yet neither is it simply a matter of custom or longstanding convention. There are grounds for it such that it is a reasonable thing to maintain. Moral beliefs are generally accepted in that second sense. Thus, some of what is generally accepted God wishes to efface from our minds, as is the case with idolatrous beliefs, while some of what is generally accepted is important for us to believe and to employ as a basis for action. What is generally accepted, in this sense, is not merely a matter of being commonly believed. It is a matter of being a justified though non-demonstrable belief.

Above we noted that, according to Maimonides, there are reasons for all of the commandments. The reasons for them are not always evident, and in many cases, when we seek after them, will find that their justification remains elusive. For instance, we may be able to see that there is reason to punish certain kinds of conduct; it may be easily understood that certain action-types count as crimes or offenses. It may not be clear why the punishment is forty lashes rather than thirty-nine or forty-one. Perhaps we agree that sixty would be too many and ten would be too few. But why does the commandment tell us forty? In such cases Maimonides tells us that some number had to be chosen so that there would be clarity about what is required, and God had a reason for the degree of severity of the punishment even if it is not rationally evident that it must be forty. In some cases, even God simply has to make a choice within a range determined by his wisdom.

There is an important connection between this issue and the earlier discussion of the reasons for the commandments. Many of the statutes (hukkim) concern ritual, diet, the clean and the unclean, matters of dress, and a great many practices, some of which do not seem to have any easily discernible ethical significance. Maimonides argued that part of the explanation for some of them is that they were needed to orient the Israelites to proper worship of God when they were accustomed to the practices of the pagan peoples surrounding them. Part of the divine wisdom of the commandments is that they did not require a complete, abrupt change in practice, a change so radical that people would have resisted it on account of having no grasp of what they were being required to do. Instead, in a manner reflective of God’s “gracious ruse,” many of the commandments required sacrifice and other practices with which the Israelites were familiar. However, the Law overall, as an integrated, purposeful discipline of perfection, guided people to true belief and genuinely virtuous practice.

On the issue of why the commandments contain many requirements not so different from the practices of people from whom the Israelites were to be distinguished by their covenant with God, Maimonides wrote:

For a sudden transition from one opposite to another is impossible. And therefore man, according to his nature, is not capable of abandoning suddenly all to which he was accustomed. As therefore God sent Moses our Master to make out of us a kingdom of priests and a holy nation—through the knowledge of Him, may He be exalted, according to what he has explained” (Guide, III, 32, p. 526).

Recognizable practices oriented to a new purpose and having new meaning were required.

His wisdom, may He be exalted, and His gracious ruse, which is manifest in regard to all His creatures, did not require that He give us a Law prescribing the rejection, abandonment, and abolition of all these kinds of worship. For one could not then conceive the acceptance of [such a Law], considering the nature of man, which always likes that to which it is accustomed” (Guide, III, 32, p. 526).

This way the people would not reject what was being asked of them as alien and inscrutable. Maimonides, like Aristotle, regarded human beings as creatures of habit in very significant respects. This is one of the respects in which Aristotelian elements of philosophical anthropology and moral psychology are discernible in Maimonides.

These points are also relevant to Maimonides’ treatment of messianism. He argued that when the Messiah reigns there will be no fundamental change in human nature. The world will not be reordered except that it will be a time of universal peace. Israel will have political sovereignty restored to it, and peoples all over the world will engage in study, seeking scientific and philosophical understanding. The ways of the world will not be altered in any fundamental respect except that during the messianic era people will attain and exercise virtue. Moreover, fulfilling the commandments is necessary preparation for that. People need to prepare themselves for rule by the Messiah; until that preparation is done, messianic claims should be severely tested.

Habits and the importance of habituation figure prominently in “Eight Chapters” (Commentary on the Mishnah) and also in “Laws Concerning Character Traits,” (Mishneh Torah). “Eight Chapters” presents much of Maimonides’ moral psychology and the main claims in his conception of free will. In it we find very Aristotelian-sounding philosophical idioms being put to work in the service of some quite un-Aristotelian themes and theses. That the commandments are to be fulfilled has implications for the conception of free will and for the possibility of repentance and character change, and of course, there are many implications for what a human being needs to do in order to realize the perfection proper to humans. Maimonides’ conception of the virtues differs from Aristotle’s in some striking ways, though Maimonides still owes a great deal to Aristotle in respect to the conceptual architecture of virtue.

Like Aristotle, Maimonides emphasized the importance of regular practice, in contrast to any particular episode of decision, in acquiring a virtue. Like Aristotle, he understood virtues and vices as ethically and explanatorily significant states of character. Like Aristotle, he took many virtues to lie in a mean. “The general rule is that he follow the mean for every single character trait, until all his character traits are ordered according to the mean. That is in keeping with what Solomon says: ‘And all your ways will be upright’” (Maimonides, “Laws Concerning Character Traits,” in Ethical Writings of Maimonidess, p. 33).

In addition, Maimonides agreed that there is a vital role for excellent examples, persons of sound judgment and well-ordered dispositions of desire and affect. “It is a positive commandment to cleave to the wise men in order to learn from their actions” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 47). Such persons can be important models, shaping the aspirations of others. When one suffers a sickness of the soul, he is to “go to the wise men—who are physicians of the soul—and they will cure their disease by means of the character traits that they shall teach them, until they make them return to the middle way” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 31).

Like Aristotle, Maimonides recognizes the significance of the overall character of one’s community and the people by whom one is surrounded. Notwithstanding those and other important points of agreement, Maimonides’ ethics and his account of moral psychology include some elements very different from Aristotle’s views. The differences concern some fundamental, general features of moral psychology as well as the understanding of individual virtues and vices.

With regard to particular virtues Maimonides held that anger and pride are two aspects of our moral psychology that we should do our utmost to minimize. He goes so far as to say that a truly virtuous man will put on a show of anger—because it may be necessary as part of the project of habituating one’s children or making important ethical points to others—while not actually feeling anger. He regarded anger as quite threatening to composure of mind and to attention to God as one’s proper focus. In actually feeling anger the individual is disturbed and is taken over by passion in a way that can misguide judgment and action. That is to be avoided as completely as possible, even when it is appropriate to punish for example.

Because prophecy is ultimately an intellectual phenomenon, one cannot be a prophet if one’s passions are disturbed. Anger and sadness, for example, are impediments to prophecy. In “Laws Concerning Character Traits” Maimonides writes, “the wise men of old said: ‘Anyone who is angry—it is as if he worships idols.’ They said about anyone who is angry: If he is a wise man, his wisdom departs from him, and if he is a prophet, his prophecy departs from him” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits” p. 32). Distractions from intellectual focus and composure are impediments to prophecy.

Pride is another element of moral psychology without proper place in the virtuous person’s character. First of all, we are to be humble before God. We mentioned above the significance of awareness of our finiteness and smallness in contrast to God, and there is also the fact of the radical dependence of all things on God. Scripture says that Moses, the greatest prophet and the leader of the Israelites on their way to becoming a people through his leadership, was very humble. Thus, the sort of humility urged is not inconsistent with courage, resolve, excellent judgment, and the willingness to accept weighty responsibility. Humility concerns restraint of the ego, restraint of self-love in order to remain mindful of the needs and the welfare of others, and guarding against an inflated opinion of oneself and one’s own interests. Torah enjoins again and again to welcome the stranger, to care for the widow, the orphan, and the needy, and for the Israelites not to forget that they were once slaves in Egypt. Humility is a way of registering dependence, showing gratitude for existence and for being sustained, and appreciating the gift of Torah.

Pride and anger are two notable cases regarding which one is to aim for an extreme rather than the mean. “In the case of some character traits, a man is forbidden to accustom himself to the mean. Rather, he shall move to the other extreme. One such [character trait] is a haughty heart, for the good way is not that a man be merely humble, but that he have a lowly spirit, that his spirit be very submissive.”(“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 31)

Every man whose character traits all lie in the mean is called a wise man. Whoever is exceedingly scrupulous with himself and moves a little toward one side or the other, away from the character trait in the mean, is called a pious man. Whoever moves away from a haughty heart to the opposite extreme so that he is exceedingly lowly in spirit is a called a pious man. This is the measure of piety. If he moves only to the mean and is humble, he is called a wise man; this is the measure of wisdom(“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” pp. 29-30).

In general, Maimonides held that the commandments give human beings the discipline to acquire dispositions lying in the mean. “We are commanded to walk in these middle ways, which are the good and right ways. As it is said: ‘And you shall walk in His ways’” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 30). He referred to the middle way as “the way of the Lord” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 30). Thus, “[t]he Law forbids what it forbids and commands what it commands only for this reason, i.e., that we move away from one side as a means of discipline” (Maimonides, “Eight Chapters,” p. 71). He did, though, include the category of the pious in addition to the wise, noting the appropriateness of certain extremes to the pious.

Maimonides did not encourage severe asceticism and self-punishment. Like many other Jewish thinkers he held that the discipline of the commandments was discipline enough, “Therefore the wise men commanded that a man only abstain from things forbidden by the Torah” (“Eight Chapters,” p. 34). Quoting the sages, he asks, “‘Is what Torah has prohibited not enough for you, that you prohibit other things for yourself?’” (“Eight Chapters,” p. 34).

Maimonides made an important moral-psychological distinction between fulfilling the commandments that concern matters ascertainable by human reason, the things “generally accepted,” and those concerning matters of the “traditional laws,” that is, the hukkim. Those are what Saadia called “the laws of revelation” in contrast to “the laws of reason.” In regard to what is generally accepted, he quotes Talmud, writing, “If they were not written down, they would deserve to be written down.” (“Eight Chapters,” p. 80) The traditional laws make a different sort of demand on inclination and desire. They specify prohibitions that would not, just on the basis of what reason generally accepts, be arrived at. For that reason, there is greater virtue in fulfilling those commandments when it is a struggle to do so, while the person who is temperate with regard to what reason requires is better than the person who struggles to fulfill those commandments. With regard to murder, theft, fraud, repaying a benefactor with evil rather than gratitude, and so forth, it is better to have no desire to do what is prohibited.

With regard to the dietary laws, ritual laws, and so forth, there is greater virtue in successfully battling an inclination to do what is prohibited than in simply having no such desire. Thus, in the case of one type of commandment, virtue is superior to continence; in the case of the other type of commandment, continence, in the face of struggling against desire, is superior. This was Maimonides’ method of resolving what appeared to be a contradiction between what ‘the philosophers’ say and what ‘the sages’ say. It is, he asserts, “a marvelous subtlety and a wonderful reconciliation of the two views” (“Eight Chapters,” p. 80). This approach acknowledges the special difficulty involved with the ritual laws and commandments unique to the Jewish people. Maimonides saw that it would be unreasonable to expect people to be able to fulfill those on the basis of natural tendencies. One might have a natural disposition to be kind and compassionate, but no one has a natural disposition to fulfill say, the laws concerning specific practices associated with holy days, diet or sacrifices of specific types.

9. Freedom of the Will, Repentance, and Covenant

Two issues regarding which Maimonides’ views departed significantly from Aristotle’s are freedom of the will and repentance. Both are related in a significant respect. Repentance, as Maimonides understood it, is possible only if persons have free will and Maimonides insisted that the Law and the commandments would be pointless without freedom of the will:

If man’s actions were done under compulsion, the commandments and prohibitions of the Law would be nullified and they would all be absolutely in vain, since man would have no choice in what he does. Similarly, instruction and education, including instruction in all the productive arts, would necessarily be in vain an would all be futile (“Eight Chapters,” pp. 84-5).

He maintained that “[r]eward and punishment would also be sheer injustice, not be be [sic] meted out by some of us to others nor by God to us (“Eight Chapters,” p. 85).

There is no question that humans have free will. “The truth about which there is no doubt at all is that all of man’s actions are given over to him (“Eight Chapters,” p. 85). This is a robust version of ‘ought implies can,’ such that God’s wisdom and justice are at stake. The notion that a human being might lack freedom of the will is simply unsupportable, and Maimonides’ argument concerning the Law has a result that comports with his critique of astrological determinism.

Moreover, despite the weight he put on the importance of habits in shaping a person’s character and in the acquisition of virtues and vices, Maimonides also argued that even a mature individual is able to change his character through repentance. The regularly virtuous person is still able to sin, and the regularly vicious person is able to ethically reorient himself, connecting with the good through changing his dispositions and following the commandments.

Aristotle held that through the process of habituation, including how one habituates oneself, a person acquires a second nature, a developed character, which becomes fixed or very nearly fixed. The plasticity of one’s capacities is largely exhausted as a result of exercising them in specific ways such that certain specific states of character are formed. That’s just what it is to have a character. This does not mean that a person must be either soundly virtuous or profoundly vicious. Most people are continent rather than temperate, and they may never cease to struggle to some extent to do what virtue requires. In Aristotle’s view the chief point is that, whatever the extent of one’s virtues or vices, the individual is very likely to reach a condition in which states of character are firmly established. In having a character, one has dispositions of desire and emotion and engages in patterns and policies of reasoning in quite regular ways. In Aristotle’s view it would not be reasonable to expect of people in general that they should be able to change their mature characters.

Aristotle (especially in the Rhetoric) discusses certain characteristic features of persons at different stages in life—how young men differ from men late in life, and so forth. Still, his view was that one’s second nature, one’s ethically relevant dispositions to choose, to act, and to respond, tends to be stable rather than easily changed. The dispositions into which a person settles shape the person’s judgments, awareness, and deliberations. It is not as though there is rational agency and separate from that are elements of character. One’s character just is the form that one’s rational agency takes on account of how specific dispositions are reflected in one’s choices, actions, and responses. In this view the person established in vice may not even be able to recognize what virtue requires. After all, that person is settled in a (wrong) conception of what is worthwhile and desirable and may see no reason to revise that conception.  Even supposing that recognition of what virtue requires is possible, the vicious person may not have any effective desire to change.

For Maimonides it was crucial that a significant revision of a person’s dispositions is possible. That is a necessary condition of genuine repentance, which is something Maimonides held is never practically impossible. Even the person established in profound vices and enjoying vicious activities, can come to see what virtue requires and can achieve ethical reorientation.  It should be noted that there are a few instances in the Hebrew Bible in which God prevents a person from repenting and makes it impossible for that agent to do the right thing. The ‘hardening of Pharaoh’s heart’ just before the exodus from Egypt is a notable example. The difficulty of interpreting the morality of such a case made it a fixture of medieval Jewish philosophy. Maimonides addresses the instance explicitly. There is not space here to discuss it in depth. It is indeed a hard case but that is because it is at odds with another view that he held, namely, that people have freedom of the will adequate to repent genuinely.

The Law has a crucial role in helping people to achieve ethical reorientation. First, the Law supplies accessible guidance. Even if the people by whom one is surrounded are poor examples, an individual is not utterly cut off from direction and guidance concerning virtue. The Law provides accessible guidance in a way that is not part of Aristotle’s view. If there are no persons around with practical wisdom, an Aristotelian agent may not be able to ascertain what is virtuous and good. The guidance of actual exemplars is likely to be vitally important to the cultivation and encouragement of virtue given Aristotle’s moral psychology. Maimonides also thought that exemplars and the prevailing norms of the community are crucial. However, the Law provides a measure for who is to count as an exemplar. Its guidance is accessible in a way for which there is no counterpart in Aristotle’s ethical view. In “Laws of Repentance” Maimonides writes, “If one desires to turn towards the good way and be righteous, he has the power to do” (Maimonides, “Laws of Repentance,” V, 1). He says, “Every person turns to the way which he desires, spontaneously and of his own volition” (“Laws of Repentance,” V, 2). In the Guide Maimonides writes, “If then the individual believed that this fracture [the tendency to sin] can never be remedied, he would persist in his error and sometimes perhaps disobey even more because of the fact that no stratagem remains at his disposal” (Guide, III, 36, p. 540).

The Law also includes guidance regarding the practices through which repentance is possible. It shows persons what is involved in the effort to re-orient oneself to virtue. Repentance is not simply a matter of decision. It requires certain kinds of recognition, reflective self-knowledge, knowledge of what is really good, not only apparently good, and knowledge of the practices required to re-turn to God and to attain virtue. Maimonides acknowledged the ‘inertia,’ so to speak, of second nature, while also holding that a person can radically redirect volition. There are many commandments concerning repentance. Thus, the agent who is genuinely motivated to make the effort can know what is needed in order to make an effective effort.

This more libertarian conception of free will, at least in contrast to Aristotle, is connected with moral epistemology and important issues in moral psychology. The ‘ought’ of the commandments implies that we can do what is required, and in order to do what is required, we need to know what is required. In fact, the notion that what the Law requires is not too hard for human beings to grasp is an important principle in Jewish thought. Maimonides agreed with Aristotle in regard to each person being born with a certain temperament and having specific propensities and susceptibilities through no choice or fault of one’s own. However, Maimonides had a more optimistic conception of the depth of change one can bring about in one’s character, made possible by and through fulfilling the commandments.

In Aristotle’s view, happiness is attainable by a human being if the individual is fortunate with respect to external conditions and with respect to habituation by others, and if one habituates oneself in a sound manner. The core of happiness depends upon the self-determined agency of the individual but certain external conditions are also required. For some, something like the happiness of the gods may even be attainable. However, in Aristotle’s view there is not a notion of redemption or providential history as there is in the Abrahamic faith-traditions. There is, however, something like blessedness—the favor of the gods—but it is not a clear counterpart to monotheistic providence. In Judaism, providence and redemption are closely connected with the notion of covenant. Through the covenant they have an enduring relation with God, to whom they answer for their sins and by whom their virtue is to be rewarded.

Many related topics, such as repentance, worship, the aspiration to be holy, and responsibilities with respect to other members of the national community are to be understood through their connections with covenant. Like Aristotle, Maimonides attached considerable importance to the community in which one lives and the ways in which the public, social world can influence character:

A disciple of wise men is not permitted to live in any city that does not have these ten things: a physician, a surgeon, a bathhouse, a bathroom, a fixed source of water such as a river or spring, a synagogue, a teacher of children, a scribe, a collector of charity, and a court that can punish with lashes and imprisonment (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 41).

These are all needed in order for a person to live well. In addition, “It is a positive commandment to cleave to the wise men in order to learn from their actions” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 47). This emphasis on the community is connected with covenant inasmuch as the commandments are a comprehensive guide to life and not just ethical guidance or guidance for worship. Jewish law extends to all sorts of aspects of life, and there are not clear, systematic distinctions between criminal law and torts or between law and religion or ethics and religious life.

The Talmud, which is the written version of the Oral Law, covers everything from agricultural practice, to marriage, to tithing, to criminal procedure and sentences, to contracts, forgiveness, sexuality, and so forth. Some commandments could not be fulfilled because of the destruction of the Temple and the lack of a self-determining political entity. But Maimonides did not therefore maintain that those portions of the Law were irrelevant or ceased to be integral. Rather, they would have to wait upon the restoration of the Temple.

We noted above that Maimonides had an intellectualist conception of human nature. In the final chapters of the Guide he emphasizes this and claims, “Thus it is clear that after apprehension, total devotion to Him and the employment of intellectual thought in constantly loving Him should be aimed at. Mostly this is achieved in solitude and isolation. Hence every excellent man stays frequently in solitude and does not meet anyone unless it is necessary” (Guide, III, 51, p. 621). In “Laws Concerning Character Traits” Maimonides indicates several respects in which a man should be preoccupied with thought of God, even to the extent of feigning attention to more mundane matters. This is not because it is perfectly all right to ignore one’s spouse or children or neighbors but, rather, because this is how a person guards against pride and distraction from the true and the good. Indulging in gossip, bearing a grudge, idol worship, and illicit sexual union are all examples of how one can be led down a bad path of aroused passions and desires, harming oneself and others. Accordingly, “[i]t is proper for a man to overlook all things of the world, for according to those who understand, everything is vain and empty and not worth taking vengeance for” (“Laws Concerning Character Traits,” p. 52).

10. The Issue of Esotericism

 

The question of the relation between philosophy and revealed religion in Maimonides’ thought has motivated considerable debate. The chief point of dispute is whether Maimonides actually held that the claims of revealed religion are untenable and that his works deliberately disguise his true convictions, namely that the claims of reason leave no place for revealed religion. Thus, advocates of the view maintain that there is a deep political purpose to a work such as the Guide; it supports the claims of revealed religion and its tradition by appearance only in order not to undermine and demoralize the many Jews for whom fidelity to the tradition shaped their world and their lives. Critics of the case for Maimonidean esotericism agree that Maimonides’ views are complex, involve apparent contradictions, and that he presents part of a line of reasoning in one place and other parts in other places without clear signals, especially in the Guide. However, they argue that there is a consistent, undisguised theme of explicating religion in philosophical terms because of his genuine commitment to philosophy and tradition.

Maimonides’ thought aroused controversy during and after his life, and it has influenced important philosophers in diverse ways. It is a rationalistic understanding of Judaism and at the same time it ascribes fundamental importance to tradition. It includes many distinctively medieval elements and aspects, yet it manages to remain relevant through the ways it formulates and addresses some of the most fundamental questions concerning philosophy, religion, and the relations between them.

11. Conclusion

 

Maimonides’ negative theology and the rationalistic valence of his thought influenced Aquinas, and later, Leibniz and Spinoza. Maimonides and Spinoza are similar in the respect that the relation between philosophy and theism in their thought is complex, controversial, and continues to motivate vigorous debate. In the context of the recently growing interest in more and more figures and periods of the history of philosophy, the medievals are certainly benefiting, being read and studied much more widely than, say, twenty-five or thirty years ago, no less fifty or a hundred years ago. A good deal of fine scholarship on Maimonides, and Spinoza too, has been published in the late twentieth and early twenty-first centuries, and much of it concerns the relations between philosophy and religion. Scholarly debates abound, and in the present discussion I have only hinted at some of the most important of them. One of the benefits of the increased attention to the history of philosophy is that increasing numbers of scholars and students of philosophy are recognizing the profound and ambitious originality of Maimonides’ thought. It is certainly not ‘Aristotle plus Judaism,’ a formulation that barely makes sense.

Maimonides developed an original, important conception of how a tradition anchored in revelation can be understood in philosophically rationalistic terms. As long as we are careful with jargon, we can say that he elaborated a broadly rationalistic conception of revealed religion, wringing out of it mystery, superstition, and any elements inconsistent with truths of reason. It is not difficult to see how his thought could have influenced seventeenth century rationalists.

Among them, Spinoza was a vehement critic of traditional Judaism, and yet there are respects in which his project and Maimonides’ share important features. Spinoza wanted to isolate and separate out from religion whatever rational truths may be embedded in it. In a sense, that is what Maimonides was doing though he argued that a great deal more of the concrete, practical content of the faith-tradition could be shown to be rationally justifiable. His anthropology was, perhaps, less optimistic than Spinoza’s. Maimonides and Spinoza were both centrally concerned with how we are to understand God and God’s relation to everything else. Their views of this matter diverge in decisive ways; after all, Spinoza held that God and nature are one, and Maimonides held that God transcends everything else so completely that we can only attain any understanding of God by way of a negative theology. But in each philosopher’s thought there is a crucial commitment to the notion that happiness depends upon understanding and that a human being’s deepest and most enduring gratifications are attained through disciplined desires and passions along with understanding. There is a deep-seated Stoic-like dimension to Spinoza’s thought, and though the metaphysics is very different from Spinoza’s, Maimonides’ thought also has some Stoic resonances in the way in which it understands relations between reason, freedom, perfection, and the enjoyment of them.

Maimonides was able to influence non-Jewish philosophers because his thought concerns themes and questions that are not ‘local’ to Judaism, even though the way that he pursues those themes and questions is deeply Jewish and attuned to details of Jewish tradition and Jewish life. Still, he understood Judaism as concerned with human perfection. For Maimonides fulfillment of the commandments and fidelity to tradition enable an individual to be perfected as a human being not merely as an excellent Jew. He insisted that no prophecy could exceed Moses’ and that Torah is a perfect instrument for guiding a person to perfection, but the notion of perfection involved in this view includes no element of mystery or an essentialism of a particular people.

In Maimonides’ view, being a Jew is a matter of a person’s ethical and intellectual convictions and commitments, rather than exclusively a matter of ethnicity or lineage. At the same time, the particular history and traditions of the Jewish people had fundamental significance to Maimonides. His philosophy is a powerful, intriguing, and challenging example of the project of finding and articulating universally significant principles, commitments, and ideals in the life and history of a particular people.

12. References and Further Reading

This is a selective bibliography. Maimonides himself wrote a great deal, and the number of works on Maimonides is extensive. This list includes Maimonides’ most important works relevant to philosophy and some of the most important scholarly and interpretive literature on Maimonides.

  • Berman, Lawrence V., “Maimonides, the Disciple of Alfarabi,” in J.A. Buijs (ed.), Maimonides: A Collection of Critical Essays, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1988.
  • Berman, Lawrence V., “Maimonides on the Fall of Man,” AJS Review, 5, 1980, pp. 1–16.
  • J. David Bleich, “Judaism and Natural Law,” The Jewish Law Annual, Vol. VII, 1988, pp. 5-42.
    • Bleich presents a helpful analysis of whether Maimonides’ ethical thought should be interpreted as a version of natural law theorizing.
  • David Burrell, Freedom and Creation in Three Traditions, Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1993.
    • The essays in this book supply illuminating comparisons of how some of the fundamental elements of Abrahamic monotheism are to be understood in Christian, Jewish, and Islamic thought. The author’s endorsement of Thomistic views on many of the issues comes across clearly.
  • Herbert Davidson, Moses Maimonides. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005.
  • Marvin Fox, Interpreting Maimonides, Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1990.
    • Fox’s interpretation of Maimonides is an attempt to explicate how his views are closer to a certain understanding of Orthodox Judaism than to philosophical views. While Fox’s analysis has been heavily criticized, it is valuable for how it explains Maimonides’ fidelity to religious orthodoxy.
  • Daniel Frank, ‘Reason in Action: The ‘Practicality of Maimonides’ Guide’ in Daniel H. Frank (ed.), Commandment and Community: New Essays in Jewish Legal and Political Philosophy, Albany: SUNY Press, 2002, pp. 69–84.
  • Daniel Frank, “Maimonides and Medieval Jewish Aristotelianism,” in The Cambridge Companion to Medieval Jewish Philosophy, eds., Daniel H. Frank, Oliver Leaman, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
  • Daniel Frank, Oliver Leaman, eds., The Cambridge Companion to Medieval Jewish Philosophy, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2003.
  • Saadia Gaon: The Book of Beliefs & Opinions, trans. by Samuel Rosenblatt, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1976.
    • Saadia set much of the agenda of medieval Jewish philosophy. While Maimonides criticizes him on various matters and objected to Saadia’s philosophical method, study of Saadia is very valuable for understanding the main concerns of medieval Jewish philosophy, especially the current of thought defending Judaism as a religion of reason.
  • Lenn E. Goodman, God of Abraham, New York: Oxford University Press, 1996.
    • This book is a helpful study of many of the main themes of Judaism as a monotheistic religion and Maimonides’ place in the elaboration of those themes.
  • Abraham Halkin and David Hartman, eds., Crisis and Leadership: Epistles of Maimonides, Philadelphia: Jewish Publication Society, 1985.
    • This work contains important shorter works of Maimonides and The Epistle to Yemen mentioned in Section 1 of this article.
  • David Hartman, Torah and Philosophic Quest, Philadelphia: The Jewish Publication Society, 1976.
  • Warren Zev Harvey, “A Portrait of Spinoza as a Maimonidean,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 19, 1981.
  • Barry Holtz, ed., Back to The Sources: Reading the Classic Jewish Texts, New York: Simon & Schuster, 1986.
    • An excellent collection of essays on the various texts central to Judaism that explains the places of Scripture, Talmud, Midrash, Kabbala, biblical commentary, and philosophical works in the Jewish tradition(s). This is very helpful on account of the large number of references Maimonides makes to several of these texts.
  • Isaac Husik, A History of Mediaeval Jewish Philosophy, New York, Macmillan, 1916.
    • This is a classic study still worth consulting despite being written nearly a century ago.
  • Jonathan Jacobs, Law, Reason, and Morality in Medieval Jewish Philosophy, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2010.
    • This work, focusing on Saadia, Maimonides, and Bahya ibn Pakuda, argues that many elements of their views remain relevant to fundamental questions of metaethics and moral psychology.
  • Jonathan Jacobs, ‘The Epistemology of Moral Tradition: A Defense of aMaimonidean Thesis,” Review of Metaphysics, 64, 1, September 2010, pp. 55-74.
    • Jacobs argues for the claim that Maimonides developed a view of the ‘non-evident rationality’ of tradition and that tradition can be a mode of access to objective ethical understanding.
  • Jonathan Jacobs, “The Reasons of the Commandments: Rational Tradition without Natural Law,” in Reason, Religion and Natural Law: Plato to Spinoza, ed. Jonathan Jacobs, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2012.
    • The author argues that while there are significant points of overlap between Maimonides’ ethical thought and natural law, there are important reasons not to interpret the former as a version of the latter. This has especially to do with the epistemic role of tradition in Maimonides’ thought.
  • Menachem Kellner, Maimonides on Human Perfection, Providence: Brown Judaic Studies, 1990.
    • This is a brief but valuable study of Maimonides’ intellectualist conception of human perfection.
  • Menachem Kellner, Maimonides on Judaism and the Jewish People, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1991.
    • This work explicates how Maimonides’ conception of Judaism differed from other, important conceptions by focusing on the role of intellectual commitments rather than a distinct nature or essence of the Jewish people.
  • Joel Kraemer, ed., Perspectives on Maimonides, Portland: Littman Library of Jewish Civilization, 1996.
  • Joel Kraemer, Maimonides: The Life and World of One of Civilization’s Greatest Minds, New York: Doubleday, 2008.
    • This is an important, recent biography exploring Maimonides’ life and thought in considerable detail.
  • Howard Kreisel, “Imitatio Dei in Maimonides’ Guide of the Perplexed,” AJS Review, 19/2, 1994, pp. 169-211.
  • Kreisel, Howard T., Maimonides’ Political Thought: Studies in Ethics, Lawand the Human Ideal, Albany: SUNY Press, 1999.
  • Kreisel, Howard T., Prophecy: The History of an Idea in Medieval Jewish Philosophy, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 2001.
  • Manekin, Charles, On Maimonides. Belmont, CA.: Wadsworth, 2005.
  • Moses Maimonides: “Eight Chapters,” in Ethical Writings of Maimonides, ed. by Raymond L. Weiss, Charles Butterworth, New York: Dover Publications, Inc., 1975.
    • In this work Maimonides presents many of the main elements of his account of moral psychology, virtue, and freedom of the will. The Aristotelian resonances are pronounced, but there are also important departures from Aristotle.
  • Moses Maimonides, “Laws Concerning Character Traits,” in Ethical Writings of Maimonides, ed. by Raymond L. Weiss, Charles Butterworth, New York: Dover Publications, Inc., 1975.
    • In this work the differences between Maimonides and Aristotle in regard to ethics are evident, especially regarding the role of the mean.
  • Moses Maimonides, “Laws of Repentance,” in Mishneh Torah Book of Knowledge, trans. by Moses Hyamson, Jerusalem: Feldheim Publishers, 1981.
    • In the course of presenting his account of repentance and what is required for it to be genuine, Maimonides also presents important claims and arguments regarding freedom of the will.
  • Moses Maimonides, Guide of the Perplexed trans. by Shlomo Pines, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1963.
  • Moses Maimonides, Mishneh Torah, “Hilkhot Avel,” 14:1, from A Maimonides Reader, ed. Isadore Twersky, Springfield: Behrman House, 1972.
  • Maimonides, “Basic Principles of the Torah,” Ch. 1, reprinted in A Maimonides Reader, ed. Isadore Twersky, Springfield, NJ: Behrman House, Inc., 1972.
  • Moses Maimonides, A Maimonides Reader, ed. Isadore Twersky, Springfield, NJ: Behrman House, Inc., 1972.
  • Moses Maimonides, Mishneh Torah, trans. Moses Hyamson, Jerusalem: Feldheim Publishers, 1981.
  • Moses Maimonides, Maimonides’ Introduction to His Commentary on the Mishnah, trans. Fred Rosner, Lanham, MD: Jason Aronson, 1994.
  • Louis Newman, “Ethics as Law, Law as Religion: Reflections on the Problem of Law and Ethics in Judaism,” in Contemporary Jewish Ethics and Morality, eds., Elliot N. Dorff, Louis E. Newman, New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
    • This and the following two works take up the issue of the relation between Jewish law and ethics, explicating key points of similarity and difference.
  • Louis Newman, “Law, Virtue, and Supererogation in the Halakha,” in Past Imperatives: Studies in the History and Theory of Jewish Ethics, Albany: SUNY Press, 1998.
  • David Novak, “Natural Law, Halakha, and the Covenant, in Contemporary Jewish Ethics and Morality, eds. Elliot N. Dorff, Louis E. Newman, New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
  • David Novak, Natural Law in Judaism, New York: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
    • Novak defends the view that Maimonides should be interpreted as holding a natural law approach to ethics, despite the fact that ‘natural law’ was not part of the idiom he used.
  • Tamar Rudavsky, “Natural Law in Judaism: A Reconsideration,” in Reason, Religion, and Natural Law: From Plato to Spinoza, ed. Jonathan Jacobs, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2012.
    • This essay defends the view that Maimonides’ ethical thought involved natural law elements. Rudavsky’s argument differs from Novak’s and does not include the Kantian elements found in Novak’s analysis.
  • Daniel Rynhold, An Introduction to Medieval Jewish Philosophy, London: I. B. Taurus & Co., Ltd., 2009.
  • Saadia Gaon, The Book of Beliefs & Opinions, trans., Samuel Rosenblatt, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1976.
  • Kenneth Seeskin, Searching For a Distant God: The Legacy of Maimonides, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
  • Kenneth Seeskin, “Metaphysics and Its Transcendence,” in The Cambridge Companion to Maimonides, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2005, p. 89.
  • Kenneth Seeskin, ed. The Cambridge Companion to Maimonides, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
    • This work contains chapters on all of the main topical areas of Maimonides’ philosophical thought.
  • David Shatz,  “Maimonides’ Moral Theory,” The Cambridge Companion to Maimonides, ed. Kenneth Sesskin, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2005, pp. 167-192.
  • M. S. Stern, “Al-Ghazali, Maimonides, and Ibn Paquda on Repentance: A Comparative Model,” Journal of the American Academy of Religion, XLVII/4, pp. 589-607.
    • Repentance is an important issue in all three of the Abrahamic monotheistic traditions, and this article examines some of the chief points of similarity between important Islamic and Jewish thinkers.
  • Shubert Spero, Morality, Halakha and the Jewish Tradition, New York: KTAV Publishing House, Inc., 1983.
  • Baruch Spinoza, TheologicalPolitical Treatise, 2nd ed., trans., Samuel Shirley, Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, Inc., 2007.
    • Spinoza was a harsh critic of traditional Judaism and this work contains important elements of his critique while also exhibiting aspects of Maimonides’ influence on Spinoza.
  • Leo Strauss,  “The Literary Character of the Guide for the Perplexed,” in Persecution and the Art of Writing. Glencoe, IL, The Free Press, 1952.
    • Leo Strauss has been a key voice in making the argument for the esotericism of Maimonides’ writings. Readers interested in the debate concerning esotericism may wish to consult Strauss’s works.
  • Leo Strauss, Philosophy and Law: Contributions to the Understanding of Maimonides and His Predecessors, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1995.
  • Sarah Stroumsa, Maimonides in His World, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2009.
  • Isadore Twersky, Introduction to the Code of Maimonides, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1980.
    • This is an in-depth study of Maimonides’ conception of the relation between law (the commandments) and philosophy. Twersky explains Maimonides’ view that Torah contains philosophical wisdom and how that philosophical wisdom can be found and elaborated.
  • Isadore Twersky, ed., Studies in Maimonides, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Center for Jewish Studies, 1990.

 

Author Information

Jonathan Jacobs
Email: jojacobs@jjay.cuny.edu
City University of New York
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Religion

Philosophy of religion is the philosophical study of the meaning and nature of religion. It includes the analyses of religious concepts, beliefs, terms, arguments, and practices of religious adherents. The scope of much of the work done in philosophy of religion has been limited to the various theistic religions. More recent work often involves a broader, more global approach, taking into consideration both theistic and non-theistic religious traditions. The range of those engaged in the field of philosophy of religion is broad and diverse and includes philosophers from the analytic and continental traditions, Eastern and Western thinkers, religious believers and agnostics, skeptics and atheists. Philosophy of religion draws on all of the major areas of philosophy as well as other relevant fields, including theology, history, sociology, psychology, and the natural sciences.

There are a number of themes that fall under the domain of philosophy of religion as it is commonly practiced in academic departments in North America and Europe. The focus here will be limited to six: (1) religious language and belief, (2) religious diversity, (3) concepts of God / Ultimate Reality, (4) arguments for and against the existence of God, (5) problems of evil and suffering, and (6) miracles.

Table of Contents

  1. Religious Language and Belief
    1. Logical Positivism
    2. Realism and Non-realism
  2. Religious Diversity
    1. Religious Pluralism
    2. Religious Relativism
    3. Religious Exclusivism
  3. Concepts of God/Ultimate Reality
  4. Arguments for and against the Existence of God
    1. Ontological Arguments
    2. Cosmological Arguments
    3. Teleological Arguments
    4. The Challenge of Science
    5. The Coherence of Theism
  5. Problems of Evil and Suffering
    1. Logical Problems
    2. Evidential Problems
    3. Theodicy
    4. The Hiddenness of God
    5. Karma and Reincarnation
  6. Miracles
  7. Conclusion
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Religious Language and Belief

a. Logical Positivism

The practice of philosophy, especially in the analytic tradition, places emphasis on precision of terms and clarity of concepts and ideas. Religious language is often vague, imprecise, and couched in mystery. In the twentieth century this linguistic imprecision was challenged by philosophers who used a principle of verifiability to reject as meaningless all non-empirical claims. For these logical positivists, only the tautologies of mathematics and logic, along with statements containing empirical observations or inferences, were taken to be meaningful. Many religious statements, including those about God, are neither tautological nor empirically verifiable. So a number of religious claims, such as “Yahweh is compassionate” or “Atman is Brahman,” were considered by the positivists to be cognitively meaningless. When logical positivism became prominent mid-century, philosophy of religion as a discipline became suspect.

By the latter half of the twentieth century, however, many philosophers came to the conclusion that the positivists’ radical empiricist claims and verificationist criteria of meaning were problematic or self-refuting. This development, along with other factors including the philosophical insights on the nature and meaning of language offered by Ludwig Wittgenstein (1889–1951) and the rise of a pragmatic version of naturalism offered by W. V. O. Quine (1908–2000), caused logical positivism to wane. By the 1970s verificationism virtually collapsed, and philosophical views that had been suppressed, including those having to do with religion and religious language, were once again fair game for philosophical discourse. With the work of certain analytic philosophers of religion, including Basil Mitchell (1917–2011), H. H. Farmer (1892–1981), Alvin Plantinga (1932–), Richard Swinburne (1934–), and John Hick (1922–), religious language and concepts were revived and soon became accepted arenas of viable philosophical and religious discourse and debate.

b. Realism and Non-realism

After the collapse of positivism, two streams emerged in philosophy of religion regarding what religious language and beliefs are about: realism and non-realism. The vast majority of religious adherents are religious realists. Realists, as used in this context, are those who hold that their religious beliefs are about what actually exists, independent of the persons who hold those beliefs. Assertions about Allah or Brahman, angels or demons, resurrection or reincarnation, for example, are true because, in part,  there are actual referents for the words “Allah,” “Brahaman,” and so forth. The implication is that statements about them can and do provide correct predications of the behavior of Allah and Brahman and so forth. If Allah or Brahman do not actually exist, assertions about them would be false. Non-realists are those who hold that religious claims are not about realities that transcend human language, concepts, and social forms; religious claims are not about realities “out there”; they are not about objectively existing entities. Religion is a human construct and religious language refers to human behavior and experience.

An important figure who had much influence on the development of religious non-realism was Ludwig Wittgenstein. In his later works, Wittgenstein understood language to be not a fixed structure directly corresponding to the way things actually are, but rather a human activity susceptible to the vicissitudes of human life and practice. Language does not provide a picture of reality, he argued, but rather presents a set of activities which he dubbed “language games.” In learning language, one needs to be able to respond to words in various contexts; speech and action work together. In many cases, then, the meaning of a word is its use in the language. For Wittgenstein, this is true in all forms of discourse, including religious discourse. In speaking of God or other religious terms or concepts, their meanings have more to do with their use than with their denotation. The language games of the religions reflect the practices and forms of life of the various religious adherents; religious statements should not be taken as providing literal descriptions of a reality that somehow lies beyond those activities.

Some non-realists have been highly critical of religion, such as Sigmund Freud (1856–1939). Others, such as Don Cupitt (1934–), have sought to transform religion. Cupitt, a philosopher, theologian, and former priest in the Church of England, rejects historic religious dogma for, he maintains, it encompasses an outdated realist metaphysics and cosmology. He also abandons the notion of objective and eternal truth and replaces it with truth as a human improvisation. His approach to religion is to translate dogma and doctrine into a spirituality of practice where they become guiding myths to live by in this life, and they lead the believer to give up belief in a supernatural afterlife beyond the grave.

Non-realists have noted the alleged failure of realism to provide evidences or justifications for the truths of any particular religion, or of religion in general, and argue that projects in natural theology—the attempt to demonstrate the existence of God from evidence found in the natural world—are abject failures. Another point made by non-realists is that, since religious claims and practices are always done within a particular human context, and since the mind structures all perception within that context, the meanings of these claims are determined and limited by that context. To affirm a transcendent realm is to go beyond these contexts and structures.

Various responses to these claims have been offered by religious realists. Regarding the claim that there is no rational justification for religious beliefs, some realists agree. Nevertheless, these fideists claim that religion does not require evidence and justification; religion is about faith and trust, not evidence. Other realists, sometimes referred to as evidentialists, disagree and claim that while faith is fundamental to religion, or at least to some religions, there are in fact good arguments and evidences for religious truth claims. Yet another group of realists are commonly referred to as “Reformed epistemologists” (the term “Reformed” refers to the Christian, Calvinist Reformation theological tradition). Three of its leading proponents are Alvin Plantinga (1932–), Nicholas Wolterstorff (1932–), and William Alston (1921–). Reformed epistemology is non-evidentialist as it asserts that evidence (in the sense that evidentialists use the term) is not required in order for one’s faith to be justified. Unlike fideism, though, its adherents maintain that belief in God can be a rational endeavor despite a lack of evidence. This is contrary to the evidentialist approach in which it is irrational to believe a claim without evidence. It is also unlike evidentialism in that its adherents are generally opposed to classical foundationalism—the view that all justified beliefs must either be properly basic or derivative of properly basic beliefs.

Regarding the claim that religious statements, concepts, and beliefs exist only within a given social context, some realists have responded by noting that, while much of what occurs in religious discourse and practice is of human origin, one need not affirm a reductionist stance in which all religious meanings and symbols are reducible to human constructs.

2. Religious Diversity

In the West, most work done in philosophy of religion historically has been theistic. More recently, there has been a growing interest in religions and religious themes beyond the scope of theism. While awareness of religious diversity is not a new phenomenon, philosophers of religion from both the East and the West are becoming increasingly more aware of and interactive with religious others. It is now common to see contributions in Western philosophy of religion literature on various traditions, including Hinduism, Buddhism, Daoism, Confucianism, and African religions.

While interest in Eastern religion and comparative religion have brought about a deeper understanding of and appreciation for the different non-theistic religious traditions, it has also brought to the fore an awareness of the many ways the different traditions conflict. Consider some examples: for Buddhists there is no creator God, whereas Muslims affirm that the universe was created by the one true God, Allah; for Advaita Vedanta Hindus, the concept of Ultimate Reality is pantheistic monism in which only Brahman exists, whereas Christians affirm theistic dualism in which God exists as distinct from human beings and the other created entities; for Muslims and Christians, salvation is the ultimate goal whereby human beings are united with God forever in the afterlife, while the Buddhists’ ultimate goal is nirvana—an extinguishing of the individual self and complete extinction of all suffering. Many other examples could be cited as well. For the realist, at least, not all of these claims can be true. How is one to respond to this diversity of fundamental beliefs?

a. Religious Pluralism

One response to religious diversity is to deny or minimize the doctrinal conflicts and to maintain that doctrine itself is not as important for religion as religious experience and that the great religious traditions are equally authentic responses to Ultimate Reality. This is one form of religious pluralism. Its most ardent defender has been John Hick. Utilizing Immanuel Kant’s (1724–1804) distinctions of noumena (things as they are in themselves) and phenomena (things as they are experienced), Hick argues that a person’s experiences, religious and non-religious, depend on the interpretive frameworks and concepts through which one’s mind structures and comprehends them. While some people experience and comprehend Ultimate Reality in personal, theistic categories (as Allah or Yahweh, to mention two), others do so in impersonal, pantheistic ways (as nirguna Brahman, for example). Yet others experience and comprehend Ultimate Reality as non-personal and non-pantheistic (as Nirvana or the Tao). We do not know which view is ultimately correct (if any of them are, and for Hick Ultimate Reality is far beyond human conceptions) since we do not have a “God’s eye” perspective by which to make such an assessment. One common illustration of the pluralist position of experiencing God is the Hindu parable of the blind men and the elephant. In this parable, God is like an elephant surrounded by several blind men. One man felt the elephant’s tail and believed it to be a rope. Another felt his trunk and believed it to be a snake. Another felt his leg and believed it to be a tree. Yet another felt his side and believed it to be a wall. Each of them experience the same elephant but in very different ways from the others. In our experiences and understandings of Ultimate Reality, we are very much like the blind men, argue such religious pluralists, for our beliefs and viewpoints are constricted by our enculturated concepts.

Hick argues for what he calls the “pluralistic hypothesis”: that Ultimate Reality is ineffable and beyond our understanding but that its presence can be experienced through various spiritual practices and linguistic systems offered within the religions. The great world religions, then, constitute very different but equally valid ways of conceiving, experiencing, and responding to Ultimate Reality. He uses different analogies to describe his hypothesis, including an ambiguous picture of a duck-rabbit. A culture that has ducks but no familiarity with rabbits would see the ambiguous diagram as a duck. People in this culture would not even be aware of the ambiguity. So too with the culture that has rabbits but no familiarity with ducks. People in this culture would see the diagram as a rabbit. Hick’s point is that the ineffable is experienced in the different traditions as Vishnu, or as Allah, or as Yahweh, or as the Tao, and so on, depending on one’s individual and cultural concepts.

One objection to pluralism of this sort is that it leads to a dilemma, neither horn of which pluralists will want to affirm. On the one hand, if we do not have concepts that are in fact referring to Ultimate Reality as it is in itself, then we have landed in religious skepticism. On the other hand, if we do have concepts that describe actual properties of Ultimate Reality, then we are not epistemically blind after all, and therefore we could, theoretically at least, be in a position to make evaluations about different claims that are made about Ultimate Reality from the various religious traditions.

Another version of religious pluralism attempts to avoid some of the difficulties of the pluralistic hypothesis. For the aspectual pluralist, there is an objective Ultimate Reality which can be knowable to us. Unlike the pluralistic hypothesis, and in very non-Kantian fashion, valid descriptions of the noumenal are possible. Peter Byrne argues that each of the different major religious traditions reflects some aspect of the transcendent. Byrne uses the notion of natural kinds in order to clarify his view. Just as the natural kind gold has an unobservable essence as well as observable properties or qualities—being yellow, lustrous, and hard—so too Ultimate Reality has an essence with different experienced manifestations. Ultimate Reality manifests different aspects of itself in the different religions given their own unique conceptual schemes and practices.

One challenge to this form of pluralism is that, since each of the religions is capturing only an aspect of the transcendent, it seems that one would obtain a better understanding of its essence by creating a new syncretistic religion in order to glean a more comprehensive understanding of Ultimate Reality. Also, since religious adherents are only glimpsing the transcendent through properties which are themselves enculturated within the various traditions, descriptions of Ultimate Reality cannot offer adequate knowledge claims about it. So one is left with at least a mitigated form of religious skepticism.

b. Religious Relativism

A second way of responding to the conflicting claims of the different traditions is to remain committed to the truth of one set of religious teachings while at the same time agreeing with some of the central concerns raised by pluralism. Religious relativism provides such a response. For religious relativism, as articulated by Joseph Runzo, the correctness of a religion is relative to the worldview of its community of adherents. On this view, each of the religious traditions are comprised of various experiences and mutually incompatible truth claims, and the traditions are themselves rooted in distinct worldviews that are incompatible with, if not contradictory to, the other worldviews. Runzo maintains that these differing experiences and traditions emerge from the plurality of phenomenal realities experienced by the adherents of the traditions. On this relativistic view, one’s worldview—that is, one’s total cognitive web of interrelated concepts and beliefs—determines how one comprehends and experiences Ultimate Reality. Furthermore, there are incompatible yet adequate truth claims that correspond to the various worldviews, and the veracity of a religion is determined by its adequacy to appropriately correspond to the worldview within which it is subsumed. An important difference between the religious relativist and the pluralist is that, for the relativist and not the pluralist, truth itself is understood to be relative.

Relativism may offer a more coherent account of religious conflict than pluralism, but it can be argued that it falls short of the actual beliefs of religious adherents. For most religious adherents, their beliefs are generally understood to be true in an objective sense. This leads to the third, and most commonly held, response to conflicting religious claims.

c. Religious Exclusivism

In contrast to pluralism and relativism is a third response to the conflicting truth claims of the religions: exclusivism. The term is used in different ways in religious discourse, but a common element is that the central tenets of one religion are true, and claims which are incompatible with those tenets are false. Another common and related element is that salvation is found exclusively in one religion. Regarding the truth claim, for example, for a Muslim exclusivist, Allah is the one true God who literally spoke to the prophet Muhammad in space and time. Since that is true, then the Advaita Vedantan claim that Brahman (God) is nirguna—without attributes—must be false, for these two understandings of Ultimate Reality contradict one another. The same is the case for all religious exclusivists; since they take their religious claims to be objectively true, the contrary claims of other religions are false. This does not mean that exclusivists are not self-critical of their own beliefs, nor does it rule out the practice of dialoguing with or learning from religious others. But it does mean that religious differences are real and that there are intractable disagreements among religious traditions. Religious exclusivism (of which Alvin Plantinga is one prominent example) has been the most widely held position among the adherents of the major world religions.

Various responses have been made to exclusivism, including moral objections (such as that the exclusivist is arrogant, dishonest, oppressive) and intellectual and epistemic objections (including claims that the exclusivist holds unjustified or irrational beliefs).

3. Concepts of God/Ultimate Reality

A major theme among philosophers of religion in the West has been that of God, including questions about the nature and existence of God, challenges to the existence of God, language about God, and so on. Within every major religion is a belief about a transcendent reality underlying the natural, physical world. From its beginnings, philosophy of religion has been concerned with reflecting on, as far as possible, how religions might understand Ultimate Reality. How the various religions conceptualize that reality differs, especially between Eastern and Western religions. In Western religion, primarily the three religions of Abrahamic descent—Judaism, Christianity, and Islam—Ultimate Reality is conceived of and described in terms of a personal God who is creator and sustainer of all and perfect in every respect. Many other properties are commonly attributed to God as well, including omniscience, omnipotence, and immutability.

In much of Eastern religion, including Buddhism, Taoism, and the Advaita Vedanta school of Hinduism, Ultimate Reality is understood quite differently. It is not a personal creator God, but an absolute state of being. It cannot be described by a set of attributes, such as omniscience or omnipotence, for it is undifferentiated Absolute Reality. Taoists refer to it as the Tao; Hindus refer to it as Brahman; for Buddhists, the name varies and includes Shunyata and Nirvana. These different conceptions of Ultimate Reality bring with them distinct understandings of other significant issues as well, such as salvation/liberation, life after death, and evil and suffering, among others.

There is a recent view of Ultimate Reality articulated by philosopher of religion John Schellenberg that he has dubbed “ultimism,” which is neither theistic nor pantheistic. According to this view, the best one can do from a religious perspective is to have faith that there exists a metaphysically and axiologically ultimate reality and that from this reality an ultimate good can be attained.

4. Arguments for and against the Existence of God

It is generally the case that religious adherents do not hold their religious convictions because of well-articulated reasons or arguments which support those convictions. However, reasons and arguments are sometimes used by believers to defend and advance their positions. Arguments for the existence of God have been utilized in natural theology and theistic apologetics for at least two millennia. Three which have been prominent historically and still receive special attention in contemporary philosophy of religion discussions are the ontological, cosmological, and teleological arguments.

a. Ontological Arguments

First developed by Saint Anselm of Canterbury (1033–1109), ontological arguments take various forms. They are unique among traditional arguments for God’s existence in that they are a priori arguments, for they are based on premises that can allegedly be known independently of experience of the world. All of them begin with the concept of God and conclude that God must exist. If successful, ontological arguments prove that God’s non-existence is impossible.

Anselm argues that God is a being than which none greater can be conceived. It is one thing to exist in the mind (in the understanding) and another to exist outside the understanding (outside one’s thoughts; in reality). He then asks which is greater: to exist in the mind or in reality. His argument concludes this way:

Therefore, if that, than which nothing greater can be conceived, exists in the understanding alone, the very being, than which nothing greater can be con­ceived, is one, than which a greater can be conceived. But obviously this is impossible. Hence, there is no doubt that there exists a being, than which nothing greater can be conceived, and it exists both in the understanding and in reality. (Proslogion, chapter II, 54)

Since it would be a contradiction to affirm that the greatest possible being does not exist in reality but only in the mind (because existing in reality is greater than existing in the mind), one is logically drawn to the conclusion that God must exist.

There have been many objections to this argument. One of the most well-known is based on the analogy of the greatest possible island and was developed by Anselm’s fellow monk, Gaunilo. Utilizing a reductio ad absurdum, he argued that if we affirm Anselm’s conclusion, we must also affirm that the greatest possible island exists. Since that conclusion is absurd, so too is Anselm’s. Another important objection offered by Immanuel Kant was that existence is not a real predicate. Since existence does not add to the concept of a thing, and in Anselm’s argument existence is treated as a real predicate (rather than, say, as a quantifier), the argument is flawed.

Recent modal versions of the argument have been construed that avoid the objections to Anselm’s original formulation. Alvin Plantinga, for example, has devised a version of the ontological argument utilizing the semantics of modal logic: possibility, necessity, and possible worlds (a possible world being a world that is logically possible). Defining a maximally excellent being as one that is omniscient, omnipotent, and morally perfect in every possible world, his argument can be stated this way:

(1)   It is possible that a being exists which is maximally great (a being that we can call God).

(2)   So there is a possible world in which a maximally great being exists.

(3)   A maximally great being is necessarily maximally excellent in every possible world (by definition).

(4)   Since a maximally great being is necessarily maximally excellent in every possible world, that being is necessarily maximally excellent in the actual world.

(5)   Therefore, a maximally great being (for example, God) exists in the actual world.

Plantinga does not affirm that the argument provides conclusive proof that God exists, but he does claim that there is nothing irrational in accepting it.

Many objections have been raised against Plantinga’s modal ontological argument, including problems with possible worlds semantics, that God’s existence is a logical or metaphysical impossibility, and that it leads to metaphysical absurdities. Regarding the latter, Michael Martin (1932–), offers the following reductio:

(1’) It is possible that a special fairy exists.

(2’) So there is a possible world in which a special fairy exists.

(3’) A special fairy is necessarily a tiny woodland creature with magical powers in

every possible world (by definition).

(4’) Since a special fairy is necessarily a tiny woodland creature with magical powers

in every possible world, that fairy is necessarily a tiny woodland creature with

magical powers in the actual world.

(5’) Therefore, a special fairy exists in the actual world.

Martin then argues that premise (1’) is no more contrary to reason than premise (1), so if we affirm (1) and conclude that (5), we must also affirm (1’) and conclude that (5’). Given this argument structure, we could also conclude that ghosts, gremlins, and countless other mythical creatures exist as well, which is absurd.

b. Cosmological Arguments

Cosmological arguments begin by examining some empirical or metaphysical fact of the universe, from which it then follows that something outside the universe must have caused it to exist. There are different types of cosmological arguments, and its defenders include some of the most prominent thinkers spanning the history of philosophy, including Plato, Aristotle, ibn Sina, al-Ghazali, Maimonides, Aquinas, Descartes, and Leibniz. Three versions of the argument that have received much attention are the Thomistic contingency argument, the Leibnizian sufficient reason argument, and the kalam argument.

With the Thomistic contingency argument, named after the medieval Christian theologian/philosopher Thomas Aquinas (1225–1274), the claim is made that contingent things exist in the world—“contingent things” ostensibly referring to those entities which begin to exist and cease to exist and whose existence is dependent on another. It is next argued that not all things can be contingent, for if they were there would be nothing to ground their existence. Only a necessary thing (or being) can account for the existence of contingent things—“necessary thing” ostensibly referring to a thing which never began to exist and which cannot cease to exist and whose existence does not depend on another. This necessary thing (or being) is God.

Another type of cosmological argument is the Leibnizian sufficient reason argument, so named after the German thinker Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646–1716). With this argument, an answer is sought to the question “Why is there something rather than nothing?” For Leibniz, there must be an explanation, or “sufficient reason,” for anything that exists, and the explanation for whatever exists must lie either in the necessity of its own nature or in a cause external to itself. The argument concludes that the explanation of the universe must lie in a transcendent God since the universe does not have within its own nature the necessity of existence and God does.

Some recent versions of the cosmological argument grant that contingent things exist due to the causal events of other contingent things, but they then go on to inquire why the universe should exist at all when conceivably this could have not been the case. Utilizing elements of both Aquinas’s and Leibniz’s arguments, the central point of these recent versions is that with respect to anything that exists, there is a reason for its existence. What provides a sufficient reason for the existence of the universe? It cannot be another contingent thing (and on into infinity), for to explain the existence of any contingent thing by another contingent thing lacks a sufficient reason why any contingent thing exists. Timothy O’Connor argues this way:

If our universe truly is contingent, the obtaining of certain fundamental facts or other will be unexplained within empirical theory, whatever the topological structure of contingent reality. An infinite regress of beings in or outside the spatiotemporal universe cannot forestall such a result. If there is to be an ultimate, or complete, explanation, it will have to ground in some way the most fundamental, contingent facts of the universe in a necessary being, something which has the reason for its existence within its own nature. It bears emphasis that such an unconditional explanation need not in any way compete with conditional, empirical explanations. Indeed, it is natural to suppose that empirical explanations will be subsumed within the larger structure of the complete explanation. (Theism and Ultimate Explanation: The Necessary Shape of Contingency. Oxford, Blackwell, 2008, 76)

An objection raised against both the Thomistic- and the Leibnizian-type arguments is that they are demanding explanations which are unwarranted. If for every individual contingent thing in the universe there is an explanation, why does the whole need a further explanation? Furthermore, an explanation must at some point come to an end—a brute fact. So why not end with the universe? Why posit some further transcendent reality?

Another form of cosmological argument is commonly referred to as the kalam argument (the term “kalam” is from medieval Islamic theology and came to mean “speculative theology”). The argument is structured by William Lane Craig, its most ardent proponent in recent times, as follows:

universe

/                  \

beginning                        no beginning

/                   \

caused                       not caused

/           \

personal                 not personal

The dilemmas are obvious. Either the universe had a beginning or it did not. If it did, either that beginning was caused or it was not caused. If it was caused, either the cause was personal or it was impersonal. Based on these dilemmas, the argument can be put in the following logical form:

  1. Whatever begins to exist has a cause of its existence.
  2. The universe began to exist.
  3. Therefore, the universe has some kind of cause of its existence.
  4. The cause of the universe is either an impersonal cause or a personal one.
  5. The cause of the universe is not impersonal.
  6. Therefore, the cause of the universe is a personal one, which we call God.

This version of the cosmological argument was bolstered by work in astrophysics and cosmology in the late twentieth century. On one interpretation of the standard Big Bang cosmological model, the time-space universe sprang into existence ex nihilo approximately 13.7 billion years ago. Such a beginning is best explained, argue kalam defenders, by a non-temporal, non-spatial, personal, transcendent cause—namely God.

The claim that the universe began to exist is also argued philosophically in at least two ways. First, it is argued that an actual infinite set of events cannot exist, for actual infinities lead to metaphysical absurdities. Since an infinite temporal regress of events is an actual infinite set of events, such a regress is metaphysically impossible. So the past cannot be infinite; the universe must have had a temporal beginning. A second approach begins by arguing that an infinite series of events cannot be formed by successive addition (one member being added to another). The reason why is that, when adding finite numbers one after the other, the set of numbers will always be finite. The addition of yet another finite number, ad infinitum, will never lead to an actual infinite. Since the past is a series of temporal events formed by successive addition, the past could not be actually infinite in duration. Nor will the future be so. The universe must have had a beginning.

Many objections have been raised against the kalam argument, both scientific and philosophical, including that there are other cosmological models of the universe besides the Big Bang in which the universe is understood to be eternal, such as various multi-verse theories. Philosophical rebuttals marshaled against the kalam argument include the utilization of set theory and mathematical systems which employ actual infinite sets.

c. Teleological Arguments

Teleological arguments in the East go back as far as 100 C.E., where the Nyāya school in India argued for the existence of a deity based on the order found in nature. In the West, Plato, Aristotle, and the Stoics offered arguments for a directing intelligence of the world given the order found within it. There is an assortment of teleological arguments, but a common theme among them is the claim that certain characteristics of the natural world reflect design, purpose, and intelligence. These features of the natural world are then used as evidence for an intelligent, intentional designer of the world.

The teleological argument has been articulated and defended at various times and places throughout history, but its zenith was in the early nineteenth century with perhaps its most ardent defender: William Paley (1743–1805). In his book, Natural Theology, Paley offers an argument from analogy: since we infer a designer of an artifact such as a watch, given its evident purpose, ordered structure, and complexity, so too we should infer a grand designer of the works of nature, since they are even greater in terms of their evident purpose, order, and complexity—what he describes as “means ordered to ends.” Paley’s argument can be structured this way:

  1. Artifacts (such as a watch), with their means to ends configurations, are the products of (human) design.
  2. The works of nature, such as the human hand, resemble artifacts.
  3. Thus the works of nature are probably the products of design.
  4. Furthermore, the works of nature are much more in number and far greater in complexity.
  5. Therefore, the works of nature were probably the products of a grand designer—one much more powerful and intelligent than a human designer.

A number of objections have been raised against Paley’s version of the design argument. Those offered by David Hume (1711–1776) in his Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion are often taken to be archetype refutations of traditional design arguments. Among them are that the analogy between the works of nature and human artifacts is not particularly strong; that even if we could infer a grand designer of the universe, this designer turns out to be something less than the God of the theistic religions (especially given the great amount of evil in the world); and that just because a universe has the appearance of design, it does not follow that it is in fact designed; such an event could have occurred through natural, chance events.

A more recent version of the design argument is based on the apparent fine-tuning of the cosmos. Fine-tuning arguments, whose current leading defender is Robin Collins, include the claims that the laws of nature, the constants of physics, and the initial conditions of the universe are finely tuned for conscious life. Often cited as evidence are several dozen “cosmic constants” whose parameters are such that if they were altered even slightly, conscious life would be impossible. Consider the following three: (1) If the strong nuclear force (the force that binds protons and neutrons in an atom) had been either stronger or weaker by five percent, life would be impossible; (2) If neutrons were not roughly 1.001 times the mass of protons, all protons would have decayed into neutrons, or vice versa, and life would be impossible; (3) If gravity had been stronger or weaker by one part in 1040, life-sustaining stars, including the sun, could not exist; thus life would most likely be impossible. While each of the individual calculations of such constants may not be fully accurate, it is argued that the significant number of them, coupled with their independence from one other, provides evidence of their being intentionally established with conscious life in mind.

Objections to fine-tuning arguments are multifarious. According to an anthropic principle objection, if the laws of nature and physical constants would have varied to any significant degree, there would be no conscious observers such as ourselves. Given that such observers do exist, it should not be surprising that the laws and constants are just as they are. One way of accounting for such observers is the many-worlds hypothesis. In this view, there exist a large number of universes, perhaps an infinite number of them. Most of these universes include life-prohibiting parameters, but at least a minimal number of them would probably include life-permitting ones. It should not be surprising that one of them, ours, for example, is life-permitting. Much of the current fine-tuning discussion turns on the plausibility of the many-worlds hypothesis and the anthropic principle.

There are other versions of the teleological argument that have also been proposed which focus not on fundamental parameters of the cosmos but on different aspects of living organisms—including their emergence, alleged irreducibly complex systems within living organisms, information intrinsic within DNA, and the rise of consciousness—in an attempt to demonstrate intelligent, intentional qualities in the world. These biological and noölogical design arguments have not generally received as much attention as the fine-tuning argument by those engaged in natural theology or by the broader philosophical community.

Other arguments for the existence of God (or theism) include the moral argument, the argument from mind, the argument from religion experience, and Pascal’s wager. One common objection to the traditional arguments for God’s existence is that even if they are successful, they do not prove the existence of the deity of any particular religion. If successful, the cosmological argument only provides evidence for a transcendent first cause of the universe, nothing more; at best, the teleological argument provides evidence for a purposive, rational designer of the universe, nothing more; and so on. These conclusions are very different from the God (or gods) depicted in the Qur’an, or the Bible, or the Vedas.

Natural theologians maintain, however, that the central aim of these arguments is not to offer full-blown proofs of any particular deity, but rather to provide evidence or warrant for belief in a grand designer, or creator, or moral lawgiver. Some natural theologians argue that it is best to combine the various arguments in order to provide a cumulative case for a broad form of theism. Cosmological arguments provide insight into God’s creative providence; teleological arguments provide insight into God’s purposive nature and grand intelligence; and moral arguments provide insight into God’s moral nature and character. Taken together, these natural theologians argue, the classical arguments offer a picture of a deity not unlike the God of the theistic religious traditions and even if this approach does not prove the existence of any particular deity, it does nonetheless lend support to theism over naturalism (which, as used here, is the view that natural entities have only natural causes, and that the world is fully describable by the physical sciences).

Along with arguments for the existence of God, there are also a number of reasons one might have for denying the existence of God. One reason is that a person just does not find the arguments for God’s existence to be sufficiently compelling. If the burden is on the theist to provide highly convincing evidences or reasons that would warrant his or her believing that God exists, in the absence of such evidences and reasons disbelief is justified. Another reason one might have for not believing that God exists is that science conflicts with theistic beliefs and, given the great success of the scientific enterprise, it should have the last word on the matter. Since science has regularly rebuffed religious claims in the past, we should expect the claims of religion to eventually become extinct. A third possible reason for denying the existence of God is that the very concept of God is incoherent. And a fourth reason one might have is that the existence of God conflicts with various features of the natural world, such as evil, pain, and suffering.

d. The Challenge of Science

Over the last several hundred years there has been tremendous growth in scientific understanding of the world in such fields as biology, astronomy, physics, and geology. These advances have had considerable influence on religious belief. When religious texts, such as the Bible, have been in conflict with science, the latter has generally been the winner in the debate; religious beliefs have commonly given way to the power of the scientific method. For example, the three-tiered universe held by the biblical authors, with heaven above the sky, hell below the earth, and the sun moving around the earth (and with the sun stopping its rotation during battle at Joshua’s command), is no longer plausible given what we now know. It has seemed to some that modern science will be able to explain all of the fundamental questions of life with no remainder.

Given the advances of science and the retreat of religious beliefs, many in the latter half of the twentieth century agreed with the general Freudian view that a new era was on the horizon in which the infantile illusions, or perhaps delusions, of religion would soon go the way of the ancient Greek and Roman gods. With the onset of the twenty-first century, however, a new narrative has emerged. Religion has not fallen into oblivion, as many anticipated; in fact, religious belief is on the rise. Many factors account for this, including challenges to psychological and sociological theories which hold belief in God to be pathological or neurotic. In recent decades these theories have themselves been challenged by medical and psychological research, being understood by many to be theories designed primarily to destroy belief in God. Another important factor is the increase in the number of believing and outspoken scientists, such as Francis Collins, the director of the human genome project.

At the other end of the spectrum regarding religion, however, is a fairly small but vocal band of intellectual atheists who have spawned a movement dubbed the “New Atheism.” These atheists, whose leading voices include Richard Dawkins, Christopher Hitchens, Sam Harris, and Daniel Dennett, attempt to demonstrate that respect for belief in God is irrational and socially unacceptable. But despite this orchestrated opposition arguing the falsity and incoherence of theism, it has proved rather resilient. Indeed, the twenty-first century is reflecting a renewed interest in philosophical theism.

e. The Coherence of Theism

Philosophical challenges to theism have also included the claim that the very concept of God makes no sense—that the attributes ascribed to God are logically incoherent (either individually or collectively). There are first-rate philosophers today who argue that theism is coherent and others of equal stature who argue that theism is incoherent. Much of the criticism of the concept of theism has focused on God as understood in Judaism, Christianity, and Islam, but it is also relevant to the theistic elements found within Mahayana Buddhism, Hinduism, Confucianism, and certain forms of African and Native American religions. The question of whether theism is coherent is an important one, for if there is reason to believe that theism is incoherent, theistic belief is in an important sense undermined.

The logical consistency of each of the divine attributes of classical theism has been challenged by both adherents and non-adherents of theism. Consider the divine attribute of omniscience. If God knows what you will freely do tomorrow, then it is the case now that you will indeed do that tomorrow. But how can you be free not to do that thing tomorrow if it is true now that you will in fact freely do that thing tomorrow? There is a vast array of replies to this puzzle, but some philosophers conclude that omniscience is incompatible with future free action and that, since there is future free action, God—if God exists—is not omniscient.

Another objection to the coherence of theism has to do with the divine attribute of omnipotence and is referred to as the stone paradox. An omnipotent being, as traditionally understood, is a being who can bring about anything. So, an omnipotent being could create a stone that was too heavy for such a being to lift. But if he could not lift the stone, he would not be omnipotent, and if he could not make such a stone, he would not be omnipotent. Hence, no such being exists. A number of replies have been offered to this puzzle, but some philosophers conclude that the notion of omnipotence as traditionally defined is incoherent and must be redefined if the concept of God is to remain a plausible one.

Arguments for the incoherence of theism have been offered for each of the divine attributes. While there have been many challenges to the classical attributes of God, there are also contemporary philosophers and theologians who have defended each of them as traditionally understood. There is much lively discussion currently underway by those defending both the classical and neo-classical views of God. But not all theistic philosophers and theologians have believed that the truths of religious beliefs can be or even should be demonstrated or rationally justified. As mentioned above, fideists, such as Søren Kierkegaard (1813–1855), maintain that religious faith does not need rational justification or the support of rational arguments. For fideists, attempting to prove one’s religious faith may even be an indication of a lack of faith.

5. Problems of Evil and Suffering

a. Logical Problems

Perhaps the most compelling and noteworthy argument against theism is what is referred to as the problem of evil. Philosophers of the East and the West have long recognized that difficulties arise for one who affirms both the existence of an omnipotent and omnibenevolent God and the reality of evil. David Hume, quoting the ancient Greek thinker Epicurus (341–270 B.C.E.), got to the heart of the matter with the following pithy observation:

Is he [God] willing to prevent evil, but not able? then he is impotent. Is he able, but not willing? then he is malevolent. Is he both able and willing? whence then is evil? (Hume’s Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, Part X, 63)

There are different ways the problem of evil can be formulated. In fact, it is probably more accurate to refer to “problems” of evil. One formulation is construed as a logical problem. For the logical problem of evil, it is asserted that the two claims, (1) an omnipotent and omnibenevolent God exists, and (2) evil exists, are logically incompatible. Since evil ostensibly exists, the argument goes, God (understood traditionally as being omnipotent and omnibenevolent) must not exist.

In the latter half of the twentieth century, the logical argument held sway. But by the end of that century, it was widely acknowledged by philosophers of religion that the logical problem had been rebutted. One reason is that as claims (1) and (2) are not explicitly contradictory, there must be hidden premises or unstated assumptions which make them so. But what might those be? The assumed premises/assumptions appear to be something along these lines: (a) an omnipotent God could create any world, (b) an omnibenevolent God would prefer a world without evil over a world with evil, and (c) God would create the world he prefers. Given these claims, (1) and (2) would be logically incompatible. However, it turns out that at least (a) may not be true, even on a classical theistic account. It could be that a world with free agents is more valuable than a world with no free agents. Further, it could be that such free agents cannot be caused or determined to do only what is morally right and good, even by God. If this is so, in order for God to create agents who are capable of moral good, God had to create agents who are capable of moral evil as well. If this is a logical possibility, and it seems to be so, then premise (a) is not a necessary truth because God cannot create just any world.

In addition, premise (b) is not necessarily true either. For all we know, God could use evil to achieve some good end, such as bringing about the virtues of compassion and mercy. As long as (a) and (b) are possibly false, the conclusion of the argument is no longer necessarily true, so it loses its deductive force. This response to the logical argument from evil is called a defense, which is distinguished from a theodicy. The aim of a defense is to demonstrate that the arguments from evil are unsuccessful given a possible scenario or set of scenarios, whereas a theodicy is an attempt to justify God and the ways of God given the evil and suffering in the world. Both defenses and theodicies have been used by theists in responding to the various problems of evil.

b. Evidential Problems

Evidential arguments attempt to demonstrate that the existence of evil in the world counts as inductive evidence against the claim that God exists. One form of the evidential argument from evil is based on the assumption, often agreed on by theists and atheists alike, that an omnipotent, omniscient, omnibenevolent being would prevent the existence of significant amounts of gratuitous evil. Since significant amounts of gratuitous evil seem to exist, God probably does not. One influential approach, espoused by William Rowe (1931), contends that many evils, such as the slow and agonizing death of a fawn burned in a forest fire ignited by lightning, appear to be gratuitous. However, an omnipotent and omniscient being could have prevented them from occurring, and an omnibenevolent being would have not allowed any significant pointless evils to occur if they could have been avoided. So, the argument concludes, it is more reasonable to disbelieve that God exists.

One way of responding to such arguments is to attempt to demonstrate that there is, after all, a point to each of the seemingly gratuitous evils. A solid case for even some examples would lower the probability of the evidential argument, and one could maintain that normal epistemic limitations restrict knowledge in many other examples. The theistic traditions historically have, in fact, affirmed the inscrutability of God and the ways of God. It is from within this context that Stephen Wykstra developed a response to the evidential argument, a response that is referred to as “skeptical theism” (not to be taken as being skeptical about theism). The central point of skeptical theism is that because of human cognitive limitations we are unable to judge as improbable the claim that there are various goods secured by God’s allowing the evils in the world.

Rowe has provided responses to skeptical theism, one of which is that on this view one could never have any reason for doubting God’s existence given evil, no matter how horrific the evil turns out to be. The skeptical theist has created a chasm between human and divine knowledge far beyond what theism has traditionally affirmed.

Another version of the evidential argument has been advanced by Paul Draper. He argues that the world as it is, with its distribution of pains and pleasures, is more likely given what he calls a “hypothesis of indifference” than given theism. On this hypothesis, the existence of sentient beings (including their nature and their place) is neither the result of a benevolent nor a malevolent nonhuman person. Contrast this with the theistic account in which, since God is morally perfect, there must be morally good reasons for allowing biologically useless pain, and there must be morally good reasons for producing pleasures even if such pleasures are not biologically useful. But given our observations of the pains and pleasures experienced by sentient creatures, including their biologically gratuitous experiences (such as those brought about by biological evolution), the hypothesis of indifference provides a more reasonable account than theism.

In response, Peter van Inwagen (1942) maintains that this argument can be countered by contending that for all we know, in every possible world which exhibits a high degree of complexity (such as ours with sentient, intelligent life) the laws of nature are the same or have the same general features as the actual laws. We cannot assume, then, that the distribution of pain and pleasure (including the pains and pleasures reflected in biological evolution) in a world with a high degree of complexity such as ours would be any different given theism. We are simply not epistemically capable of accurately assigning a probability either way, so we cannot make the judgment that theism is less likely than the hypothesis of indifference.

When assessing arguments of this sort, some important questions for consideration are these: What is the claim probable or improbable with respect to? And what is the relevant background information with respect to the claim? The plausibility of the claim “God’s existence is improbable with respect to the evil in the world” considered alone may well be very different from the plausibility of the claim “God’s existence is improbable with respect to the evil in the world” when considered in conjunction with, say, one or more of the arguments for God’s existence. Furthermore, the theist can offer other hypotheses which may raise the probability of evil given God’s existence. For example, the major theistic traditions affirm the belief that God’s purposes are not restricted to this earthly life but extend on into an afterlife as well. In this case, there is further opportunity for God to bring moral good out of the many kinds and varieties of evil in this life. Thus the full scope of the considerations and evidences for and against theism may well raise the probability of God’s existence above that of taking into account only a part. Nevertheless, the evidential problem of evil remains a central argument type against the plausibility of theism.

c. Theodicy

A theodicy, unlike a defense, takes on the burden of attempting to vindicate God by providing a plausible explanation for evil. The theodical approach often takes the following general form: God, an omnipotent and omnibenevolent being, will prevent/eliminate evil unless there is a good reason or set of reasons for not doing so. There is evil in the world. Therefore God must have a good reason or set of reasons for not preventing/eliminating evil. There are various attempts to demonstrate what that good reason is, or those good reasons are. Two important theodicies are those that appeal to the significance and value of free will, and those that appeal to the significance and value of acquiring virtuous traits of character in the midst of suffering.

The first fully developed theodicy was crafted by Augustine in the fifth century of the common era. For Augustine, God is perfect in goodness, and the universe, God’s creation, is also good and exists for a good purpose. Since all creation is intrinsically good, evil must not represent the positive existence of any substantial thing. Evil, then, turns out to be a metaphysical privation, a privatio boni (privation of goodness), or the going wrong of something that is inherently good.

Both moral and natural evil, for Augustine, entered the universe through the wrongful use of free will. Since all creatures, both angels and humans, are finite and mutable, they have the capacity to choose evil, which they have done. Thus, while God created everything in the world good, including angels and humans, through the use of their wills these free agents have ushered into the world that which is contrary to the good. Much of what is good has become corrupted, and this corruption stems from these free creatures, not from God. The Augustinian theodicy concludes with the culmination of history entailing cosmic justice. For God will, in the eschaton (the end of time), usher all who repent into the eternal bliss of heaven and castigate to hell all those who, through their free will, have rejected God’s gift of salvation.

One objection to Augustine’s theodicy is that a number of evils are brought about by natural events, such as disease and natural disasters, including earthquakes and tsunamis. These evils do not seem to occur because of the free choices of moral creatures. The free will theodicy, then, is ineffectual as a solution to arguments from evil that include natural events such as these. C. S. Lewis, Alvin Plantinga, and others have proposed that supernatural beings may ultimately be responsible for evils of this kind, but most theodicists are skeptical of such a notion.

Another objection to this theodicy is that it was crafted in a pre-scientific culture and thus is devoid of an evolutionary view of the development of flora and fauna, including such elements as predation and species annihilation. The narrative of an originally perfect creation through which evil entered by the choices of free agents is now generally considered to be mistaken and unhelpful.

The soul-making (or person-making) theodicy was developed by John Hick, utilizing ideas from the early Christian thinker and bishop Irenaeus (c.130–c.202 C.E.). According to this theodicy, as advanced by Hick, God created the world as a good place, but no paradise, for developing morally and spiritually mature beings. Through evolutionary means, God is bringing about such individuals who have the freedom of will and the capacity to mature in love and goodness. Individuals placed in this challenging environment of our world, one in which there is epistemic distance between God and human persons, have the opportunity to choose, through their own free responses, what is right and good and thus develop into the mature persons that God desires them to be—exhibiting the virtues of patience, courage, generosity, and so on.

Evil, then, is the result of both the creation of a soul-making environment and of the human choices to act against what is right and good. While there is much evil in the world, nevertheless the trajectory of the world is toward the good, and God will continue to work with human (and perhaps other) persons, even in the afterlife if necessary, such that in the eschaton everyone will finally be brought to a place of moral and spiritual maturity.

One objection to the soul-making theodicy is that there are many evils in the world that seem to have nothing to do with character development. Gratuitous evils appear to be in abundance. Furthermore, there is no empirical support for the claim that the world is structured for soul making. Many persons appear to make no moral progress after much suffering; in fact, some persons seem to be worse off by the end of their earthly life.

In reply, it can be argued that apparently pointless evils are not always, in fact, without purpose and merit. The compassion that is evoked from such seemingly indiscriminate and unfair miseries, for example, is a great good, and one which may not arise without the miseries appearing as unfair and indiscriminate. While God did not intend or need any particular evils for soul-making purposes, God did arguably need to create an environment where such evils were a possibility. Thus, while each individual instance of evil may not be justified by a particular greater good, the existence of a world where evil is possible is necessary for a world where soul making can occur. Furthermore, with this theodicy a positive doctrine of life after death is central, for there are cases in which difficulties in an individual’s life breed bitterness, anger, and even a reduction of virtuous character. So in these instances, at least, the soul-making process would need to continue on in the afterlife.

The free will and soul-making theodicies share a common supposition that God would not permit evil which is not necessary for a greater good. But many theists maintain that some evils are not justified, that some horrors are so damaging that there are no goods which outweigh them. But if there are such evils, the question can be raised why God would allow them. It may be that standard theism, theism unaccompanied by other religious claims, is inadequate to provide a response. In fact, some have argued that an adequate reply requires an expanded theism which incorporates other particular religious claims.

One such approach has been offered by Marilyn McCord Adams (1943–). Utilizing the resources of her own religious tradition, Adams pushes theodicy beyond a general theism to an expanded Christian theism utilizing a Christocentric theological framework. She focuses on the worst sorts of evils, which she calls “horrendous evils.” These are evils which, when experienced by a particular person, give that person reason to doubt whether her life could, considered in totality, be taken to be a great good to her. Adams argues that the Christian theodicist should abandon the widely held assumption that responses to evil can only include those goods that both theists and atheists acknowledge. She maintains that goods of this sort are finite and temporal, whereas the Christian has infinite and eternal goods at her disposal. An intimate, loving, eternal relationship with God, for example, may well be a good that is infinite and incomparable with any other kind of good. She further argues that taking a “general reasons-why” approach to theodicy in which some general reason is provided to cover all forms of evil does not seem to be the kind of help we need. As a Christian philosopher, she believes a more adequate response can be provided which involves the coexistence of God and the evils in the world. Rather than focusing on the possible reasons why God might allow evils of this sort, she maintains that it is enough to show how God can be good and yet permit their existence.

Adams argues that there is good reason for the Christian to believe that all evils will ultimately be defeated in one’s life and that God will ultimately engulf all personal horrors through integrating participation in the evils into one’s life with God. Given this integration, she argues, all human beings, even those who have experienced the most horrific evils on earth, will in the eschaton be redeemed and thus find ultimate meaning and goodness in their lives. Such a view does, of course, presuppose one particular religious tradition and one interpretation of that tradition.

Another recent approach to the problem of evil has been offered by Eleonore Stump. She considers the problem to be not an intellectual one attempting to solve a logical puzzle, but rather a deeply personal one involving interpersonal relations, the central relations of which are between God and God’s creatures. She treats the problem of evil as centrally a problem of suffering and utilizes an account of second-person experiences and second-person biblical narratives to make her case.

Stump suggests a possible world, one grounded in the worldview of Thomas Aquinas, in which love is central. The proper object of love is God, which, on Aquinas’s doctrine of divine simplicity, is identical to God’s goodness. This goodness is also within human beings, and so a proper object of love includes love of other human beings (as well as oneself). Fallen human beings prefer pleasure and power over the greater goods, and as such human beings are not properly internally integrated around the ultimate and proper good. One must be redeemed in order to have proper internal integration.

Using the biblical story of Job, Stump sees several levels of second-person accounts, including God’s interactions with Job and a dialogue between God and Satan. Job, she suggests, received what he needed: an assurance of God’s goodness. But the way Job received this assurance, the way he knows that his suffering is under the providence of a good and loving God, occurs through a second-person experience that is difficult to explain to one who did not have the same experience. What we have in these accounts, then, are second-person stories relating God’s personal interaction with his creatures. What we learn from such biblical stories is that God will produce goods from one’s suffering for the one suffering—goods which would otherwise have not been produced.

One objection to Stump’s defense is that, in many cases, suffering seems to produce no growth or goods in the individual who is suffering. In fact, in some cases, suffering seems to predictably diminish the sufferer. Furthermore, much evil and suffering seems to be indiscriminate and gratuitous.

d. The Hiddenness of God

A related problem is that of divine hiddenness. Many people are perplexed and see as problematic that, if God exists, God does not make his existence sufficiently clear and available. The problem, concisely stated, can be put this way. If God exists as the perfect, loving, omnibenevolent being that theists have generally taken God to be, then God would desire the best for his creatures. The best for God’s creatures, at least in the Christian religion and to some extent in all of the Abrahamic traditions, is to be in relationship with God. However, many people, both non-theists and sometimes theists themselves, claim to have no awareness of God. Why would God remain hidden and elusive, especially when individuals would benefit from being aware of God?

John Schellenberg has argued that the hiddenness of God provides evidence that God does not in fact exist. Using a child-parent analogy, an analogy which is often used in the Abrahamic traditions themselves, Schellenberg notes that good parents are present to their children, especially when they are in need. But God is nowhere to be found, whether one is in need or not. So God, at least as traditionally understood, must not exist.

Schellenberg offers several different forms of the argument. One version can be sketched this way. If God does exist, then reasonable nonbelief would not occur, for surely a perfectly loving God would desire that people believe in God. And if God desires that people so believe, God would work it out so that persons would be in a reasonable position to believe. However, reasonable nonbelief does occur. There are persons who do not believe in God, and they are reasonable in doing so. Even after studying the evidence, examining their motives of belief, praying and seeking God, they still do not believe and see no good reason to believe. But a perfectly loving and good God, it seems, would ensure belief in God by all such persons. God would make himself known to them so that they would believe. Since there is reasonable nonbelief, then, we have solid evidence that God, as a perfectly loving, caring being does, not exist. The argument can be stated concisely this way:

  1. If there is a God, he is perfectly loving.
  2. If a perfectly loving God exists, reasonable nonbelief does not occur.
  3. Reasonable nonbelief occurs.
  4. So no perfectly loving God exists (from 2 and 3).

Various replies can be made to this argument. While not a common move by theists, one could deny the first premise. Dystheists maintain that God is less (maybe much less) than omnibenevolent. This view of God is certainly not consistent with traditional theism whereby, as Anselm put it, God is “that than which nothing greater can be conceived.”

Another reply is to deny premise two, and several reasons might be offered in support of its denial. First, it may be that those persons who do not believe are, for one reason or another, not ready to believe that God exists, perhaps because of emotional or psychological or other reasons. So God hides out of love and concern for the person. Second, it could be that God’s revealing himself to some people would produce the wrong kind of belief or knowledge of God or could cause one to believe for the wrong reasons, perhaps out of fear or trepidation or an egoistic desire for success. In cases like this, God’s hiding would, again, be due to God’s love and concern for those who are not yet ready to believe.

A third reply is to deny the third premise. Some theists have, in fact, maintained that any nonbelief of God is unreasonable—that every case of nonbelief is one in which the person is epistemically and morally culpable for her nonbelief. That is, while such persons do not believe that God exists, they should so believe. They have the requisite evidence to warrant such belief, yet they deny or suppress it; they are intentionally disbelieving.

For many philosophers of religion, these replies to the issue of divine hiddenness are unsatisfactory. The elusiveness of God continues to be a problem for both theists and non-theists.

e. Karma and Reincarnation

Non-theistic religions have also offered accounts of evil, including its nature and existence, specifically with respect to suffering. For Hindus and Buddhists, these considerations are rooted in karma and rebirth. In its popular formulations, rebirth is the view that the conscious self transmigrates from one physical body to the next after death. Each human being has lived former lives, perhaps as another human being or maybe even as another kind of organism. Rebirth is connected to the doctrine of karma. As typically understood within Hinduism and Buddhism, karma literally means “deed” or “action”—what one does. It can also mean one’s intention or motivation for a given action, or what happens to an individual. Its broader meaning, sometimes referred to as the “law of karma,” is a law of moral causation, including the results of one’s actions. Understood this way, it involves causal connections linking what an individual does to what happens to them. It is, in effect, the idea that one reaps the good and bad consequences of her or his actions, either in this life or in another life.

Reincarnation and karma seem to offer a better account of evil and suffering than does theism. For example, it seems exceedingly unfair that one child is born healthy into a wealthy, loving family, whereas another child is born sickly into a poor, cruel environment. If there is a personal, creator God who brought these two persons into the world, God seems to be unloving and unjust. But if the two children are reaping the consequences of actions they performed in previous lives, this seems to provide a justification for the inequalities. The effect of one’s karma determines the circumstances of one’s past, present, and future lives. We reap what we sow.

Various objections have also been raised against karma/rebirth. According to the karmic law of cause and effect, a person’s present life circumstances are explained by her actions in a previous life; and her life circumstances in that life are explained by her life circumstances in a life previous to that one; and so on indefinitely. So the solution hoped for regarding inequalities never seems to come to an end. Furthermore, does it really seem fair that when a person who has lived a long life dies and is reincarnated, she must start all over again as a baby with her maturity, life experiences, wisdom, and memories completely erased?

Another difficulty for the karma/rebirth solution has to do with free will. An initial advantage of this solution to the problem of evil is that real moral agency is preserved. In fact, moral agency is central to the karma/rebirth solution: our moral decisions self-determine our future experiences, making us responsible for our own destiny. Upon further reflection, the view seems to run contrary to free moral agency. Consider the example of a man contemplating the rape and murder of a woman. Suppose he has done so before, and has thus far not been caught. He is considering redirecting his life by turning himself in to the authorities and receiving the consequences of his actions. But just as he is pondering this option, a woman strolls by and his mad passions for rape and murder begin to burn within him. He now has the choice to continue down the path of destruction or put a stop to it. If he decides to attack the woman and does so, then on the karmic account the woman was not completely innocent after all; she is paying the price for her former evil actions. In that case, the rapist is not truly free to act as he does, for he is simply following mechanistically the effects of karmic justice. He is merely the instrumental means for meting out the justice requisite for this woman’s previous moral failings. If, however, the woman does not deserve such moral recompense, then karmic justice will ensure that she does not receive it. In that case, the rapist will be unable to engage in the attack.

The problem that arises has to do with locating the moral freedom in this system. If the rapist is deterministically carrying out justice on his victim, then it seems that he is not truly a free moral agent after all. He is simply a cog in the karmic justice machine. It is disconcerting to affirm a moral system in which we understand raped and murdered victims to be themselves morally culpable for such acts of brutality against them. On the other hand, suppose the rapist really is free to attack the woman. If she was not deserving of such an act, this would be a serious violation of the law of karma whereby suffering occurs only because of one’s previous evil actions. If in attempting to justify such actions, the defender of the karmic system replied that the woman would in a future life receive a reward for such a morally gratuitous act, this does not appear to be consistent with karma, for this would run counter to the central principle of karma in which evil and suffering are the effects of one’s previous deeds.

As with theistic replies to evil, karmic solutions may be helpful at some level, but they nevertheless leave one with less than complete answers to the variety of problems of evil and suffering.

6. Miracles

The term “miracle” (Latin mirari, to wonder) is generally used in religious contexts to refer to an unusual event which is not explicable by natural causes alone but rather is the result of divine activity. Theists commonly consider most of the events that occur in the world to be, fundamentally, acts of God. As creator and sustainer of the universe, God is, broadly construed, the ultimate cause of what occurs in the universe. But many theists also affirm that some events involve a direct act of God, such as “miraculous” healings or in the case of Christian theism, the resurrection of Jesus, or in the case of Islam, the production of the Qur’an.

But there is debate among philosophers of religion about what kinds of divine activity should be considered miraculous. David Hume maintained that a miracle is a “violation of the laws of nature.” As such, he raised objections to such a notion. One objection is that it is never reasonable to believe a report that a violation of a law of nature has occurred. The evidence used to support a claim of a miraculous event is the testimony of witnesses. But the establishment of a natural law was based on the uniform experience of many persons over time. So the witness testimony necessary to establish a miracle would need to be greater than that which established the natural law in the first place. Since this never happens, no evidence is sufficient to make probable or establish the occurrence of a violation of a natural law, so it is always unreasonable to believe that such a violation has occurred.

Objections have been raised to Hume’s definition of a miracle. One objection is that miracles are not in fact violations of natural laws. Natural laws are descriptive rather than prescriptive; they describe what will, or likely will, occur or not occur under certain specifiable conditions. In that case, referring to God’s occasional actions in the world as a violation of them would be misrepresentative. If what one means by a violation of the laws of nature is just an exception to usual processes in the natural world, however, this objection is unwarranted.

This leads back to the issue of whether it is ever reasonable to believe that an exception to the usual processes in the natural world has occurred, and also whether it can be established that God has directly acted in the world. Hume does not attempt to demonstrate that miracles are a metaphysical impossibility. His approach is an epistemic one: to show that there is never sufficient evidence to warrant belief in a miracle.

One response to Hume’s claim about the insufficiency of evidence for belief in miracles is that his understanding of probability is inadequate. Determining the probability of an event is a rather complex undertaking, and simply utilizing the frequency of an occurrence to determine its probability, as Hume apparently does, simply will not do. Establishing the a priori probability of a miracle without the background information of, for example, the existence of God, the nature of God, the purposes and plans of God, and so on, is impossible. If one had such knowledge, a particular miracle may turn out to be highly probable.

Recent discussions of miracles by philosophers of religion have often focused on the concept of natural law, probability theory, and the role of religion as evidence for a particular religion or for belief in God.

7. Conclusion

Philosophy of religion is a flourishing field. Beyond those specific areas described above, there are also a number of important currents emerging, including feminist and continental approaches, renewed interest in medieval philosophy of religion, and an emphasis on the environment, race and ethnicity, and science and faith.

8. References and Further Reading

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  • Anderson, Pamela Sue. “What’s Wrong with the God’s Eye Point of View: A Constructive Feminist Critique of the Ideal Observer Theory.” In Faith and Philosophical Analysis: The Impact of Analytical Philosophy on the Philosophy of Religion, Harriet Harris and C. J. Insole, eds. Aldershot: Ashgate, 2005.
  • Anselm of Canterbury. St. Anselm: Basic Writings. LaSalle, IL: Open Court Publishing, [1077–1078] 1962.
  • Beilby, James K., ed. Naturalism Defeated? Essays on Plantinga’s Evolutionary Argument against Naturalism, Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 2002.
  • Bergmann, Michael. “Skeptical Theism and Rowe’s New Evidential Argument from Evil.” Noûs 35 (2001) 2:278–296.
  • Bergmann, Michael and Michael Rea. “In Defense of Skeptical Theism: A Reply to Almeida and Oppy.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 83 (2005): 241–251.
  • Bowker, John. Problems of Suffering in Religions of the World. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1970.
  • Byrne, Peter. Prolegomena to Religious Pluralism: Reference and Realism in Religion. London: Macmillan, 1995.
  • Caputo, John. The Religious: Blackwell Readings in Continental Philosophy. Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell, 2001.
  • Clack, Beverly and Brian R. Clack. The Philosophy of Religion: A Critical Introduction. Oxford: Blackwell, 1998.
  • Clayton, John. Religions, Reasons and Gods: Essays in Cross-Cultural Philosophy of Religion. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
  • Coakley, Sarah. Powers and Submissions: Spirituality, Philosophy, and Gender. Oxford: Blackwell Publishers, 2002.
  • Collins, Robin. “The Teleological Argument.” In Paul Copan and Chad Meister, eds., Philosophy of Religion: Classic and Contemporary Issues. Oxford: Blackwell, 2008, 98–111.
  • Collins, Robin. “The Teleological Argument: An Exploration of the Fine Tuning of the Universe.” In William Lane Craig and J. P. Moreland, eds. The Blackwell
  • Companion to Natural Theology. Oxford: Blackwell, 2009.
  • Collins, Francis. The Language of God: A Scientist Presents Evidence for Belief. New York: Simon and Schuster, 2006.
  • Copan, Paul. Loving Wisdom: Christian Philosophy of Religion. St. Louis: Chalice Press, 2007.
  • Copan, Paul. “The Moral Argument.” In Paul Copan and Chad Meister, eds., Philosophy of Religion: Classic and Contemporary Issues. Oxford: Blackwell, 2008.
  • Craig, W. The Kalam Cosmological Argument. New York: Barnes and Noble, 1979.
  • Craig, William Lane. The Cosmological Argument from Plato to Leibniz. Eugene, OR: Wipf and Stock, 1980.
  • Craig, W. L. and Smith, Q. Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1993.
  • Cupitt, Don. Taking Leave of God. Norwich: SCM Press, 2001.
  • Davies, Brian. The Reality of God and the Problem of Evil. London: Continuum, 2006.
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  • Gellman, Jerome. Experience of God and the Rationality of Theistic Belief. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1997.
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  • Gutting, Gary. Religious Belief and Religious Skepticism. Notre Dame: Notre Dame University Press, 1982.
  • Harris, Sam. The End of Faith: Religion, Terror, and the Future of Reason. New York: W. W. Norton, 2004.
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  • Hick, John. Rational Theistic Belief without Proof. London: Macmillan, 1966.
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  • Hick, John. An Interpretation of Religion: Human Responses to the Transcendent. 2nd ed. New Haven, CT: Yale University Press, 2004.
  • Hick, John. Evil and the God of Love. New edition. London: Palgrave Macmillan, 2007.
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel. The Evidential Argument from Evil. Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 1996.
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel Paul Moser, ed. Divine Hiddenness. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
  • Hume, David. Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion. Second edition. Richard H. Popkin, ed. Indianapolis/Cambridge: Hackett Publishing, 1998.
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  • London: Routledge, 1996.
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  • Mackie, J. L. The Miracle of Theism. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1985.
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  • Meister, Chad. Introducing Philosophy of Religion. London: Routledge, 2009.
  • Meister, Chad and Paul Copan, eds. The Routledge Companion to Philosophy of Religion. London: Routledge, 2007; second edition 2012.
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  • Morris, Thomas V. The Logic of God Incarnate. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1986.
  • Moser, Paul. The Elusive God: Reorienting Religious Epistemology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008.
  • Moser, Paul. The Evidence for God: Religious Knowledge Reexamined. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
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  • O’Connor, Timothy. Theism and Ultimate Explanation: The Necessary Shape of Contingency. Oxford, Blackwell, 2008.
  • Oppy, Graham. Ontological Arguments and Belief in God. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
  • Oppy, Graham. Arguing About Gods. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2006.
  • Peterson, Michael, William Hasker, Bruce Reichenbach, and David Basinger. Introduction to the Philosophy of Religion. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1991.
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  • Plantinga, Alvin. Does God Have a Nature? Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press, 1980.
  • Plantinga, Alvin. Warrant: The Current Debate. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1993.
  • Plantinga, Alvin. Warrant and Proper Function. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1993.
  • Plantinga, Alvin. Warranted Christian Belief. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2003.
  • Plantinga, Alvin and Michael Tooley. Knowledge of God. Oxford: Blackwell, 2008.
  • Rea, Michael. World without Design: The Ontological Consequences of Naturalism. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2002.
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  • Schloss, Jeffrey and Michael Murray, eds. The Believing Primate: Scientific, Philosophical, and Theological Reflections on the Origins of Religion. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2009.
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Author Information

Chad Meister
Email: chad.meister@bethelcollege.edu
Bethel College (Indiana)
U. S. A.

Immanuel Kant: Radical Evil

kant2 The subject of Immanuel Kant’s philosophy of religion has received more attention in the beginning of the 21st century than it did in Kant’s own time. Religion was an unavoidable topic for Kant since it addresses the ultimate questions of metaphysics and morality. For, as he presents it in his Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals and elsewhere, the universal moral law does not entirely depend upon demonstrating the existence of God, but rather upon reason (though he believes that its source cannot be divorced from the concept of God). Nevertheless he shocks the casual reader of the First Preface of his Religion within the Boundaries of Mere Reason (hereafter Religion) by claiming that morality “inevitably leads to religion.”

Obedience to the moral law, of which Kant believes religion should be an example, appears to be an expectation that is neither universally nor willingly practiced. What is notable about the first two chapters of Religion is that he addresses this phenomenon in a manner that his Enlightenment predecessors had not: The failure of human moral agents to observe the moral law is symptomatic of a character or disposition (Gesinnung) that has been corrupted by an innate propensity to evil, which is to subordinate the moral law to self-conceit. Because this propensity corrupts an agent’s character as a whole, and is the innate “source” of every other evil deed, it may be considered “radical.” However, this propensity can be overcome through a single and unalterable “revolution” in the mode of thought (Revolution für die Denkungsart), which is simultaneously the basis for a gradual reform of character in the mode of sense (für die Sinnesart); for without the former, there is no basis for the latter. This reformation of character ultimately serves as the ground for moral agents within an ethical commonwealth, which, when understood eschatologically, is the Kingdom of God on Earth.

Kant’s account of radical evil demonstrates how evil can be a genuine moral alternative while nevertheless being an innate condition. Given the general optimism of the time, Kant’s view was revolutionary. It not only harkened back to an older Augustinian account of human nature, but also affirmed a propensity to evil within human nature using his apparatus of practical reason.

Table of Contents

  1. Kant on the Natural Predisposition to Good and the Propensity to Evil
  2. The Propensity to Evil: Universal and Innate
  3. The Source of the Propensity to Radical Evil: Two Views
  4. Overcoming Evil: The Necessity of an Ethical-Religious Revolution
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary References
      1. German
      2. English
    2. Secondary References

1. Kant on the Natural Predisposition to Good and the Propensity to Evil

Kant’s account of radical evil in Religion must be seen within the context of his account of why, given the force of the moral law, rational beings would actually choose evil. The presence of moral evil in human beings can be explained by their possession of an innate propensity to subordinate the moral law to inclination. Of course, for Kant to even suggest that human beings have such a propensity places him at odds with the Enlightenment Zeitgeist, which saw human beings as neither wholly good nor wholly evil, but somewhere in between (“latitudinarianism”). He ultimately rejected this and in his Religion, he not only shows that a universal propensity to radical evil is possible, but also gives an account of how it is possible.

Contrary to the latitudinarianism of Jean-Jacques Rousseau and others on the subject of human nature, Kant holds to the following rigoristic thesis: Ethically, human beings are either wholly evil or wholly good by virtue of whether or not an agent has adopted the moral law as the governing maxim for all of his or her maxims (Religion 6:22-23). For either the moral law is the governing maxim for the choice of maxims or it is not; making the moral law the ground of our maxims is sufficient for moral goodness. This thesis turns on a second thesis: An individual with a morally good character or disposition (Gessinnung) has adopted a moral maxim as a governing maxim, and incorporates the moral law as a basis for choosing all other maxims. If an agent has done so, then by virtue of making all other maxims compliant with this maxim, these subsequent maxims will be consistent with the moral law. Nevertheless, when an alternative maxim—that of self-conceit—is chosen as a governing maxim, then this egoistic alternative becomes the basis for maxim choice and the moral law is subordinated to an alternative governing maxim along with every other maxim.

Consequently, the ethical choice facing the moral agent is either to subordinate all other maxims to the moral law, or to subordinate the moral law with every other maxim to an egoistic alternative. The fact is that human agents, although conscious of the moral law, nevertheless do in fact incorporate the occasional deviation from it as part of their individual maxim set. When an agent mis-subordinates the requirements of morality to the incentives of self-conceit (however small it may be), the result is radical evil (Religion 6.32).

Note that this propensity does not amount to the rejection of morality. It is in fact perfectly compatible with our acceptance of the requirements of the moral law, but only insofar as they are compatible with a maxim of inclination. But the next question, as always with Kant, must be one of possibility: how is it that radical evil is even possible for human agents?

Every human being possesses the incentive to adopt the moral law as the governing maxim for maxim choice by virtue of it having arisen out of a basic predisposition to the good. As such, an individual’s predisposition constitutes the determinate nature (Bestimmung) of a human being as a whole, of which Kant identifies three basic predispositions (Anlagen): animality (Thierheit), personality (Persönlichkeit), and humanity (Menschlichheit). They belong to us as part of our motivational DNA. By itself, a predisposition is generally not a conscious choice, but a source of motivation for choices, some of which happen to have ethical significance. The basic predispositions, taken as a whole, are considered good in the sense that, not only do they not resist the moral law, but they also demand compliance with it  (Religion 6:28). For a human agent to have an original predisposition to the good yet nevertheless to be capable of evil, suggests that the possibility for the corruption of human nature is a consequence of the corruption of one of our basic predispositions.

Although it would be tempting to do so, it would be a mistake to identify the source of this corruption in our sensuous animal nature (the predisposition to animality). This predisposition concerns itself with the purely instinctual elements of the human being qua mammal: self-preservation, the sexual drive, and the desire for community. While the inclinations of animality indeed influence us ignobly, they are nevertheless necessary for every member of the species to survive and flourish. Hence human sensuality and appetite alone could hardly make human beings radically evil. As Kant states (Religion 6:35): “For not only do [the natural inclinations] bear no direct relation to evil . . . we also cannot presume ourselves responsible for their existence (we cannot because as connatural to us, natural inclinations do not have us for their author).”

Yet neither can our predisposition to personality be identified with our moral corruption, since Kant attributes to personality the capacity not only to grasp but also to determine the maxims that are morally required of us as universal legislation. For unlike the predisposition to animality, the predisposition to personality shares, with humanity, the property of rationality. The incentive to follow the moral law thus requires a distinct predisposition, so that the moral law can be an incentive given “from within” that stands in contrast to a circumstantially dependent happiness. It is the “highest incentive” (Religion 6:26n) by which we both grasp and choose the moral law, and it provides the basis for our personhood, if not our accountability. For this reason radical evil cannot constitute a “corruption of the morally legislative reason” (Religion 6:35).

This leaves humanity as the remaining basic predisposition susceptible to corruption. Although it shares the property of rationality with the predisposition to personality, humanity is distinct by virtue of the fact that it is concerned with the practical and therefore calculative elements of life. Yet this basic predisposition also possesses the inclination to seek equality in the eyes of others and to determine whether or not one is happy by comparison with others (Religion 6:26-27). It is manifestly egocentric since it relates to others in terms of its concern for happiness. Yet it is not by itself evil. Rather, it is from these positive characteristics within our predisposition of humanity that evil becomes a possibility and constitutes a propensity to egoistic and malignant self-love as self-conceit.

2. The Propensity to Evil: Universal and Innate

Once Kant is able to show how radical evil, as an innate condition, is possible the question becomes: How can evil, insofar as it rests on a propensity, constitute a genuine choice? In many ways, this question appears to be the essential problem for Kant’s ethics, since he believes that rational moral agency entails not only the capacity to know but also to obey the moral law.

Generally speaking, a propensity (Hang) is an innate yet non-necessary feature of every person that serves as a motivation for action in distinctively human affairs.  However, unlike a basic predisposition (e.g., humanity, animality, and personality), a propensity can be represented as having been acquired by habit if it is good, or if it is evil, as having been self-inflicted (Religion 6:29). It demonstrates a tendency to respond or act in a particular manner, either in accordance with, or in tension with the moral law. Taken together, both predispositions and propensities serve to form an individual’s mindset or character (Gessinnung), for the development of which every human being is responsible.

The obvious requirement for Kant at this stage is to give an account of the nature of the propensity to evil, which he provides in psychological terms as a disordering of incentives. As opposed to other vices, this propensity is essentially depravity, and stands in contrast to frailty (fragilitas) and moral impurity (impuritas, improbitas). Depravity or perversity (perversitas), unlike frailty, is not mere weakness and an inability to resist sensuous inclination (Religion 6:29). And unlike impurity, it is more than merely obeying the moral law from alternative motivations (instead of a sense of duty). Instead, depravity must be understood as the reversal of “the ethical order as regards the incentives of a free power of choice” (Religion 6:30). The propensity to evil becomes manifest when human beings choose to act (Willkür) in accordance with the incentive of self-conceit, which stands in opposition to the incentive of the moral law. (Religion 6:36).

Yet merely possessing the propensity to self-conceit does not by itself make an agent evil, since a moral agent already possesses both the incentive of the moral law and that of self-conceit within that agent’s hierarchy of maxims. An agent’s moral character as a whole is determined ultimately by which maxim is going to be the dominant maxim for the choice of maxims. Yet, because both cannot fulfill this role, they compete with each other with the result that one is inevitably “subordinated to the other” (Religion 6:36).  An evil character results when the moral agent makes the satisfaction of the moral law as the basis for maxim choice (Willkür) conditional to the incentives of self love (understood as self-conceit) and their inclinations (Religion 6:36). And so, what makes for an evil character is deviating from the moral law as the basis for maxim choice and adopting self-conceit in its place (Religion 6:29).

Note that for Kant, the faculty of volition or desire, or freedom of the will (Wille), has two different senses, a broad sense and a narrow sense. In the narrow sense (as Wille) it refers to the practical will that formulates laws as the “faculty of desire whose inner determining ground, hence even what pleases it, lies within the subject’s [practical] reason.” Practical will is considered in relation to the ground determining the choice of action (Metaphysics of Morals, 6:213), and through it an agent formulates both hypothetical and categorical imperatives. Practical will stands in contrast with executive will (Willkür), which is the power of choice (together with which it forms the will in the broad sense) to choose, decide, wish, and formulate maxims presented to it by the practical will as imperatives. Hence, whether or not an agent is wholly good or evil is determined entirely by “a free power of choice (Willkür) and this power . . .  on the basis of its maxims [which] must reside in the subjective ground of the possibility of the deviation of the maxims from the moral law” (Religion 6:29).

Thus, either the incentive of the moral law or the incentive of egoistic self-conceit is sufficient for the agent to be either morally good or morally evil. When the propensity to subordinate the moral law to the governing maxim of self-conceit is taken up within the mindset or disposition (Gesinnung) as a governing maxim, the agent’s character as a whole is corrupted and becomes radically evil.

3. The Source of the Propensity to Radical Evil: Two Views

The propensity to evil is affirmed by Kant as a universal yet non-necessary feature of every human being. However, he appears to believe that its universal quality entails that there is no need for proof of its innateness. As he states: “We can spare ourselves the formal proof that there must be such a corrupt propensity rooted in the human being, in view of the multitude of woeful examples that the experience of human deeds parades before us” (Religion 6:33). Such examples are obvious simply from an examination of history and anthropology (Religion 6:33-34). The fact that Kant raises the possibility of a formal proof for the innateness of this propensity while declining to give one raises the question: What is the basis for characterizing this propensity as innate?

One view is that radical evil may be cast in terms of what Kant has identified as “unsociable sociality” (ungesellige Geselligkeit; “The Idea for a Universal History from a Cosmopolitan Point of View” 8:20). It arises within the human agent from interactions within society, and its demonstration need not appeal to a litany of human evils from which to derive an inductive proof. Instead, all that is necessary is an examination of the predisposition to humanity. Recall that by virtue of this predisposition, we possess a natural tendency not only to compare ourselves with others, but to compete with each other as a means of deriving our own self-worth. From our social interactions, we learn to give preference to our own concerns and needs, or self-conceit (Religion 6:26-27). This unsociable sociality becomes manifest in our tendency to exempt ourselves from the moral law while expecting others to follow it, treating others as means to our ends rather than as ends.  And so, in human competitiveness we seek to compare and gain mastery over others, making our own preferences the basis for our governing maxim.

The source of this feature of the basic predisposition to humanity manifests itself in natural and self-aggrandizing human competitiveness. It originates out of the company of other human beings who mutually corrupt one another’s moral predispositions (Religion 6:93-94). Hence, by virtue of living in community and in our need for sociality, the shortcomings of our basic predisposition to humanity accounts for our self-conceit. Our social interactions serve as a kind of breeding ground for radical evil.

Our natural tendencies not only to compare ourselves with others, but to compete with them as a means for deriving our own self-worth, can be demonstrated through the study of anthropology. However this interpretation does not entail that Kant thinks that the individual is absolved of responsibility. Evil remains a deed that is the product of an individual’s capacity for choice, and for this reason the individual still retains the responsibility for its commission. Even if we claim that we are not guilty of a particular social evil (e.g., slavery or the Holocaust), on account of having been caught up in the “spirit of the age,” then inasmuch as we are participants, we are still guilty.

Thus on this first view, the propensity to evil is simply part of our nature as social beings and is aggravated by our proximity to each other, the existence of which is evident from an observation of unsociable sociability when, and where it occurs  in human society. It is a universal feature shared by every human being, yet it does not require holding that each individual necessarily possesses this feature.

The alternative view for the basis for the propensity’s innateness is that the subordination of the moral law to the incentive of self-conceit is an entirely timeless and intelligible “deed” (That). This wholly intelligible act is so called because it does not take place at any one point in time, but it is nevertheless the deed out of which all subsequent evil deeds arise. It is, as Kant states, the “subjective determining ground of the power of choice that precedes every deed, and is itself not yet a deed” (Religion 6:31).

In making this claim, Kant follows the more Pietist (or less orthodox Lutheran) theologians of his day who broke from an Augustinian approach towards human evil or sin, claiming that each agent is alone responsible for its own evil. Adam and Eve were responsible for their own sin, and all subsequent human beings have followed their example in disobedience to the moral law (Religion 6:42-43). Human beings, then, approach their empirical circumstances having always already chosen the maxim by which they will act, and so subordinate the moral law to the incentive of self-conceit.

An a priori proof for the innate source of this radical evil can easily be drawn out through an examination of Kant’s observation in the Critique of Practical Reason that the moral law strikes down this incentive. Here he states that only two propensities are applicable to beings capable of apprehending the moral law: to follow the moral law either gladly (gern) or reluctantly (ungern; Critque of Practical Reason 5:82).  Whether or not the moral law is followed gladly or reluctantly is in part a function of its ability to generate respect, which serves as an incentive for its adoption. As an incentive, the moral law competes with inclination for acceptance by the practical will, against which inclination sometimes wins. Viewed positively: Respect for the moral law, while illuminating to a certain extent our limitations, also reveals our dignity as rational beings. However, the incentive of respect for the moral law competes with sensuous inclinations which arise out of self-regard (Selbstsucht, solipsismus; Critique of Practical Reason 5:73).

Note that for Kant self-regard is a complex phenomenon. As a rational and guided concern for one’s own livelihood and well being (Eigenliebe, philautia; Critique of Practical Reason 5:74) self-regard constitutes a healthy benevolence towards ourselves. For “we find our nature as sensible beings so constituted that the matter of the faculty of desire (objects of inclination, whether of hope or fear) first forces itself upon us” (Critique of Practical Reason 5:74). However, self-regard also subsumes a more malignant form of self-concern, that of self-conceit (Eigendünkel, arrogantia), in which the “pathologically determinable self” desires “to make its claims primary and originally valid, just as if it constituted our entire self” (Critique of Practical Reason 5:74). In the language of Religion, a healthy self-regard is mechanical self-love, that is an extension of the predisposition to animality in the human being. It is a kind of self-concern for which no reason is required, but it is not immune to the plentitude of vices, including gluttony, lust, and “wild lawlessness” (Religion 6:26-27). But mechanical self-love is entirely different from the malignant self-regard that is self-conceit, which, in conflict with the moral law, arrogantly “prescribes the subjective conditions of [self-love] as laws” (Critique of Practical Reason 5:74).

So, while the moral agent recognizes the requirements of the moral law and wishes to practice self-restraint by virtue of its normative requirements, the moral law is neither universally adopted nor gladly accepted in all cases and at all times. The fact that the moral law does not merely infringe “upon our self-conceit,” but “humiliates every human being when he compares with it the sensible propensity of his nature,” illustrates that this malignant condition is as unavoidable as it is universal (Critique of Practical Reason 5:74).

To return to the issue of radical evil in the Religion, human beings are generally susceptible to natural inclinations that never actually agree with the dictates of the moral law. Rather than naturally possessing a propensity to follow the moral law, humans instead possess a propensity to follow their own self-serving inclinations. Since, as we saw earlier, human beings are wholly good or evil by virtue of whether or not they choose a moral governing maxim or an egoistic alternative at the top of their hierarchy of maxims, this propensity must be evil and imputable to human nature.

4. Overcoming Evil: The Necessity of an Ethical-Religious Revolution

Although Kant, for the most part, dedicates only the first two chapters of the Religion to radical evil, he anticipates some of its issues in the Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals (as heteronomy), in the Critique of Practical Reason, and in the Metaphysics of Morals. He dedicates the remaining two books of Religion to cultivating the idea of an ethical community which requires as a necessary condition for participation that an individual possesses a disposition transformed by a “revolution.” While the revolution may be characterized as a singular event, it is also the first step in a new life of unending progress toward goodness (Religion 6:67). Only through a revolution can an individual claim to have acquired a “holy will.”  The “Kingdom of God on earth,” or the ethical commonwealth, is composed of individuals who have recognized both this need for a revolution and the primacy of the moral law as their governing maxim (Religion 6:95 ff).

While radical evil must be understood in terms of a propensity that is as inexplicable as it is universal, it is nevertheless “imputed to us” as a disposition (Religion 6.43). How we come to choose a good disposition (and overcome evil), is equally unfathomable. The difficulty lies in the fact that acquiring such a disposition cannot merely be a matter of a resolution to try harder next time (though such resolve is of some merit). Nor is a mere change in the habitual practice of virtues sufficient by itself to acquire a good character because the disposition remains corrupted in the midst of such efforts. The only solution is to undergo a revolution in our “mode of thought” (Denkungsart; Religion 6:47). Acquiring an original goodness that constitutes “holiness of maxims” is the acquisition of a disposition in compliance with our duty to the maxim of obedience to the moral law and serves as the basis for our subsequent maxims (Religion 6:47). It should be noted that Kant’s use of ‘revolution’ should not be confused with a social or political revolution, since this would ultimately lead to the Terror witnessed in the French Revolution.

The acquisition of the holy disposition through such a revolution requires that we take up the disposition of the human personification of the holy will, present to us in our reason as the archetype of moral perfection. To elevate ourselves to this ideal of moral perfection constitutes our universal human duty (Religion 6:61-62). Kant identifies the historical human personification of this archetype as the “Son of God.” This individual is described in religious terms as the one who has “descended from Heaven,” whom we come to believe in through “practical faith.” When an agent acquires this disposition, then that agent, by emulating it, may be considered as “not an unworthy object of divine pleasure” (Religion 6:62). We are no longer subject to suffering the moral consequences of our own sin or debt. Yet we are nevertheless obliged to continue to experience the consequences of the life lived prior to the revolution (Religion 6:75n). Indeed, according to Kant, to undergo suffering as the consequence of a “pre-conversion” life is consistent with his views about the development of a good character (Religion 6:69).

The revolution, then, is not merely an intellectual undertaking. It also involves a practical and continual process of reformation of maxims in accordance with the newly acquired governing maxim of “holiness of maxims.” An intelligible (Denkungsart) revolution takes place when a human being makes a singular decision which instantaneously reverses “the supreme ground of his maxims” (Religion 6:48), and precedes a gradual empirical (Sinnesart) reformation of character. The former is the volitional overcoming of the propensity to evil that serves as a basis for maxim choice, a mode that is distinct from that of the empirical reformation (for Kant, they are in fact, two sides of the same coin). For, once an individual has experienced this inner revolution, “he is a good human being only in incessant laboring and becoming, i.e. he can hope –  in view of the purity of the principle –  to find himself upon the good (though narrow) path of constant progress from bad to better” (Religion 6:48).

The operative in question here is that of “manifestation of the good principle,” or “humanity in its moral perfection,” as displayed in the disposition of the Son of God in history (Religion 6:77). Our acquisition of a renewed disposition requires a kind of moral habituation. It is a disposition that results from adopting holiness of maxims as a governing maxim, and subsequently not only serves to systematically root out vice, but aids in the resolution to resist backsliding from temptation—because for Kant, ought implies can. It involves a commitment to the struggle to restructure one’s incentives from top to bottom, as it were, from self-conceit towards virtue; it is to begin to fulfill one’s duties from duty itself.

We may note that by means of this revolution, moral reform does carry with it a degree of uncertainty as to whether or not we will succeed. Hope for success rests on considering our efforts from the divine perspective. For, from this perspective, what matters is a change of heart, or the acquisition of a transformed moral disposition or character. Through such a change, Kant says, “in the sight of the divine judge for whom the disposition takes the place of the deed,” the agent is morally “another being” (Religion 6:74). Because one who has taken on the disposition of the archetype of humanity has become a new creation, the disposition of the personified archetype comes to be considered a kind of work “imputed to us by grace” (Religion 6:75-76). At the same time, Kant also appears to recognize that, in practical terms and from the human perspective, we might need reassurance that our efforts are successful.

On this matter, Kant appears to offer some consolation using the distinction between “narrow” and “perfect” duties on the one hand, and “wide” or “imperfect” duties on the other (Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals, 4:424). Narrow or perfect duties clearly constitute tasks that we are required to do or accomplish and are therefore exact in their stipulation. On the other hand, a wide or imperfect duty is one such that, although we are required to strive for it, is not something that we can be expected to attain. Holiness of will is such a duty. For while holiness is narrow and perfect—and constitutes a qualitative ideal—practically considered, it can only be considered a wide duty “because of the frailty (fragilitas) of human nature.” That is: “It is a human being’s duty to strive for this perfection, but not to reach it . . . and his compliance with this duty can, accordingly consist only in continual progress” (The Metaphysics of Morals 6:446). Holiness of will is for us such an ideal, the fulfillment of which we cannot be certain of attaining in this lifetime

Kant’s account of radical evil as a propensity has received much discussion at the turn of the twenty-first century and has generated a fair degree of controversy. One criticism is that he does not allow for the possibility of diabolical evil. A second is that, while Kant is committed to holding that the propensity to evil is universal, his positions on the revolution fail to properly allow for the possibility of grace, the doctrine that God is able to act in human affairs and effect change within a person’s moral disposition. This paper does not attempt to adjudicate between these two concerns, and they do not affect the main thesis that for Kant, evil is largely a moral category, present universally in human beings as a propensity to self-conceit that influences the adoption of maxims.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary References

i. German

  • Immanuel Kant. Bereitstellung und Pflege von Kants Gesarmmelten Werken in elektronisher Form. 2008.
    • References and quotations in this encyclopedia article have used the English translation of Kant’s works provided by Cambridge University Press, but the textual references themselves are to Kant’s Gesarmmelten Werken that is available online.

ii. English

  • Kant, Immanuel. Groundwork for the Metaphysics of Morals, trans. and ed. by M. J. Gregor. In Immanuel Kant: Practical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
  • Kant, Immanuel. Critique of Practical Reason, trans and ed. by M. J. Gregor. In Immanuel Kant: Practical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
  • Kant, Immanuel. The Metaphysics of Morals, trans. and ed. by M.J. Gregor. In The Cambridge Edition of the Works of Immanuel Kant. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1991.
  • Kant, Immanuel. Religion Within the Boundaries of Mere Reason. In Immanuel Kant: Religion and Rational Theology, trans. and ed. by A. W. Wood and G. diGiovanni. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.

b. Secondary References

  • Allison, Henry. Kant’s Theory of Freedom. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1990.
    • First to propose the Rigorism Thesis and Incorporation Thesis, and the propensity to evil as an intelligible act.
  • Allison, Henry. “On the Very Idea of a Propensity to Evil.” The Journal of Value Inquiry 36 (2002): 337-48.
    • Defends propensity to evil as intelligible act against Wood’s thesis that the propensity to evil is mere “unsociable sociality.” Many subsequent articles tend to defend either Allison or Wood.
  • Anderson-Gold, Sharon. “God and Community: An Inquiry into the Religious Implications of the Highest Good.” In Rossi and Wreen (1991), pp. 113-131.
    • An important contribution to the discussion on the significance of evil within Kant’s anthropology.
  • Anderson-Gold, Sharon. Unnecessary Evil. New York: State University of New York Press, 2001.
  • Anderson-Gold, Sharon, and Pablo Muchnik (eds). Kant’s Autonomy of Evil: Interpretive Essays and Contemporary Applications. New York: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
  • Caswell, Matthew. “Kant’s Conception of the Highest Good, the Gesinnung, and the Theory of Radical Evil.” Kant-Studien 97 (2006): 184-209.
    • Offers discussion on importance of the disposition for the acquisition of evil as an alternative incentive to the Good. Caswell largely follows Allison’s thesis.
  • Caswell, Matthew. “The Value of Humanity and Kant’s Conception of Evil.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 44.4 (2006): 635-63.
  • Fackenheim, Emil. “Kant and Radical Evil.” University of Toronto Quarterly 23 (1954): 339-53.
    • Raises questions about whether Kant’s apparent claim that each person is responsible for “self-redemption” is consistent within his Religion as a whole.
  • Grimm, Stephen. “Kant’s Argument for Radical Evil.” European Journal of Philosophy 10:2 (2002): 160-77.
    • By and large a defense of Wood’s position.
  • Kosch, Michelle. Freedom and Reason in Kant, Schelling, and Kierkegaard. Oxford/New York: Clarendon, 2006.
    • A discussion of Kant’s ethics of autonomy, and offers an account of the challenge faced by radical evil to Kant’s ethics of autonomy; for the most part follows Wood’s thesis against Allison.
  • Mariña, Jacqueline, “Kant on Grace: A Reply to His Critics.” Religious Studies 33 (1997): 379-400.
    • Presents a defense of Kant against Wolterstorf and Michalson for the compatibility of Kant’s Religion on the topic of the possibility of grace.
  • Matuštík, Martin Beck. Radical Evil and the Scarcity of Hope. Bloomington/ Indianapolis: Indiana University Press, 2008.
    • Chapter 8 offers contemporary criticism of Kant, largely following Silber, arguing that Kant’s account of evil is restricted by his commitment to resisting diabolical evil.
  • Michalson Jr., Gordon. Fallen Freedom. Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 1990.
    • While offering excellent commentary on Religion 1 & 2, critiques Kant’s treatment of grace and Christian theism generally.
  • Morgan, Seiriol. “The Missing Proof of Humanity’s Radical Evil in Kant’s Religion.” The Philosophical Review 114.1 (2005): 63-114.
    • Offers alternative proof for thesis that the propensity to evil is an intelligible act.
  • Muchnik, Pablo, “An Alternative Proof of the Universal Propensity to Evil.” In Sharon Anderson-Gold and Pablo Muchnik (2010), pp. 116-143.
    • Presents an alternative proof for evil as an innate propensity from Wood and Allison.
  • Quinn, Philip. “In Adam’s Fall, We Sinned All,” Philosophical Topics 16 (1988): 110-118.
    • Quinn was the first to present the propensity to evil, and its adoption by the disposition, understanding the disposition (Gesinnung) as the ‘meta-maxim’.
  • Quinn, Philip. “Saving Faith from Kant’s Remarkable Antinomy,” Faith and Philosophy 7.4 (1990): 418-433.
  • Reath, Andrews. “Kant’s Theory of Moral Sensibility: Respect for the Moral Law and the Influence of Inclination,” in his Agency and Autonomy in Kant’s Moral Theory, Oxford: Clarendon (2006), pp. 8-32.
  • Provides an excellent analysis of the importance in understanding respect as an incentive for the moral law.
  • Rossi, Philip J. and Michael J. Wreen. Kant’s Philosophy of Religion Reconsidered. Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1991.
  • Savage, Denis. “Kant’s Rejection of Divine Revelation and his Theory of Radical Evil.” Rossi and Wreen (1991), pp. 54-76.
    • Presents skepticism of Kant’s willingness to allow for revelation in his Religion.
  • Silber, John. “The Ethical Significance of Kant’s Religion.” In Immanuel Kant, Religion Within  the Limits of Reason Alone. Trans. T.M. Greene and H.H. Hudson, New York: Harper and Row, 1960.
  • Silber’s introduction raises questions about the viability of Kant’s treatment of evil, given that it does not allow for the possibility of diabolical evil.
  • Silber, John. “Kant at Auschwitz.” Proceedings of the Sixth International Kant Congress. Ed. by G. Funke and T. Seebohm, Center of Advanced Research in Phenomenology and Research: University Press of America, 1991.
    • A defense of his earlier claim (1960), that Kant’s account of radical evil does not do justice to instances of diabolical evil in the twentieth century.
  • Wolterstorff, Nicholas. “Conundrums in Kant’s Rational Religion.” In Rossi and Wreen (1991), pp. 40-53.
    • Raises questions about whether or not Kant’s Religion is consistent with Christian theism.
  • Wood, Allen. Kant’s Moral Religion. Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press, 1970.
    • A discussion of Wood’s earlier views on Kant’s religion.
  • Wood, Allen. Kant’s Ethical Thought. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
    • Chapter 9 develops his views of radical evil in terms of unsociable sociality against Allison.
  • Wood, Allen. “Kant and the Intelligibility of Evil.” In Sharon Anderson-Gold and Pablo Muchnik (2010), pp. 144-172.
    • Makes extensive use of Kant’s Anthropology for a defense of his thesis of radical evil as unsociable sociality, implicitly against Allison.

 

Author Information

Erik M. Hanson
Email: ehanson2@uccs.edu
University of Colorado
U. S. A.

Constructive Mathematics

Constructive mathematics is positively characterized by the requirement that proof be algorithmic. Loosely speaking, this means that when a (mathematical) object is asserted to exist, an explicit example is given: a constructive existence proof demonstrates the existence of a mathematical object by outlining a method of finding (“constructing”) such an object. The emphasis in constructive theory is placed on hands-on provability, instead of on an abstract notion of truth. The classical concept of validity is starkly contrasted with the constructive notion of proof. An implication (A⟹B) is not equivalent to a disjunction (¬A∨B), and neither are equivalent to a negated conjunction (¬(A∧¬B)). In practice, constructive mathematics may be viewed as mathematics done using intuitionistic logic.

With the advent of the computer, much more emphasis has been placed on algorithmic procedures for obtaining numerical results, and constructive mathematics has come into its own. For, a constructive proof is exactly that: an algorithmic procedure for obtaining a conclusion from a set of hypotheses.

The historical and philosophical picture is complex; various forms of constructivism have developed over time. Presented here is a brief introduction to several of the more widely accepted approaches, and is by no means comprehensive.

Table of Contents

  1. Motivation and History
    1. An Example
    2. Constructivism as Philosophy
    3. The BHK Interpretation
    4. Constructive Methods in Mathematics
    5. Early History
    6. The Axiom of Choice
  2. Intuitionism
    1. Brouwerian Counterexamples
    2. The Fan Theorem
  3. Constructive Recursive Mathematics
    1. Surprises
  4. Bishop’s Constructive Mathematics
    1. Proof Readability and Preservation of Numerical Meaning
    2. The Axiom of Choice in BISH
    3. Foundations and Advances
  5. Martin-Löf Type Theory
    1. The Axiom of Choice is Provable
  6. Constructive Reverse Mathematics
  7. Summary
    1. Some Further Remarks
  8. References and Further Reading
    1. Further Reading
    2. References

1. Motivation and History

The origin of modern constructive mathematics lies in the foundational debate at the turn of the 20th Century. At that time, the German mathematician David Hilbert established some very deep and far-reaching existence theorems using non-constructive methods. Around the same time, the Dutch mathematician L.E.J. Brouwer became philosophically convinced that the universal validity of contradiction proofs for existence proofs was unwarranted—despite his early work in establishing the non-constructive fixed point theorem which now bears his name.

It is often the case that a classical theorem becomes more enlightening when seen from the constructive viewpoint (we meet an example of such a case—the least upper bound principle—in Section 1d. It would, however, be unfair to say that constructive mathematics is revisionist in nature. Indeed, Brouwer proved his Fan Theorem (see Section 2b) intuitionistically in 1927 (Brouwer, 1927), but the first proof of König’s Lemma (its classical equivalent) only appeared in 1936 (König, 1936). It is ironic that the Brouwer’s intuitionist position (see Section 2) has become known as anti-realist since it demands that every object be explicitly constructible.

a. An example

Here is an example of a non-constructive proof that is commonly encountered in the literature:

Proposition.
There exist non-rational numbers <span id="MathJax-Element-4-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-24" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 10px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.522em 1000em 2.283em -0.432em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-25" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-26" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">a</span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-4">a</script> and <span id="MathJax-Element-5-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-27" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 8px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.269em 1000em 2.284em -0.425em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-28" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-29" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">b</span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-5">b</script> such that <span id="MathJax-Element-6-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-30" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 17px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.109em 1000em 2.283em -0.432em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-31" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-32" class="msubsup"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 0.901em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.522em 1000em 2.283em -0.432em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-33" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">a</span></span><span style="position: absolute; top: -2.481em; left: 0.517em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-34" class="mi" style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">b</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-6">a^b</script> is rational.

<i>Proof.</i> Take <span id="MathJax-Element-7-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-35" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 59px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.161em 1000em 2.48em -0.425em); top: -2.169em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-36" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-37" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">b</span><span id="MathJax-Span-38" class="mo" style="font-family: MathJax_Main; padding-left: 0.278em;">=</span><span id="MathJax-Span-39" class="msqrt" style="padding-left: 0.278em;"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 1.343em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.348em 1000em 2.324em -0.415em); top: -2.169em; left: 0.826em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-40" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-41" class="mn" style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.022em 1000em 4.332em -0.393em); top: -4.022em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-7">b = sqrt{2}</script>; so <span id="MathJax-Element-8-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-42" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 8px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.269em 1000em 2.284em -0.425em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-43" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-44" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">b</span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-8">b</script> is irrational. Either <span id="MathJax-Element-9-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-45" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 46px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(0.793em 1000em 2.428em -0.393em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-46" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-47" class="msubsup"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 2.399em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(2.968em 1000em 4.288em -0.393em); top: -3.977em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-48" class="msqrt"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 1.343em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.348em 1000em 2.324em -0.415em); top: -2.169em; left: 0.826em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-49" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-50" class="mn" style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.022em 1000em 4.332em -0.393em); top: -4.022em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; top: -4.558em; left: 1.343em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-51" class="texatom"><span id="MathJax-Span-52" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-53" class="msqrt"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 0.981em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.492em 1000em 2.273em -0.43em); top: -2.118em; left: 0.62em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-54" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-55" class="mn" style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.257em 1000em 4.274em -0.414em); top: -3.995em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-9">sqrt{2}^{sqrt{2}}</script> is rational, or it is not. If it is, then set <span id="MathJax-Element-10-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-56" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 61px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.161em 1000em 2.48em -0.432em); top: -2.169em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-57" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-58" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">a</span><span id="MathJax-Span-59" class="mo" style="font-family: MathJax_Main; padding-left: 0.278em;">=</span><span id="MathJax-Span-60" class="msqrt" style="padding-left: 0.278em;"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 1.343em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.348em 1000em 2.324em -0.415em); top: -2.169em; left: 0.826em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-61" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-62" class="mn" style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.022em 1000em 4.332em -0.393em); top: -4.022em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-10">a=sqrt{2}</script>. On the other hand, if <span id="MathJax-Element-11-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-63" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 46px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(0.793em 1000em 2.428em -0.393em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-64" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-65" class="msubsup"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 2.399em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(2.968em 1000em 4.288em -0.393em); top: -3.977em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-66" class="msqrt"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 1.343em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.348em 1000em 2.324em -0.415em); top: -2.169em; left: 0.826em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-67" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-68" class="mn" style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.022em 1000em 4.332em -0.393em); top: -4.022em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; top: -4.558em; left: 1.343em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-69" class="texatom"><span id="MathJax-Span-70" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-71" class="msqrt"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 0.981em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.492em 1000em 2.273em -0.43em); top: -2.118em; left: 0.62em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-72" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-73" class="mn" style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.257em 1000em 4.274em -0.414em); top: -3.995em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-11">sqrt{2}^{sqrt{2}}</script> is irrational, then take <span id="MathJax-Element-12-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-74" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 81px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(0.844em 1000em 2.48em -0.432em); top: -2.169em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-75" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-76" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">a</span><span id="MathJax-Span-77" class="mo" style="font-family: MathJax_Main; padding-left: 0.278em;">=</span><span id="MathJax-Span-78" class="msubsup" style="padding-left: 0.278em;"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 2.399em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(2.968em 1000em 4.288em -0.393em); top: -3.977em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-79" class="msqrt"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 1.343em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.348em 1000em 2.324em -0.415em); top: -2.169em; left: 0.826em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-80" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-81" class="mn" style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.022em 1000em 4.332em -0.393em); top: -4.022em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; top: -4.558em; left: 1.343em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-82" class="texatom"><span id="MathJax-Span-83" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-84" class="msqrt"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 0.981em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.492em 1000em 2.273em -0.43em); top: -2.118em; left: 0.62em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-85" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-86" class="mn" style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Main;">2</span></span></span><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(3.257em 1000em 4.274em -0.414em); top: -3.995em; left: 0em;"><span style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Main;">√</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-12">a=sqrt{2}^{sqrt{2}}</script>, which makes <span id="MathJax-Element-13-Frame" class="MathJax" role="textbox" aria-readonly="true"><span id="MathJax-Span-87" class="math"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; font-size: 121%; width: 17px;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.109em 1000em 2.283em -0.432em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-88" class="mrow"><span id="MathJax-Span-89" class="msubsup"><span style="display: inline-block; position: relative; height: 0px; width: 0.901em;"><span style="position: absolute; clip: rect(1.522em 1000em 2.283em -0.432em); top: -2.118em; left: 0em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-90" class="mi" style="font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">a</span></span><span style="position: absolute; top: -2.481em; left: 0.517em;"><span id="MathJax-Span-91" class="mi" style="font-size: 70.7%; font-family: MathJax_Math; font-style: italic;">b</span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span></span><script type="math/tex" id="MathJax-Element-13">a^b</script> = 2 and thus rational. In either case, the conclusion holds.

The proof is non-constructive because even though it shows that the non-existence of such numbers would be contradictory, it leaves us without the knowledge of which choice of a and b satisfy the theorem. There is a (simple) constructive proof of this theorem: set a=2 and b=log29 (in the full constructive proof, a little work first needs to be done to demonstrate that a and b are, in fact, irrational). A fully constructive proof that 2 is properly irrational (that is, positively bounded away from every rational number) may be found in Bishop (1973). This clarifies the choice of words in the proposition above. It is further possible to show that 22 is in fact irrational, but this is not done by the proof presented here. (An early mention of the above illustrative example in the literature is in Dummett (1977, p. 10).)

b. Constructivism as philosophy

Constructive mathematics is often mis-characterized as classical mathematics without the axiom of choice (see Section 1f); or classical mathematics without the Law of Excluded Middle. But seen from within the discipline, constructive mathematics is positively characterized by a strict provability requirement. The consequences of adopting this stance—and rigorously implementing it—are far-reaching, as will be seen.

There are two conditions which are fundamental to every constructivist philosophy:

  • The notion of `truth’ is not taken as primitive; rather, a proposition is considered true only when a proof for the proposition is produced.
  • The notion of `existence’ is taken to be constructibility: when an object is proved to exist, the proof also exhibits how to find it.

To assert that P, then, is to produce a proof that P. Likewise, to assert that ¬P is to prove that the assumption of P leads to a contradiction. Very quickly, one realizes that the Principle of Excluded Middle (PEM; Latin tertium non datur or principium tertii exclusi) leads to trouble:

PEM: For any statement P, either P or ¬P.

The assertion of PEM constructively amounts to claiming that, for any given statement P, either there is a proof of P, or there is a proof that P leads to a contradiction. Consider, for example, the following:

The Collatz conjecture. Define f:NN by the rule:

f(n)={n/23n+1if n is even,if n is odd.


Then for each natural number n, that is for each n in {1,2,3,…}, there exists a natural number k such that fk(n)=1.

At the time of writing this article, the Collatz conjecture remains unsolved. To claim that there is a proof of it is erroneous; likewise to claim that there is a proof that it leads to a contradiction is also erroneous. In fact, in Brouwer’s view (see Section 2), to assert PEM is to claim that any mathematical problem has a solution. Thus there are good philosophical grounds for rejecting PEM.

c. The BHK interpretation

The following interpretation of logical connectives is now known as the Brouwer-Heyting-Kolmogorov (BHK) interpretation, and is widely accepted by constructivists.

Statement Interpretation
P We have a proof of P.
PQ We have both a proof of P and a proof of Q.
PQ We have either a proof of P or a proof of Q.
PQ We have an algorithm that converts any proof of P into a proof of Q.
¬P We have a proof that P, where is absurd (for example, 0=1).
xAP(x) We have an algorithm which computes an object xA and confirms that P(x).
xAP(x) We have an algorithm which, given any object x, together with the data that xA, shows that P(x) holds.

In particular, the interpretations for ¬,, and are worth emphasizing: each of these has the very strict requirement that a proof of such a statement will consist of a decision procedure—in other words, every constructive proof contains, in principle, an algorithm.

The BHK interpretation characterizes a logic called intuitionistic logic. Every form of constructive mathematics has intuitionistic logic at its core; different schools have different additional principles or axioms given by the particular approach to constructivism.

d. Constructive methods in mathematics

Upon adopting only constructive methods, we lose some powerful proof tools commonly used in classical mathematics. We have already seen that the Principle of Excluded Middle is highly suspect from the constructivist viewpoint, as (under the BHK interpretation) it claims the existence of a universal algorithm to determine the truth of any given statement. This is not to say that PEM is constructively false, however. Both Russian recursive mathematics (in which PEM is provably false) and classical mathematics (in which it is logically true) are in a sense models, or interpretations, of constructive mathematics. So in a way, PEM is independent of constructive mathematics. Note, however, that if one is given a statement, it may be possible to prove PEM concerning that particular statement—such statements are called decidable. The point is that there is no general constructive method for doing so for all statements.

If PEM is not universally valid we also lose universal applicability of any mode of argument which validates it. For example, double negation elimination, or proof by contradiction. Again, it must be emphasized that it is only the universal applicability which is challenged: proof by contradiction is constructively just fine for proving negative statements; and double negation elimination is just fine for decidable statements.

However these limitations are in fact often advantages. In a lot of cases, constructive alternatives to non-constructive classical principles in mathematics exist, leading to results which are often constructively stronger than their classical counterpart. For example, the classical least upper bound principle (LUB) is not constructively provable:

LUB: Any nonempty set of real numbers that is bounded from above has a least upper bound.

The constructive least upper bound principle, by contrast, is constructively provable (Bishop & Bridges, 1985, p. 37):

CLUB: Any order-located nonempty set of reals that is bounded from above has a least upper bound.

A set is order-located if given any real x, the distance from x to the set is computable.
It is quite common for a constructive alternative to be classically equivalent to the classical principle; and, indeed, classically every nonempty set of reals is order-located.

To see why LUB is not provable, we may consider a so-called Brouwerian counterexample (see Section 2a), such as the set

S={xR:(x=2)(x=3P)}


where P is some as-yet unproven statement, such as Goldbach’s conjecture that every even number greater than 2 is the sum of two prime numbers. (There may be some philosophical problems with this set; however these do not matter for the purpose of this example. Section 2a has a much “cleaner”, though more technically involved, example.) If the set S had a computable least upper bound, then we would have a quick proof of the truth or falsity of Goldbach’s conjecture. A Brouwerian counterexample is an example which shows that if a certain property holds, then it is possible to constructively prove a non-constructive principle (such as PEM); and thus the property itself must be essentially non-constructive.

e. Early history

In the late 19th century, the mathematical community embarked on a search for foundations: unquestionable solid ground on which mathematical theorems could be proved. An early exemplar of this search is Kronecker’s 1887 paper “Über den Zahlbegriff” (“On the Concept of Number”) (Kronecker, 1887), where he outlines the project of arithmetization (that is, founding on the fundamental notion of number) of analysis and algebra. It is perhaps in this work that we see the earliest instance of the constructive manifesto in mathematical practice. Kronecker was famously quoted by Weber (1893) as saying “Die ganzen Zahlen hat der liebe Gott gemacht, alles andere ist Menschenwerk.” (“The integers were made by God; all else is the work of man.”)

It has been said that “almost all mathematical proofs before 1888 were essentially constructive.” (Beeson, 1985, p. 418). This is not to say that constructive mathematics, as currently conceived of, was common practice; but rather that the natural interpretation of existence of the time was existence in the constructive sense. As mathematical concepts have changed over time, however, old proofs have taken on new meaning. There are thus plenty of examples of results which are today regarded as essentially non-constructive, but seen within the context of the period during which they were written, the objects of study that the authors had in mind allowed proofs of a constructive nature. One good example of this is Cauchy’s 1821 proof of the Intermediate Value Theorem (Cauchy, 1821; in Bradley & Sandifer, 2009, pp. 309–312); the classical interval-halving argument. The concept of “function” has, since then, expanded to include objects which allow for Brouwerian counterexamples (see Section 2a).

The first major systematic development of a constructive approach to mathematics is that of Brouwer and the intuitionists, introduced in the next major section. Some notable forerunners (who should perhaps not be thought of as intuitionists themselves) were Henri Poincaré, who argued that mathematics is in a way more immediate than logic, and Emile Borel, who maintained that the only objects that concern science are those that can be effectively defined (Borel, 1914). Poincaré argues that intuition is a necessary component of mathematical thought, rejects the idea of an actual infinite, and argues that mathematical induction is an unprovable fact (Poincaré, 1908).

As a result of techniques from ZF set theory, rigorous proofs have over time taken on non-constructive aspects. David Hilbert, contemporary of Brouwer and an opponent of Brouwer’s philosophy, deserves particular mention, since he was an early pioneer of highly non-constructive techniques. The debate between Brouwer and Hilbert grew fierce and controversial, which perhaps added fuel to the development of both constructivism (à la Brouwer) and formalism (à la Hilbert) (see, for example, van Heijenoort, 1976). The spectacular 1890 proof by Hilbert of his famous basis theorem (Hilbert, 1890), showing the existence of a finite set of generators for the invariants of quantics, was greeted by the German mathematician Gordan with another now-(in)famous phrase: “Das ist nicht Mathematik. Das ist Theologie.” (“That is not Mathematics. That is Theology.”) This is perhaps the most dramatic example of a non-constructive proof, relying on PEM in an infinite extension.

The method Hilbert exhibited there has become widely accepted by the mathematics community as a pure existence proof (that is, proving that non-existence of such an object was contradictory without actually exhibiting the object); however it was not admissible as a constructive technique. Weyl, one of Hilbert’s students (who Hilbert would eventually “lose”—perhaps temporarily—to intuitionism) commented on pure existence proofs, that they “inform the world that a treasure exists without disclosing its location” (Weyl, 1946). The Axiom of Choice, perhaps due in part to its regular use in many non-constructive proofs (and heavily implicated in many of Hilbert’s most influential proofs), has been accused of being the source of non-constructivity in mathematics.

f. The Axiom of Choice

The Axiom of Choice (AC) has been controversial to varying degrees in mathematics ever since it was recognized by Zermelo (1904). Loosely, it states that given a collection of non-empty sets, we can choose exactly one item from each set.

AC: If to each x in A there corresponds a y in B, then there is a function f such that f(x) is in B whenever x is in A.

Formally, given non-empty sets A and B, the Axiom may be stated as:

xAyBP(x,y)fBAxAP(x,f(x)).


Intuitively, this seems almost trivial, and the case where the non-empty sets are finite in size is indeed so, since one does not need the axiom of choice to prove that such a choice can be made in most formulations of set theory. However it becomes less clear when the size of the sets involved is very large or somehow not easily determined. In such cases, a principled, functional choice may not necessarily be made. Even in classical mathematics, the axiom of choice is occasionally viewed with some suspicion: it leads to results that are surprising and counterintuitive, such as the Banach-Tarski paradox: using the axiom of choice allows one to take a solid sphere in 3-dimensional space, decompose it into a finite number of non-overlapping pieces, and reassemble the pieces (using only rotations and translations) into two solid spheres, each with volume identical to the original sphere. Due to its controversial nature, many mathematicians will explicitly state when and where in their proof AC has been used.

Nonetheless, the BHK interpretation of the quantifiers seems to invite one to think about the existential quantifier yB as defining the choice function, and so it would seem very natural to adopt AC from the constructive point of view (see, however, the discussion in Sections 4b and 5a). But consider the set S given by

S={xZ:(x=0P)(x=1¬P)}


for some syntactically correct statement P. This set is not empty, since if it were then both P and ¬P would have to be false; so ¬P¬¬P, a contradiction. Similarly, S cannot contain both 0 and 1. But suppose that we had an algorithmic procedure which (in a finite time) returns an element of S for us. If it returns 0, then we know that P must be true; whereas if it returns 1 then we know that P must be false—and thus we will have proved that P¬P. We may repeat this for any statement, and so this amounts to a (constructive) proof of the universal applicability of PEM. And as we have seen, universal applicability of PEM is not constructively acceptable. Thus, while the set S is non-empty, we cannot necessarily exhibit any of its members either. A set which has constructible members is called inhabited, and the distinction between inhabited and non-empty sets is key in constructive set theories. Related is the issue of the size of S; since S is not empty, its size is not 0, but since S is not (necessarily) inhabited, its size is no other natural number either—S is an at-most-singleton set. It is a consquence of AC, in fact, that every non-empty set is inhabited.

It is no coincidence that the symbolic form of AC suggests that it is essentially a quantifier swap: AC states that if to each element of A an element of B can be assigned, then it can be done so in a systematic (algorithmic) way. It is thus a kind of uniformity principle.

The example set S above is known as a Brouwerian example (although most of Brouwer’s examples of this sort were a little more specific—see below). It is to intuitionism, Brouwer’s philosophy of mathematics, that we now turn.

2. Intuitionism

If there is a name synonymous with constructive mathematics, it is L.E.J. Brouwer (Luitzen Egbertus Jan Brouwer; Bertus to his friends). In his doctoral thesis, Over de Grondslagen der Wiskunde (On the Foundations of Mathematics; Brouwer, 1907), Brouwer began his program of laying the foundations of constructive mathematics in a systematic way. Brouwer’s particular type of constructive mathematics is called “intuitionism” or “intuitionistic mathematics” (not to be confused with intuitionistic logic; recall Section 1c).

Shortly after the presentation of his thesis, Brouwer wrote a paper entitled “De onbetrouwbaarheid der logische principes” (“The Untrustworthiness of the Principles of Logic”; Brouwer, 1908), in which he challenged the absolute validity of classical logic: “De vraag naar de geldigheid van het principium tertii exclusi is dus aequivalent met de vraag naar de mogelijkheid van onoplosbare wiskundige problemen.” (“The question of validity of the principle of excluded third is equivalent to the question of the possibility of unsolvable mathematical problems.”; Brouwer, 1908, p. 156) In other words, PEM is valid only if there are no unsolvable mathematical problems.

In intuitionistic mathematics, mathematics is seen as a free creation of the human mind: a (mathematical) object exists just in case it can be (mentally) constructed. This immediately justifies the BHK interpretation, since any existence proof cannot be a proof-by-contradiction—the contradiction leaves us without a construction of the object.

According to Brouwer, the natural numbers and (perhaps surprisingly) the continuum, are primitive notions given directly by intuition alone. This connects to the idea of what Brouwer called free choice sequence, a generalization of the notion of sequence. It is perhaps ironic that when Brouwer initially encountered the idea of a free choice sequence, which had been a mathematical curiosity at the time, he rejected such sequences as non-intuitionistic (Brouwer, 1912). However, soon afterward he accepted them and was the first to discover how important they were to practical constructive mathematics (Brouwer, 1914). This is one of two major aspects which distinguishes intuitionistic mathematics from other kinds of constructive mathematics (the second being Brouwer’s technique of bar induction, which we do not explain in great depth here; though see Section 2b).

A free choice sequence is given by a constructing agent (Brouwer’s creative subject), who is at any stage of the progression of a sequence free to choose (or subject to mild restrictions) the next member of the sequence. For example, if one is asked to produce a binary free choice sequence, one may start “0000” for a hundred digits, and then (perhaps unexpectedly) freely choose “1” as the next digit. A real number, classically thought of as a (converging) Cauchy sequence, thus need not be given by a determinate rule; instead, it is only subject to a Cauchy restriction (that is, some rate of convergence).

The idea of a free choice sequence leads to some very strong commitments. Not immediately obvious is the principle of continuous choice. It states:

If PNN×N and for each x in NN there exists n in N such that (x,n) is in P, then there is a choice function f:NNN such that (x,f(x)) is in P for all x in NN.

The notation BA, where A and B are sets, denotes the collection of functions from A to B. So NN denotes the collection of functions from natural numbers to natural numbers; the arguments x in question are thus actually functions x:NN. One may conceive of these (as Brouwer did) as sequences of natural numbers; further technical details are omitted.

Intuitively, the principle arises from the following considerations. Let PNN×N and suppose that we have a procedure that we may apply to any given sequence x=x1,x2,x3, of natural numbers which computes an index n such that (x,n)P—that is, P is a set in which every sequence of natural numbers is (constructively) paired with some natural number. Under the intuitionist’s view, at any given moment we may have only a finite number of terms of x at hand. The procedure which computes n such that (x,n)P must thus do so after being given only a finite initial fragment of x; say x1,x2,,xm. Now if we are given another sequence y, if the first m terms of y are the same as those of x (that is, if y is “close” to x in some sense), then the procedure must return the same value of n for y as it would give for x. The procedure is thus a continuous function (the choice function) from NN to N.

The principle of continuous choice is a restricted form of the classical axiom of choice (see Section 1f). This principle (together with the BHK interpretation) gives rise to a number of very strong consequences—perhaps the most (in)famous being that every function f:RR which maps the real line into itself is pointwise continuous.

If this seems outlandish, then remember that in intuitionistic mathematics the very ideas of “function” and “real number” are different from their classical counterparts. We now discuss a technique that originated with Brouwer which justifies, to some extent, these conceptions.

a. Brouwerian counterexamples

As we have seen, Brouwer rejected the principle of excluded middle. The intuitionist school further rejects appeal to so-called omniscience principles; logical principles which allow one to decide the truth of predicates over an infinite number of things. An illuminating example of such a principle is the limited principle of omniscience (LPO), which states that:

For each binary sequence a1a2a3, either an=0 for all natural numbers n or there exists a natural number n such that an=1.

In symbols LPO states that, for any given binary sequence a1a2a3, the following statement is decidable:

n(an=0)n(an=1).


For one familiar with computability, the above statement will already appear problematical. It says that there is an algorithm which, given an arbitrary binary sequence will in finite time determine either that all the terms in α are zero, or it will output an n such that an=1. Since computers have a finite memory capacity, the problem of loss of significance (or underflow) occurs: the computer carrying out the calculation may not carry enough digits of the sequence to determine whether a 1 occurs or not (though see Section 3).

However, (modern) computational issues aside, this was not the problem seen by the intuitionist. To Brouwer, the possible existence of choice sequences made this statement unacceptable. Since a constructing agent is free to insert a 1 while constructing a sequence at any stage of the construction, there is no a priori bound on how many terms one may need to search in order to establish the presence, or lack of, a 1.

Thus we see that the lesser principle of omniscience does not apply to binary sequences in intuitionist mathematics. Let us now turn to the real numbers. The decimal expansion of π is a favourite example. There are well-known algorithms for computing π to arbitrary precision, limited only by the power of the device on which the algorithms run. At the time of writing this article, it is unkown whether a string of 100 successive 0s (that is, 0000, with 100 digits) appears in the decimal expansion of π. It is known that π does not have a terminating decimal expansion (so it does not finish in all 0s) and that it has no systematic repetition (since it is not a rational number).

But suppose we define a real number x by the expansion

x=n=1(12)nan


where an is defined as

an={01if a hundred consecutive 0s have not occurred by the nth digit of π‘s expansionotherwise.


The number x is constructible: we have prescribed an algorithm for computing it to any desired precision. It also has a Cauchy condition—the 1/2n part—which ensures it converges. However, we now have a problem as regards the sign of x: if a hundred consecutive 0s never occur in the decimal expansion of π, then x=0. If a hundred consecutive 0s do occur in the decimal expansion of π, and the hundredth such 0 occurs in an odd place, then x<0; whereas if it occurs in an even place then x>0. So if we have an answer to the question whether such a string occurs in the decimal expansion of π, then we can determine whether x=0 or not; however, since we do not have an answer, we cannot conclude that x>0, or x=0, or x<0.

The previous paragraph is a Brouwerian counterexample to the statement "every real number satisfies the law of trichotomy". Trichotomy is exactly the decision (disjunction) that every real number is either positive, zero, or negative. Under Brouwer's view, we may construct real numbers about which we simply do not have enough information at hand—even in principle—to determine their sign.

b. The Fan Theorem

In addition to the use of intuitionistic logic and the principle of continuous choice, Brouwer's intuitionism involves one final central technique, bar induction. It is a technically challenging idea which we do not cover in depth here (see Beeson, 1985, p. 51 or Troelstra & van Dalen, 1988, p. 229 for detail; see also Bridges, Dent & McKubre-Jordens, 2012). Bar induction is a key principle which allowed Brouwer to prove his Fan Theorem; we will outline the theorem for the binary fan, demonstrating the significance of the fan theorem.

The (complete) binary fan is the collection of all (finite) sequences of 0s and 1s (including the empty sequence). Diagrammatically, we may draw a tree-like diagram (the "fan") with a binary split for each branch at each level; one branch corresponds to 0, another to 1. A path through the binary fan is a sequence (finite or infinite) of 0s and 1s. Compare then:

  • A bar of the binary fan is a set of `cut-offs', such that for each infinite path α through the fan there exists a natural number n such that the first n terms of α are `in the bar'.
  • A bar of the binary fan is uniform if there exists a natural number N such that for each infinite path α through the fan, there is some kN such that the first k terms of α are in the bar.

Note the quantifier shift: we go from "for each path there exists n…" to "there exists N such that for each path …". Brouwer's fan theorem for the binary fan then states that

FAN: Every bar of the binary fan is uniform.

The classical contrapositive of the fan theorem, well-known in graph theory, is König's Lemma: if for every n there exists a path of length n which does not hit the bar, then there exists an infinite path that is not in the bar.

As mentioned, the fact that Brouwer's proof of the fan theorem (1927) was published nine years before König's proof of his Lemma (1936) shows the innaccuracy of the criticism sometimes held that constructive mathematics is revisionist. Indeed, as is shown by the Gödel-Gentzen negative translation (Gödel, 1933), every classical theorem may be translated into a constructive theorem (some of which are not very informative); and so constructive mathematics can be interpreted as a generalization of classical mathematics. If one adds PEM to intuitionistic logic, then the full classical system is recovered. (Of course, the reverse view may also be argued for—that classical mathematics is a generalization of constructive methods.)

3. Constructive recursive mathematics

In the 1930s, amidst developments in what is now known as computer science, concepts of algorithmic computability were formalised. The well-known Turing machines, λ-calculus, combinatory logic and the like arose. These were proved to be equivalent, leading Church, Turing and Markov to postulate the thesis now known as the Church-Markov-Turing thesis (or the Church-Turing thesis, or simply Church's thesis):

CMT: a function is computable if and only if it is computable by a Turing machine.

Markov's work, based in what he called normal algorithms (now known as Markov algorithms; Markov, 1954) was essentially recursive function theory employing intuitionistic logic. In this type of constructive mathematics, the groundwork for which was done in the 40s and 50s, Church's thesis is accepted as true (as it is to classical mathematicians, by and large). Moreover, in Markov's school, Markov's Principle of unbounded search is accepted:

MP: For any binary sequence, if it is impossible that all the terms are zero, then there exists a term equal to 1.

This reflects the idea that if it is contradictory for all the terms to be zero, then (although we do not have an a priori bound on how far in the sequence we must seek) eventually any machine that is looking for a 1 will find one in finite (possibly large) time.

While MP may seem like a kind of omniscience principle, there is a distinct difference: the implication PQ is, under the BHK interpretation, weaker than the disjunction ¬PQ. An algorithm which takes any (correct) proofs of P and turns them into (correct) proofs of Q does not leave us any the wiser which of ¬P or Q is actually the case. In part because of this, the constructive status of this principle is not so clear. While the omniscience principles are not accepted by any school of constructivism, there is at least pragmatic (that is, computer-implementable) reason to admit MP: the algorithm which will compute the 1 in a binary sequence for which it is impossible that all terms are 0 is simply to carry on the process of writing the sequence down until you come across a 1. Of course, MP does not provide a guarantee that a 1 will be found in a sequence before, say, the extinction of the human race, or the heat death of the universe.

Recursive function theory with intuitionistic logic and Markov's principle is known as Russian recursive mathematics. If Markov's principle is omitted, this leaves constructive recursive mathematics more generally—however, there appear to be few current practitioners of this style of mathematics (Beeson, 1985, p. 48).

A central tenet of recursive function theory, is the following axiom of Computable Partial Functions:

CPF: There is an enumeration of the set of all computable partial functions from N to N with countable domains.

Much may be deduced using this seemingly innocuous axiom. For example, PEM (and weakenings thereof, such as LPO) may be shown to be (perhaps surprisingly) simply false within the theory.

a. Surprises

Constructive recursive mathematics presents other surprises as well. Constructivists are already skeptical about PEM, LPO, and other wide-reaching principles. However, some amazing (and classically contradictory) results can be obtained, such as Specker's theorem (Specker, 1949):

Theorem.
There exists a strictly increasing sequence (xn)n1 of rational numbers in the closed interval [0,1] that is eventually bounded away from each real number in [0,1].

To be `eventually bounded away from a number x' means that, given the number x, one may calculate a positive integer N and a positive distance δ such that the distance from x to xk is at least δ whenever kN.

Of course such sequences cannot be uniformly bounded away from the whole of [0,1], otherwise they could not progress within [0,1] past this uniform bound (again, there is a quantifier swap, from the pointwise property xN,δ to the uniform property N,δx—recall Section 2b). While it seems like a contradictory result, the theorem becomes clear when one considers the objects of study: sequences (and functions) and real numbers, are recursive sequences and real numbers; so Specker sequences are sequences which classically converge to non-recursive numbers.

Another interesting result is the constructive existence, within this theory, of a recursive function from [0,1] to the reals which is everywhere pointwise continuous yet not uniformly continuous (as such a function would be both classically and intuitionistically, as a consequence of Brouwer's fan theorem).

4. Bishop's constructive mathematics

In 1967 Errett Bishop published the seminal monograph Foundations of Constructive Analysis (Bishop, 1967). Not only did this assuage the worries expressed by some leading mathematicians (such as Weyl) about the feasibility of constructive proofs in analysis, but it helped lay the foundation for a programme of mathematical research that has flourished since. It captures the numerical content of a large part of the classical research programme and has become the standard for constructive mathematics in the broader sense, as we will shortly see.

a. Proof readability and preservation of numerical meaning

Bishop refused to formally define the notion of algorithm in the BHK interpretation. It is in part this quality which lends Bishop-style constructive mathematics (BISH) the following property: every other model of constructive mathematics, philosophical background notwithstanding, can be seen as an interpretation of Bishop's constructive mathematics where some further assumptions have been added. For example, intuitionistic mathematics is BISH together with bar induction and continuous choice; and (Russian) constructive recursive mathematics is BISH together with the Computable Partial Functions axiom and Markov's Principle. Even classical mathematics—or mathematics with classical two-valued logic—can be seen as a model of Bishop-style constructive mathematics where the principle of excluded middle is added as axiom.

Another factor that contributes to this versatility is the fact that Bishop did not add extra philosophical commitments to the programme of his constructive mathematics, beyond the commitment of ensuring that every theorem has numerical meaning (Bishop, 1975). The idea of preserving numerical meaning is intuitive: the numerical content of any fact given in the conclusion of a theorem must somehow be algorithmically linked to (or preserved from) the numerical content of the hypotheses. Thus BISH may be used to study the same objects as the classical mathematician (or the recursive function theorist, or the intuitionist). As a result, a proof in Bishop-style mathematics can be read, understood, and accepted as correct, by everyone (Beeson, 1985, p. 49) (barring perhaps the paraconsistentists, for whom the disjunctive syllogism, weakening, and contraction—accepted under BHK—portend trouble).

At heart, Bishop's constructive mathematics is simply mathematics done with intuitionistic logic, and may be regarded as "constructive mathematics for the working mathematician" (Troelstra & van Dalen, 1988, p. 28). If one reads a Bishop-style proof, the classical analyst will recognize it as mathematics, even if some of the moves made within the proof seem slightly strange to those unaccustomed to preserving numerical meaning. Further, BISH can be interpreted in theories of computable mathematics, such as Weihrauch's Type 2 effectivity theory (Weihrauch, 2000).

b. The Axiom of Choice in BISH

One (in)famous claim Bishop makes is that "A choice function exists in constructive mathematics, because a choice is implied by the very meaning of existence" (Bishop & Bridges, 1985, p. 12). The axiom is in fact provable in some constructive theories (see Section 5). However, Diaconescu has shown that AC implies PEM, so it would seem that constructivists ought to accept PEM after all (the proof in Diaconescu (1975) is actually remarkably simple). And as we have seen, for some constructivists it would actually be inconsistent to accept PEM. It thus seems that AC, while very important, presents a significant problem for constructivists. However, as we now discuss, such a conclusion is hasty and unjustified.

The key observation to make regards the interpretation of the quantifiers. AC comes out as provable only when we interpret the quantifiers under BHK: for then the hypothesis xAyBP(x,y) says that there is an algorithm which takes us from elements x of A together with the data that x belongs to A, to an element y of B. Thus only if there is no extra work to be done beyond the construction of x in showing that x is a member of A (that is, if this can be done uniformly) will this be a genuine function from A to B. We will revisit this in Section 5. Thus the classical interperatation of AC is not valid under BHK, and PEM cannot be problematically derived.

Let us return to Bishop's statement at the start of this section, regarding the existence of a choice function being implied by the meaning of existence. The context in which his claim was made illuminates the situation. The passage (Bishop & Bridges, 1985, p. 12) goes on to read: "[Typical] applications of the axiom of choice in classical mathematics either are irrelevant or are combined with a sweeping use of the principle of omniscience." This also shows that blaming the axiom of choice for non-constructivity is actually a mistake—it is the appeal to PEM, LPO, or similar absolute principles applied to objects other than the finite which prevent proof from being thoroughly algorithmic. Some constructive mathematicians adopt various weakenings of AC which are (perhaps) less contentious; Brouwer, as we saw in Section 2, adopts Continuous Choice.

c. Foundations & Advances

Bishop's view is that the Gödel interpretation of logical symbols accurately describes numerical meaning (Bishop, 1970). This view does not appear to have retained much traction with practitioners of BISH (Beeson, 1985, p. 49). Leaving the question of foundations open is, as mentioned, partly responsible for the portability of Bishop-style proofs.

Some work has been done on founding BISH. A set-theoretic approach was proposed in Myhill (1975) and Friedman (1977); Feferman (1979) suggested an approach based on classes and operations. Yet another approach is Martin-Löf's theory of types, which we visit in Section 5.

The Techniques of Constructive Analysis book (Bridges & Vîta, 2006) develops a Bishop-style constructive mathematics that revisits and extends the work from Bishop (1967) in a more modern setting, showing how modern proof techniques from advanced topics such as Hilbert spaces and operator theory can be successfully covered constructively. It is interesting to observe that, as a rule of thumb, the more ingenious a proof looks, the less explicit numerical content it tends to contain. Thus such proofs are usually more difficult to translate into constructive proofs. Of course there are exceptions, but the comparison between (say) Robinson's nonstandard analysis and Bishop's constructive methods appears to be a confusion between elegance and content propagated by some authors; see, for example, Stewart (1986) and Richman (1987).

5. Martin-Löf Type Theory

In 1968, Per Martin-Löf published his Notes on Constructive Mathematics (Martin-Löf, 1968). It encapsulates mathematics based on recursive function theory, with a background of the algorithms of Post (1936).

However he soon revisited foundations in a different way, which harks back to Russell's type theory, albeit using a more constructive and less logicist approach. The basic idea of Martin-Löf's theory of types (Martin-Löf, 1975) is that mathematical objects all come as types, and are always given in terms of a type (for example, one such type is that of functions from natural numbers to natural numbers), due to an intuitive understanding that we have of the notion of the given type.

The central distinction Martin-Löf makes is that between proof and derivation. Derivations convince us of the truth of a statement, whereas a proof contains the data necessary for computational (that is, mechanical) verification of a proposition. Thus what one finds in standard mathematical textbooks are derivations; a proof is a kind of realizability (c.f. Kleene, 1945) and links mathematics to implementation (at least implicitly).

The theory is very reminiscent of a kind of cumulative hierarchy. Propositions can be represented as types (a proposition's type is the type of its proofs), and to each type one may associate a proposition (that the associated type is not empty). One then builds further types by construction on already existing types.

a. The Axiom of Choice is provable

Within Martin-Löf type theory, the axiom of choice, stated symbolically as

xAyBP(x,y)fBAxAP(x,f(x))


is derivable. Recall that this would be inconsistent, if AC were interpreted classically. However the axiom is derivable because in the construction of types, the construction of an element of a set (type) is sufficient to prove its membership. In Bishop-style constructive mathematics, these sets are "completely presented", in that we need to know no more than an object's construction to determine its set membership. Under the BHK interpretation, the added requirement on the proof of xAP(x) that the algorithm may depend also on the data that x belongs to A and not just on the construction of x itself is thus automatically satisfied.

It is worth noting that sets construed in this theory are constrained by this realizability criterion. For example, in Martin-Löf's theory, the power set axiom is not accepted in full generality—the power set of N, for example, is considered to be what would in classical theory be called a class, but not a set (Martin-Löf, 1975).

6. Constructive Reverse Mathematics

The program of Reverse Mathematics, instigated by Harvey Friedman (1975), aims to classify theorems according to their equivalence to various set-theoretic principles. The constructive equivalent was begun in a systematic manner by Ishihara (2006) and, separately and independently by W. Veldman in 2005.

The field has since had numerous developments, the interest of which lies mainly in the metamathematical comparison of different branches of constructive mathematics and the logical strengths of various principles endorsed or rejected by the different schools. This also points to the requirements on computational data for various properties to hold, such as various notions of compactness (Diener, 2008).

Principles whose classification is of interest include:

  • The Uniform Continuity Theorem (UCT): Every pointwise continuous mapping of the closed interval [0,1] into R is uniformly continuous.
  • Brouwer's fan theorem, and various weakenings thereof. (There is actually a hierarchy of fan theorems; see, for example, Diener, 2008.)
  • The Anti-Specker property (AS): A sequence (zn)n1 of real numbers in [0,1] that is eventually bounded away from each point of [0,1] is eventually bounded away from all of [0,1] (recall the discussion in Section 3a).
  • Omniscience principles.

It should be noted that arguably the first author dealing with reverse-mathematical ideas was Brouwer, although he certainly would not have seen it as such. The weak counterexamples (see Section 2a) he introduced were of the form: P implies some non-constructive principle. Though Brouwer may have been aware of the possibility of reversing the implication in many cases, to him non-constructive principles were meaningless and as such the full equivalence result would be of little interest.

7. Summary

The philosophical commitments of constructivist philosophies (Section 1b) are:

  • Truth is replaced by (algorithmic) proof as a primitive notion, and
  • Existence means constructibility.

This naturally leads to intuitionistic logic, characterized by the BHK interpretation (Section 1c). Omniscience principles, such as the Principle of Excluded Middle (PEM), and any mode of argument which validates such principles, are not in general valid under this interpretation, and the classical equivalence between the logical connectives does not hold.

Constructive proofs of classical theorems are often enlightening: the computational content of the hypotheses is explicitly seen to produce the conclusion. While intuitionistic logic places restrictions on inferences, the larger part of classical mathematics (or what is classically equivalent) can be recovered using only constructive methods (Section 4); there are often several constructively different versions of the same classical theorem.

The computational advantage of constructive proof is borne out in two ways. Constructive proofs:

  • embody (in principle) an algorithm (for computing objects, converting other algorithms, etc.), and
  • prove that the algorithm they embody is correct (that is, that it meets its design specification).

The programme of constructive reverse mathematics (Section 6) connects various principles and theorems (such as omniscience principles, versions of the fan theorem, etc.), shedding light on constructive or computational requirements of theorems. Furthermore, the use of Brouwerian counterexamples (Section 2a) often allows the mathematician to distinguish which aspects of classical proof are essentially nonconstructive.

Throught the article, several schools of constructivism are outlined. Each is essentially mathematics with intuitionistic logic, philosophical differences notwithstanding. Different schools add different further axioms: for example, (Russian) constructive recursive mathematics (Section 3) is mathematics with intuitionistic logic, the computable partial functions axiom (and Markov's principle of unbounded search). Classical mathematics can be interpreted as Bishop's constructive mathematics, with PEM added.

a. Some Further Remarks

The contrast between classical and constructive mathematicians is clear: in order to obtain the numerical content of a proof, the classical mathematician must be careful at each step of the proof to avoid decisions that cannot be algorithmically made; whereas the constructive mathematician, in adopting intuitionistic logic, has automatically dealt with the computational content carefully enough that an algorithm may be extracted from their proof.

In an age where computers are ubiquitous, the constructivist programme needs even less (pragmatic) justification, perhaps, than the classical approach. This is borne out by the successful translation of constructive proofs into actual algorithms (see, for example, Schwichtenberg (2009) and Berger, Berghofer, Letouzey & Schwichtenberg (2006)). The link between programming and abstract mathematics is stronger than ever, and will only strengthen as new research emerges.

8. References and Further reading

a. Further Reading

An overview of constructivism in mathematics is given in both Troelstra & van Dalen (1988), and Beeson (1985). For further reading in intuitionism from a philosophical perspective, Dummett's Elements (1977) is the prime resource. The Bishop and Bridges book (1985) is the cornerstone textbook for the Bishop-style constructivist. For the finitist version, see Ye (2011), where it is shown that even a strict finitist interpretation allows large tracts of constructive mathematics to be realized; in particular we see application to finite things of Lebesgue integration, and extension of the constructive theory to semi-Riemannian geometry. For advances and techniques in Bishop-style mathematics, see Bridges & Vîta (2006). For an introduction to constructive recursive function theory, see Richman (1983); Bridges & Richman (1987) expounds the theory relative to other kinds of constructive mathematics. For an introduction to computable analysis, see, for example, Weihrauch (2000). For topology, Bridges & Vîta (2011) outlays a Bishop-style development of topology; Sambin (1987) and (2003) are good starting points for further reading in the recent development of point-free (or formal) topology.

b. References

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Author Information

Maarten McKubre-Jordens
Email: maarten.jordens@canterbury.ac.nz
University of Canterbury
New Zealand

Bioethics

Bioethics is a rather young academic inter-disciplinary field that has emerged rapidly as a particular moral enterprise against the background of the revival of applied ethics in the second half of the twentieth century. The notion of bioethics is commonly understood as a generic term for three main sub-disciplines: medical ethics, animal ethics, and environmental ethics. Each sub-discipline has its own particular area of bioethics, but there is a significant overlap of many issues, ethical approaches, concepts, and moral considerations. This makes it difficult to examine and to easily solve vital moral problems such as abortion, xenotransplantation, cloning, stem cell research, the moral status of animals and the moral status of nature (the environment). In addition, the field of bioethics presupposes at least some basic knowledge of important life sciences, most notably medicine, biology (including genetics), biochemistry, and biophysics in order to deal successfully with particular moral issues. This article also contains a discussion about the vital issue of moral status—and hence protection—in the context of bioethics, that is, whether moral status is ascribed depending on rationality, harm, or any other feature. For example, it might well be the case that non-sentient beings such as plants and unique stone formations, such as the Grand Canyon, do have a moral standing—at least, to some degree—and should not be deliberately destroyed by virtue of either their instrumental or intrinsic value for human beings. The last part contains a discussion of the main bioethical theories including their main line of reasoning and complex challenges in contemporary philosophy.

Table of Contents

  1. Preliminary Distinctions
  2. A Brief History of Bioethics
    1. The Origin of the Notion of Bioethics
    2. The Origin of the Academic Discipline and Institutionalization of Bioethics
    3. The Origin of Bioethics as a Phenomenon
  3. Sub-disciplines in Bioethics
    1. Introduction
    2. Medical Ethics
    3. Animal Ethics
    4. Environmental Ethics
  4. The Idea of Moral Status in Bioethics
  5. Theory in Bioethics
    1. Introduction
    2. Deontological Approaches
    3. Utilitarianism
    4. The Four-Principle Approach
    5. Virtue Ethics
    6. Casuistry
    7. Feminist Bioethics
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. References
    2. Further Reading

1. Preliminary Distinctions

Rapid developments in the natural sciences and technology (including biotechnology) have greatly facilitated better living conditions and increased the standard of living of people worldwide. On the other hand, there are undesirable consequences, such as nuclear waste, water and air pollution, the clearing of tropical forests, and large-scale livestock farming, as well as particular innovations such as gene technology and cloning, which have caused qualms and even fears concerning the future of humankind. Lacunae in legal systems, for example, regarding abortion and euthanasia, additionally are a cause of grave concern for many people. Furthermore, moral problems which stem from a concrete situation, for example, gene-manipulated food, have given rise to heated public debates and serious public concerns with regard to safety issues in the past. There was—and still is—a need for ethical guidance which is not satisfied simply by applying traditional ethical theories to the complex and novel problems of the twenty-first century.

What are the general goals of bioethics? As a discipline of applied ethics and a particular way of ethical reasoning that substantially depends on the findings of the life sciences, the goals of bioethics are manifold and involve, at least, the following aspects:

  1. Discipline: Bioethics provides a disciplinary framework for the whole array of moral questions and issues surrounding the life sciences concerning human beings, animals, and nature.
  2. Inter-disciplinary Approach: Bioethics is a particular way of ethical reasoning and decision making that: (i) integrates empirical data from relevant natural sciences, most notably medicine in the case of medical ethics, and (ii) considers other disciplines of applied ethics such as research ethics, information ethics, social ethics, feminist ethics, religious ethics, political ethics, and ethics of law in order to solve the case in question.
  3. Ethical Guidance: Bioethics offers ethical guidance in a particular field of human conduct.
  4. Clarification: Bioethics points to many novel complex cases, for example, gene technology, cloning, and human-animal chimeras and facilitates the awareness of the particular problem in public discourse.
  5. Structure: Bioethics elaborates important arguments from a critical examination of judgements and considerations in discussions and debates.
  6. Internal Auditing: The combination of bioethics and new data that stem from the natural sciences may influence−in some cases −the key concepts and approaches of basic ethics by providing convincing evidence for important specifications, for example, the generally accepted concept of personhood might be incomplete, too narrow, or ethically problematic in the context of people with disability and, hence, need to be modified accordingly.

In other words, bioethics is concerned with a specific area of human conduct concerning the animate (for example, human beings and animals) and inanimate (for example, stones) natural world against the background of the life sciences and deals with the various problems that arise from this complex amalgam. Furthermore, bioethics is not only an inter-disciplinary field but also multidisciplinary since bioethicists come from various disciplines, each with its own distinctive set of assumptions. While this facilitates new and valuable perspectives , it also causes problems for a more integrated approach to bioethics.

2. A Brief History of Bioethics

Historically speaking, there are three possible ways at least to address the history of bioethics. First, by the origin of the notion of bioethics, second, by the origin of the academic discipline and the institutionalization of bioethics, and third, by the origin of bioethics as a phenomenon. Each focuses on different aspects concerning the history of bioethics; however, one can only understand and appreciate the whole picture if one takes all three into account.

a. The Origin of the Notion of Bioethics

It is commonly said that the origin of the notion of bioethics is twofold: (i) the publishing of two influential articles; Potter’s “Bioethics, the Science of Survival” (1970), which suggests viewing bioethics as a global movement in order to foster concern for the environment and ethics, and Callahan’s “Bioethics as a Discipline” (1973), in which he argues for the establishment of a new academic discipline, and (ii) discussions between Shriver and Hellegers about the need for an institute in which researchers should examine and analyse medical dilemmas by appealing to moral philosophy (1970). This institute was created in 1971 as the Joseph and Rose Kennedy Center for the Study of Human Reproduction and Bioethics, and is now known as the Kennedy Institute of Ethics (see, also the Institute of Society, Ethics, and the Life Sciences, 1969). However, this  oft-repeated story about the origin of the term bioethics is incorrect. Sass (2007) is right in claiming that the German theologian Fritz Jahr published three articles in 1927, 1928, and 1934 using the German term “Bio-Ethik” (which translates as “Bio-Ethics”) and forcefully argued, both for the establishment of a new academic discipline,  and for the practice of a new, more civilized, ethical approach to issues concerning human beings and the environment. Jahr famously proclaimed his bioethical imperative: “Respect every living being, in principle, as an end in itself and treat it accordingly wherever it is possible,” (1927: 4).

b. The Origin of the Academic Discipline and Institutionalization of Bioethics

The origin of the discipline of bioethics in the USA goes hand in hand with the origin of its institutionalization. At the beginning of this complex process, bioethics was seen as more or less identical with medical ethics−the latter notion is first mentioned by Thomas Percival (1803) −and was mainly conducted by philosophers, theologians, and a few physicians. Animal ethics and environmental ethics are sub-disciplines which emerged at a later date. In the beginning, the great demand for medical ethics was grounded in reaction to some negative events, such as the research experiments on human subjects committed by the Nazis and the Tuskegee Syphilis Study (1932–1972) in the USA. At that time, bioethics was rather driven by urgent cases (“putting out fires”) and did not consider systematic problems in healthcare such as the access to quality care. However, in reaction to these horrible events, the Nuremberg Code (1947) and the Declaration of Helsinki (1964) were created in order to provide researchers and physicians with ethical guidelines. In the case of the Tuskegee Syphilis Study (Belmont Report 1979), and other experiments in clinical research (Beecher 1966), one has to concede however that they were performed in the full knowledge of both sets of guidelines (and hence against the basic and most important idea of individual informed consent).

In particular, the idea of individual informed consent is due to the Prussian and German bureaucratic regulations of 1900/01 that appeal to the case of Dr. Albert Neisser in 1896 who publicly announced his concern about the possible dangers to the experimental subjects whom he vaccinated with an experimental immunizing serum (Zentralblatt der gesamten Unterrichtsverwaltung in Preussen 1901: 188). Additionally, the investigation of the death of 75 German children caused by the use of experimental tuberculosis vaccines in 1931 revealed that the mandatory informed consent was not obtained (Rundschreiben des Reichsministers des Inneren 28.2.1931, in: Sass 1989: 362-366). Baker rightly states that “the informed consent doctrine was thus originally a regulatory innovation created by Prussian bureaucrats; it was not an artefact of American legal or philosophical culture but of German bureaucratic culture. It was a German solution to problems created by the advances of German biomedical science” (Baker 1998: 250).

Furthermore, influential books such as Morals and Medicine: The Moral Problems of the Patient’s Right to Know the Truth, Contraception, Artificial Insemination, Sterilization, and Euthanasia (Fletcher 1954) and Ramsey’s ground breaking book, The Patient as Person: Explorations in Medical Ethics (1970) argued that there was a serious and urgent need for thinking about complex moral issues in medicine and thereby facilitated the creation of the new academic discipline of  medical ethics (also known as bioethics).

Against this background, the Institute of Society, Ethics, and the Life Sciences (1969), later known as the Hastings Center, and the Joseph and Rose Kennedy Center for the Study of Human Reproduction and Bioethics (1971) were created. They were the first two (academic) institutions to conduct research in medical ethics and to publish high quality academic journals: the Hastings Center Report and the Kennedy Institute of Ethics Journal. Many bioethics programs and degrees were established at universities in the USA during the 1970s and 1980s in order to provide students−most notably medical, law, and public policy students−with some expertise in medical ethics to deal with complex cases. In the early years, the bioethics programs were mainly funded by foundations such as the Rockefeller Foundation, the Russell Sage Foundation, the Ford Foundation and others, as well as by donations from individuals such as the Kennedy family.

The need for medical ethics experts and commissions was fostered by a series of important events in medicine, especially the Harvard Definition of Brain Death (1968), Roe v. Wade (1973), the Karen Ann Quinlan case (1975), and Baby Doe (1982). Since, most hospitals in the USA provide clinical ethics consultation that is mainly due to the requirement of The Joint Commission for Accreditation of Healthcare Organizations—in 2007 renamed the Joint Commission—that accredited hospitals must have a method for addressing ethical issues that arise (JCAHO 1992: 106).

Furthermore, new technologies in the life sciences caused new inventions and possibilities for the survival of the sick; kidney dialysis, intensive care units, organ transplantation, and respirators, to name just a few. Severe problems concerning the just distribution of health care resources emerged, for example, in access to kidney dialysis and intensive care units due to the consequences of scarcity, which caused much debate (concerning problems of resource allocation, for instance). The upshot is that the origins of bioethics as a discipline and its institutionalization can be traced back to the second half of the twentieth century in the USA. Other countries then adapted to the new situation and established their own bioethics programs and institutions.

c. The Origin of Bioethics as a Phenomenon

The notion of bioethics and the origin of the discipline of bioethics and its institutionalization in academia is a modern development. The phenomenon itself, however, can be traced back, at least with any certainty, to the Hippocratic Oath in Antiquity (500 B.C.E.) in the case of medical ethics (Jonsen 2008) and possibly beyond if one considers the Code of Hammurabi (1750 B.C.E.), which contains some written provisions related to medical practice (Kuhse and Singer 2009: 4).

The idea that animals have a moral status (§4) and should be protected is based in modern moral philosophy, most notably utilitarianism, on the one hand, and the animal rights movement in the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries in Europe (in particular, England and Germany) and the USA. On the other hand, Aristotle, Thomas Aquinas, and Kant had a lasting (negative) effect on the way people thought about animals and their moral status. According to Aristotle (400 B.C.E.), animals do not have a moral status and hence human beings cannot treat them unjustly. This line of thought was omnipresent during the time of the Romans and was reflected their great pleasure in animal hunts in the Colosseum and the Circus Maximus between the second century B.C.E. and the sixth century C.E. Researchers estimate that hundreds of thousands of animals were killed in order to please the public (“panem et circenses”). Only one incident is documented in the long and bloody history of cruelty against animals in Rome, when the audience sided with a group of elephants and proclaimed that the emperor showed cruelty to these majestic creatures, which was seen by the public as an “immoral act”. According to Thomas Aquinas (thirteenth century), who shaped the Christian view on the moral status of animals for several hundred years, animals have no moral status and human beings are allowed to use them for their own comfort since everything is made by God and subjected to the rule of human beings. Kant (eighteenth century) famously argued that animals have no moral status but one should treat them appropriately since cruelty against animals might have a negative effect on our behaviour towards our fellow humans, that is, the brutalization of human behaviour.

The idea of protecting nature/the environment is a contemporary thought that particularly evolved by virtue of public concern about the rapid technological developments in the twentieth century and the extreme dangers to the whole globe posed by these developments, for example, nuclear waste, water and air pollution, the clearing of tropical forests, and global warming. The point is, however, that a concern for bioethical issues is much older than the name of the phenomenon itself and the academic discipline.

3. Sub-disciplines in Bioethics

a. Introduction

Bioethics is a discipline of applied ethics and comprises three main sub-disciplines: medical ethics, animal ethics, and environmental ethics. Even though they are “distinct” branches in focusing on different areas—namely, human beings, animals, and nature—they have a significant overlap of particular issues, vital conceptions and theories as well as prominent lines of argumentation. Solving bioethical issues is a complex and demanding task. An interesting analogy in this case is that of a neural network in which the neural knot can be compared to the bioethical problem, and the network itself can be compared to the many different links to other vital issues and moral problems on different levels (and regarding different disciplines and sub-disciplines). Sometimes it seems that the attempt to settle a moral problem stirs up a hornets’ nest because many plausible suggestions cause further (serious) issues. However, a brief overview of the bioethical sub-disciplines is as follows.

b. Medical Ethics

The oldest sub-discipline of bioethics is medical ethics which can be traced back to the introduction of the Hippocratic Oath (500 B.C.E.). Of course, medical ethics is not limited to the Hippocratic Oath; rather that marks the beginning of Western ethical reasoning and decision making in medicine. The Hippocratic Oath is a compilation of ancient texts concerning the proper behaviour of physicians and the relationship between physician and patient. It also contains some binding ethical rules of utmost importance such as the well known principle of non-maleficence (“primum non nocere”) and the principle of beneficence (“salus aegroti suprema lex”); furthermore, doctor-patient confidentiality and the prohibition on exploiting the patient (including sexual exploitation) are important rules that are still valid.

Other more critical elements of the Hippocratic Oath such as the strict prohibition of euthanasia and abortion seem to be rather debatable and raise the vital question of how to distinguish between valuable and less valuable principles it proposes. In contemporary bioethics, euthanasia is—in general—widely regarded as an eligible autonomous decision of the patient that must be respected. With regard to abortion, most bioethicists believe that it should be allowed, at least, under certain circumstances, but this issue is still hotly debated and causes many emotional responses. The upshot is that one needs a more fundamental theoretical analysis of the particular elements of the Hippocratic Oath in order to determine possible traditional shortcomings in more detail before one accepts them as a fixed set of unquestionable professional rules. Furthermore, the idea that “the physician knows best” and should be able to act against the will of the patient for the benefit of the patient (that is, the patriarchal model of the physician-patient relationship) also originated in ancient times. The competence of the physician was too overwhelming for most people so that they almost always complied with the physician’s advice.

In medical ethics, one is concerned with the general ethical question of “what should one do” under the particular circumstances of medicine. In this respect, medical ethics is not different from basic ethics but it is limited to the area of medicine and deals with its particular state of affairs.

There are a number of important traditional issues in medical ethics that still need to be solved. These include beginning- and end-of-life issues (notably abortion, euthanasia, and limiting therapeutic treatments), the physician-patient relationship, research on human beings (including research ethics and human genetics). More recent medical issues include reproductive decision making, organ transplantation, just distribution of healthcare resources, access to healthcare, and most recently vital issues concerning healthcare systems and (global) public health. In the twentieth century, medical ethics was focused on−but not limited to− two main issues: the concept of personhood (for example, the Singer debate) and the principle of autonomy (that is, individual informed consent). The rise of autonomy in the context of the physician-patient relationship can be seen as the counter-movement to paternalism in healthcare. Both vital issues pervaded many debates in medical ethics in the past and can been seen as key issues that shaped the discussions in academia, at the theoretical level, and were highly influential on the ward, that is in practice, as well.

c. Animal Ethics

The history of ethics is to some extent a history of who is and should be part of the moral community. Roughly speaking, in Antiquity only men of a particular social status were part of the moral community; several hundred years later, after a long and hard social struggle women achieved equal status with men−even though there is still a long way to go in many parts of most societies (for example, in the job market and equal pay for equal work). The idea that animals should be part of the moral community mainly evolved in the context of the ethics of utilitarianism in the nineteenth century, most notably spearheaded by Jeremy Bentham, who famously argued that it does not matter morally whether animals can reason but rather whether they can suffer. In addition, animal rights groups were founded in the USA and Europe (in particular, in Protestant England and Germany) by virtue of a new awareness of sensitivity towards cruelty against animals (for example, vivisection) and a growing feeling of compassion for the suffering of animals in general (see Schopenhauer). This new paradigmatic moral shift was supported by the scientific findings of Darwin’s evolutionary theory. The findings undermined the sharp (empirical) distinction between human and animal posed by the traditional natural rights position that only rational human beings are part of the moral community (see also the objection of speciesism, §3d). Evolutionary theory provides convincing empirical evidence that there is a natural kinship between human beings and animals in the sense that human beings evolved from animals through  a long, gradual process.

Current problems include research on animals (including vivisection), livestock farming and animal transports, xenotransplantation, human-animal chimera, meat eating versus vegetarianism/veganism, the legitimacy of zoos and circuses, religious freedom versus animal protection, recreational hunting, and the growing conflict between the protection of the environment and animal welfare. These pose complex moral issues that need to be addressed appropriately by responding to the question of whether animals have a moral status in general (and why), and, if they do, what their exact moral rank is.

All ethical viewpoints defending the protection of animals broaden the scope of the traditional position by claiming that the ability to suffer is the key point and hence sentient beings should be protected as part of the moral community. Two ground-breaking and highly influential books written by the utilitarian Peter Singer (1975) and Tom Regan (1983), who favors a Kantian-oriented approach, were the starting point of a more sophisticated discussion in academia and which also influenced many laypeople across the world. Singer argues for a utilitarian animal ethics based on the equal consideration of interests of sentient beings in combination with the criterion of the ability to feel pain. Regan claims instead that sentient beings who are able to see themselves as “subjects of life” do have an “inherent value” which provides them with strong defensible moral rights that implicate prima facie duties for human beings towards animals. Other  ethical approaches contribute important insights as well. Virtue ethics calls for one not to undermine the aspiration of the good life by acting in a cruel way towards animals but acknowledge the animal-like part of one’s existence (Midgley 1984). Feminist care ethics implies animals stand in an asymmetrical relation of care and responsibility towards human beings (Donovan and Adams 1996). Discourse ethics implies animals are part of the moral community through the voice of a surrogate decision maker (Habermas 1997).

d. Environmental Ethics

Generally speaking, environmental ethics deals with the moral dimension of the relationship between human beings and non-human nature−animals and plants, local populations, natural resources and ecosystems,  landscapes, as well as the biosphere and the cosmos. Strictly speaking, human beings are, of course, part of nature and it seems somewhat odd to claim that there is a contrast between human beings and non-human nature. At second glance, however, it seems reasonable to make this distinction because human beings are the only beings who are able to reason about the consequences of their actions which may influence the whole of nature or parts of nature in a positive or negative way.

Ideas about the “right” conduct concerning the environment are as old as humankind but the establishment of environmental ethics as an academic discipline dates back to the 1970s when issues of vital importance emerged, such as the global threat to the natural basis of existence, the growing number of extinct species, the destruction of ecosystems and natural resources, as well as the more recognized dangers of technological inventions—for example, nuclear power, including its radioactive waste, and the new biotechnologies like genetic engineering. The exploitation of the environment was first justified by the religious teachings of the Old Testament (such as the stewardship of the environment in the Bible) and, during the secular period of the Enlightenment, supported by Francis Bacon’s scientific program to (rigorously) disclose all the secrets of nature. René Descartes’ famous and influential dualism of rational beings, on the one hand, and soulless matter, on the other hand, led to the debasement of nature, including animals, since the objects of morality were by nature rational beings only. The first serious counter-movement can be traced back to the Romantic philosophies of nature of the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries. In the non-Western context, the idea of respect for and valuing nature is more prevalent and at least 2500 years old, referring to the general teachings of Hinduism and Buddhism which influenced the Western view in Europe in the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries (for example, Schopenhauer). Of course, contemporary environmentalists, particularly feminist ethicists and supporters of the idea of natural aesthetics, have refined the criticism of the traditional view by claiming that animals and nature are not valueless but deserving of moral protection.

It is possible to make the following broad distinctions regarding environmental ethics. Environmental ethics is commonly divided into two distinct areas: (i) anthropocentrism and (ii) non-anthropocentrism (or physiocentrism). Anthropocentric approaches such as virtue ethics and deontology stress the particular human perspective, and claim that values depend on human beings only. Values are relational and require a rational being, hence animals and non-human nature are not per se objects of morality, unless indirectly, by virtue of a surrogate decision maker. According to the anthropocentric view, only (rational) human beings deserve moral protection although one should respect and protect nature either for the sake of human beings (instrumental view) or for the sake of nature itself (non-instrumental view). Anthropocentrism is faced with the objection of speciesism, the view that the mere affiliation to the species of Homo sapiens is sufficient to grant a higher moral status to human beings in comparison with animals. Singer has powerfully claimed, however, that the “mere difference of species in itself cannot determine moral status” (Singer 2009: 567).

Non-anthropocentrism (or physiocentrism) mainly consists of three main branches: (1) pathocentrism, (2) biocentrism, and (3) ecocentrism, which can be further divided into an individualistic and holistic version. All non-anthropocentric approaches share the common claim that there are “objective” or more straightforward naturalistic values which are non-relational (intrinsic) and do not presuppose rational human beings. Nature (including animals) itself is valuable, independently of whether there are any human beings or not (non-instrumental view), even though one has to acknowledge the fact that many arguments about intrinsic value also have instrumental underpinnings. Supporters of pathocentrism argue that all sentient beings deserve moral consideration and protection, equally/egalitarian or non-equally/non-egalitarian with reference to human beings (see Singer 1975, Regan 1983, Wolf 1996). Adherents of biocentrism claim that all beings should be part of the moral community. Finally, supporters of ecocentrism argue that the whole of nature deserves moral protection, either according to an individualistic or holistic approach. If individualistically, all “things” in nature are bearers of moral values and are of equal moral worth. If holistically, there are traditionally at least three main positions: (a) ecofeminism, (b) deep ecology, and (c) the land ethics. Ecofeminists believe that there is a parallel between the systems of domination that affect both women and nature. Therefore, if human beings are willing to change the way they act towards nature, they must understand the real causes of the problem−the idea that nature is rather irrational and passive as well as needing to be controlled by human beings (Plumwood 1986, Warren 1987). According to deep ecologists, human beings should view themselves as being a part of and not distinct from the natural world by virtue of a refined notion of the self. All living things, according to the founder of deep ecology, Arne Naess, have an equal right to flourish (“biospherical egalitarianism”). Proponents of the land ethics argue that one should stop  treating the land as a mere resource, but view it as a precious source of energy. Aldo Leopold, the founder of land ethics, famously claims: “A thing is right when it tends to preserve the integrity, stability, and beauty of the biotic community. It is wrong when it tends otherwise.” (Leopold 1949/1989: 218-225).

4. The Idea of Moral Status in Bioethics

Bioethical debates, particularly in animal ethics and environmental ethics, are concerned with issues of moral status and moral protection. The vital question is, for example, whether all animals have a moral status and hence are members of the moral community enjoying moral protection or whether they do not have a moral status at all (or only to some degree for some animals, such as higher mammals such as great apes, dolphins and elephants). But, even if animals do not have a moral status and hence have no moral rights, it could be the case that they still are morally significant in the sense that human beings are not allowed to do whatever they want to do with them (for example, to torture animals for fun). The fundamental idea of granting a living being a moral status is to protect the particular being from various kinds of harm which undermine the being’s flourishing. For example, one can protect the great apes by granting them a moral status which is important for their survival since one can then legally enforce their moral right not to be killed.

But what are the prerequisites for ascribing a being a moral status and hence moral rights and (legal) protection? And, furthermore, what about non-sentient nature, such as tropical rainforests, the Grand Canyon, mammoth trees, and beautiful landscapes? Do they have a moral status as well? Are they morally significant at least to some degree? Or are human beings allowed to do whatever they want to do with non-human nature?

Traditionally, philosophers made the distinction between sentient beings and non-sentient beings (including the environment) and argued that only beings who have an intrinsic worth are valuable and hence deserve moral concern and (legal) protection. Therefore, it is the intrinsic worth of the particular being that is important for the ascription of the being’s moral status as well as the being’s moral and legal protection. If a being has no intrinsic worth, then it has no moral status, and so forth. It has been commonly argued that the intrinsic worth of a being can be fleshed out by claiming that it is rationality or the capacity to reason which is the underlying motif for ascribing “intrinsic worth” (for example, Kant). This line of reasoning is anthropocentric and is faced with the objection of speciesism (§3d). A somewhat different view is, for example, to claim that even the Grand Canyon has an intrinsic worth by virtue of its uniqueness and great beauty. In this respect, the notion of intrinsic worth is fleshed out by the idea of uniqueness and beauty and hence one avoids (to some degree) anthropocentrism and the objection of speciesism. But, on the other hand, this position seems questionable for at least two important reasons. First, “being unique” seems to be of no moral importance at all. For example, if a dog was born with two heads, one might say that this is unique but it would seem awkward to grant the dog protection by virtue of his two heads. Rather, one would be more likely to protect him in order to study the dog’s particular abnormality. This, however, has nothing to do with the dog’s supposed intrinsic worth based on his uniqueness but everything to do with his instrumental value for some scientists. Secondly, to say that something (or someone) is “beautiful” seems to presuppose a sentient being that values the particular thing in the first place; hence we are not concerned with an intrinsic worth but rather with an instrumental worth with reference to a particular valuer. According to this reasoning, the Grand Canyon should be protected since it causes great experiences in people who stand in awe of this landscape when they appreciate the great beauty of it and simply feel good about it.

Some scholars argue that one has to be cautious of examining the moral status of non-human nature through the lens of a purely anthropocentric line of reasoning because it conceptually downplays the value of animals and the environment right from the start. However, on the other hand, many people find it questionable to argue for the moral rights of stones, sunflowers, and earthworms. Even so, it seems plausible to consider that there might be a significant distinction between the moral status of stones, sunflowers, and earthworms by virtue of their instrumental value for human beings. For example, the Grand Canyon might have a certain moral status because this unique stone formation makes human beings not only view it with awe, but also aesthetically admire it, which is the reason not to deliberately destroy the Grand Canyon. Sunflowers are nice to look at and hence are enjoyable for human beings, therefore one should not deliberately destroy them; earthworms are useful for the thriving of plants (including sunflowers) which is good both for animals and human beings since they loosen the ground, and hence they should not be deliberately destroyed as well. The differing moral status of stones, sunflowers, and earthworms—if there is any—could then be eventually ranked according to their particular instrumental value for human beings. Or one could argue that stones, sunflowers, and earthworms have an intrinsic (that is, non-instrumental) value in so far as they are valuable as such. Then, a possible ranking concerning their moral status might either depend on their supposed usefulness for other entities (a case of intrinsic value with instrumental underpinnings) or on a fixed general order of non-instrumental values: first, animals, second, animated plants, and third, the most inanimate, such as stones. Against this fixed order, however, some people could object that mammoth trees—the gigantic several hundred years old majestic trees—should be ranked higher than simple earthworms because they are very rare and make human beings view them with awe.  That is, it might well be the case that sometimes animated plants such as majestic mammoth trees morally outweigh lower forms of animals such as earthworms. Furthermore, one could even argue, then, that the Grand Canyon morally outweighs a group of majestic mammoth trees and so forth. As a result, it seems reasonable to acknowledge the fact that there is no easy way to determine: (1) The exact moral status between different life forms within the animated group, as well as the moral status between the animated and the most inanimated in non-human nature, and (2) the exact moral status between human and non-human nature, if one does not hold the view that human beings have the same moral standing as animals and plants (that is, human beings and non-human nature).

Thus, one might eventually conclude that, in general, morally appropriate conduct towards non-human nature should focus on paying attention to the many details of the particular case and the consequences of one’s actions. In sum, do no premeditated harm (for example, do not torture animals for fun, restrain large-scale livestock farming), preserve nature wherever it is possible (by, for example, avoiding water and air pollution and protecting tropical rainforests from clearing). As Hans Jonas famously put it, be responsible in your dealings with non-human nature.

5. Theory in Bioethics

a. Introduction

Bioethics is an important inter-disciplinary and rapidly emerging field of applied ethics. The traditional but deficient view concerning ethical reasoning and decision making in applied ethics is that one simply “applies” a particular ethical theory such as utilitarianism or deontology in a given context such as business (business ethics), politics (political ethics), or issues related to human health (medical ethics) in order to solve the moral problem in question. This top-down approach of ethical reasoning and decision making adheres to the idea that ethics is quite similar to geometry, in that it presupposes a solid foundation from which principles and general rules can be inferred and then applied to concrete cases independent of the details of the particular case. The locus of certitude, that is, the place of the greatest certainty for principle ethics—approaches using one master principle—concerns its foundation; the reasonableness of the ethical decision is passed on from the foundation itself.

This picture is awry. In the twentieth century it was clearly shown that the traditional ethical theories had great difficulty in solving the new contemporary problems such as nuclear power and its radioactive waste, issues related to the new biotechnologies (for example, genetic enhancement, cloning), and so on. The consequences were, first, that the two main classical theories in principle ethics—deontology and utilitarianism—were modified in order to deal more properly and successfully with the new situation. For example, Christine Korsgaard modified Kantianism and Richard Hare modified utilitarianism. Secondly, new approaches of ethical reasoning and decision making were developed, such as Beauchamp and Childress’s four-principle approach in bioethics and feminist bioethics. Casuistry and virtue ethics—the bottom-up approaches—were rediscovered and refined in order to examine complex bioethical issues. The rise of applied ethics in general and the rise of bioethics in particular has been faced with an overwhelming variety of details and complex circumstances with regard to the rapidly emerging ethical issues against the background of the fast development of new technologies and the process of globalization, accompanied by an awakening of individual autonomy and the rejection of being submissive to authority. Sound ethical approaches in applied ethics must at least fulfill two criteria: (1) They must be consistent and (2) they must be applicable. These are the minimum conditions for any successful ethical theory in applied ethics.

In addition, one might raise the issue of reaching an agreement about what to do in practice against the background of competing moral theories. There is a twofold response to this well-known problem. First, most cases (for example, clinical ethics consultations, commission work, and so forth) reveal that there is a broad consensus among people concerning the results (practical level) but that they—quite often—differ considerably in their justifications at the theoretical level. Secondly, it might well be the case—as some scholars such as Gert and Beauchamp claim—that some people without adhering to moral relativism have equally good reasons about what to do in practice but, nonetheless, still differ about what and why it should be done. Contrary to the first response, the second response is more alarming since the idea that people could have equally good reasons for differing suggestions seems odd, at least at first sight. At second glance, however, moral judgements might not only depend on pure reason alone but are influenced by different cultures, religions, and traditions that would substantiate the claim of different outcomes and justifications. Whether one is, then, necessarily committed to a form of moral relativism can be reasonably questioned since one can still make the convincing distinction between a hard core of moral norms that is universally shared (for example, that one should not commit murder or lie and that one should help people in need) and other moral norms which are non-universal by nature. If that is correct, then this would solve the issue of moral relativism.

The following brief depiction of (bio)ethical theories, including their main points of criticism, provides an overview of the  approaches (see also Düwell and Steigleder 2003: 41-210; Kuhse and Singer 2009: 65-125).

b. Deontological Approaches

Deontological approaches such as provided by Kant (1785) and Ross (1930) are commonly characterized by applying usually strict moral rules or norms to concrete cases. Religious approaches, such as those of the Catholic Church, and non-religious deontological approaches, such as Kantian-oriented theories, are prime examples of applying moral rules. For example, the (extreme) conservative position of the Catholic Church justifies that one should not abort fetuses, under any circumstances, including in cases of rape (Noonan 1970) and forbids the use of condoms. Furthermore, the Catholic Church regularly defends its strict religious position in end-of-life cases to prolong human life as long as possible and not to practice euthanasia (or physician-assisted suicide) because human life is sacred and given as a gift from God. In this respect, religious approaches are necessarily faced with the objection of speciesism, if they claim that it is sufficient to be a member of the human species in order to be protected. Kantian-oriented approaches, instead, are not necessarily faced with this objection because—at least, in the original version—moral status is assigned according to “rationality” and not according to “membership of the human species”. Other Neo-Kantian deontological approaches, however, might emphasize “human dignity” and hence run into serious troubles with regard to the objection of speciesism as well. In other words, there is a fundamental disagreement inherent in the notion of human dignity—roughly, the idea that there is something special about human beings—and the ascription of moral status to non-human nature such as animals and plants.

Kantian-oriented deontological approaches (or Kantianism) generally adhere to the basic Kantian ideas of respect for persons and human dignity; both central ideas are rooted in the human being’s capacity to act autonomously. Kantianism has been adopted in order to provide a justification for strict truth telling in medical contexts, for example, in cases of terminal cancer, bedside rationing, and medical experiments. This development can be seen as a counter-movement against previous malpractice. The former practice consisted in not telling the truth to the patient in order either not to cause additional harm or not to undermine the goals of the medical experiments (for example, the Tuskegee Syphilis Study). In the late 20th century, this has changed by virtue of acknowledging the patient’s right to be told the truth about his or her health condition. Likewise, regarding the patient’s involvement in research studies—including research with placebos—in order to enable the patient to make adequate autonomous decisions (that is, individual informed consent). The second formula of Kant’s Categorical Imperative—“Act in such a way that you treat humanity, whether in your own person or in the person of any other, never merely as a means to an end, but always at the same time as an end” (Kant 1785/1968)—has been successfully used in different medical contexts in order to avoid abuses. In particular, it is nowadays used to avoid abuses in research experiments on human subjects. The sad examples of the Tuskegee Syphilis Study and the Human Radiation Experiments clearly show the dangers of researchers acting in a highly dubious and immoral way (see, The Belmont Report 1979). Additionally, deontological approaches have been used in the fields of animal ethics (Regan 1983, Korsgaard 1996, 2004, Wood 1998) and environmental ethics (Taylor 1986, Korsgaard 1996). Altman (2011) offers a thorough examination of the strengths and weaknesses of Kant’s ethics concerning a vast range of important bioethical issues in contemporary applied ethics.

Genuine religious approaches are problematic by virtue of their strong commitment to religious presuppositions such as the existence of God as the ultimate source of morality or the absolute sacredness of the human life. In modern—or rather secular—societies, this line of reasoning cannot be taken as a universal starting point to justify moral norms for religious and non-religious people alike in medical contexts on issues such as abortion, euthanasia, the use of contraceptives, and genetic enhancement. Despite the prima facie reasonableness of Kantian-oriented deontological approaches in cases concerning truth telling and in the context of medical exploitation, they particularly suffer from using moral norms too general and abstract  to be applied without difficulty or stiltedness to concrete cases. The upshot is that deontological approaches are less effective at providing adequate guidance since their application is too complex and possibly misleading (for a different view, see Altman 2011) or causes strong counter-intuitive intuitions in the case of religious positions.

c. Utilitarianism

One of the most prominent and influential ways of ethical reasoning and decision making in the field of bioethics is based on utilitarianism. In the late twentieth century, utilitarian approaches were so influential that many people outside academia believed that all bioethicists were utilitarians. Utilitarianism, in fact, contains a wide range of different approaches, but one can distinguish four important core elements that all utilitarian approaches have in common:

  1. The consequence principle: The consequences of a given action are the measure of its moral quality.
  2. The utility principle: The moral rightness and wrongness of actions are determined by the greatest possible utility for the greatest possible number of all sentient beings.
  3. The hedonistic principle: The consequences of a given action are evaluated with reference to a particular value. This particular prime value can be as follows: (1) Promoting pleasure, or (2) avoiding pain, or (3) satisfaction of interests or considered preferences, or (4) satisfaction of some objective criteria of well-being, and so forth.
  4. The universal principle: Maximize the total utility for all sentient beings affected.

Utilitarian approaches in bioethics were spearheaded by Singer (1979) and Harris (1975) and carried on by, among others, Savulescu (2001, 2002) and Schüklenk (2010). Such approaches in bioethics are less concerned with public welfare than other vital aspects, such as: (1) debunking the traditional religious views on the sacredness of human beings, the prohibition of abortion, infanticide, and euthanasia; (2) stressing the importance of non-rational sentient animals (animal ethics) and the preservation of nature (environmental ethics) against anthropocentric approaches such as Kantianism and religious approaches; (3) arguing against the use of human rights and human dignity in bioethical discourses; (4) maximizing the patient’s well-being or best interests in medicine. In this context, utilitarians claim that one should focus on the patient avoiding pain and suffering, and therefore one should, for example, allow terminally ill patients to obtain physician-assisted suicide. Furthermore, the religious idea that human life is sacred and hence must be protected from the moment of conception is rejected by utilitarians who believe that religious claims are unsubstantiated and incompatible with the requirements of a modern, secular nation-state (for example, research on human embryos and genetic enhancement should be made possible). In addition, abortion and infanticide in cases where the baby has a severe disability should be possible depending on the circumstances of the particular case and by appealing to the idea of personhood (Singer 1979, Kuhse and Singer 1985, Giubilini and Minerva 2012). According to Singer, one should not be allowed to kill a human being or sentient animal if one can detect in that being rationality and self-consciousness—the core elements of personhood according to Singer. To treat sentient animals with interests differently than human beings is speciesism which is comparable to sexism and racism and must be avoided. Moral judgements, according to utilitarians, should always be impartial and universal. Singer (1975) additionally claims that human beings must consider the equal interests of human beings and animals alike.

The general idea to always maximize the patient’s well-being according to a rather simplistic idea of calculating and comparing the pleasures and pains of all affected persons seems questionable to many people since they do not think that the outcome of these calculations necessarily leads to morally right or wrong actions. Furthermore, the claim that the killing of an innocent being in the case of a fetus with a (severe) disability might be the best possible outcome in some situations—by adhering to “the good life” doctrine—seems to undermine some important values of living together (compassion, care, responsibility for the weak, justice). In addition, the idea that minority groups such as people with (severe) disabilities and patients in a permanent vegetative state can be legitimately sacrificed in some cases has led to a rather bad reputation for utilitarian approaches. Utilitarians are also at odds with approaches in bioethics that appeal to human dignity and human rights. Two centuries ago, Bentham famously stated that natural rights (or human rights) are “nonsense upon stilts,” a dictum most utilitarians still regard as reasonable.

d. The Four-Principle Approach

One of the most important approaches in bioethics or medical ethics is the four-principle approach developed by Tom Beauchamp and James Childress (1978, latest edition 2009). Since then they have continually refined their approach and integrated the points of criticism raised by their opponents, most notably Gert et al. (1990). The four-principle approach, often simply called principlism, consists of four universal prima facie mid-level ethical principles: (1) autonomy, (2) non-maleficence, (3) beneficence, and (4) justice. Together with some general rules and ethical virtues, they can be seen as the starting point and constraining framework of ethical reasoning and decision making (“common morality”). According to Beauchamp and Childress:

The common morality is the set of norms shared by all persons committed to morality. The common morality is not merely a morality, in contrast to other moralities. The common morality is applicable to all persons in all places, and we rightly judge all human conduct by its standards. (2009: 3)

Particular moralities, instead, contain non-universal moral norms which stem from different cultural, religious, and institutional sources. These norms—unlike the abstract and content-thin principles of the common morality—are concrete and rich in substance. Beauchamp and Childress use the methods of specification and balancing to enrich the abstract and content-thin universal principles with empirical data from the particular moralities. The method of specification is, according to Beauchamp,

…a methodological tool that adds content to abstract principles, ridding them of their indeterminateness and providing action-guiding content for the purpose of coping with complex cases. Many already specified norms will need further specification to handle new circumstances of indeterminateness and conflict. (Beauchamp 2011: 301)

The method of balancing, instead, is important for reaching sound judgements in individual cases and it can be seen as “the process of finding reasons to support beliefs about which moral norms should prevail” (Beauchamp and Childress 2009: 20). Since the particular moralities are different, people sometimes specify and balance the principles differently, and hence principlists often claim “that there can be different and equally good solutions to moral problems” (Gordon et al. 2011: 299).

Even though the four-principle approach certainly belongs to the most prevalent, authoritative, and widely used bioethical approaches, this approach has not been unquestioned and has provoked serious objections. The three most important objections are: first, the lack of ethical guidance because there is no master principle in cases of conflict among the principles (Gert et al. 1990); secondly, the problem of bias concerning the universal principles in cross-cultural contexts (Takala 2001, Westra et al. 2009, Gordon 2011), and thirdly, the objection that the four-principle approach is a mere checklist of considerations and so methodologically unsound (Gert et al. 1990).

e. Virtue Ethics

The revival of virtue ethics in moral philosophy in the last century was most notably spearheaded by Anscombe (1958), MacIntyre (1981), Williams (1985), Nussbaum (1988, 1990), and more recently Hursthouse (1987, 1999), Slote (2001), Swanton (2003), and Oakley (2009). This approach also deeply influenced the ethical reasoning and decision making in the field of bioethics, particularly in medical ethics (for example, Foot 1977, Shelp 1985, Hursthouse 1991, Pellegrino 1995, Pellegrino and Thomasma 2003, McDougall 2007).

The general idea of virtue ethical approaches in bioethics is that one should act in accordance with what the virtuous agent would have chosen. In more detail, an action is morally right if it is done by adhering to the ethical virtues in order to promote human flourishing and well-being; the action is morally good if the person in question acts on the basis of the right motive as well as his or her action is based on a firm and good character or disposition. That means an action that is morally right (for instance, to help the needy) but performed according to the wrong motive (such as to gain honour and reputation) is not morally good. The right action and the right motive must both come together in virtue ethics. For a detailed view of how contemporary virtue ethics focuses on action and the rightness of action against the background of the general idea of living a good life, see in particular Hursthouse (1999: chapters 1-3), Swanton (2003: chapter 11), and Slote (2001: chapter 1).

Generally speaking, virtue ethical approaches put a lot of weight on the particular agent. For example, the virtuous physician in medical ethics should not only be a well trained and conscientious professional—one who shows compassion towards his or her patients, is helpful and honest, and keeps his or her promises—but also should be strongly inclined to promote the patient’s well-being even at his or her own expense (Pellegrino 1989). The virtuous agent in bioethics knows how to deal with complex cases, shows a greater sensitivity than proponents of deontological and utilitarian approaches, and acts virtuously not only by complying with moral norms but also “going the extra mile” to perform supererogatory actions. Virtue ethical approaches have been applied in medical ethics by, for example, Foot on euthanasia (1977), Lebacqz on the virtuous patient (1985), Hursthouse on abortion (1991), Oakley and Cocking on professional roles (2001), and Holland on virtue politics (2011). The role of virtue ethics in the field of environmental ethics has been examined by Frasz (1993) and Hursthouse (2007), and in the field of animal ethics by Hursthouse (2011) and Merriam (2011).

It is a matter of debate (see for example, Kihlbom 2000, Holland 2011), whether the strengths of virtue ethical approaches are limited to single cases (individual level) or whether they are also equally good candidates in cases of developing biomedical procedures for regulatory policy (societal level). In addition, Jansen (2000), for example, argues that virtue ethical approaches face two serious problems, which cannot be sufficiently resolved by adhering to virtue ethics. First is the problem of content: vague virtues are unable to give proper guidance. Second is the problem of pluralism: competing conceptions of the good life complicate a sound solution. Virtues only have a limited function; for example, in the context of medicine they should enable the physician to become a virtuous practitioner abiding by the right motive. But, even in this case, Jansen claims that the right action should prevail over the right motive. Furthermore, sometimes opponents such as Jansen (2000) claim that virtues are relative by nature and hence lack proper guidance in the context of global bioethics (the “problem of cultural relativity”). However, Nussbaum (1988) argues persuasively, by appealing to Aristotle, that ethical virtues are non-relative by nature and allow for variations.

f. Casuistry

The revival of casuistry as an inductive method of ethical reasoning and decision making in the second half of the twentieth century coincides with a wide and persistent critique of principle-oriented approaches, most notably principlism, deontological ethics, and utilitarianism in bioethics. Casuistry had its historical heyday in moral theology and ethics during the period from the fifteenth to the seventeenth century in Europe. After a long time of no importance or influence in moral philosophy, it gained a significant importance in bioethics—mostly in clinical ethics—after the vital publications of Jonsen and Toulmin (1988), Strong (1988), and Brody (1988). Casuists attack the traditional idea of simply applying universal moral rules and norms to complex cases in order to solve the problem in question—that is, a moral theory justifies a moral principle (or several principles) which in turn justifies a moral rule (or several rules) which in turn justifies the moral judgement concerning a particular case. The circumstances make the case and are of utmost importance in order to yield a good solution (see moral particularism).

Whether the casuists’ solution always leads to an open-and-shut case appears questionable and depends largely on the paradigm cases and analogies that are used to determine and evaluate the case in question as well as the skills of the particular casuist (in finding proper paradigm cases and analogies, and so on.). For example, Strong (1988) claims that it might be that a complex case lies right in between two reference cases and hence one is unable to find a clear solution; in such a case different solutions might be equally justified. In general, casuists argue that universal principles and rules are unable to solve complex cases in a sufficient way since the complexity of the moral life is too great (for example, Toulmin 1982, Brody 1988). The general strategy in casuistry can be described as follows:

  1. Depiction of the case: A thorough depiction of the empirical and moral elements of the given case lays out the basic structure and the decisive problems. Vital questions are: (a) What are the particulars of the case (who, what, where, when, how much)? (b) What are the basic questions in the relevant area (in medical ethics: what are the medical indications, what are the patient’s preferences, evaluating the quality of life, consider and respect the context of the treatment)?
  2. Classification of the case: Once the given case is thoroughly depicted, one must classify the case by finding paradigm cases and  analogies by analogical reasoning. Paradigm cases and analogies function as the background against which the given case is evaluated. They help to determine the important similarities and differences of the specifics of the case.
  3. Moral judgement: Once the specific similarities and differences of the case are determined, the casuists evaluate the results by adhering to common sense morality and the basic values of the community.

Case sensitivity and the (partial) integration of cultural and community bound values and expectations are, in general, advantageous in ethical reasoning and decision making. But it seems equally true that this approach presents some difficulties as well. As critics such as Arras (1991), Wildes (1993), and Tomlinson (1994) have argued, it is impossible to take a critical standpoint if one is deeply rooted in one’s own tradition, value system, and social community, since it can be the case that the social practices and convictions are simply biased (Kopelman 1994) or unjust according to an external standpoint (Apartheid in South Africa, the caste system in India). Furthermore, casuistry seems to presuppose a widespread agreement on basic values in the community and, therefore, is doomed to failure in pluralistic cultures (Wildes 1993). Finally, casuistry may have difficulty providing solutions to rather general bioethical regulatory policies since it is completely focused on cases. Whether a series of similar cases may warrant a particular regulatory practice from a casuistical point of view is a matter of debate (see virtue ethics), but it seems fair to say that the very meaning of casuistry really concerns cases and not general rules which can be adopted as binding regulations.

g. Feminist Bioethics

Feminist bioethics can only be fully appreciated if one understands the context in which this increasingly important approach evolved during the late twentieth century (Tong 1993, Wolf 1996, Donchin and Purdy 1999, Rawlinson 2001). The social and political background of feminist bioethics is feminism and feminist theory with its major social and political goal to end the oppression of women and to empower them to become an equal gender. The apparent differences between men and women have often led cultures to treat them in radically different ways, ways that often disadvantage women. Thus women have been allocated to social roles that leave them worse off with respect to benefits enjoyed by men, such as freedom and power. Yet despite their differences in reproductive roles, women and men share many morally relevant characteristics such as rationality and the capacity for suffering, and hence deserve fundamental equality.

In more detail, the most important task in the long struggle regarding the goals of feminism was to combine two distinct features that were both vital in order to fight against traditional power relations. That is, the idea that men and women are equal and different at the same time. They are equal by virtue of gender equality and different because the proponents stress a particular feminist perspective. The combination of both aspects is, in general, a difficult task for feminist ethics since, on the one hand, the proponents must avoid the common trap of speaking in traditional dualistic ways of care versus justice, particularity versus universality, and emotion versus reason and, on the other hand, they must carve out the specific differences of the feminist perspective (Haker 2003). Historically speaking, feminist ethics developed in strong opposition to the traditional male-oriented approaches which genuinely appealed to universal moral rights and principles, such as principlism, deontological approaches and utilitarianism (Gilligan 1982, Gudorf 1994, Lebacqz 1995). Feminist ethics, instead, is construed differently by adhering to a context-sensitive and particularist ethics of care as well as by appealing to core values such as responsibility, relational autonomy, care, compassion, freedom, and equality (Gilligan 1982, Noddings 1984, Jagger 1992). The ethics of care, however, is a necessary but not sufficient depiction of feminist ethics since the latter has, in general, become more refined and sophisticated with its different branches (Tong 1989, Cole and Coultrap-McQuin 1992).

Feminist bioethics developed from the early 1970s on and was initially focused on medical ethics (Holmes and Purdy 1992, Warren 1992, Tong 1997); proponents later extended the areas of interest to issues in the fields of animal and environmental ethics (Plumwood 1986, Warren, 1987, Mies and Shiva 1995, Donovan 2008). Important topics in feminist bioethics are concerned with the correct understanding of autonomy as relational autonomy (Sherwin 1992, 1998, Mackenzie and Stoljar 2000, Donchin 2001), a strong focus on care (Kittay 1999), the claim for an equal and just treatment of women in order to fight against discrimination within healthcare professions and institutions on many different levels (Miles 1991, Tong 2002). In more detail, from a feminist perspective the following bioethical issues are of great importance: abortion, reproductive medicine, justice and care, pre-implantation genetic diagnosis, sex selection, exploitation and abuse of women, female genital circumcision, breast cancer, contraception and HIV, equal access to (and quality of) healthcare and healthcare resources, global bioethics and cultural issues. The main line of reasoning is to make a well informed ethical decision which is not gender biased and to appeal to important core values. Feminist bioethics is by nature particularistic and in this respect it is similar to many virtue ethical approaches and casuistry.

Without any doubt, feminist bioethics initiated discussion of important topics, provided valuable insights, and caused a return to a more meaningful way of ethical reasoning and decision making by, for example, not only adhering to universal moral norms. On the other hand, it can be doubted whether feminist bioethics—all things considered—can be seen as a well-equipped and full moral theory. It may be that feminist bioethics complements the traditional ethical theories by adding an important and new perspective (that is, the feminist standpoint) to the debate. Several vital methodological topics still need to be clarified in more detail and put into a broader moral context—such as how to avoid the traditional dualistic way of speaking about things and at the same time stressing a particular feminist standpoint; the problem of loyalty towards family and close friends and impartiality in ethics (universalism versus particularism); and feminist bioethics and the global perspective. Developing feminist bioethics is on the agenda of many scholars working in the fields of virtue ethics and casuistry. Thus, feminist bioethics comes in for the standard objections raised by the opponents of virtue ethics and casuistry alike. Therefore, it must also defend itself against some of the above-mentioned objections that are not peculiar to feminist bioethics. To sum up, feminist bioethics adds valuable insights to debates on various bioethical topics, but may not be a well-equipped full moral theory yet.

6. References and Further Reading

a. References

  • Altman, M. (2011). Kant and Applied Ethics: The Uses and Limits of Kant’s Practical Philosophy. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Anscombe, E. (1958). Modern Moral Philosophy, Philosophy, 33(124), 1-19.
  • Arras, J.D. (1991). Getting Down to Cases: The Revival of Casuistry in Bioethics, Journal of Medicine and Philosophy, 16(1), 29-51.
  • Baker, R. (1998). A Theory of International Bioethics: The Negotiable and Non-Negotiable, Kennedy Institute of Ethics Journal, 8(3), 233-273.
  • Beauchamp, T.L. (2011). Making Principlism Practical, Bioethics, 25(6), 301-303.
  • Beauchamp, T.L. & Childress, J.F. (1979). Principles of Biomedical Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Beauchamp, T.L. & Childress, J.F. (2009). Principles of Biomedical Ethics, 6th ed., New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Beecher, H. (1966). Ethics and Clinical Research, New England Journal of Medicine, 274(24), 1354-1360.
  • Brody, B. (1988). Life and Death Decision-Making. New York: Oxford University Press.
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b. Further Reading

  • Boylan, M. (2013). Medical Ethics, 2nd ed., Malden, MA and Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Held, V. (1995). Justice and Care: Essential Readings in Feminist Ethics. Boulder and Oxford: Westview Press.
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  • Overall, C. (1987). Ethics and Human Reproduction: A Feminist Analysis. Boston: Allen & Unwin.
  • Purdy, L. (1996). Reproducing Persons. Issues in Feminist Bioethics. Ithaca and London: Cornell University Press.
  • Scully, D. (1980). Men Who Control Women’s Health: The Miseducation of Obstetrician-Gynecologists. Boston: Houghton Mifflin.
  • Thomson, J. (1971). A Defense of Abortion, Philosophy and Public Affairs, 1(1), 47-66.
  • Todd, A.D. (1989). Intimate adversaries: cultural conflict between doctors and women patients. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press.
  • Tong, R., Anderson, G. & Santos, A. (2001). Globalizing Feminist Bioethics. Crosscultural Perspectives. Boulder: Westview Press.

Author Information

John-Stewart Gordon
Email: jgordon@uni-koeln.de
University of Cologne, Germany
Vytautas Magnus University, Lithuania

Plato: The Republic

PlatoSince the mid-nineteenth century, the Republic has been Plato’s most famous and widely read dialogue.  As in most other Platonic dialogues the main character is Socrates.  It is generally accepted that the Republic belongs to the dialogues of Plato’s middle period.  In Plato’s early dialogues, Socrates refutes the accounts of his interlocutors and the discussion ends with no satisfactory answer to the matter investigated.  In the Republic however, we encounter Socrates developing a position on justice and its relation to eudaimonia (happiness).  He provides a long and complicated, but unified argument, in defense of the just life and its necessary connection to the happy life.

The dialogue explores two central questions.  The first question is “what is justice?”  Socrates addresses this question both in terms of political communities and in terms of the individual person or soul.  He does this to address the second and driving question of the dialogue: “is the just person happier than the unjust person?” or “what is the relation of justice to happiness?” Given the two central questions of the discussion, Plato’s philosophical concerns in the dialogue are ethical and political.  In order to address these two questions, Socrates and his interlocutors construct a just city in speech, the Kallipolis.  They do this in order to explain what justice is and then they proceed to illustrate justice by analogy in the human soul.  On the way to defending the just life, Socrates considers a tremendous variety of subjects such as several rival theories of justice, competing views of human happiness, education, the nature and importance of philosophy and philosophers, knowledge, the structure of reality, the Forms, the virtues and vices, good and bad souls, good and bad political regimes, the family, the role of women in society, the role of art in society, and even the afterlife.  This wide scope of the dialogue presents various interpretative difficulties and has resulted in thousands of scholarly works.  In order to attempt to understand the dialogue’s argument as a whole one is required to grapple with these subjects.

Table of Contents

  1. Synopsis of the Republic
    1. Book I
    2. Book II
    3. Book III
    4. Book IV
    5. Book V
    6. Book VI
    7. Book VII
    8. Book VIII
    9. Book IX
    10. Book X
  2. Ethics or Political Philosophy?
  3. The Analogy of the City and the Soul
  4. Plato’s Defense of Justice
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Standard Greek Text
    2. English Translations
    3. General Discussions of the Republic
    4. Discussions on Plato’s Ethics and Political Philosophy
    5. Discussions on the City/Soul Analogy.
    6. Discussions of Plato’s Defense of Justice in the Republic
    7. Discussions of Political Measures Introduced in the Just City
      1. Discussions of the Role of Women in the Just City
      2. Discussions of Poetry in the Just City
      3. Discussions on the Soul in the Republic
      4. Discussions on Plato’s Moral Psychology in the Republic

1. Synopsis of the Republic

a. Book I

Socrates and Glaucon visit the Piraeus to attend a festival in honor of the Thracian goddess Bendis (327a).  They are led to Polemarchus’ house (328b).  Socrates speaks to Cephalus about old age, the benefits of being wealthy, and justice (328e-331d). One would not claim that it is just to return weapons one owes to a mad friend (331c), thus justice is not being truthful and returning what one owes as Cephalus claims.  The discussion between Socrates and Polemarchus follows (331d-336b).

Polemarchus claims that justice is helping one’s friends and harming one’s enemies and that this is what one owes people (332c).  Socrates’ objections to Polemarchus’ definition are as follows: (i) Is this appropriate in medicine or cooking?  So in what context is this the case? (332d)? (ii) The just person will also be good at useless things and at being unjust (333e). (iii) We often do not know who our friends and enemies are. Thus, we may treat those whom we only think are our friends or enemies well or badly.  Would this be justice? (334c). (iv) It does not seem to be just to treat anyone badly, not even an enemy (335b).  Discussion between Socrates and Thrasymachus follows (336b-354c).

Thrasymachus defines justice as the advantage or what is beneficial to the stronger (338c).  Justice is different under different political regimes according to the laws, which are made to serve the interests of the strong (the ruling class in each regime, 338e-339a).  Socrates requires clarification of the definition: does it mean that justice is what the stronger think is beneficial to them or what is actually beneficial to them (339b)?  And don’t the strong rulers make mistakes and sometimes create laws that do not serve their advantage (339c)?  Thrasymachus points out that the stronger are really only those who do not make mistakes as to what is to their advantage (340d).  Socrates responds with a discussion of art or craft and points out that its aim is to do what is good for its subjects, not what is good for the practitioner (341c).  Thrasymachus suggests that some arts, such as that of shepherds, do not do this but rather aim at the advantage of the practitioner (343c). He also adds the claim that injustice is in every way better than justice and that the unjust person who commits injustice undetected is always happier than the just person (343e-344c).  The paradigm of the happy unjust person is the tyrant who is able to satisfy all his desires (344a-b).  Socrates points out that the shepherd’s concern for his sheep is different from his concern to make money, which is extraneous to the art (345c) and that no power or art provides what is beneficial to itself (346e).  Socrates claims that the best rulers are reluctant to rule but do so out of necessity: they do not wish to be ruled by someone inferior (347a-c).

Socrates offers three argument in favor of the just life over the unjust life: (i) the just man is wise and good, and the unjust man is ignorant and bad (349b); (ii) injustice produces internal disharmony which prevents effective actions (351b); (iii) virtue is excellence at a thing’s function and the just person lives a happier life than the unjust person, since he performs the various functions of the human soul well (352d).  Socrates is dissatisfied with the discussion since an adequate account of justice is necessary before they can address whether the just life is better than the unjust life (354b).

b. Book II

Glaucon is not persuaded by the arguments in the previous discussion (357a).  He divides good things into three classes: things good in themselves, things good both in themselves and for their consequences, and things good only for their consequences (357b-d).  Socrates places justice in the class of things good in themselves and for their consequences.

Glaucon renews Thrasymachus’ argument to challenge Socrates to defend justice by itself without any consideration of what comes from it (358b ff.).  Glaucon gives a speech defending injustice: (i) justice originates as a compromise between weak people who are afraid that suffering injustice is worse than doing it (358e-359a);  (ii) people act justly because this is necessary and unavoidable, so justice is good only for its consequences (story of the ring of Gyges’ ancestor, 359c-360d); (iii) the unjust person with the reputation for justice is happier than the just person with the reputation for injustice (360d-362c).

Adeimantus expands Glaucon’s defense of injustice and attack on justice by asserting: the reputation of justice is better than justice itself, so the unjust person who is able to keep the reputation of being just will be happier than the just person; discussion of various ways that the unjust can acquire the reputation for justice (362d-366d).

Socrates is asked to defend justice for itself, not for the reputation it allows for (367b).  He proposes to look for justice in the city first and then to proceed by analogy to find justice in the individual (368c-369a).  This approach will allow for a clearer judgment on the question of whether the just person is happier than the unjust person.  Socrates begins by discussing the origins of political life and constructs a just city in speech that satisfies only basic human necessities (369b-372c).  Socrates argues that humans enter political life since each is not self-sufficient by nature.  Each human has certain natural abilities (370a) and doing only the single job one is naturally suited for, is the most efficient way to satisfy the needs of all the citizens (370c).  Glaucon objects that Socrates’ city is too simple and calls it “a city of pigs” (372d).  Socrates describes a city that allows for luxuries (“a feverish city,” 372e-373e).  Socrates points out that the luxurious city will require an army to guard the city (373e).  The army will be composed of professional soldiers, the guardians, who, like dogs, must be gentle to fellow citizens and harsh to enemies (375c).  The guardians need to be educated very carefully to be able to do their job of protecting the city’s citizens, laws, and customs well (376d).  Poetry and stories need to be censored to guarantee such an education (377b).  Poetry should: (i) present the gods as good and only as causes of good (379a); (ii) as unchanging in form (380d); (iii) as beings who refrain from lies and deception (381e).

c. Book III

Socrates continues the political measures of the censorship of poetry: (iv) the underworld should not be portrayed as a bad place so that the guardians will not be too afraid of death (386b); (v) the heroes and gods should not be presented lamenting so that the guardians can develop courage (387e); (vi) poetry should prevent people from laughing violently (388e); (vii) poetry should promote the guardian’s sense of truth-telling but with the willingness to lie when this is conducive to the good of the city (389b); (viii) it should promote self-discipline and obedience (389c-d); (ix) it should not include stories that contribute to avarice (390d); (x) it should not include stories that contribute to hubris or impiety (391a).  Socrates moves on to discuss the manner in which stories should be told (392d).  He divides such manners into simple narration (in third person) and imitative narration (in first person, 392d).  To keep the guardians doing only their job, Socrates argues that the guardians may imitate only what is appropriate for this (394e-395d).  The just city should allow only modes and rhythms that fit the content of poetry allowed in the just city (398b-399c).  Socrates explains how good art can lead to the formation of good character and make people more likely to follow their reason (400e-402c).  Socrates turns to the physical education of the guardians and says that it should include physical training that prepares them for war, a careful diet, and habits that contribute to the avoidance of doctors (403c-405b).  Physical education should be geared to benefit the soul rather than the body, since the body necessarily benefits when the soul is in a good condition, whereas the soul does not necessarily benefit when the body is in a good condition (410b-c).

Socrates begins to describe how the rulers of the just city are to be selected from the class of the guardians: they need to be older, strong, wise, and wholly unwilling to do anything other than what is advantageous to the city (412b-414b).  Socrates suggests that they need to tell the citizens a myth that should be believed by subsequent generations in order for everyone to accept his position in the city (414b-415d).  The myth of metals portrays each human as having a precious metal in them: those naturally suited to be rulers have gold, those suited to be guardians have silver, and those suited for farming and the other crafts have bronze.

Socrates proceeds to discuss the living and housing conditions of the guardians: they will not have private property, they will have little privacy, they will receive what they need from the city via taxation of the other classes, and they will live communally and have common messes (415e-416e).

d. Book IV

Adeimantus complains that the guardians in the just city will not be very happy (419a).  Socrates points out that the aim is to make the whole city, and not any particular class, as happy as possible (420b).  Socrates discusses several other measures for the city as a whole in order to accomplish this.  There should be neither too much wealth nor too much poverty in the city since these cause social strife (421d-422a).  The just city should be only as large in size as would permit it to be unified and stable (423b).  Socrates reemphasizes the importance of the guardian’s education and suggests that the guardians will possess wives and children in common (423e). He suggests that they should only allow very limited ways by which innovations may be introduced to education or change in the laws (424b-425e).  The just city will follow traditional Greek religious customs (427b).

With the founding of the just city completed, Socrates proceeds to discuss justice (427d).  He claims that the city they have founded is completely good and virtuous and thus it is wise, courageous, moderate, and just (427e).  Justice will be what remains once they find the other three virtues in it, namely wisdom, courage, and moderation (428a).  The wisdom of the just city is found in its rulers and it is the type of knowledge that allows them to rule the city well (428b-d).  The courage of the just city is found in its military and it is correct and lawful belief about what to fear and what not to fear (429a-430b).  The city’s moderation or self-discipline is its unanimity in following the just city’s structure in terms of who should rule and who should be ruled (430d-432a).  The city’s justice consists in each class performing its proper function (433a-b).

Socrates then proceeds to find the corresponding four virtues in the individual (434d).  Socrates defends the analogy of the city and the individual (435a-b) and proceeds to distinguish three analogous parts in the soul with their natural functions (436b).  By using instances of psychological conflict, he distinguishes the function of the rational part from that of the appetitive part of the soul (439a).  Then he distinguishes the function of the spirited part from the functions of the two other parts (439e-440e).  The function of the rational part is thinking, that of the spirited part the experience of emotions, and that of the appetitive part the pursuit of bodily desires.  Socrates explains the virtues of the individual’s soul and how they correspond to the virtues of the city (441c-442d).  Socrates points out that one is just when each of the three parts of the soul performs its function (442d).  Justice is a natural balance of the soul’s parts and injustice is an imbalance of the parts of the soul (444e).  Socrates is now ready to answer the question of whether justice is more profitable than injustice that goes unpunished (444e-445a).  To do so he will need to examine the various unjust political regimes and the corresponding unjust individuals in each (445c-e).

e. Book V

Socrates is about to embark on a discussion of the unjust political regimes and the corresponding unjust individuals when he is interrupted by Adeimantus and Polemarchus (449a-b).  They insist that he needs to address the comment he made earlier that the guardians will possess the women and the children of the city in common (449b-d).  Socrates reluctantly agrees (450a-451b) and begins with the suggestion that the guardian women should perform the same job as the male guardians (451c-d).  Some may follow convention and object that women should be given different jobs because they differ from men by nature (453a-c). Socrates responds by indicating that the natural differences between men and women are not relevant when it comes to the jobs of protecting and ruling the city.  Both sexes are naturally suited for these tasks (454d-e).  Socrates goes on to argue that the measure of allowing the women to perform the same tasks as the men in this way is not only feasible but also best.  This is the case since the most suited people for the job will be performing it (456c).

Socrates also proposes that there should be no separate families among the members of the guardian class: the guardians will possess all the women and children in common (457c-d).  Socrates proceeds to discuss how this measure is for the best and Glaucon allows him to skip discussing its feasibility (458a-c).  The best guardian men are to have sex with the best guardian women to produce offspring of a similar nature (458d-459d).    Socrates describes the system of eugenics in more detail.  In order to guarantee that the best guardian men have sex with the best guardian women, the city will have marriage festivals supported by a rigged lottery system (459e-460a).  The best guardian men will also be allowed to have sex with as many women as they desire in order to increase the likelihood of giving birth to children with similar natures (460a-b).  Once born, the children will be taken away to a rearing pen to be taken care of by nurses and the parents will not be allowed to know who their own children are (460c-d).  This is so that the parents think of all the children as their own.  Socrates recognizes that this system will result in members of the same family having intercourse with each other (461c-e).

Socrates proceeds to argue that these arrangements will ensure that unity spreads throughout the city (462a-465d).  Responding to Adeimantus’ earlier complaint that the guardians would not be happy, Socrates indicates that the guardians will be happy with their way of life; they will have their needs satisfied and will receive sufficient honor from the city (465d-e).  Thereafter, Socrates discusses how the guardians will conduct war (466e).

Glaucon interrupts him and demands an account explaining how such a just city can come into being (471c-e).  Socrates admits that this is the most difficult criticism to address (472a). Then he explains that the theoretical model of the just city they constructed remains valid for discussing justice and injustice even if they cannot prove that such a city can come to exist (472b-473b).  Socrates claims that the model of the just city cannot come into being until philosophers rule as kings or kings become philosophers (473c-d).  He also points out that this is the only possible route by which to reach complete happiness in both public and private life (473e).  Socrates indicates that they to, discuss philosophy and philosophers to justify these claims (474b-c).  Philosophers love and pursue all of wisdom (475b-c) and they especially love the sight of truth (475e).  Philosophers are the only ones who recognize and find pleasure in what is behind the multiplicity of appearances, namely the single Form (476a-b).  Socrates distinguishes between those who know the single Forms that are and those who have opinions (476d).  Those who have opinions do not know, since opinions have becoming and changing appearances as their object, whereas knowledge implies that the objects thereof are stable (476e-477e).

f. Book VI

Socrates goes on to explain why philosophers should rule the city.  They should do so since they are better able to know the truth and since they have the relevant practical knowledge by which to rule.  The philosopher’s natural abilities and virtues prove that they have what is necessary to rule well: they love what is rather than what becomes (485a-b), they hate falsehood (485c), they are moderate (485d-e), they are courageous (486a-b), they are quick learners (486c), they have a good memory (486c-d), they like proportion since the truth is like it, and they have a pleasant nature (486d-487a).

Adeimantus objects that actual philosophers are either useless or bad people (487a-d).  Socrates responds with the analogy of the ship of state to show that philosophers are falsely blamed for their uselessness (487e-489a).  Like a doctor who does not beg patients to heal them, the philosopher should not plead with people to rule them (489b-c).  To the accusation that philosophers are bad, Socrates responds that those with the philosopher’s natural abilities and with outstanding natures often get corrupted by a bad education and become outstandingly bad (491b-e).  Thus, someone can only be a philosopher in the true sense if he receives the proper kind of education.  After a discussion of the sophists as bad teachers (492a-493c), Socrates warns against various people who falsely claim to be philosophers (495b-c).  Since current political regimes lead to either the corruption or the destruction of the philosopher, he should avoid politics and lead a quiet private life (496c-d).

Socrates then addresses the question of how philosophy can come to play an important role in existing cities (497e).  Those with philosophical natures need to practice philosophy all their lives, especially when they are older (498a-c).  The only way to make sure that philosophy is properly appreciated and does not meet hostility is to wipe an existing city clean and begin it anew (501a).  Socrates concludes that the just city and the measures proposed are both for the best and not impossible to bring about (502c).

Socrates proceeds to discuss the education of philosopher kings (502c-d).  The most important thing philosophers should study is the Form of the Good (505a).  Socrates considers several candidates for what the Good is, such as pleasure and knowledge and he rejects them (505b-d).  He points out that we choose everything with a view to the good (505e).  Socrates attempts to explain what the Form of the Good is through the analogy of the sun (507c-509d).  As the sun illuminates objects so the eye can see them, the Form of the Good renders the objects of knowledge knowable to the human soul.  As the sun provides things with their ability to be, to grow, and with nourishment, the Form of the Good provides the objects of knowledge with their being even though it itself is higher than being (509b).

Socrates offers the analogy of the divided line to explain the Form of the Good even further (509d-511d).  He divides a line into two unequal sections once and then into two unequal sections again.  The lowest two parts represent the visible realm and the top two parts the intelligible realm.  In the first of the four sections of the line, Socrates places images/shadows, in the second section visible objects, in the third section truths arrived at via hypotheses as mathematicians do, and in the last section the Forms themselves.  Corresponding to each of these, there is a capacity of the human soul: imagination, belief, thought, and understanding.  The line also represents degrees of clarity and opacity as the lowest sections are more opaque and the higher sections clearer.

g. Book VII

Socrates continues his discussion of the philosopher and the Forms with a third analogy, the analogy of the cave (514a-517c).  This represents the philosopher’s education from ignorance to knowledge of the Forms.  True education is the turning around of the soul from shadows and visible objects to true understanding of the Forms (518c-d).  Philosophers who accomplish this understanding will be reluctant to do anything other than contemplate the Forms but they must be forced to return to the cave (the city) and rule it.

Socrates proceeds to outline the structure of the philosopher king’s education so that they can reach an understanding of the Forms (521d).  Those who eventually become philosopher kings will initially be educated like the other guardians in poetry, music, and physical education (521d-e).  Then they will receive education in mathematics: arithmetic and number (522c), plane geometry (526c), and solid geometry (528b).  Following these, they will study astronomy (528e), and harmonics (530d).  Then they will study dialectic which will lead them to understand the Forms and the Form of the Good (532a).  Socrates gives a partial explanation of the nature of dialectic and leaves Glaucon with no clear explanation of its nature or how it may lead to understanding (532a-535a).  Then they discuss who will receive this course of education and how long they are to study these subjects (535a-540b).  The ones receiving this type of education need to exhibit the natural abilities suited to a philosopher discussed earlier.  After the training in dialectic the education system will include fifteen years of practical political training (539e-540c) to prepare philosopher kings for ruling the city.  Socrates concludes by suggesting that the easiest way to bring the just city into being would be to expel everyone over the age of ten out of an existing city (540e-541b).

h. Book VIII

Socrates picks up the argument that was interrupted in Book V.  Glaucon remembers that Socrates was about to describe the four types of unjust regime along with their corresponding unjust individuals (543c-544b).  Socrates announces that he will begin discussing the regimes and individual that deviate the least from the just city and individual and proceed to discuss the ones that deviate the most (545b-c).  The cause of change in regime is lack of unity in the rulers (545d).  Assuming that the just city could come into being, Socrates indicates that it would eventually change since everything which comes into being must decay (546a-b).  The rulers are bound to make mistakes in assigning people jobs suited to their natural capacities and each of the classes will begin to be mixed with people who are not naturally suited for the tasks relevant to each class (546e).  This will lead to class conflicts (547a).

The first deviant regime from just kingship or aristocracy will be timocracy, that emphasizes the pursuit of honor rather than wisdom and justice (547d ff.).  The timocratic individual will have a strong spirited part in his soul and will pursue honor, power, and success (549a).  This city will be militaristic.  Socrates explains the process by which an individual becomes timocratic: he listens to his mother complain about his father’s lack of interest in honor and success (549d).  The timocratic individual’s soul is at a middle point between reason and spirit.

Oligarchy arises out of timocracy and it emphasizes wealth rather than honor (550c-e).  Socrates discusses how it arises out of timocracy and its characteristics (551c-552e): people will pursue wealth; it will essentially be two cities, a city of wealthy citizens and a city of poor people; the few wealthy will fear the many poor; people will do various jobs simultaneously; the city will allow for poor people without means; it will have a high crime rate.  The oligarchic individual comes by seeing his father lose his possessions and feeling insecure he begins to greedily pursue wealth (553a-c).  Thus he allows his appetitive part to become a more dominant part of his soul (553c).  The oligarchic individual’s soul is at middle point between the spirited and the appetitive part.

Socrates proceeds penultimately, to discuss democracy.  It comes about when the rich become too rich and the poor too poor (555c-d).  Too much luxury makes the oligarchs soft and the poor revolt against them (556c-e).  In democracy most of the political offices are distributed by lot (557a).  The primary goal of the democratic regime is freedom or license (557b-c).  People will come to hold offices without having the necessary knowledge (557e) and everyone is treated as an equal in ability (equals and unequals alike, 558c). The democratic individual comes to pursue all sorts of bodily desires excessively (558d-559d) and allows his appetitive part to rule his soul.  He comes about when his bad education allows him to transition from desiring money to desiring bodily and material goods (559d-e).  The democratic individual has no shame and no self-discipline (560d).

Tyranny arises out of democracy when the desire for freedom to do what one wants becomes extreme (562b-c).  The freedom or license aimed at in the democracy becomes so extreme that any limitations on anyone’s freedom seem unfair.  Socrates points out that when freedom is taken to such an extreme it produces its opposite, slavery (563e-564a).  The tyrant comes about by presenting himself as a champion of the people against the class of the few people who are wealthy (565d-566a).  The tyrant is forced to commit a number of acts to gain and retain power: accuse people falsely, attack his kinsmen, bring people to trial under false pretenses, kill many people, exile many people, and purport to cancel the debts of the poor to gain their support (565e-566a).  The tyrant eliminates the rich, brave, and wise people in the city since he perceives them as threats to his power (567c).  Socrates indicates that the tyrant faces the dilemma to either live with worthless people or with good people who may eventually depose him and chooses to live with worthless people (567d).  The tyrant ends up using mercenaries as his guards since he cannot trust any of the citizens (567d-e).  The tyrant also needs a very large army and will spend the city’s money (568d-e), and will not hesitate to kill members of his own family if they resist his ways (569b-c).

i. Book IX

Socrates is now ready to discuss the tyrannical individual (571a).  He begins by discussing necessary and unnecessary pleasures and desires (571b-c).  Those with balanced souls ruled by reason are able to keep their unnecessary desires from becoming lawless and extreme (571d-572b).  The tyrannical individual comes out of the democratic individual when the latter’s unnecessary desires and pleasures become extreme; when he becomes full of Eros or lust (572c-573b).  The tyrannical person is mad with lust (573c) and this leads him to seek any means by which to satisfy his desires and to resist anyone who gets in his way (573d-574d).  Some tyrannical individuals eventually become actual tyrants (575b-d).  Tyrants associate themselves with flatterers and are incapable of friendship (575e-576a).  Applying the analogy of the city and the soul, Socrates proceeds to argue that the tyrannical individual is the most unhappy individual (576c ff.).  Like the tyrannical city, the tyrannical individual is enslaved (577c-d), least likely to do what he wants (577d-e), poor and unsatisfiable (579e-578a), fearful and full of wailing and lamenting (578a).  The individual who becomes an actual tyrant of a city is the unhappiest of all (578b-580a).  Socrates concludes this first argument with a ranking of the individuals in terms of happiness: the more just one is the happier (580b-c).

He proceeds to a second proof that the just are happier than the unjust (580d).  Socrates distinguishes three types of persons: one who pursues wisdom, another who pursues honor, and another who pursues profit (579d-581c).  He argues that we should trust the wisdom lover’s judgment in his way of life as the most pleasant, since he is able to consider all three types of life clearly (581c-583a).

Socrates proceeds to offer a third proof that the just are happier than the unjust (583b).  He begins with an analysis of pleasure: relief from pain may seem pleasant (583c) and bodily pleasures are merely a relief from pain but not true pleasure (584b-c).  The only truly fulfilling pleasure is that which comes from understanding since the objects it pursues are permanent (585b-c).  Socrates adds that only if the rational part rules the soul, will each part of the soul find its proper pleasure (586d-587a).  He concludes the argument with a calculation of how many times the best life is more pleasant than the worst: seven-hundred and twenty nine (587a-587e).  Socrates discusses an imaginary multi-headed beast to illustrate the consequences of justice and injustice in the soul and to support justice (588c ff.).

j. Book X

Thereafter, Socrates returns to the subject of poetry and claims that the measures introduced to exclude imitative poetry from the just city seem clearly justified now (595a).  Poetry is to be censored since the poets may not know which is; thus may lead the soul astray (595b).  Socrates proceeds to discuss imitation.  He explains what it is by distinguishing several levels of imitation through the example of a couch: there is the Form of the couch, the particular couch, and a painting of a couch (596a-598b).  The products of imitation are far removed from the truth (597e-598c).  Poets, like painters are imitators who produce imitations without knowledge of the truth (598e-599a).  Socrates argues that if poets had knowledge of the truth they would want to be people who do great things rather than remain poets (599b).  Socrates doubts the poet’s capacity to teach virtue since he only imitates images of it (599c-601a).  The poet’s knowledge is inferior to that of the maker of other products and the maker’s knowledge is inferior to that of the user’s (601c-602b).

Now Socrates considers how imitators affect their audiences (602c).  He uses a comparison with optical illusions (602c) to argue that imitative poetry causes the parts of the soul to be at war with each other and this leads to injustice (603c-605b).  The most serious charge against imitative poetry is that it even corrupts decent people (605c).  He concludes that the just city should not allow such poetry in it but only poetry that praises the gods and good humans (606e-607a).  Imitative poetry prevents the immortal soul from attaining its greatest reward (608c-d).

Glaucon wonders if the soul is immortal and Socrates launches into an argument proving its immortality: things that are destroyed, are destroyed by their own evil; the body’s evil is disease and this can destroy it; the soul’s evils are ignorance, injustice and the other vices but these do not destroy the soul; thus, the soul is immortal (608d-611a).  Socrates points out that we cannot understand the nature of the soul if we only consider its relation to the body as the present discussion has (611b-d).

Socrates finally describes the rewards of justice by first having Glaucon allow that he can discuss the rewards of reputation for justice (612b-d).  Glaucon allows this since Socrates has already defended justice by itself in the soul.  Socrates indicates justice and injustice do not escape the notice of the gods, that the gods love the just and hate the unjust, and that good things come to those whom the gods love (612e-613a).  Socrates lists various rewards for the just and punishments for the unjust in this life (613a-e).  He proceeds to tell the Myth of Er that is supposed to illustrate reward and punishment in the afterlife (614b).  The souls of the dead go up through an opening on the right if they were just, or below through an opening on the left if they were unjust (614d).  The various souls discuss their rewards and punishments (614e-615a).  Socrates explains the multiples by which people are punished and rewarded (615a-b).  The souls of the dead are able to choose their next lives (617d) and then they are reincarnated (620e).  Socrates ends the discussion by prompting Glaucon and the others to do well both in this life and in the afterlife (621c-d).

2. Ethics or Political Philosophy?

The Republic has acquired the recognition of a classic and seminal work in political philosophy.  It is often taught in courses that focus on political theory or political philosophy.  Moreover, in the dialogue Socrates seems primarily concerned with what is an ethical issue, namely whether the just life is better than the unjust life for the individual.  These two observations raise two issues.  The first is whether the Republic is primarily about ethics or about politics.  If it is primarily about ethics then perhaps its recognition as a seminal political work is unwarranted.  Moreover, considering it a political work would be somewhat mistaken.  The second issue is that even if thinking of it as a classic in political philosophy is warranted, it is very difficult to situate it in terms of its political position.

Interpreters of the Republic have presented various arguments concerning the issue of whether the dialogue is primarily about ethics or about politics.  As is evident from Books I and II, Socrates’ main aim in the dialogue is to prove that the just person is better off than the unjust person.  In Book II, he proposes to construct the just city in speech in order to find justice in it and then to proceed to find justice in the individual (368a). Thus, he seems to use a discussion in political matters as a means by which to answer what is essentially an ethical question.  But, Socrates also spends a lot of time in the dialogue on political matters in relation to the question of political justice such as education, the positions and relations among political classes, war, property, the causes of political strife and change of regimes, and several other matters.  Each of these could provide important contributions to political philosophy.

One argument, suggesting that the dialogue is primarily concerned with the ethical question, focuses on Socrates’ presentation of the political discussion of justice as instrumental to discovering justice in the individual.  Another relevant consideration is that there are several indications in the dialogue that the aim in the discussion is more pressing than the means (the just city).  Thus, the argument goes, Socrates does not seem primarily interested in discussing political philosophy but ethics instead. Another related argument indicates that the discussion entails great doubts about whether the just city is even possible. Socrates claims this along with the idea that the function of the just city in the argument is to enable the individual to get a better idea of justice and injustice (472b-d, 592a-b).  Thus, it is very difficult for us to conclude that Socrates takes the political discussion as seriously as he does the moral question (see Annas, Julia.  Platonic Ethics, Old and New).

Other interpreters indicate that the Republic is essentially about both ethics and politics (among others see Santas, Gerasimos. Understanding Plato’s Republic; Schofield, Malcolm. Plato: Political Philosophy; Reeve C.D.C. Philosopher Kings). Some emphasize that many of Socrates’ proposals for social reform (education, property, the role of women, the family) go beyond what is needed to be able to argue that the just person is better off than the unjust person.  Thus, these social reforms seem to be developed for their own sake.

Some indicate that Socrates’ discussion of political matters is meant, in part, to provide us with Plato’s critique of Greek political life.  In Book VIII he criticizes democracy as an unjust regime and thus he seems to launch a critique against Athenian democracy.  He also adopts several measures in the just city, which were part of the Spartan constitution.  Like Spartan citizens, the guardians of the just city are professional soldiers whose aim is the protection of the city, the guardians eat together, and they have their needs provided for by other classes.  But unlike Sparta, the just city has philosophers as rulers, a rigorous system of education in intellectual matters, and it is not timocratic or honor loving.  These differences may be construed as a critique of Sparta’s political life.  Thus, the argument suggests, in addition to the main ethical question the dialogue is also about political philosophy.

Another position is that even though the discussion of political matters is instrumental to addressing the main ethical question of the dialogue, Socrates makes several important contributions to political philosophy.  One such contribution is his description of political regimes in Book VIII and his classification of them on a scale of more or less just.  Another such contribution is his consideration of the causes of political change from one political regime to another.  Moreover, Socrates seems to raise and address a number of questions that seem necessary in order to understand political life clearly.  He raises the issues of the role of women in the city, the role of the family, the role of art, the issue of class relations, of political stability, of the limitation of people’s freedoms and several others.  Thus, according to this view, it is warranted to regard the Republic as a work on political philosophy and as a seminal work in that area.

A further relevant consideration has to do with how one understands the nature of ethics and political philosophy and their relation.  Since modernity, it becomes much easier to treat these as separate subjects.  Modern ethics is more focused on determining whether an action is morally permissible or not whereas ancient ethics is more focused on happiness or the good life.  Many ancient thinkers want to address the question “what is the happy life?” and in order to do this they think that it is warranted to address political matters.  Humans live their lives in political communities and the kind of political community they live in can be conducive or detrimental to one’s happiness.  Thus, ethics and political philosophy are more closely linked for ancient thinkers than they may be for us since modernity.  Ethics and political philosophy seem to be different sides of the same coin.

The second issue has to do with situating the Republic’s political stance.  There are several competing candidates.  The Republic entails elements of socialism as when Socrates expresses the desire to achieve happiness for the whole city not for any particular group of it (420b) and when he argues against inequalities in wealth (421d).  There are also elements of fascism or totalitarianism. Among others, there is extreme censorship of poetry, lying to maintain good behavior and political stability, restriction of power to a small elite group, eugenic techniques, centralized control of the citizen’s lives, a strong military group that enforces the laws, and suppression of freedom of expression and choice.  Several commentators focused on these elements to dismiss the Republic as a proto-totalitarian text (see Popper, Karl.  The Open Society and Its Enemies). There are also some strong elements of communism such as the idea that the guardian class ought to possess things in common.  Despite, Socrates’ emphasis on the individual and the condition of his soul, the Republic does not entail the kernels of what becomes modern liberalism. Socrates seems to argue against allowing much freedom to individuals and to criticize the democratic tendency to treat humans as equals. Some have argued that the Republic is neither a precursor of these political positions nor does it fit any of them.  They find that the Republic has been such a seminal work in the history of political philosophy precisely because it raises such issues as its political stance while discussing many of the features of such political positions.

3. The Analogy of the City and the Soul

The analogy of the city and the soul, is Socrates proposed and accepted method by which to argue that the just person is better off than the unjust person (Book II, 368c-369a).  If Socrates is able to show how a just city is always happier than unjust cities, then he can have a model by which to argue that a just person is always happier than an unjust one.  He plausibly assumes that there is an interesting, intelligible, and non-accidental relation between the structural features and values of a city and an individual.  But commentators have found this curious approach one of the most puzzling features of the Republic.  The city/soul analogy is quite puzzling since Socrates seems to apply it in different ways, thus there is much controversy about the exact extent of the analogy.  Moreover, there is much controversy concerning its usefulness in the attempt to discover and to defend justice in terms of the individual.

In several passages Socrates seems to say that the same account of justice must apply to both cities (justice is the right order of classes) and to individuals (justice is the right order of the soul).  But even though he says this he seems to think that this ought to be the case for different reasons.  For example, at (435a), he seems to say that the same account of justice ought to apply to the city and to the individual since the same account of any predicate X must apply to all things that are X.  So, if a city or an individual is just then the same predicates must apply to both.  In other passages Socrates seems to mean that same account of justice ought to apply to the city and to the individual since the X-ness of the whole is due to the X-ness of the parts (435d).  So, if the people in the city are just, then this will cause the city to be just as well.  Yet still in other passages he seems to say that if a city is just and this causes it to have certain features such as wisdom or courage, then we can deduce that the individual’s being just will also cause him to be wise and courageous.  So if a city’s X-ness entails certain predicates, then the individual’s X-ness must entail the same predicates.  In other passages still, he seems to claim that the justice of the city can be used as a heuristic device by which to look for justice in the individual, thus the relation between the two seems quite loose (368e-369a).  (For a thorough discussion of these issues and the various interpretations of the city/soul analogy see Ferrari, G.R.F. City and Soul in Plato’s Republic.)

4. Plato’s Defense of Justice

In response to Thrasymachus, Glaucon, and Adeimantus, Socrates seeks to show that it is always in an individual’s interest to be just, rather than unjust.  Thus, one of the most pressing issues regarding the Republic is whether Socrates defends justice successfully or not.  David Sachs, in his influential article “A Fallacy in Plato’s Republic”, argues that Socrates’ defense of justice entails a crucial problem which renders the defense problematic.  Sachs argues that Socrates commits the fallacy of irrelevance.  Socrates sets out to defend the idea that it is always in one’s interest to be just and to act justly and he presents the just person as one who has a balanced soul.  Sachs observes that what Socrates defends is psychic health or rationality which may lead one to be happy but he fails to defend justice.  Socrates fails to show why having a balanced soul will lead one to act justly or why psychic health amounts to justice.  Sachs implies that justice, as this is traditionally understood, includes actions in relation to others, it includes considerations of other people’s good, and also includes strong motivations not to act unjustly.  According to Sachs, Socrates’ defense of justice does not include compelling reasons to think that a person with a balanced soul will refrain from acts that are traditionally thought to be unjust such as say, theft, murder, or adultery.  Thus, Plato presents Socrates defending psychic health rather than justice.

Sachs’ critique indicates that as Socrates presents the just person, the person’s balanced soul does not entail a sufficient causal or logical connection to performing socially just actions.  In order to save Socrates’ defense of justice one needs to show that there is a logical and a causal connection between having a balanced soul and performing socially just actions.  Otherwise, the problem of being psychically just but socially unjust remains

Given Sachs’ critique, several commentators have come to Socrates’ defense to bridge the gap between a just soul and just actions (these are discussed in detail by Singpurwalla, Rachel G. K. “Plato’s Defense of Justice in the Republic”).  One approach to bridging the gap between a just soul and just actions has been to show that the just person with a balanced soul operates according to certain values and desires which cannot lead to unjust actions (see Kraut, Richard “The Defense of Justice in Plato’s Republic”).  The just person’s soul entails desires for certain kinds of objects the most important of which is knowledge.  Socrates indicates the difficulty and extreme effort required to attain knowledge of the forms and the form of the Good, thus the just person will pursue learning and not spend time indulging in the satisfaction of desires that typically lead to unjust actions.  This approach of bridging the gap between a just soul and just actions may have some drawbacks.  One drawback may be that several unjust actions may be motivated by desires that are compatible with the desire for knowledge.  For example, why wouldn’t a person with a great desire for knowledge steal a book if this would contribute to his knowledge.

A second approach to bridging the gap between the just soul and just actions has been to show that the just person’s knowledge of the good, directly motivates him to perform just actions and to refrain from unjust ones (see Cooper, John “The Psychology of Justice in Plato’s Republic” and White, N. A Companion to Plato’s Republic).  A crucial piece of evidence for this approach is Socrates’ presentation of the philosopher who agrees to rule the city even though this will interfere with his desire to learn.  The proponents of this approach argue that the philosopher agrees to rule since his knowledge of the good directly motivates him to act against his interests and to do something that is good objectively and for others.  This approach has met at least one serious objection: the just person’s knowledge of the good may motivate him to do what is good for others but Socrates seeks to also argue that it is always in one’s interest to be just, thus this approach may suggest that just actions may not always be in the just person’s interests (for a discussion of this see Singpurwalla).  This objection amounts to the claim that the second approach may show that the just person will do just actions but it does this by sacrificing Socrates’ claim that being just is always in one’s interest.

Given the problems of the first two approaches, a third one attempts to show that the just person will do what is just in relation to others while at the same time doing what is in the just person’s interests.  In other words, this approach seeks to show that the just person’s own good is realized in doing what is also good for others.  According to this approach, the just person has a value that motivates him to do what is just, in relation to others and this value is the just person’s love of the forms (see Dahl, Norman “Plato’s Defense of Justice”).  The just person’s love of the forms is the desire to contemplate and also imitate or instantiate these in the world.  Thus, the philosopher regards ruling as something in his interest despite the fact that it interferes with his pursuit of knowledge, since in ruling he will be imitating the forms.  Even though this approach seems to bridge the gap between the just person and just actions and the gap between just actions and such actions being in the just person’s interest (this was the problem with the second approach) a criticism remains. Singpurwalla points out that only very few people can acquire such knowledge of the forms so as to be just persons, thus for most people Socrates offers no good reason to be just.  This third approach may save Socrates’ defense of justice only for people capable of knowing the forms, but falls short of showing that everyone has a reason to be just.

Singpurwalla suggests a fourth approach which can defend Socrates contra Sachs and which will avoid the criticisms launched against the other approaches.  She aims to show that Socrates has a good reason to think that it is in everyone’s interest to act justly because doing so satisfies a deeply ingrained human need, namely, the need to be unified with others.  Singpurwalla attempts to make her case by showing the following: (1) that according to Socrates our happiness largely resides in being unified with others (she cites the tyrant’s unhappiness due to bad relations with others as evidence for this, 567a-580a); (2) that being unified with others entails considering their own good when we act (she cites Socrates’ claims that when people are unified they share in each other’s pleasures and successes and failures as evidence for this, 462b-e, 463e-464d); (3) thus, behaving unjustly, which involves disregarding another’s good, is incompatible with being unified with others and with our happiness.  Singpurwalla’s position tries to show that even though the average person may not be able to attain the knowledge of the form of the good, he can still be motivated to act justly since this is in his interest.  Thus, Socrates’ defense of justice may be compelling for the philosopher as well as the average person.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Standard Greek Text

  • Slings, S.R. (ed.), Platonis Rempublicam (Oxford: Oxford Classical Texts, 2003).

b. English Translations

  • Shorey, Paul. Plato. Republic (2 vols. Loeb, 137-1937). This translation includes an introduction and notes.
  • Bloom, Allan. The Republic of Plato. (New York: Basic Books, 1968).  This translation includes notes and an interpretative essay.
  • Ferrari, G.R.F. (ed.), Griffith, Tom (trans.). Plato. The Republic. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000).  This translation includes an introduction.
  • Reeve, C.D.C. Plato. The Republic. (Indianapolis: Hackett, 2004).

c. General Discussions of the Republic

(all attempt to provide a unified interpretation of the dialogue).

  • Murphy, N.R. The Interpretation of Plato’s Republic (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1951).
  • Cross, R.C. and Woozley, A.D. Plato’s Republic: A Philosophical Commentary (New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1964).
  • White, Nicholas P. A Companion to Plato’s Republic (Indianapolis: Hackett, 1979).
  • Annas, Julia. An Introduction to Plato’s Republic (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1981).
  • Reeve, C.D.C. Philosopher Kings: The Argument of Plato’s Republic (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988).
  • Howland, Jacob. The Republic: The Odyssey of Philosophy (Philadelphia: Paul Dry Books, 2004).
  • Rosen, Stanley. Plato’s Republic: A Study (New Haven: Yale University Press, 2005).
  • Santas, Gerasimos. Understanding Plato’s Republic (Wiley-Blackwell, 2010).

d. Discussions on Plato’s Ethics and Political Philosophy

(all entail a systematic discussion of ethics and/or political philosophy in the Republic).

  • Irwin, T.H. Platos Ethics (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1995).
  • Annas, Julia. Platonic Ethics Old and New (Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1999).
  • Monoson, Sara.  Plato’s Democratic Entanglements (Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2000).
  • Bobonich, Christopher.  Plato’s Utopia Recast (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2002).
  • Schofield, Malcolm. Plato: Political Philosophy (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2006).
  • Rowe, Christopher. “The Place of the Republic in Plato’s Political Thought” in Ferrari, G.R.F. The Canbridge Companion to Plato’s Republic. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).

e. Discussions on the City/Soul Analogy.

  • Williams, Bernard. “The Analogy of City and Soul in Plato’s Republic”, in Kraut, Richard (ed.).  Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).
  • Lear, Jonathan. “Inside and Outside the Republic”, in Kraut, Richard (ed.).  Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).
  • Ferrari, G.R.F. City and Soul in Plato’s Republic (Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 2005).
  • Blossner, Norbert. “The City-Soul Analogy”, in Ferrari, G.R.F. The Canbridge Companion to Plato’s Republic. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).

f. Discussions of Plato’s Defense of Justice in the Republic

(in chronological order; these essays discuss how Socrates defends justice and examine how well he does in doing so).

  • Sachs, David. “A Fallacy in Plato’s Republic”, in The Philosophical Review 72 (1963): 141-58.
  • Dahl, Norman O. “Plato’s Defense of Justice”, in Philosophy and Phenomenological Research. Vol. 51, No. 4 (Dec. 1991).
  • Kraut, Richard. “The Defense of Justice in Plato’s Republic”, in Kraut, Richard (ed.) Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).
  • Singpurwalla, Rachel G.K. “Plato’s Defense of Justice in the Republic”, in Santas, Gerasimos (ed.). The Blackwell Guide to Plato’s Republic (Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2006).

g. Discussions of Political Measures Introduced in the Just City

i. Discussions of the Role of Women in the Just City

  • Discussions of the Role of Women in the Just City
  • Vlastos, Gregory.  “Was Plato a Feminist?”, Times Literary Supplement, No. 4, 485, Mar. 17, 1989, 276, 288-89.
  • Saxonhouse, Arlene. “The philosopher and the Female in the Political Thought of Plato”, in Kraut, Richard (ed.) Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).
  • Reeve. C.D.C. “The Naked Old Women in the Palaestra”, in Kraut, Richard (ed.) Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).

ii. Discussions of Poetry in the Just City

  • Urmson, James O. “Plato and the Poets”, in Kraut, Richard (ed.) Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).
  • O’Connor, David K. “Rewriting the Poets in Plato’s Characters”, in Ferrari, G.R.F. The Canbridge Companion to Plato’s Republic. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).
  • Moss, Jessica.  “What is Imitative Poetry and Why is it Bad?”, in Ferrari, G.R.F. The Canbridge Companion to Plato’s Republic. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).

iii. Discussions on the Soul in the Republic

  • Lorenz, Hendrik. “The Analysis of the Soul in Plato’s Republic” in Santas, Gerasimos (ed.). The Blackwell Guide to Plato’s Republic (Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2006).
  • Ferrari, G.R.F., “The Three-Part Soul”, in Ferrari, G.R.F. The Cambridge Companion to Plato’s Republic. (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).

iv. Discussions on Plato’s Moral Psychology in the Republic

  • Cooper, John M. “The Psychology of Justice in Plato” in Kraut, Richard (ed.) Plato’s Republic: Critical Essays (New York: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997).
  • Anagnostopoulos, Mariana.  “The Divided Soul and the Desire for Good in Plato’s Republic” in Santas, Gerasimos (ed.). The Blackwell Guide to Plato’s Republic (Oxford: Blackwell Publishing, 2006).

 

Author Information

Antonis Coumoundouros
Email: acoumoundouros@adrian.edu
Adrian College
U. S. A.

Victor Kraft (1880—1975)

Victor KraftVictor Kraft was an Austrian philosopher and librarian. He was, as he himself emphasized, a “non-orthodox” member of the Vienna Circle and tried to reintroduce scientific philosophy in Austria after the Second World War. Beginning in 1903, Kraft argued for epistemology based on ontological realism. He did not claim that realism can be proven logically but is established as an (abductive) inference in order to explain the regularities of perception. In the philosophy of science, he was a proponent of the hypothetico-deductive method. Interestingly, Kraft used a lot of illustrative examples from the sciences and humanities to substantiate his methodological claims. Kraft was the only member of the Vienna Circle who claimed, against logical-empiricist conviction, that an analysis of values and ethics are an appropriate subject for philosophical analysis. Also, he combined insights from empirical sciences (especially psychology) and philosophical analysis in order to provide a non-relativistic basis for morals. From a historical point of view, it is especially remarkable that Kraft published for over seven decades without abandoning his initial position. Of particular importance is his impact on Karl Popper and Paul Feyerabend. His most important works are his Erkenntnislehre (Theory of Knowledge, 1960), his Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden (The Basic Forms of the Scientific Method, 1925, second edition 1973) and his Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value (second German edition 1951, English version published in 1981). He is also known as the author of the seminal monograph The Vienna Circle: the Origin of Neo-Positivism (1951, published in English in 1969).

Table of Contents

  1. Life
  2. Work
    1. Epistemology and Ontology
    2. Philosophy of Science–Methodology
    3. Philosophy of Geography as an Example of Kraft’s Philosophy of Science
    4. Value Theory and Moral Philosophy
  3. Kraft’s Impact as a Philosopher
  4. References and Further Reading
    1. Selected Works by Kraft
    2. Quoted Literature and Suggestions for Further Reading

1. Life

Victor (or Viktor) Kraft was born on July 4, 1880 in Vienna, Austria. Both his father and his maternal grandfather were teachers. In 1899, he received the matura (the general qualification for university entrance) and enrolled in geography and history at the University of Vienna with the intention of becoming a teacher. There he attended lectures in economics, geology and botany. Kraft encountered philosophy for the first time as a member of the University of Vienna’s Philosophical Society and in private discussion circles. In 1903, Kraft completed his PhD thesis, “The Knowledge of the External World” (Die Erkenntnis der Außenwelt). The following year he studied under Wilhelm Dilthey, Georg Simmel, Carl Stumpf and Heinrich Wölfflin for one semester in Berlin. In 1914, he received the venia legendi, the right to teach at the university level, as a result of his book World-Concept and Knowledge-Concept (Weltbegriff und Erkenntnisbegriff). His supervisors for his “habilitation” were the psychologist and philosopher Friedrich Jodl and the philosopher Alois Höfler. Kraft’s original intention to pursue an academic career was regarded as futile by both Jodl and the philosopher Laurenz Müllner, which led Kraft to seek employment at the University of Vienna library. Though he held a full-time job, in which he ultimately reached the position of national librarian (Generalstaatsbibliothekar), he continued his work in philosophy. In 1924, he applied for a full professorship in Vienna, but for political reasons, the position was given to another candidate (Stadler 2001, 522 ff). Kraft received merely the title of associate professor. In the book he wrote for this application, The Basic Forms of the Scientific Method (Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden), which was published in 1925, Kraft outlined his hypothetico-deductive method. A second, completely revised edition was published in 1973.

In 1924, the Vienna Circle began as an informal discussion group led by the philosopher Moritz Schlick, and Kraft participated at these meetings. He was also a member of the so called Gomperz circle, which was named after its leader, the philosopher Heinrich Gomperz. Kraft never adhered to verificationism, the most radical thesis of the logical empiricists, because it was incompatible with his concept of realism. In 1937, he published Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Values (Die Grundlagen einer wissenschaftlichen Wertlehre), a book which made early contributions to value theory and ethics. A second edition was released in 1951. In 1938, after the Anschluss (the occupation and annexation of Austria by Nazi Germany), a biographical caesura took place. Kraft was forced to retire due to the fact that he was married to a Jewish woman (Heiß 1993, 139, 157, n. 43; Topitsch 1981, xii). During World War II, he remained in his hometown of Vienna as an “inner emigrant” and wrote a manuscript that was lost in the final days of the war. During this time, he was able to publish in the Swedish journal Theoria. In 1947, he released Mathematics, Logic and Experience, a small volume based on the lost manuscript.

Kraft was finally reinstated as extraordinary professor in 1950, and at the age of seventy he received the title of ordentlicher Professor (full professor) at the University of Vienna. He tried to revitalize a kind of reformed logical empiricist philosophy but was unsuccessful; the political climate at that time was as hostile to logical-empirical philosophizing as it had been in the 1920s and 1930s. He became the academic head of a discussion group of students, which included Paul Feyerabend, who wrote his Ph.D. thesis under Kraft’s supervision. This group was part of the “Forum Alpach”, a non-profit organization that was most important for reintroducing scientific philosophy in Austria and Germany. Feyerabend served as the student leader of this group.

Kraft‘s most significant and mature monograph was published in 1960; the voluminous Theory of Knowledge (Erkenntnislehre) summarized his lifelong philosophical work, and he dedicated the book to himself on his eightieth birthday. Eight years later, he published a small book, The Fundamentals of Knowledge and of Morality (Die Grundlagen der Erkenntnis und der Moral). In 1974, Mathematics, Logic and Experience was reprinted in a substantially revised form. Kraft died on January 3, 1975, in Vienna. For Kraft’s biography see Kainz [1976].

2. Work

a. Epistemology and Ontology

The historical and thematic context in which Kraft developed his own philosophical position included the critique of immanence philosophy (a form of neutral monism developed by Richard Avenarius) and Ernst Mach’s positivism. Kraft was primarily concerned with defending the assumption of an external world. The Kantian (Critique of Pure Reason, B116) distinction between “question of fact” (quaestio facti) and “question of right” (quaestio iuris) was central for Kraft. In sharp contrast to any form of traditional Kantianism, Kraft did not intend to logically justify any answers to those “questions of right” but instead insisted on pragmatic vindication. This becomes remarkably clear in his attempts to stipulate the concept of knowledge, wherein only by presupposing some ends can an adequate normative definition of the concept of “knowledge” be reached. Kraft presupposes that knowledge must bear practical implications:

The only thing one can do is to make clear why a certain definition of knowledge is chosen, why those traits are regarded as essential for knowledge (Erkenntnis). These are not theoretical but practical claims of validity, which must be seen in the context of other ends, that is, that some consequences are preferred, or that some consequences or presuppositions are rejected (Kraft 1960, 31, my translation).

Later Kraft explains that the concept of knowledge is determined by human nature; that is, only a concept of knowledge that guarantees an invariant order of knowledge can be generally accepted. Human beings need information about the external world; otherwise, no orientation or human actions are possible. Hence, knowledge must be reliable, and it is reliable if it is not chaotic but ordered according to the laws of logic. Pragmatic utility is not enough; knowledge consists of invariant order (Kraft 1968, 17).

The same pattern can be found in his argumentation for a realistic ontology. Kraft states that he does not intend to logically prove the claim for the external world but maintains that the hypothesis of an external world is able to explain any inter- and intrasensual regularity. Examples of intersensual regularities would be: Every time you are served your favourite Indian curry, you recognize its taste and smell; you recognize your cell phone every time it rings. The latter is an example for an intrasensual regularity. In later years Kraft (Kraft 1968, 19) alludes to the infant’s psychological development to stress this point. In earlier years the same point was made without referring to developmental psychology (compare Kraft 1912, 60, 98 174, 181, 183; Kraft 1960, 115). An analogous argument can be constructed concerning the assumption of “other minds” (Fremdseelische). This is an inference to the best explanation. It is, however, not sufficient to simply postulate any explanatory hypothesis; it is also necessary to deduce regular experiential statements from this hypothesis. Kraft claims that his realism has advantages over  positivism because it is a “richer” position: one is able to use it to explain any form of inter- and intrasensual regularity, whereas the positivist must see a sheer miracle in this regularity (compare Kraft 1912, 168). He claims that the assumption of the existence of the external world is a condition for explaining experiential regularity.

It should be noted that Kraft’s starting point is the concept of “everyday realism;” it therefore lost some power in light of modern microphysics. As a consequence, he later emphasizes the subject’s perception of well-known objects (Kraft 1960, 321 f), such as a measuring instrument’s needle.

Any argument against abductive reasoning can be raised against Kraft. The objection that Kraft’s argument begs the question is especially important here; he starts with a realist’s assumption and tries to explicate the very same assumption. The skeptic (or positivist) cannot be convinced theoretically, and therefore, Kraft relies on praxis. Here, he turns the tables; it is not the realist who has to justify his claim but the positivist because the latter violates our commonly accepted principles of abductive reasoning.

b. Philosophy of Science–Methodology

Kraft’s epistemology cannot be separated from his methodology; his aim is to explicate the epistemological assumptions of any human cognitive practice. Science especially must be emphasized here because it notably fulfills the epistemological requirements mentioned above. It is useful to discuss Kraft’s philosophy of science by asking four questions:

  1. What is a (scientific) theory for Kraft?
  2. Why, for Kraft, does any theory have mere hypothetical validity?
  3. How can the theory’s axioms be reached?
  4. How is a theory anchored in experience?

Question 1: What is a (scientific) theory for Kraft?

Kraft adheres to the classical notion of a theory as a “deductive system” (Kraft, 1925, 126; 1960, 369 f). Explanation is deduction from axioms (Kraft 1912, 175). This notion was elaborated by Carl Hempel (see Theories of Explanation, sect. 2).

Question 2: Why, for Kraft, does any theory have mere hypothetical validity?

The answer is simple. Any theory contains sentences of a general nature, for example, “All bodies fall to earth.” This generalization can only be regarded as a hypothesis because it does not follow logically from single instances of falling bodies (problem of induction). This classical, logical uncertainty is supplemented by pragmatic underdetermination. In short, if several aims or concepts of knowledge are possible, as we have seen, how can the correctness of the chosen one be established? Thus, the answers to the first two questions can be conveniently labeled “hypothetico-deductivism.”

Question 3: How can the theory’s axioms be reached?

To begin with, there is an important distinction to keep in mind: “axioms” is Kraft’s wording; today, one would use the term “hypotheses”. Kraft’s use of words is not modified here for expository reasons. He mentions several times that any deduction is only valid if the axioms are accepted. The axioms are not freely chosen but are accepted on the basis of whether they could fulfill an explanatory task (Kraft, 1925, 157; 1947, 96 f). Given this, a hypothetical system can be established rationally because Kraft argues that the “immanent order of experience” guides the postulation of the axioms (Kraft 1947, 96 f). He claims that this order is sought because it guarantees technical and theoretical control of experiential facts (Erlebnistatsachen). In other words, experience guides the postulation of axioms in an unambiguous manner.

Axioms are postulates. In any kind of scientific research, they are the product of scientific genius and intuition or scintillation. Therefore, they cannot be explained and analyzed further. On the other hand, those very axioms must fulfill a practical task, for example, the explanation of inter- and intrasensual regularities. Immediately the question arises of what explanation consists in, because any set of axioms which does not fulfill its explanatory task cannot be regarded as practically relevant. Consequently, if those axioms in question do not provide the logical starting point for an explanatory deduction of the above mentioned regularities, they must be dismissed as practically irrelevant. Logical deduction, according to Kraft, is the standard form of a (scientific) explanation and science provides knowledge. Therefore, in order to establish the fundamental axioms of any form of (scientific) knowledge, one must refer to a basic or embryonic notion of (scientific) knowledge. In a nutshell, in order to establish knowledge one must already have knowledge. Although Kraft is aware of this so called “circle of epistemology” (a claim made by the German philosopher Leonard Nelson early in 1911, compare Kraft, 1960, 1 ff) his solution is not satisfactory because a conventional fixation of the term in question must be either arbitrary, hence irrational – a solution which is rejected by Kraft – or guided by rational philosophical argumentation. If the latter is the case, one begs the question, assuming that “rationality” is explicated at least partly by (logical) consistency of the propositions in question. This remarkable tension is overlooked by Kraft. The charge of circularity lurks again under the surface of his argumentation because Kraft claims that the axioms are chosen in order to be empirically applicable. However, this is problematic because counter-instances are excluded, and the very idea of falsification of a theory becomes questionable. Experience would lose its power as a corrective instance.

Question 4: How is a theory anchored in experience?

Kraft is an empiricist; that is, he sees the basis of any knowledge-claim in experience. Its foundation lies not in a pure atomistic “sense-datum” or any sensualistic equivalent. Instead, the sense-datum is embedded in an experiential complex that consists of experiential relations (Wahrnehmungsbeziehungen). Moreover, experiential relations are interpreted as signs for external objects. As a consequence, statements about those “external objects” can be tested because any statement about a mind-independent object implies existential statements as logical consequences. Kraft claimed that there is isomorphism between the class of existential statements (implied by the assumption of a mind-independent object) and the experiential regularity. (If there is no table in my room, neither you nor I will be able to perceive it; I will not be able to perceive any intrasensual, intersensual or intersubjective regularity.)

Given tables, flowers and honey bees as ordinary objects, no problems will arise. However, what will happen if electrons, quarks or other highly theoretical entities enter the stage? The layman will perhaps see nothing and will not be able to construct any regularities. To be sure, one is able to learn to “see” those theoretical regularities, but once again, Kraft seems to dismiss the role of dissent in science. He establishes the concept of a “well-known object,” a class of objects about which no dissent might arise. Researcher Miller “sees” electrons, researcher Smith sees another theoretical entity, but both see a screen. (This is a corollary to the idea of the theory-ladenness of observation.) It should be kept in mind, that the term “theory-ladenness” can be understood in two ways (Heidelberger, 2003, 138 f). First, it is the notion that perception is based on expectations and beliefs, hence no “neutral” sense-data is given. Second, “theory-ladennes” is a semantical notion: every (scientific) term gets its meaning through a (scientific) theory. Kraft rejects the second notion, and adheres to the first one: It is a matter of fact that there are no “neutral” sense data. In his earlier years, however, he makes this point without explicitly referring to psychology but admits that the idea of an objective external world is a necessary prerequisite for any rational construction of knowledge.

To summarize, Kraft argued for the assumption of an external world in order to explain perceptual regularities. The empirical basis is equivalent to “experiential relations,” which implies the assumption of the external world. Only because of this is one able to formulate fertile predictions and exclude metaphysical or theistic (pseudo-)explanations. The most important criticism that can be raised against Kraft’s attempt is that it is circular: he argued abductively for realism in order to exclude any form of idealism, solipsism or positivism. This maneuver begins with perceived regularities that demand explanation; however, these very regularities are the basis for his empiricist philosophy of science. Kraft rejected any other (pseudo-)explanation of these regularities. He upholds realism as an inference to the best explanation, and in so doing, he was able to formulate a criterion for rejecting non-realistic interpretations of regularity. Hence, his ontology and philosophy of science are entangled, to say the least. This reveals once again that the postulation of axioms cannot be a free decision but is at least partly guided by meta-theoretical considerations and leads quite naturally to Kraft’s moral philosophy, especially because the concept of knowledge is regarded as a normative concept.

c. Philosophy of Geography as an Example of Kraft’s Philosophy of Science

Kraft was not only a philosopher; he was also trained in geography. He studied under Albrecht Penck, an outstanding geographer who specialized in physical geography and geomorphology. Penck was influenced by William Morris Davis, an American geographer famous for the “cycle of erosion,” an explicitly deductive theory of geomorphological change. It can be argued that Kraft developed his methodology in part as a result of his association with Penck.

1914 and fifteen years later (1929a), Kraft wrote introductory treatises for students of geography that focused on methodology. As a discipline, geography was (at least in German-speaking countries) in an uncertain state. Is geography a generalizing science or merely descriptive? Is its object the need to simply describe the earth’s surface or should it also tackle the laws governing the changes that take place there, for example as a result of erosion?

Kraft stresses that this “double dualism” is the reason for the not-yet-settled scientific status of geography. The following table illustrates these challenges:

The “double dualism” of geography according to Kraft
Dualism according the epistemological aim of geography (question of right) Dualism according the object of geography (the question of fact)
regional geography (Länderkunde) general geography (Allgemeine Geographie) for example, physical geography; earth’s surface as physical object for example, historical geography; earth’s surface as humankind’s home
Is the dualism bridgeable? No, because both aims are mutually exclusive. Yes, because both are mutually dependent.

In this conundrum, Kraft took a generally “nomothetical” stance. That is, scientific explanation is deducing singular statements from general laws. Even if the aim is descriptive, some universal laws must be presupposed because every scientific description works with concepts of type. However, this is not the whole story. Kraft sees in abductive inferences to universal laws an important task for general geography (Kraft 1929a, 14). His use of the term “induction” is ambiguous; “abductive” would fit much better, because he did not refer to a merely enumerative induction. Such an “inductive inference” therefore presupposes hypothetical assumptions (Kraft 1925, 250f); only then can universal laws be postulated. These hypotheses can in turn be tested by deducing predictions. To summarize, “induction is not more than postulating a hypotheses and is not an epistemological procedure (Erkenntnisverfahren) on its own” (Kraft 1960, 257).

Description is important too. Descriptive geography presupposes universal laws, whereas general geography presupposes scientific description. The result of Kraft’s analysis is that the more fundamental epistemological dualism in geography cannot be bridged because there are two different epistemological aims—generalizing and describing—that cannot be reduced. However, this chasm must not be regarded as an ontological gap. The praxis of geography illustrates that human and physical geography need each other.

Finally, Kraft mentioned a holistic approach that was in fashion during the 1920s. The idea was that a landscape (Landschaft) could be grasped intuitively, much like a work of art is apprehended. According to Kraft, this “third way” is not scientific because a “synthetic approach” lacks any criteria to rationalize the material. Both treaties had some impact. The first (1914) led to a short correspondence between Kraft and the eminent German geographer Alfred Hettner. Fred K. Schaefer used the latter (1929a) to support his critique of Richard Hartshorne, who followed Hettner in some respects.

The “Schaefer-Hartshorne Debate” was the central methodological controversy in geography in the 1950s (compare Martin 1989). It followed the nomothetic-idiographic debate and helped to clarify the scientific status of the study of geography. (Basically, it was the aftermath of the old nomothetic-idiographic controversy.) Kraft developed the idea that any special epistemological status for geography as a science cannot be argued for, which was a straightforward rejection of Hettner’s approach. This is not surprising given the main tenets of logical empiricism, but researchers tend to overlook that Kraft came to his conclusion by dwelling on the (Kantian) distinction between “questions of fact” and “questions of right”. As a methodologist, Kraft proposes a unitarian or non-dualistic approach, and as an epistemologist, he refers to different aims of geography; in his view, geography’s basic aims are either individualistic or generalizing. (For further reading, see Radler, 2008.)

Although Kraft’s analysis of geography is of rather special interest for students of (general) philosophy of science, one can show that Kraft’s basic ideas can also be found in his criticism of the Verstehen approach in the humanities (compare Kraft 1929b). An intuitive grasping of a text’s meaning is rejected by Kraft with the same arguments he proposed against the grasping of the “essence” of a landscape. Besides, in his analysis of the methodology of historiography Kraft makes remarkably clear that the former cannot proceed without some nomothetical laws. At least implicitly, the historians have to refer to causal laws or statistical regularities if they aim to explain the behavior of an historical individual or group. The same holds for the philologist who wants to classify a historical document.

d. Value Theory and Moral Philosophy

In his value theory and moral philosophy, Kraft distinguishes between (a) value concepts, (b) value judgments and (c) the rational justification of morals. His Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value contains an extensive chapter about the psychology of value judgment.

(a) Value concepts.

Kraft’s primary aim is conceptual clarification and analysis. For example, consider the following statement: “Lassie is a loyal and healthy dog.” The subject Lassie is the bearer of value (Wertträger)—a good. The example can be generalized: a loyal or healthy dog is a good, a bearer of value. The adjectives “loyal” and “healthy” in the statement are value predicates. “Loyalty” and “health” are, according to Kraft, values. Values are the intension (Bedeutungsgehalt) of a value concept. Hence, values designate a general relation to a range of things; a comrade, a friend or a partner can be loyal as well. Thus, the bearer of value may change. In a corollary analysis, Kraft shows that the value concept can be divided into two components. First, it can be divided into a factual component, and second, it can be divided into a normative component (Wertcharakter). (A similar distinction was later made by R. M. Hare.) What does this mean? Consider the value “loyalty.” A loyal friend, comrade or dog may have some factual traits in common. One might argue that a specific form of subservient and respectful behavior might be called “loyal”. These factual traits become more evident if one considers “technical norms;” for example, it is easy to explain what a good tool is. Finally, consider the value “beauty.” Its factual component can be described as a harmonic relationship of the parts of a whole and therein lies its beauty (compare Aesthetics, especially sect. 3). The normative component denotes the value character that, generally speaking, signifies a distinction (Auszeichnung). A loyal dog is preferred over a dog that is disobedient; a masterful painting is preferred over a smearing of paint on a train station’s wall. It is this normative, distinctive component that is essential for value concepts. A large part of Kraft’s analysis consists in describing psychological investigations, or how the subject acquired the value component psychologically.

Valuations do not consist, according to Kraft, in their relation to emotions. Emotions merely cause valuations. An attitude or disposition to these emotions must be added, a normative stance to these emotions must be taken. An analysis of valuation must consider this attitude or disposition but must not be exhausted in the inquiry into emotions or feelings. Therefore, an equation of valuation and emotional affection or disaffection is ruled out. Of course, psychological aspects and problems enter the stage immediately if one analyzes the normative stance to relational feelings or emotions. It becomes clear here that Kraft abandoned the notion of purely semantic and syntactical consideration. Based on his assumptions and his conception of philosophy, it is not possible to analyze valuation without including empirical findings.

(b) Value judgments.

The distinction (Auszeichnung), the essential component of a value concept, can be explained psychologically. Its acquisition is an individual process. However, this is irrelevant in normative considerations because moral philosophy cannot, according to Kraft, be reduced to the description of psychological processes. Value judgments must be impersonal (Kraft, 1981, 129 ff). Kraft distinguishes between value judgments as propositions concerning actual determination of attitudes and value judgments that can be described as imperatives. Value judgments as propositions about actual determination of attitudes would be labeled as descriptive ethics today. The problem is that such a position cannot guarantee objectivity, insofar as moral relativism is regarded as fact:

General human structure as such is not sufficient to determine valuations unequivocally, and given individual differences between evaluations, we cannot in principle exclude the possibility that the same aspect of the same object maybe appraised differently by different persons. (Kraft, 1981, 137).

Kraft therefore offers value judgments as imperatives, as “general guidelines” (Kraft, 1981, 138 ff).

(c) The rational justification of morals.

For this reason, the very problem is that given the empirical findings that guided Kraft’s analysis of values and value judgments, how it is possible to establish an objective (and not merely subjective) moral (compare Kraft 1981, 142 ff)? Is a form of moral relativism not the unavoidable consequence of Kraft’s analysis? From the 1940s on, Kraft began to confront this problem. His main contribution to practical philosophy is an explication of objective morality in a form of the following argument, which can be generalized by substituting “we” for “I” (see also Radler 2010):

I (we) have desires which I am (we are) eager to satisfy.
If I (we) accept morality, I (we) could satisfy my (our) desires.
I (we) accept morality.

Kraft asserts that due to general human organization (allgemein menschliche Organisation), some basic valuations must be valid in every culture (Kraft 1981, 173). In his last monograph, “basic human organization” is not the reference point but rather the (even more vague) concept of “culture”, which is important for an individual’s morality:

Culture is not solely a means to reach happiness, culture is the manner in which humans live. Therefore, culture has to be human’s highest aim, regardless of whether culture makes men happier or not. Humans can only seek to induce happiness through culture” (Kraft, 1968, 141).

Hence, “[culture] is the means, to devise one’s life. Therefore the imperative to guide one’s life through culture is categorical” (Kraft, 1968, 143).

From a social point of view, morality can, according to Kraft, only be instrumentally argued for. He regarded the imperatives of social morality as necessary conditions for reaching aims decreed by human nature.

Kraft was aware of the problems inherent in this kind of reasoning. First, in social morality, only “hypothetical imperatives” can be formulated. The crucial question is how to deal with the apparent plurality of aims and means. Second, it is doubtful whether the conditional sentence in the premises formulates a necessary and sufficient condition. Third, Kraft was criticized because this position is circular; an unspecified moral stance must be taken, and morality is only binding for those who already have accepted its binding force. Kraft is therefore not able to convince those who are “moral outsiders.” His work was an attempt to clarify the cryptic normative inclinations of moral individuals. Kraft’s approach resembles “natural law” positions.

3. Kraft’s Impact as a Philosopher

Looking back one can summarize Kraft’s philosophy as empirically informed (naturalistic), anti-inductivistic, anti-relativistic and – on the other hand – anti-dogmatic. In this way, he is an adherent of “scientific philosophy.” To be more precise, Kraft’s philosophy is remarkable in several aspects: First, “inferences to the best explanations” are scattered throughout the entirety of his work, from epistemology to moral philosophy. Second, Kraft formulates his arguments on the basis of specific empirical findings and a metaphysical (ontological) position. It has also become clear that ontology, epistemology, methodology, value theory and moral philosophy are entangled. At the very center of his philosophical ideas stands the notion that “knowledge” must be regarded as a normative concept. It is this understanding of philosophy, an adherence to prescriptions and not only formal reconstruction, which is central for Kraft.

His bearing on the philosophy of geography was already mentioned. Far more importance seems to be his influence on Karl Popper (compare Schramm 1992, 135f). Popper admits that Kraft can be regarded as a forerunner of his deductivism, however Kraft criticized Popper where the latter argues for a kind of platonistic metaphysics, that is his world 3 (Kraft 1976). Besides this, Kraft criticized Popper’s contribution to the so called “protocol sentence debate”. With his critique of Hugo Dingler, a proponent of conventionalism, Kraft influenced Hans Albert, the leading adherent of Critical Rationalism in Germany. Since the late twentieth century, Kraft’s impact on Paul Feyerabend has been under investigation. It is significant that under Kraft’s guidance a discussion circle of young students in the 1950s in Vienna was established. This circle provided Feyerabend the platform for discussing his PhD-thesis, which is basically a post-war prolongation of the “protocol sentence debate.” Perhaps the most important impact of Kraft’s thinking on Feyerabend is his later admission that philosophy (of science) is empirically informed but basically grounded on pragmatically chosen principles. (The problems of this point were discussed in section 2b above.)

4. References and Further Reading

Most works by Kraft have not been translated into English. The two exceptions are Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value (1981) and The Vienna Circle, the origin of neo-positivism; a chapter in the history of recent philosophy (1969). Kraft’s most important works are Erkenntnislehre (Theory of Knowledge) (1960) and Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden (The Basic Forms of Scientific Methods) (1925). The only secondary sources in English are Topitsch (1981), Stadler (2001, 159-161; 666-673) and the review by Feyerabend (1962/1963) of Kraft’s Erkenntnislehre (1960). Kainz (1976) is the standard and still unsurpassed reference to Kraft’s life. For a complete bibliography, see Stadler (2001, 667-671) or Frey (1975a and 1975b).

Readers who are familiar with German might consult the following references. Radler (2006, 2008, 2010) provides a historical reconstruction and philosophical analysis of Kraft’s philosophy; Vollbrecht (2004)  and Siegetsleitner (2014, 332-386) investigate his moral philosophy. Short and concise overviews are given by Rutte (1973), Frey (1975a and 1976b), Haller (1976) and Schramm (1992). Stadler (2001, 522ff) describes Kraft’s difficulties with securing a professorship in the 1920s. Reininger (1938 [ed.]; compare Stadler, 2001, 158) provides an overview of the “Philosophical Society of the University of Vienna”. Feyerabend (1982, 108f) mentions the Forum Alpbach and Kraft as an important influence. The above mentioned traces of Kraft’s philosophy can – for example –  be found in Feyerabend (1958/1981, 34n; 1960/1999, 42; 1972/1999, 158n). Kraft’s modified Kantian argumentation becomes most visible in his early works (compare Kraft, 1904; 1912). Kraft’s papers on philosophy and methodology of geography are discussed in Radler (2008), where one can also find relevant details and references to secondary literature. Hacohen (2002, 236) describes Popper’s friendly relationship to Kraft. Radler (2006), Kuby (2010) and Stadler (2010) focus on his relationship to Popper and Feyerabend. Kraft’s criticism of Dingler and conventionalism can be found in (1947). Kraft discusses aspects of physicalism and phenomenalism in (1969), readers who are interested in the “protocol sentence debate” in general should compare Kraft’s reconstruction with Uebel (2007).

a. Selected Works by Kraft

  • Kraft, Victor (1904), “Das Problem der Aussenwelt.” In Archiv für Philosophie. II. Abt.: Archiv für systematische Philosophie, N.F. X, 269-313.
  • Kraft, Victor (1912), Weltbegriff und Erkenntnisbegriff. Eine erkenntnistheoretische Untersuchung. Leipzig: Johann Ambrosius Barth.
  • Kraft, Victor (1914), “Gegenstand, Aufgaben und Methoden der Geographie als Wissenschaft.” In O. Kende (ed.), Handbuch der geographischen Wissenschaften, 1st part. Berlin: Vossische Buchhandlung [= Sammlung wissenschaftlicher Handbücher für Studierende I], 1-8.
  • Kraft, Victor (1925), Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden. Vienna /Leipzig: Hölder-Pichler-Tempsky A.-G. [= Österreichische Akademie der Wissenschaften, Philosophisch-historische Klasse 203, Abh. 3].
  • Kraft, Victor (1929a), “Die Geographie als Wissenschaft.” In F. Lampe (ed.) Enzyklopädie der Erdkunde, 1st part: Methodenlehre der Geographie. Leipzig / Vienna: Franz Deuticke: 1-22.
  • Kraft, Victor (1929b), “Intuitives Verstehen in der Geschichtswissenschaft.” In W. Bauer (ed.), Mitteilungen des Österreichischen Instituts für Geschichtsforschung, Suplementary Volume XI, Innsbruck: Universitäts-Verlag Wagner, 1-30.
  • Kraft, Victor (1940b), “Über Moralbegründung.” In Theoria 6, 191-226.
  • Kraft, Victor (1947), Mathematik, Logik und Erfahrung. Vienna: Springer.
  • Kraft, Victor (1951/1937), Die Grundlagen einer wissenschaftlichen Wertlehre. 2nd ed. Vienna: Springer.
  • Kraft, Victor (1955), “Der Wissenschaftscharakter der Erkenntnislehre.” In Actes du deuxième congrès international de l’union de philosophie des sciences. Neuchatel: Èditions du Griffon I, 85-94.
  • Kraft, Victor (1960), Erkenntnislehre. Vienna: Springer.
  • Kraft, Victor (1967/1950), Einführung in die Philosophie. Philosophie, Weltanschauung, Wissenschaft. 2nd ed. Vienna / New York: Springer.
  • Kraft, Victor (1968), Die Grundlagen der Erkenntnis und der Moral. Berlin: Duncker & Humblot.
  • Kraft, Victor (1969), The Vienna Circle : the origin of neo-positivism ; a chapter in the history of recent philosophy. – Reprinted. – New York, NY: Greenwood Press.
  • Kraft, Victor (1973/1925), Die Grundformen der wissenschaftlichen Methoden, Vienna: Verlag der Österreichischen Akademie der Wissenschaften [= Österreichische Akademie der Wissenschaften. Philosophisch-historische Klasse 284, Abh. 5]. 2nd ed. Vienna: Verl. d. Österreich. Akad. d. Wiss.
  • Kraft, Victor (1973a), “Konstruktiver Realismus.” In Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie 4, 313-322.
  • Kraft, Victor (1973b), “Gespräch mit Viktor Kraft.” In Conceptus, 7 (21-23), 9-25.
  • Kraft, Victor (1974), “Popper and the Vienna Circle.” In P. A. Schilpp (ed.), The Philosophy of Karl Popper [= Library of Living Philosophers XIV]. La Salle, Ill.: Open Court, 185-205.
  • Kraft, Victor (1976), “Das Universalienproblem.” In B. Kanitscheider (ed.), Sprache und Erkenntnis. Festschrift für Gerhard Frey zum 60. Geburtstag. Innsbruck: Amoe, 33-36.
  • Kraft, Victor (1981), Foundations for a scientific analysis of value. Ed. by Henk L. Mulder. Transl. by Elizabeth Hughes Schneewind. With an introd. by Ernst Topitsch. Dordrecht, Holland [u.a.]: Reidel.
  • Kraft, Victor (1997/1951), Der Wiener Kreis. Der Ursprung des Neopositivismus. 3rd ed. Vienna / New York: Springer.

b. Quoted Literature and Suggestions for Further Reading

  • Feyerabend, Paul (1962/63), “Erkenntnislehre, By Viktor Kraft” [Review], In The British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 8, 319-323.
  • Feyerabend, Paul (1981/1958), “An attempt at a realistic interpretation of experience.” In P. K.  Feyerabend, Realism, rationalism and scientific method. Philosophical Papers. Vol. 1, Cambridge et al.: Cambridge University Press, 17-37.
  • Feyerabend, Paul (1982), Science in Free Society. London: Verso.
  • Feyerabend, Paul (1999/1960), “The problem of the existence of theoretical entities.” In P. K. Feyerabend, Knowledge, Science and Relativism. Philosophical Papers Vol. 3. Ed. by John Preston. Cambridge et al.: Cambridge University Press, 16-50.
  • Feyerabend, Paul (1999/1972), “On the limited validity of methodological rules.” In P. K. Feyerabend, Knowledge, Science and Relativism. Philosophical Papers Vol. 3. Ed. by John Preston. Cambridge et al.: Cambridge University Press, 138-181.
  • Frey, Gerhard (1975a), “Logik, Erfahrung und Norm. Zum Tode Victor Krafts.” In Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie 6, 1-6.
  • Frey, Gerhard (1975b), “Nachträge und Ergänzungen zur Bibliographie der Schriften von Victor Kraft.” In Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenschaftstheorie 6, 179-181.
  • Hacohen, Malachi Haim (2000), Karl Popper – The Formative Years 1902-1945. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Haller, Rudolf (1976), “Nachruf auf Victor Kraft.” In Zeitschrift für philosophische Forschung 30, 618-622.
  • Heidelberger, Michael (2003), “Theory Ladennes and Scientific Instruments in Experimentation.” In Hans Radder (ed.), The Philosophy of Scientific Experimentation. Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press, 138-151.
  • Heiß, Gernot (1993), “… wirkliche Möglichkeiten für eine nationalsozialistische Philosophie? Die Reorganisation der Philosophie (Psychologie und Pädagogik) in Wien 1938 bis 1940.” In Kurt R. Fischer & F, M. Wimmer (eds.), Der geistige Anschluß. Philosophie und Politik an der Universität Wien 1930-1950. Vienna: WUV-Universitätsverlag, 130-170.
  • Kainz, Friedrich (1976), “Viktor Kraft [Nachruf].” In Almanach für das Jahr 1975 [der Österreichischen Akademie der Wissenschaften], 519-557.
  • Kuby, Daniel (2010), “Rational zu sein war damals für uns eine Lebensfrage.” Studien zu Paul Feyerabends Wiener Lehrjahren. Diploma thesis, University of Vienna.
  • Martin, Geoffrey (1989), “The Nature of Geography and the Schaefer-Hartshorne Debate.” In J. N. Entrikin & S. D. Brunn (eds.), Reflections on Richard Hartshorne’s The Nature of Geography,Washington, DC: Assoc. of American Geographers 69-89.
  • Radler, Jan (2006), Victor Krafts konstruktiver Empirismus. Eine historische und philosphische Untersuchung. Berlin: Logos.
  • Radler, Jan (2008), “Victor Kraft und die Geographie.” In M.Fürst et al. (eds.), Analysen, Argumente, Ansätze. Beiträge zum 8. Internationalen Kongress der Österreichischen Gesellschaft für Philosophie in Graz, II. Frankfurt (Main): Ontos, 65-75.
  • Radler, Jan (2010), “Abduktive Argumentationsformen in Krafts Moraltheorie.” In A. Siegetsleitner (ed), Logischer Empirismus, Werte und Moral. Eine Neubewertung. Vienna / New York: Springer, 157-176.
  • Reininger, Robert (1938, ed.), “50 Jahre Philosophische Gesellschaft an der Universität Wien 1888-1938.” Vienna: Verlag der Philosophischen Gesellschaft an der Universität Wien.
  • Rutte, Heiner (1973), “VIKTOR KRAFT. Eine philosophische Standortbestimmung.” In Conceptus 7, 5-8.
  • Schramm, Alfred (1992), “Viktor Kraft: Konstruktiver Realismus.” In J. Speck (ed.), Die Grundprobleme der großen Philosophen. Philosophie der Neuzeit, VI (Tarski, Reichenbach, Kraft, Gödel, Neurath). Göttingen: Vandenhoek & Ruprecht, 110-137.
  • Siegetsleitner, Anne (2014), Ethik und Moral im Wiener Kreis Zur Geschichte eines engagierten Humanismus. Vienna / Cologne / Weimar: Böhlau.
  • Stadler, Friedrich (2001), The Vienna Circle. Studies in the Origins, Development, and Influence of Logical Empiricism. Wien / New York: Springer.
  • Stadler, Friedrich (2010), “Paul Feyerabend and the Forgotten ‘Third Vienna Circle’.” In F. Stadler (ed.), Vertreibung, Transformation und Rückkehr der Wissenschaftstheorie. Vienna /Berlin / Münster: Lit, 169-189.
  • Topitsch, Ernst (1981), “Introduction” In Victor Kraft, Foundations for a Scientific Analysis of Value, ed. by Henk Mulder. Dordrecht / Boston / London: Reidel [Vienna Circle Collection 15], xi-xvii.
  • Uebel, Thomas (2007), Empiricism at the Crossroads. The Vienna Circle’s Protocol-Sentence Debate. Chicago / La Salle, Ill.: Open Court.
  • Vollbrecht, Oliver (2004), Victor Kraft: rationale Normenbegründung und logischer Empirismus: eine philosophische Studie. Munich: Utz.

Author Information

Jan Radler
Email: jan.radler@web.de
European University Viadrina Frankfurt (Oder)
Germany

Roger Bacon: Language

Roger BaconWestern medieval philosophers and theologians spent a great deal of effort thinking about the nature of language. Notwithstanding their debt to their ancient forerunners, authors like Peter Abelard, Boethius of Dacia, and William of Ockham contributed a wide variety of innovative ideas and theories to the field of linguistics. During the time of the so-called ‘modern logic,’ the work of Roger Bacon (1214/20 —1292) is particularly noteworthy. He worked in this area from the beginning of his professional career (as a Master of Arts in Paris in the 1240’s) until the end of his life (in the Franciscan convent in Oxford). He left behind a prodigious amount of research, much of which still awaits critical examination. Bacon’s work in the field of language is also remarkable with respect to the wide range of themes and issues he covered. In his work, he either extensively covered or at least touched on issues representing the whole of the disciplines of the Trivium (grammar, dialectic, rhetoric), spanning from speculative grammar and semantics to semiotics and evolutionary linguistics. In his linguistic work, however, Bacon was primarily interested in practical ends, in the ways in which the study of language can aid in matters of divine and human wisdom. While many of his writings were composed with an eye towards theological questions such as biblical exegesis, he also considered pedagogical, ethical and political aspects of language, such as how language can be used to convert infidels or provide moral order for society.

In his work on language, Bacon would oftentimes present unorthodox positions. His semantic theory on univocal appellation and his emphasis on the importance of metaphor and the intention of the speaker in everyday communication – the so-called ‘pragmatic approach’ – distinguish him from many of his contemporaries. In addition, Bacon is probably the most important medieval theorist of signs, laying out a comprehensive classification of signs as well as a conception of signification and linguistic signs. Here as well he espoused an uncommon view. According to Bacon, a sign is essentially a relational thing, dependent on the relation between sign and sign-interpreter. Moreover, Bacon’s work on semiotics is notable for his insistence that things rather than their concepts are the principal significates of words. Together with the work of Dante Alghieri (1265-1321), Bacon’s work on language stands out in virtue of his observations on the evolution of languages. Lastly, Bacon’s linguistic work is noteworthy in virtue of his having stated the basic principle of universal grammar, that is, the principle that there is only one grammar for all languages.

This article gives an overview of Bacon’s contributions to the study of language. It focuses on Bacon’s intentionalist approach in speculative grammar, as well as his contributions to the fields of semantics, semiotics, evolutionary linguistics and universal grammar. Lastly, it considers some of Bacon’s considerations concerning pedagogical aspects of languages.

Table of Contents

  1. General Remarks
    1. Bacon’s Division of the Trivium
  2. Speculative Grammar
    1. Bacon’s Method in Speculative Grammar
    2. Bacon’s Intentionalism
  3. Logical Semantics
    1. Bacon’s Doctrine of the Production of Speech
    2. Bacon’s Doctrine of Univocal Appellation
  4. Semiotics and Semantics
    1. General Remarks
    2. The Definition of Sign and Signification
    3. The Classification of Signs
    4. Semantic Analyses within a Semiotic Context: Imposition, Analogy, and Connotation
  5. Languages
    1. Language Groups and Functions
    2. Bacon’s Formulation of the Universal Principle of Grammar
    3. Philology within Bacon’s Program for the Reform of Learning
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
      1. 1240’s-1250’s
      2. 1250’s-1268: Papal Opera
      3. 1268-1292
    2. Secondary Sources
      1. General Studies on Medieval Theories of Language
      2. On Roger Bacon’s Philosophy of Language

1. General Remarks

For several reasons, the medievals devoted much effort to the development of the skills necessary for the interpretation of texts. One reason for this was that knowledge in secular and divine matters predominantly came from books, which oftentimes needed to be translated and always required explanation and interpretation. Another reason was that medieval learning was essentially a commentary tradition, with most of the writings being commentaries on what were taken to be canonical texts (for example, the Scriptures or the works of Aristotle). In common with his fellow-logicians and grammarians, Bacon attached great value to issues pertaining to the disciplines of the Trivium (grammar, logic, and rhetoric), and he contributed to many important areas such as semantics, semiotics, and philology as well as to the question of the place of language studies within institutions of higher learning and society as a whole.

The emphasis these authors placed on logical, semantic, grammatical, and syntactic questions was in part due to the fact that after the end of Antiquity of all the branches of ancient philosophy, logic, grammar, and rhetoric remained on the agenda in secular as well as theological discussions. The particular emphasis that Bacon placed on the study of speech and languages, though, was not only theoretical. His interest in understanding language and mastering foreign languages like Hebrew and Greek was also motivated by his belief in the eminent practical importance of the study of speech and language for (1) ecclesiastical functions, (2) the reform of knowledge, (3) the conversion of infidels, and (4) the battle against the Antichrist.

During Bacon’s time, the scope of philosophical material increased considerably due to the translation of textbooks previously unavailable in Latin. The Aristotelian Organon together with the Metaphysics, Physics, and On the Soul (among other works) turned out to be a fruitful source of inspiration which triggered the development of a wide and complex variety of debates and approaches towards solving problems of many kinds. Many of the problems surrounding logic and language dealt with fallacies of equivocation. Grammatical discussions about semantics favoring a contextual approach to reference were connected to the logical problem of equivocation and thereby formed the high point (1175-1250) of a movement called “terminism” (and the approach called logica moderna or “terminist logic”), so called because of the emphasis on terms and their properties. This theory of the properties of terms – such as supposition, appellation, ampliation, and restriction – was the foundation of medieval semantic theory. Within this framework (and in particular, within the context of the controversial debates between Parisian and Oxford logicians), Bacon developed his own, sometimes original ideas on reference, meaning, and equivocation. The controversies between the Oxford and Parisian traditions on the various properties of terms remained an important point of reference for Bacon to which he returned in various writings. His writings on logical and semantic questions spanned different literary genres (including for example university textbooks and independent treatises), and his solutions to these problems are therefore scattered in many works. The fact that Bacon more or less consistently devoted himself to the study of logic and grammar over a period of almost fifty years demonstrates how important Bacon considered these debates to be (especially in relation to theology and religion in his later works).

In his work on linguistic and philological matters one can distinguish between two different stages. In the first stage are included Bacon’s contributions to the problem of universal quantification in the Summa de Sophismatibus et Distinctionibus (SSD), and to semantic problems revolving around the properties of terms in the Summulae Dialectices (SD); in particular the problem of univocal appellation and predication in regards to what are called ‘empty classes.’ Bacon’s solutions (especially to the semantic problems) provide the theoretical background against which Bacon continued to develop his doctrines during the second stage of his work on logic and linguistic matters. In this second stage, represented by the De Signis (DS) and the Compendium Studii Theologiae (CST), Bacon’s reflections on analogy were noteworthy as were his theories on the imposition of signs and, related to this, on the definition and classification of signs. The DS contains material on semiotics that was originally a part of the third part of the Opus Maius (“On the Utility of the Study of Language”), and that was discovered only recently and edited in 1978. The application of Bacon’s semiotics to theology, though – in which he intended to study sacraments as signs – remains lost. The CST represents a later adjustment of the material brought forth in the DS.

a. Bacon’s Division of the Trivium

Generally speaking, Bacon’s understanding of the nature and division of the disciplines of the Trivium (grammar, dialectic or logic, rhetoric) was quite different from that of his contemporaries and in certain respects richer. According to Bacon, rhetoric belongs to moral philosophy in that it represents the part of the practical branch of moral philosophy that is concerned with putting moral philosophy into practice: he considered rhetoric to be the art of speaking in such a manner that would motivate people to act morally. Bacon subordinated grammar to music (For Bacon’s views on music see van Deusen, 1997). Furthermore, grammar was not restricted to the study of the then-classical works on grammar by Priscian or Donatus; in Bacon’s view, grammar should first encompass the traditional elementary teaching of Latin, should then proceed to the study of the universal principles of language – a genre called ‘speculative grammar’ – and should eventually culminate in the mastery of languages, especially the languages of the Bible. Lastly, Bacon’s understanding of the place and nature of logic also differed from that of his contemporaries. Despite Bacon’s notoriety for his invectives against the “sins” infesting university studies – among which he included logic – Bacon still recommended a certain kind logic to be practiced. More specifically, according to Bacon, because there is no need for a science which treats of and teaches the rules of rational argumentation (and which, in virtue of this role, should occupy an eminent rank among the sciences) largely because logic is a basic capacity that is innate to humans, consisting in the ability to think rationally and to make arguments. In short, logic, according to Bacon, is not the “science of sciences” but rather a basic capability that needed to be made explicit rather than taught. Contrary to his contemporaries (including William of Sherwood, for example, who regarded logic to be a normative discipline that taught veritable speaking and helped to avoid false speaking), Bacon conceived logic to be a descriptive discipline. Logic, according to Bacon, makes explicit and describes the formal rules of argumentation that we already use (OT, ch. xxviii, 102f.). This explains why Bacon, in his works on logic, did not practice logic under the aspect of formal reasoning. Instead, he practiced logic under the aspect of its potential for solving problems arising from fallacies by emphasizing the role of context (“contextual approach”). In particular, Bacon was interested in the fallacy of equivocation and examined it extensively in his De Signis and Compendium Studii Theologiae.

2. Speculative Grammar

One of the accomplishments of medieval grammarians was to have significantly extended the original scope of the disciplines represented in the canonical works on grammar by Priscian and Donatus. Within the University setting, grammar along with other philosophical disciplines was expected to meet the requirements of Aristotelian science, which called for an identification of universal and necessary features of language that could become the subject of a scientific grammar. Grammar was thus considered to be a scientific and speculative, that is, theoretical endeavor: its goal was not only to teach the Latin language or to engage in literary analysis of Latin language and literature, but, in addition, to explain the nature and organization of language in terms of its causes and universal features within a purely theoretical framework (hence the name theoretical or ‘speculative grammar’). From a historical point of view, though, the Latin name grammatica speculativa was used exclusively by and for the ‘modist’ grammar of the late thirteenth and fourteenth centuries (called ‘modist’ because of the central role of the concept of the way or mode of signification – modus significandi – of this grammatical and semantic theory). The standard name for this theory today is ‘modism.’

Bacon wrote on speculative grammar – yet not always approvingly.Although during his time as Parisian Master of Arts Bacon formulated an intentionalist grammar – ‘intentionalist’ because Bacon emphasized the role of the signifying intention of the speaker (intentio proferentis) in answer to the question of the causes of language – he did not approve of the fully developed modistic doctrine of meaning which held that changes of meaning are imported by features based on the grammatical categories of nouns, verbs, cases, or tenses. Bacon preferred to explain all differences of meaning as cases of equivocation and he emphasized the importance the context had for the meaning of an utterance (DS, §§143-161; see Fredborg, 1981). As far as the study of the causes of language was concerned, the later Bacon very explicitly excluded grammar from any consideration of its principles and causes, and delegated their investigation to metaphysics and music instead. In his Opus Maius, Bacon delegated the study of causes and principles to music, and in his Opus Tertium he stated that “The grammarian is to the musician as the carpenter is to the geometer,” in the sense that the grammarian described the phenomena of the length and accents of letters and syllables which the musician studied from a causal perspective (OT, ch. lix, 231).
Despite these comments, Bacon’s early statements about grammar suggest that Bacon was himself a proponent of speculative grammar, at least originally. His earliest involvement with grammatical issues was in his early work Summa Grammatica (SG). The SG was a work typical for the Parisian arts faculty insofar as it was a supplement to the mandatory commentaries on one of the traditional canonical texts on grammar: Priscian’s Institutiones Grammaticae. More specifically, the SG is a supplement to commentaries on Priscian Minor and therefore deals with the principles of the “construction” of sentences (that is, the principles of syntax), by using sophismata (puzzling, odd or difficult sentences) as examples. The three parts of the SG represent rules and principles determining common and figurative sentence constructions, non-figurative constructions as well as adverbial constructions and liturgical formulae. In composing the SG, Bacon was deeply indebted to the most famous of the commentaries on Priscian Minor, that of his English colleague Robert Kilwardby (d. 1279) from whom he copied a considerable amount of content almost to the letter.

a. Bacon’s Method in Speculative Grammar

As was typical for speculative grammarians of that time, Bacon’s approach in the SG is guided by a principle taken from Aristotle’s Physics according to which “art imitates nature to the extent that it can” (Physics, II 2, 194 a21; SG 35, 4). Thus, within the context of the causal analysis of linguistic construction, grammatical art (re-)defines its own principles by beginning with nature. What this principle meant for Bacon’s analysis of syntactical function was that he, under the supposition that the process of constructing words was parallel to physical movement, studied grammatical construction alongside Aristotle’s analysis of movement in the fourth book of the Physics (Physics, IV 11, 219 4a21). Since a moving object, according to Physics, is moved from something (terminus a quo or principium) to something (terminus ad quem), so, in parallel manner, the verb of a sentence, signifying action and movement, needed two terms, a beginning from which it started and an end toward which it moved (SG, 65, 78). A grammatical category (like a case) was understood to be a property of an expression that allows it to function as a term of movement. Furthermore, Bacon laid out some very general rules for the combination of grammatical categories. In accordance with the principle that “nothing which is in movement can come to rest in something in movement, no movement being able to complete itself in something in movement,” Bacon deduced the argument why neither the participle nor the infinitive can occupy the function of the subject. The reason, according to Bacon, is that the character of both participle and infinitive is, by their verbal signification, too ‘unstable’ to function as a subject (SG, 60, 62). Bacon used a similar approach in regard to the topic of the organizing principle for the combination of terms. Take, for example, the dependence between adjective and its substantive: here the corresponding physical principle was that of dependence, in this particular case, between the accidental with regard to its subject (SG, 134, 143). However, as Bacon emphasized, art did not imitate nature in an absolute way but only “to the extent it can.” This meant that in those cases in which the physico-grammatical parallel reached its limits (in the sense that one ran into divergences in function), the grammarian needed to redefine the scope of this parallelism. The consequence of the limitations of the physico-grammatical parallel was that grammarians like Bacon sought inspiration regarding the functioning of grammar not only from the physical world but also from logic and other philosophical areas like epistemology.

b. Bacon’s Intentionalism

In regard to the analysis of the causes of linguistic construction, one other explanatory element arose from the realization of the role of the speaker, namely, the intention motivating a particular grammatical construction. Bacon shared this so-called intentionalist approach to grammar with many of his contemporaries, most notably with Robert Kilwardby. Generally speaking, Bacon’s analysis of linguistic construction and especially his adoption of the intentionalist approach in the SG was more or less common practice at that time. The principles of grammatical construction, according to the intentionalists, cannot be mechanically deduced from an application of rules alone; rather, one has to consider a voluntarist element in the form of the signifying intention of the speaker. According to Bacon, the truth value of a statement does not depend exclusively on its conformity with grammatical rules but, to an equal degree, on its adequateness with its signifying intention. In cases in which the speaker wishes to signify some particular idea, she is legitimately allowed to distance herself from the normal rules as for example in figurative speech, metaphors, or elliptic sentences: “It is not the sign which signifies but rather the speaker by means of the language – in the same way that it is not the stick which hits but he who uses it” (SSD, 153f.). In those ‘authorized’ variations in which statements do not conform to common usage (like in figures of speech), something is needed in order for them to be acceptable: namely, a legitimate justification in regard to a “reason which makes it possible” and a “reason which makes it necessary” (SG, 68, 133). Thus, the notion that language functions according to rules is found in both the common construction of sentences following normal rules and in the variations that are the result of the conscious and voluntary acts of a speaker (for a detailed account of Bacon’s and Kilwardby’s intentionalism see Rosier, 1994).
The later Bacon applied the above mentioned elements – (1) the intentionalist analysis of language and (2) the conception of language as an instrument for humans – in the context of his treatment of the (magical) power (potestas verborum) of spoken words. In his Opus Maius IV as well as his Opus Tertium and his Moralis Philosophia, Bacon was concerned with the issue of the “utility of grammar,” specifically, the issue of how spoken language works and is able to affect a listener’s soul. In addition to conceiving of the power of words as a physical process – along the doctrine of the multiplication of species (discussed below) – Bacon considered the intention of the speaker (among other elements) as an important factor in communication (OT, ch. xxvi, 96). Bacon utilized he principle of the rule-governed nature of language later in the semantic analyses he conducted in writings like the De Signis.

3. Logical Semantics

Recent research has begun to recognize the actual nature and extent of Bacon’s contributions to the field of semantics. Almost all of his writings in this field displayed originality to varying degrees, be that in the form of substantive solutions or in his approach toward the material. In his Summa de Sophismatibus et Distinctionibus (SSD), for example, Bacon contributed an important twofold thesis: first, a spoken statement had to be understood as a carrier of such information as was necessary for a listener to interpret it in a way that was in accordance with the speaker’s intention of conveying sense, and second, that the information contained in a sentence and the linguistic form it was presented in (especially the sequence of words) was sometimes not only insufficient but even an obstacle to a listener’s interpretation and the speaker’s intention (see Rosier and de Libera, 1986).

a. Bacon’s Doctrine of the Production of Speech

In his SSD Bacon challenged the semantic doctrine of “natural sense.” This doctrine was commonly held among 13th century logicians and revolved around the concept of “inclusion” (inclusio). The concept of inclusion was used in order to solve semantic problems arising from sentences containing several syncategorematic terms (‘all’ and ‘if,’ for example), or universal quantifiers. Sentences such as “omne animal est rationale vel irrationale” (“Every animal is rational or irrational”) allowed for two different interpretations. To decide whether what was meant was “Every animal is rational or every animal is irrational,” or “Every animal is rational or irrational,” Bacon’s fellow logicians argued that it was the sequence of words (ordo prolationis) in a sentence that contains the necessary semantic information. Bacon, however, chose a different strategy on how to solve the problem of universal quantification; he countered with his doctrine of the “production of speech” (generatio sermonis): it was not, as other logicians believed, that “the logical structure of sentences was contained in the linear sequence of the components of the sentence”; rather, as Bacon emphasized, it was necessary to consider the threefold division of the dimension linguistic communication: (1) the freedom of speaker and listener, (2) the nature of spoken language, and (3) restrictions of communication. Thus, in his argument against the doctrine of “natural sense,” Bacon stressed the relationship between the speaker and the listener. By taking into account the linguistic form chosen by the speaker and the sense provided by the listener, Bacon contributed the important consideration that decoding semantic information was interpretation: “In order to arrive at the intention of the speaker (intentio proferentis) it is necessary to bring in the concept of the production of speech (generatio sermonis).”

b. Bacon’s Doctrine of Univocal Appellation

Among some of Bacon’s other main contributions in the field of semantics was his insistence on the freedom of the will and the role of the speaker in the process of naming. Bacon put forward the notion that the significatory function of words is constituted through a relation to an external object rather than through a connection with a concept or representation in the mind of the speaker: Bacon considered things to be the significates of words rather than concepts – nowadays, this would have made him an externalist in semantics. In this context, Bacon advanced a unique doctrine in regard to the problem of equivocation, namely that by themselves names are names only of presently existing external things. He subsequently applied this theory to two issues: the first one was on inferences involving infinite, privative, and negative terms and the second issue was about the existential condition of the significates of names (the latter issue marked a recurring theme in Bacon’s scholarship) (see de Libera, 1981).
Bacon began his lifelong study of the problem of univocal appellation in his Summulae Dialectices when he criticized what was then considered to be the conventional wisdom on the matter: the view that it is possible to apply terms univocally to being and non-being – a theory called “natural supposition” (suppositio naturalis). In arguing against this theory, Bacon referred to the notion that being and non-being as well as the present and the past have nothing in common that would warrant the use of one and the same term – a notion that was strengthened by the fact that Bacon could point towards the authoritative support of Aristotle’s Metaphysics. “Some say that a term names present, past, and future things by itself, and that it is common to being and non-being. Others [though] say that a term is a name for present things only, and [that] nothing is common to being and non-being or the past, the present, and the future, according to what Aristotle states in the first book of Metaphysics” (SD, §§526-527). In his objection against the theory of natural supposition, Bacon focused his attention on the term ‘supposition’ and in his solution even resorted to grammatical concepts. While the Parisians, who argued in favor of natural supposition, believed that a term ‘supposited’ for all present, future, and possible entities outside the sentence, which in turn then constituted a term’s extension, Bacon pointed towards a term’s meaning and its original imposition (impositio) and held that supposition was to be understood as being in a sentence and, taken by itself, being restricted to present entities. Now although, according to Bacon, a term by itself (de se) could only concern those named in the present and although, in contrast, the past and the future were named only passingly, the term still could, as Bacon phrased it, be “extended” to include the past and the future through the verb’s tense. Thus, where the Parisians spoke of natural supposition and restriction (restrictio), Bacon’s response was to deny natural supposition and restriction and to affirm supposition for present entities (suppositio de se pro praesentibus) and ‘widening’ (ampliatio). Thus, from a more general point of view, Bacon’s doctrine of appellation was grounded in the distinction between two semantic perspectives: from a grammatical point of view (that of construction), and from a logical point of view (that of meaning). In other words, under the logical aspect, a noun only applies to present and existent entities, while under the grammatical aspect of a noun’s actual construction in a sentence (nomen constructionis) in combination with a verb, a noun could stand for past or future, that is, non-existent things. Hence, according to Bacon, it is the function of the verb in a sentence to establish a semantic relation to things past and future; verbs extend the supposition of nouns beyond their original imposition to present, existent entities. Verbs in present tense, however, do not contribute to the subject’s semantic relation to present, existent things since terms already possess this relation by themselves (SD, §§559-560).

4. Semiotics and Semantics

a. General Remarks

Roger Bacon was probably the most important theorist of signs in the medieval period, and his two semiological treatises, De Signis (DS) and the Compendium Studii Theologiae (CST), are among the most extensive semiotic treatises from this period. Generally speaking, his semiotics encompasses the definition and classification of signs (that is, modes in which a sign signifies or occurs), a theory of signification (including univocal, equivocal and analogical signification), as well as accounts of imposition and the so-called ‘semiotic triangle’ (a semiotic model that illustrates the relation between signs, concepts, and things). In a theoretical perspective, the three most prominent features of Bacon’s theory of signs are the semantics integrated into his classification of signs (and here especially his conception of natural signs), the notion of connotation (consignificatio) as a type of analogy, and his theory of imposition (impositio: the act of name-giving) (see Maloney, 1983a and 1984).
Many of the theses which Bacon defended in the DS (written around 1267) and the CST (written around 1292) involved the resumption of themes which he first introduced in his earlier writings on logic. By contrast, his semiotic works were neither a repetition nor a simple updating of older thoughts; rather, they contained contributions which responded to the debates going on at the respective times. In fact, Bacon remarked rather explicitly in DS that the lack of a theory of the imposition of words for signification (and the lack of a theory of the mechanics of signification) urged him to write the DS, in which the development of a theory of semantics (the signification of words – “signa quae significant ad placitum”), within a carefully developed semiotics, was the goal, and which was supposed to fill gaps and remedy errors in the logical and grammatical literature at that time (DS, §16, 86). In regard to his fellow sign theorists, Bacon deviated in many important points from the common opinions – for example, in regard to the issue of whether what should be considered essential for a sign’s existence was the relation of the sign to the intellect for whom it signified or the relation of the sign to what is signified, Bacon opted for the second answer – which, in many aspects, makes Bacon’s ideas on signs and semantics quite radical.
It should also be noted that Bacon intended both the DS and the CST to be considered from the point of view of theological application. A summary in Bacon’s Opus Tertium (OT, ch. xvii, 100-102) reveals that the DS must have contained a section about the application of the theory of signs to theology. As far as the CST is concerned, it was a treatise explicitly dealing with the reform of theological studies, in which Bacon summons the reader to turn towards the Scriptures and to investigate how signs are signified there – that is to say, to apply the theoretical section on semiotics and semantics to theological material (CST, §1, 32 and § 83, 82). It is commonly held that in both texts Bacon tried “to construct a general semantic and semiological doctrine on the basis of a tradition both theological and ‘artistic,’” or, in other words, to combine the two main semiotic traditions in the Middle Ages: Aristotelian semantics and Augustinian semiotics (Rosier-Catach, 1997, 98). Some interpreters have presented Bacon’s accomplishments in an even more pronounced form; they have said that Bacon’s concern with semiotics and semantics was directed at philosophical and theological ends, namely to improve scientific practice (which was mainly grounded in textual analysis) in both faculties. The instrument which Bacon thought should be used in order to achieve that goal was a semantic and semiotic analysis of language: an inquiry into the ways in which language worked, or did not work. His approach to philosophical and theological studies led some scholars to attribute an “analytic orientation” to Bacon’s reform efforts, which were ultimately directed at benefitting the whole of Christendom (De Libera, 1997, 120f; Perler, 2005).

b. The Definition of Sign and Signification

Bacon defined sign as “that, which offered to the senses or the intellect designates something to that intellect, because not every sign is offered to the senses as the common description assumes, but some [that is, mental concepts – passiones animae] are offered solely to the intellect […] therefore, they [mental concepts] are offered only to the intellect, [and] in this way they represent the external things themselves to that intellect” (DS, §2, 82). This view was a minority opinion in the thirteenth century in the sense that sign theorists commonly held an Augustinian, intensional definition of signs: the sign (a spoken phrase for example) stood for the thoughts of the speaker, which the sign’s recipient received through the senses which in turn represented it to the intellect. In writing that a sign was something that upon being “offered to the senses or the intellect represents itself to that intellect, since not every sign is offered to the senses,” Bacon meant that mental concepts themselves (passiones animae) were signs of things, which represented external things to the respective intellect. In other words, Bacon considered concepts as signs of the objects (DS, §166, 134). In the case of linguistic signs, spoken words for example, this meant that in accordance with the act of imposition – analogous to that of Baptism – words immediately referred to the things themselves.
A sign, according to Bacon, is in the category of relation “and is uttered essentially in reference to the one for whom it signifies” (DS, §1, 81). Signification, according to Bacon, entails four elements: the agency giving the sign, the sign itself, the significate (the thing a sign signifies), and the sign-interpreter. A sign was commonly considered to be a triadic relation (in the category relation), in regards to which the question arose regarding which of these relations was essential for the notion of a sign: the relation to the significate or to the sign-interpreter? The majority of theologians held that the primary relation of a sign is that to the thing signified and they thought this relation to be essential for the sign. In opposing Bonaventure’s (d. 1274) position (and that of other theologians of his time), Bacon reversed traditional opinion when he emphasized the priority of the ‘pragmatic’ relation of the sign to the sign-interpreter over the secondary relation to the significate (the thing signified): “Because if no one could conceive something through a [given] sign, it would be void and in vain, in fact, it wouldn’t be sign […] like the essence of the father remains when the son is dead, yet not the relation of fatherhood.” For a sign to be a sign it was required, according to Bacon, that it had an interpreter; the relation to the significate was secondary because ‘to signify’ is a relation, essentially and principally related to the one receiving the sign because it would be incorrect to infer that because “the sign is in act” that the significate is also in act, for nonentities can be signified by words just like entities” (DS, §1, 81f). Thus, signification is a relation established through communication to an interpreter: A wreath made of wine leaves above a tavern is only potentially a sign if nobody is there to interpret it as such and thereby render it actually a sign. This account also meant that the first relation of a sign (to the interpreter) determines the second relation (to the significate) which has consequences for the sign’s signification in the sense that it stresses the freedom of the one giving the sign with regard to its signification (see Maloney, 1983b and Rosier-Catach, 1997, 91-98).

c. The Classification of Signs

In the CST Bacon stated that he independently (per studium propriae inventionis) worked out the division between natural and given signs in his DS; and that, when he subsequently came across Augustine’s division in the second book of De Doctrina Christiana, he found it to be identical with his own (CST, §25, 56). In recent literature there has been considerable debate as to the degree of Bacon’s actual indebtedness to Augustine’s semiotics in the De Doctrina Christiana. Now even if Bacon was familiar with Augustine’s classification at the time he wrote the DS, it is clear that he did not simply copy it. Rather than to simply do this, Bacon integrated several sign typologies, including those from Augustine as well as from Aristotle and from theories of the sacramental sign, and this is precisely where his merit lies. For example, in the diagram given below, the first principal distinction between groups (I) and (II) corresponds to the De Doctrina Christiana, and groups (I.1-2) are of Aristotelian origin, with group (I.1) coming from the Analytics and Rhetorics, and group (I.2) coming from On Interpretation and On the Soul.
The division of signs proposed by Bacon in the opening paragraphs of DS is best represented schematically:
Signs (signa)
(I)

natural signs
signifiying by their own nature
(signa naturalia ex essentia sua)
(II)

given signs
sign from a soul
(signa ordinata ab anima, ex intentione animae recipiens rationem signi)
(I. 1) signifying necessarily or with probability because of inference, concomitance, consequence

(I.1.1) with regard to the past
(I.1.1.1) necessarily: having milk as a sign of motherhood
(I.1.1.2) with probability: the dampness of the soil being a sign for it having rained
(I.1.2) with regard to the present
(I.1.2.1) necessarily: cockcrow designating hour of the night
(I.1.2.2) with probability: motherhood designating love
(I.1.3) with regard to the future
(I.1.3.1) necessarily: rosy dawn designating sunrise
(I.1.3.2) with probability: redness of the sunset sky designating a bright morning
(I.2) signifying by configuration and likeness: images, pictures, and so forth.
(I.3) signifying by causality (because something has been effected by something as their cause): smoke designating fire, tracks designating an animal
(II.1) signifying conventionally, with imperfect or perfect deliberation in the mode of the concept (cum deliberatione rationis, ad placitum sive ex proposito)

(II.1.1) linguistic signs
(II.1.1.1) by way of imperfect deliberation: interjections such as ‘ahem’ and ‘ugh’
(II.1.1.2) by way of perfect deliberation: other parts of speech
(II.1.2) non-linguistic signs (language of gestures, monastic sign language, sign-boards, and so forth.)
(II.2) signifying naturall, instinctively, without deliberation in the mode of affect (subito et sine deliberatione, non ad placitum, per modum affectus)
(II.2.1) products of the sensitive soul: sounds emitted by animals and persons
(II.2.2) products of the rational soul: groans, exclamations, cries of pain, laughter, sighs
Bacon divided signs into two principal classes: he distinguished between signs that are natural (signa naturalia) and those that are given and directed by a soul (signa ordinata ab anima ad significandum) (DS, §3, 82). The principle of division into these two classes was built in the kind of agency that constituted something as a sign; thus, natural signs are natural because their being a sign does not depend on an act, an intention of soul but is grounded in their own essence: for smoke to designate fire it does not require a soul who makes it so but a soul only to acknowledge smoke as actually being a sign for fire. Natural signs, according to Bacon, signify by themselves and do not require a soul for intending them to signify (that is, to make a sign), whereas in the case of “signs given by a soul,” the reason why a thing is a sign is in virtue of its generating act, its originating from a soul’s intent. A linguistic sign (like an idiomatic phrase, for example) requires a deliberating and freely choosing intellect; a vocal sound like a moan uttered by a human being for example requires a soul: not a deliberating and freely choosing soul but one that “suddenly and without deliberation” utters a certain sound. The first principle class of natural signs is divided into three subclasses; of these, groups (I.1) and (I.2) are based on the significative relationship arising from inference or resemblance. Group (I.3) is based on the notion that causally related events are also related as sign and significate like smoke (effect-sign) is related to fire (cause-significate). Group (I.1.1-3) is built on the basis of the significate being contemporaneous with, following, or preceding its sign. Of these the first (I.1.1-3) signifies in virtue of a relation of necessary or probable consequence, that is, in virtue of the fact that one could be inferred from the other with either probability or necessity – for example, from the fact that a woman has milk, it could necessarily be inferred, in regard to the past, that she was a mother, hence a woman having milk is a sign of motherhood (DS, §§4-6, 82f.).
Insofar as the double use of the class ‘natural signs’ is concerned (that is, the first principal class of signs (I) and the second sub-mode of the second principal class of given signs (II.2)), Bacon introduced a new and original division. According to Bacon, both smoke designating fire and a sigh uttered by a person are ‘natural signs’ but for different reasons. A natural sign (signum naturalis) is called whatever is naturally or automatically related to something else, that is, whatever signifies something on its own (significat ex essentia sua) as opposed to a sign given by a soul, that is, a sign requiring intention in order to signify. However, into the class of natural signification Bacon also included another group of signs, yet he placed this group under the principal class of signs given from a soul (II.2). This group included products – that is, vocal sounds (voces) of the sensitive and rational soul (signa ordinata ab anima) – yet without being dependent on any convention, and being common to all persons (such as various expressions of feelings emitted by animals (II.2.1) and persons (II.2.2) like sighs, laughter, or moans). Previous theorists like Boethius attempted to exclude this group from the principal class of conventional signs, or “signifying at pleasure” (voces significativae ad placitum). Instead, Boethius and other commentators on Aristotle’s On Interpretation – the locus classicus for discussing signs “signifying at pleasure” – included them (products in group II.1) into the group of natural signs while Augustine in his De Doctrina Christiana II,4 suspended judgment about this issue altogether.
To this debate Bacon contributed the original solution that in the two cases of natural signs, for example smoke and a sigh, ‘natural’ had been used equivocally; in other words, in each case the name ‘natural’ corresponds with a different definition: smoke is not a natural sign in the same sense in which a sigh is a natural sign (DS, §14, 85). In the first case of natural signs as opposed to given signs (group I), ‘natural’ indicates the relation of signifying, whereas in the second case (II.2) ‘natural’ indicates that the sounds (voces) are produced by the agent (an animal or a person) spontaneously, that is, without deliberation or free choice but rather following a natural instinct, urge, and power of something acting naturally (DS, §8, 83). And, as he continued, when vocal sounds signifiy naturally (naturaliter), then they are natural signs (DS, §14, 85). This means that vocal sounds like a person’s sigh or a cat’s meow are a) signs and b) natural signs because in both cases they originate from a sensitive soul that constitutes and directs them with intent in order to communicate some awareness of something, for example a sensation of pain, pleasure or bewilderment. This is the reason why a vocal sound produced by an animal or a person falls under the class of signs that are given and directed by a soul with intent. Indeed, many years earlier, Bacon had already noted that non-rational animals were able to communicate with one another by means of signifying vocal sounds (voces significativae) (SD, II, §§19-26, 222f.). “Whenever a rational soul was only affected and in that way affected expresses itself without [prior] deliberation, then an articulated vocal sound signifies naturally” (DS, §11, 84). Bacon also used the concept of ‘natural sign’ in his explanation of connotation (consignificatio).

d. Semantic Analyses within a Semiotic Context: Imposition, Analogy, and Connotation

Theories of imposition deal with the issue of how linguistic signs signify, that is, how a word relates to a concept or refers to an external object. Since it has become common practice to apply modern philosophical paradigms to the respective medieval debates, modern scholars speak of medieval accounts of extensionalist and intensionalist theories of semantics. The theory of imposition that Bacon proposed in the DS has commonly been considered an extensionalist semantics (according to which terms solely designate existent objects), a “semantics of imposition” or a “semantics of reference” (De Libera, 1997, 128; Perler, 2005, 390f.). Bacon’s semantics revolves around the concept of imposition, and defends the view that the meaning of a word is established not through its relation to a mental concept but through its relation to an external and actually existing object. In defending this idea, Bacon went, as far as basic semantic commitments are concerned, against the sententia communis of his time (see Fredborg, 1981; Maloney, 1984, De Libera, 1997, 117-132).
In the context of theories of imposition, it was a central idea of Bacon’s that words designate things rather than mental concepts, and that words are coined to signify present objects. Naming, as Bacon stated, presupposes the momentary intuition of an actual object and the certainty that it was not corrupted or non-existent, which is why upon the singular object’s absence they are not being named anymore (DS, §25, 90f.). When the singular object designated by a word is absent or not existing anymore, according to Bacon, and we still use the word originally denoting that object, we have a case of a new use of the word, a new imposition; the meaning of a word is variable, that is, one word can, at different times, denote different objects, which describes the problem of equivocation.
With regard to imposition, Bacon distinguished between two modes. Bacon considered the first, “formal” mode of imposition (sub forma impositionis vocaliter expressa et assignata rei) to take place in a manner similar to Baptism, in which a name is applied to a child in virtue of a perlocutionary vocal expression like “I call you ‘Roger’.” On this view, a name is attributed to an object as a result of a vocally expressed form of imposing (DS, §154, 130). This first, formal mode of imposition, according to Bacon, refers to an act of explicitly inventing a new word, or to the situation of composing a language, and it is exclusive to skilled persons, with expertise in the art of name-giving (DS, §156-157, 131). The second mode of imposition (sine forma imponendi vocaliter expressa) occurs when a name is given not through a perlocutionary vocal expression but “within the intellect alone,” that is, when a name is imposed tacitly and without being explicitly announced, in regard to an object other than the one designated in the situation of first imposition, and at the pleasure of the impositor. This mode of imposition acknowledges the arbitrary freedom of any speaker in the sense that everybody – and not only experts – performs this mode of imposition; during our everyday use of language we make and renew significations without the vocally expressed form of imposing “because names signify at pleasure” (DS, §157, 131). For example, when a person sees the painted image of a human being for the first time, she would not perform the formal perlocutionary act of imposition, but would rather simply transfer the name ‘human’ to the image. Applying this idea to theological matters, Bacon argued that in the same way a person who says that God is just for the first time did not beforehand say “God’s essence is called justice,” but rather, based on resemblance, she transferred the name of human justice to God and pronounced it by herself and in her own mind. As a consequence for interpersonal communication, Bacon’s proposal that the signifying function of a word is variable in its scope renders crucial the roles of the intention of the impositor and the interpreter in communication. On this view, the meaning of an utterance cannot be determined by considering the sense of the words alone; rather, successful communication in everyday life and accurate interpretation of authoritative texts like the Scriptures requires a careful analysis of language according to principles of the terminist tradition of logic. Thus, Bacon’s conception of imposition attempts to account for changes in meaning in cases where the possibilities are infinite and yet follow certain patterns; Bacon’s theory is laid out in his DS within a system of different grades of equivocation.
Bacon treated of the problem of equivocation and univocation in the context of his theory of how words signify; within the same framework he also developed his theory of analogy as a mode of signification. He understood equivocation to be the case when a word designates many different objects; since there are different kinds of diversity between objects, it follows that there is also a plurality of cases of equivocation. For example, the word ‘dog’ can refer to the animal as well as the constellation (DS, §36, 93; CST, §130, 110). Corresponding to the different degrees of diversity or agreement (convenientia) existing on the level of the word’s meaning, there are different degrees of equivocation: Bacon distinguished between five such degrees in the DS, and six in the CST, which are represented here schematically (DS, §§37-46, 94-98; CST, §§131-139, 110-116).
Name
Description
Principal equivocation maximal diversity between significates like in regard to being and non-being
Equivocation in relational agreement absolute diversity of significates yet agreement in relation between significates like in regard to creator and creature
Equivocation of whole and parts partial diversity, partial agreement of significates like in whole and parts, universal and particulars
Equivocation of genus Lesser partial diversity of significates like in regard to equus (genus) and horse / donkey (species)
Minimal equivocation great identity of significates, diversity of mode of signification like in ‘loving’ designating as name and participle (amans)
Minimal equivocation no diversity of significates, no diversity of signs (grounded in grammatical interpretation) like in bishops (nominative plural) and bishop’s (genitive singular) (episcopi)
The six different kinds of equivocation are arranged hierarchically, in descending order of diversity and, correspondingly, equivocation: because the degree (that is, the mode of equivocation) depends upon the kind of difference of the significates, it follows that the smaller the diversity of the significates, the smaller the degree of equivocation. While the last two instances of diversity, strictly speaking, represent cases of grammatical ambiguity rather than equivocation, cases 2-5 represent cases of analogy, because analogy (analogia, comparatio, proportio) occurs “wherever there is diversity between the primary and secondary significates while there is still agreement, reference, and comparison;” and the modes of analogy are between pure univocation and pure equivocation (DS, §100, 115). It has been pointed out in recent literature that the original and remarkable feature of Bacon’s theory of analogy lay in the nature of the classification, namely that analogy is here subordinated under equivocation rather than being classified as equivalent with equivocation and univocation as was common during his time. According to Bacon, analogy, as an instance of equivocation, indicates the kind of comparison or relation that occurs in cases of equivocation, and what is emphasized within an analysis of equivocation is accordingly an inquiry into primary and secondary instances of meaning (De Libera, 1997, 120).
In order to account for the change of meaning of words in regard to primary or principal and secondary meaning, Bacon did not only point toward acts of imposition but also to the phenomenon of connotation (consignificatio) – also called ‘implied’ or ‘secondary meaning.’ Inspired by the Logic of the Arabic philosophers Avicenna and al Ghazali, Bacon offered an explanation of this semantic issue together with a systematic enumeration of the different kinds of connotation by connecting it to the concept of ‘natural sign’ in the sense of the first principal class of natural signs (S I.1). In this respect, Bacon’s theory of connotation was remarkable because during his time connotation was not being treated in a systematic way in relation to natural signs, and it has been pointed out in recent scholarship that the fact that Bacon accounted for connotation within a framework that combines the notions of imposition and reference into one unified theory of meaning was quite innovative. In short, to explain connotation, Bacon combined his accounts of conventional and natural meaning (signa ad placitum signa naturalia), in virtue of which he was able “to give a detailed semiotic theory of psycho-linguistic phenomena” (De Libera, 1997, 128; Pinborg, 1981, 409).
According to Bacon, connotation occurrs when the change of meaning of a word is not because of another act of tacit imposition but because the significates stand in a natural relation to other objects. It is possible, as Bacon stated, for one word to designate a plurality of objects based on one single act of imposition because the objects themselves have a relation to other things. In other words, a word signifies many objects not only because it is intended to do so in virtue of an act of soul, but, beyond imposition, because things have necessary connections to other things which is natural in the sense of the first subclass of natural signs (I.1). Thus, words are natural signs and the respective semiotic relation is based on inference, concomitance, or consequence. This way, Bacon continued, words signify an infinity of objects (DS, §§102-103, 116f.). He consequently distinguished eight modes in which consignification occurs, among which he mentioned the names of God implying creation and the names of creature implying God (modes two and three), or accidents implying substances, and universals implying some particulars (modes four and five) (DS, §§105-133, 117-125; see Pinborg, 1981).
In the CST, written approximately twenty-five years after the DS which represented Bacon’s semantics within a broad semiotic framework, Bacon returned to semantic issues, intending a “logical reform of speech” directed against errors in philosophy and theology (De Libera, 1997, 121). He tried to achieve this reform with semantic analyses directed against contemporary theories of reference. Within these he especially criticized two aspects: ontological doctrines revolving around the doctrine of “habitual being” and “empty classes” (for example, sentences like “Caesar is a human being,” with Caesar being dead) and linguistic doctrines revolving around the traditional concept of imposition. Like in the DS, his theory of imposition in CST reaffirmed the thesis of the arbitrariness of meaning and of the freedom of the speaker. With regard to the DS, the CST resumed earlier objections and arguments, adapted them to the respective new context, yet did not represent any “significant development beyond the theories espoused in the De Signis, with the exception of the double division of natural signs” (Maloney, 1983, 150).
Thus, in his CST Bacon again argued against appeals to notions such as habitual being (esse habituale) and confused as opposed to determinate being (esse confusum et determinatum), which were brought forward by some of his contemporaries (for example, Richard Rufus of Cornwall, d. c. 1260) in order to defend the possibility of the truth value of sentences involving the use of the name ‘Caesar’ or ‘Christ’ (CST, §§84-111, 86-99). According to Bacon, words signifying existing and non-existing entities represent cases of equivocation, yet a sentence could only be true when its terms signify an existing entity. “Hence we know that in every equivocation there is a difference of significates: in as many ways as there is difference, in so many modes can there be equivocation” (CST, §130, 111). In this gradation of kinds of equivocation, the sentence “John is dead,” uttered upon John’s death, represents the greatest kind of equivocation: a word signifying being and non-being at the same time in which case the sentence, according to Bacon, has no truth value: after death, the word ‘John’ signifies not John – a being thing – but a corpse – a non-being thing – and is therefore used equivocally (CST, §125, 104). Thus, Bacon acknowledged the immediate relevance of the problem of equivocation for theology: for example in the context of exegesis one had to ensure that the words used in a passage actually signify.

5. Languages

Bacon’s interest in language studies was not restricted to semantic or semiotic questions. In the context of his linguistic studies, he devoted himself to grammar also (1) insofar as it pertained and contributed to the reading and speaking of languages, especially the so-called ‘wisdom languages’ like Hebrew and Greek, and (2) insofar as it was supposed ultimately to contribute to an improvement of the methods and instruments of textual criticism. Bacon situated the science of wisdom languages among the ranks of those sciences he considered essential for the advancement of learning (and which also including such sciences as mathematics or the experimental sciences). Ignorance of these sciences, Bacon emphasized on many occasions, is to the detriment of learning and, since the status of learning was connected to the general well-being of Christendom, is to the detriment of Christendom as a whole. Thus, the goal of Bacon’s concern for languages was, as in the case of his later semiotic-semantic inquiries, situated within the wider context of his intended reform of learning, a reform aiming at the “Church and the Republic of the Faithful.”
The main texts in which Bacon developed his philological reflections are the third part of the Opus Maius (a section entitled On the Utility of Grammar, a part that was comprised of three subsections of which the DS was one), the Opus Tertium, and the Compendium Studii Philosophiae (CSP). He also wrote a Greek grammar (Oxford Greek Grammar, or OGG), the first of its kind in the west, and a work which he considered to be no more than an “introduction to the Greek language.”

a. Language Groups and Functions

In addition to his grammatical, lexicographical and philological reflections, he devoted much time to the practical justification for the learning of languages. At the time when Bacon began to study languages, sometime around 1267-1268, this topic was not established as a university discipline. In the third part of the Opus Maius, Bacon presented three different kinds of reasons for language study: (1) such as pertain to the scientific domain, (2) such as pertain both to the secular and divine domains, (3) such as pertain to functions of the Church and the relation of the Church to other peoples. For example, he emphasized a better and more accurate comprehension of the scientific literature, of which the major part was written in languages other than Latin. In regard to divine offices or to the giving of the sacraments, Bacon lamented the lack of the priests’ abilities to correctly pronounce Greek, Hebrew, or Chaldean words. But Bacon also tried to bring more mundane matters to the attention of his primary intended reader, Pope Clement IV, such as the negotiation of peace treaties or the demands of trade for which knowledge of foreign languages would be most beneficial. Another field for which Bacon considered the knowledge of languages useful was the peaceful conversion of infidels (OM, III, vol. 3, 80-125).
In his reflections on the types of language, Bacon distinguishes three groups: (1) the so-called wisdom languages, (2) Latin, and (3) the “languages of the laity.” He presented the wisdom languages in two different groupings: (i) the first of these groups consists of the languages of the Cross (Hebrew, Greek, and Latin) because they express “divine mysteries;” (ii) the second group is comprised of the languages of philosophy (Hebrew, Greek, and Arabic), and sometimes also Chaldean (today called Aramaic). The importance of learning those languages had to do with the origins and passing on of wisdom; Bacon believed that all wisdom came from God who revealed it to faithful and infidel alike. Since God revealed his wisdom first in Hebrew, which was then renewed first in Greek (by Aristotle) and then in Arabic (most notably by Avicenna), scholars should have mastery of these languages in order to succeed in their scientific pursuits. In a similar vein, Bacon held Latin in much lower esteem: nothing original had been written in Latin, it was merely a repository of foreign learning. Opposed to the Latin of the clergy, Bacon also considered the so-called “vulgar-languages” or “languages of the laity,” which comprised a third group of languages. These languages, although inferior and not appropriate for scientific purposes because of the poverty of their vocabulary, were the ones that Bacon regarded as optimally suited for preaching (Rosier-Catach, 1997, 81-83).

b. Bacon’s Formulation of the Universal Principle of Grammar

Within the field of philology, Bacon also studied the relations between different languages and the structure of individual languages, and within this context he gave the famous formulation of the principle of universal grammar. Bacon stated that there are families of related languages like (1) Greek, (2) the Gallican language family, (3) the Slavic language family, and (4) Latin. Greek diversified itself into its different idioms Attic, Aeolian, Doric, and Ionian, while all these languages were substantially one. Bacon regarded Latin, on the other hand, as derived from Greek in both grammar and spoken language. Bacon held that the substance of a language guarantees the unity of a language and its identity in time, beyond accidental differences due to the different places at which the language is spoken and in spite of phonetic or semantic variations (CSP, vi-vii, 432-464). His comparatist analyses lead him even so far as to state that as there was something substantially identical in the various spoken languages, so there was something identical in the different grammars. In regard to this “linguistic ‘substance’” (Rosier-Catach, 1997, 86), Bacon suggested that it revealed itself in universal features common to all languages: “In its substance, grammar is one and the same in all languages, even if it accidentally varies” (OGG, 27). Accidental diversity, on the other hand, is another fundamental feature of language, according to Bacon, and it is due to the fact that language is conventional (ad placitum) and that every nation chose its own linguistic means: “In every language, words are given at pleasure, and this is why the Greeks imposed words according to their own will as we did according to our [will] and in accordance with the principles of our language as they in accordance with the principles of their language” (OGG, 164).

c. Philology within Bacon’s Program for the Reform of Learning

Bacon further connected his comparatist analyses to the reform of learning: the fact that, as Bacon noted further, each idiom has its own distinctive characteristics such as vocabulary, rhythmic and musical features, makes literal translations impossible. Therefore, translators like Michael Scot and Gerard of Cremona who, according to Bacon, in this sense were not absolutely proficient in the languages they translated from, corrupted important texts like Aristotle’s works as well as the Paris Vulgate (OT, ch. xxv, 91). Hence, what is needed are translators who were proficient enough in both scientific and linguistic skills – knowing the diversities of languages, their relationships, and the origins of words – to provide scholars with translations that meet scientific and linguistic standards. Thus, etymology was another important element in a diachronic analysis of languages, and Bacon sought to help his contemporaries, for example in regard to the pronunciation of foreign words, by providing them with lists of Hebrew and Greek words which had become Latin words (OGG, 133ff.).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

Below is a list of Bacon’s major works on logic and language in chronological order with English translations of the titles.

i. 1240’s-1250’s

  • Bacon, R. 1940. Summa Grammatica, ed. Robert Steele. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
    • Summary of Grammar.
  • Bacon, R. 1986. Summulae dialectices. I: De termino. II: De enuntiatione. In Alain de Libera, ed., Archives d’Histoire Doctrinale et Littéraire du Moyen-Âge 53, 139-289.
    • Summary of Dialectics I-II.
  • Bacon, R. 1987. Summulae dialectices. III: De argumentatione. In Alain de Libera, ed., Archives d’Histoire Doctrinale et Littéraire du Moyen-Âge 54, 171-278.
    • Summary of Dialectics III.
  • Bacon, R. 2009. The Art and Science of Logic, translation, notes and introduction by Thomas S. Maloney. Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies.English translation of the Summulae Dialectices.

ii. 1250’s-1268: Papal Opera

  • Fredborg, K. M., Lauge Nielsen, and Jan Pinborg (Eds.). 1978. An unedited part of Roger Bacon’s ‘Opus Maius: De Signis’. Traditio 34, 75-136.
  • On Signs, fragment of Opus Maius, part three.

iii. 1268-1292

  • Bacon, R. 1902. Grammatica Graeca and Grammatica Hebraica (The Greek Grammar of Roger Bacon and a Fragment of His Hebrew Grammar), ed. Edmund Nolan and S. A. Hirsch. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • The exact dating of the two grammars is not determined.
  • Bacon, R. 1988. Compendium Studii Theologiae, edition and translation with introduction and notes by Thomas S. Maloney (Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters, 20). Leiden: Brill.
    • Summary of the Study of Theology.

b. Secondary Sources

Excellent overviews on the principal themes, arguments and authors are provided in:

i. General Studies on Medieval Theories of Language

  • Ashworth, E. J. 2003. Language and logic. In A. S. McGrade, ed., Cambridge Companion to Medieval Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 73-96.
    • Brief overview on the principal themes in medieval theories of language and logic.
  • Bursill-Hall, Geoffrey, Sten Ebbesen and E. F. K. Koerner. (Eds.). 1990. De Ortu Grammaticae: Studies in Medieval Grammar and Linguistic Theory in Memory of Jan Pinborg. Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Company.
  • Kretzmann, Norman, Anthony Kenny and Jan Pinborg. (Eds.). 1982. The Cambridge History of Later Medieval Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • Contains overview articles on “The old logic,” “Logic in the high middle ages: Semantic theory,” and “Logic in the high middle ages: Propositions and modalities.”
  • Pasnau, Robert and Christina Van Dyke. (Eds.). 2010. The Cambridge History of Medieval PhilosophyVolume 1. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Rosier, Irène. 1994. La Parole Comme Acte: Sur la Grammaire Et La Sémantique au XIIIe Siècle. Paris: Vrin.
    • Focuses on the ‘intentionalist’ current in grammar, special attention to Roger Bacon.

ii. On Roger Bacon’s Philosophy of Language

  • Bourgain, P. 1989. Les sens de la langue chez Roger Bacon. In Traduction et traducteurs au Moyen Age. Paris: Editions du CNRS, 317-331.
  • De Libera, Alain. 1981. Roger Bacon et le probleme de l’appellatio univoca. In H. A. G. Braakhuis, C. H. Kneepkens and L. M. de Rijk, eds., English Logic and Semantics: From the End of the Twelfth Century to the Time of Ockham and Burleigh. Nijmegen: Ingenium Publishers, 193-234.
  • De Libera, Alain. 1990. De la logique à la grammaire: Remarques sur la théorie de la determination chez Roger Bacon et Lambert d’Auxerre (Lambert de Lagny). In G. Bursill-Hall, S. Ebbesen and K. Koerner, eds., De grammatica: A Tribute to Jan Pinborg. Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Company, 209-226.
  • De Libera, Alain. 1991. Roger Bacon et la reference vide. Sur quelques antecedents médiévaux du paradoxe de Meinong. In J. Jolivet, Z. Kaluza and A. De Libera, eds., Lectionem Varietates: Homages á Paul Vignaux. Paris: Vrin, 85-120.
  • De Libera, Alain. 1997. Roger Bacon et la logique. In Jeremiah Hackett, ed., Roger Bacon and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays. Leiden: Brill, 103-132.
  • Fredborg, Karin Margareta. 1981. Roger Bacon on ‘Impositio vocis ad significandum’. In H. A. G. Braakhuis, C. H. Kneepkens and L. M. de Rijk, eds., English Logic and Semantics: From the End of the Twelfth Century to the Time of Ockham and Burleigh. Nijmegen: Ingenium Publishers, 167-191.
  • Hovdhaugen, Even. 1990. Una et eadem: Some observations on Roger Bacon’s Greek grammar. In Geoffrey L. Bursill-Hall, Sten Ebbesen and E. F. K. Koerner, eds., De ortu Grammaticae: Studies in Medieval Grammar and Linguistic Theory in memory of Jan Pinborg. Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Company, 117-131.
  • Maloney, Thomas S. 1983a. Roger Bacon on the significatum of words. In Lucie Brind’Amour and Eugene Vance, eds., Archéologie du Signe (Papers in Medieval Studies, 3). Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies, 187-211.
  • Maloney, Thomas S. 1983b. The semiotics of Roger Bacon. Medieval Studies 45, 120-154.
  • Maloney, Thomas S. 1984. Roger Bacon on equivocation. Vivarium 22, 85-112.
  • Maloney, Thomas S. 1985. The extreme realism of Roger Bacon. Review of Metaphysics 38, 807-837.
  • Maloney, Thomas S. 1995. Is the De doctrina christiana the source for Bacon’s semiotics? In Edward D. English, ed., Reading and Wisdom: The De Doctrina Christiana of Augustine in the Middle Ages. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 126-42.
  • Perler, Dominik. 2005. Logik – eine ‘wertlose Wissenschaft?’ Zum Verhältnis von Logik und Theologie. In Dominik Perler and Ulrich Rudolph, eds., Logik und Theologie: Das Organon im Arabischen und im Lateinischen Mittelalter. Leiden: Brill, 375-399.
  • Pinborg, Jan. 1981. Roger Bacon on Signs: A newly recovered part of the Opus Maius. In Herausgegeben Von Jan P. Beckmann, Ludger Honnefelder, Gabriel Jussen, Barbara Munxelhaus, Gangolf Schrimpf, and Georg Wieland Unter Leitung Von Wolfgang Kluxen, eds., Sprache und Erkenntnis im Mittelalter: Volume 1. New York: Walter de Gruyter, 403-412.
  • Rosier, Irène. 1984. Grammaire, loqique, sémantique, deux positions opposées au XIIIe siècle: Roger Bacon et les modistes. Histoire Epistémologie Langage 6, 21-34.
  • Rosier, Irène. 1994. La Parole Comme Acte: Sur la Grammaire Et la Sémantique au XIIIe Siècle. Paris: Vrin.
  • Rosier, Irène. 1997. Roger Bacon and grammar. In Jeremiah Hackett, ed., Roger Bacon and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays. Leiden: Brill, 67-102.
  • Rosier, Irène. 1998. Roger Bacon, al-Farabi, et Augustin. Rhétorique, logique et philosophie morale. In Gilbert Dahan and Irène Rosier-Catach, eds., La rhétorique d’Aristote: traditions et commentaires, de l’Antiquité au XVIIe Siècle. Paris: Vrin, 87–110.
  • Rosier, Irène and De Libera, Alain. 1986. Intention de signifier et engendrement du discours chez Roger Bacon. Histoire, Epistémologie, Langage 8, 63-79.

Author Information

Pia Antolic-Piper
Email: pia_antolic@hotmail.com
James Madison University
U. S. A.

Hans-Georg Gadamer (1900—2002)

GadamerHans-Georg Gadamer was a leading Continental philosopher of the twentieth century. His importance lies in his development of hermeneutic philosophy. Hermeneutics, “the art of interpretation,” originated in biblical and legal fields and was later extended to all texts. Martin Heidegger, Gadamer’s teacher, completed the universalizing of the scope of hermeneutics by extending it beyond texts to all forms of human understanding. Hence philosophical hermeneutics inquires into the meaning and significance of understanding for human existence in general.

Gadamer was influenced by Heidegger’s interest in the “question of Being,” which aimed to draw our attention to the ubiquitous and ineffable nature of Being that underlies human existence. “Being” refers to something like a “ground” (although not in the modern sense of “foundation”) or, better, background, that precedes, conditions, and makes possible the particular forms of human knowing as found in science and the social sciences. Gadamer developed Heidegger’s commitment to the ubiquitous and fundamental nature of Being in three related ways.

First, Gadamer wanted to elucidate the historical and linguistic situatedness of human knowing and to emphasize the necessity and productivity of tradition and language for human thought. For example, when Gadamer wrote that “Being that could be understood is language,” he meant that Being underlies, exceeds, and makes possible language.

Second, Gadamer sought to contend against the hubris of twentieth century positivism by demonstrating that truth is not reducible to a set of criteria, as is suggested by promoters of there being a scientific method. Just as Heidegger set out to uncover the way in which Being makes beings possible, so Gadamer aimed to demonstrate that truths derivable from method require a deeper, more extensive Truth. In order to extend truth’s domain beyond that of method (and note that Gadamer was never against method or science—only their totalizing tendencies), Gadamer explicates truth as an event. Truth is not, fundamentally, what can be affirmed relative to a set of criteria but an event or experience in which we find ourselves engaged and changed. These first two points form the emphasis of his magnum opus, Truth and Method (Wahrheit und Methode).

A third way of understanding Gadamer’s defense of the ubiquity of Being can be seen in the practical trajectory of Gadamer’s hermeneutics that arises from his interest in Plato and Aristotle. From Plato, Gadamer discerns the centrality of dialogue as the means by which we come to understanding. Dialogue is rooted in and committed to furthering our common bond with one another to the extent that it affirms the finite nature of our human knowing and invites us to remain open to one another. It is our openness to dialogue with others that Gadamer sees as the basis for a deeper solidarity. With Aristotle, Gadamer affirms the commitment that all philosophy starts from praxis (human practice) and that hermeneutics is essentially practical philosophy. We must not allow knowing to remain only on the conceptual (that is, distanced and theoretical) level; we must remember that knowing emerges from our practical quest for meaning and significance. Gadamer’s hermeneutics elucidates how Being makes human existence meaningful, where Being refers to commonality we all share.

Gadamer’s many essays and talks on ethics, art, poetry, science, medicine, and friendship, as well as references to his work by thinkers in these fields, attest to the ubiquity and practical relevance of hermeneutic thought today.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
    1. Early Years: Platonic Urges
    2. Middle Years: Under the Influence of Heidegger
    3. Later Years: Truth and Method and Beyond.
  2. Hermeneutic Inceptions
    1. Plato
    2. Aristotle
  3. “Foundations” of Philosophical Hermeneutics: Truth and Method
    1. Truth Beyond Science
    2. Prejudice, Tradition, Authority, Horizon
    3. Dialectic, Dialogue, Language
  4. Critical Encounters
    1. E.D. Hirsch
    2. Jürgen Habermas
    3. Jacques Derrida
  5. Practical Philosophy: Hermeneutics Beyond Gadamer
    1. Hermeneutics as Dialogue: Ethical and Political Interventions
    2. Twentieth Century Anglo-American Appropriations
    3. Applied Hermeneutics
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Collected Works in German
    2. Main Books by Gadamer in English
    3. Selected Secondary Literature

1. Biography

a. Early Years: Platonic Urges

Hans-Georg Gadamer was born on February 11, 1900 in Marburg, Germany. Two years later his family moved to Breslau where his father took up the position of professor of pharmacological chemistry. The presence of his domineering, strict Prussian father devoted to natural science, and the absence of his deeply pietistic mother (who died in 1904 from diabetes) perhaps contributed to Gadamer’s interest in poetry and the arts. In his words, poetry and the arts were the closest things an “unredeemed agnostic” had to contend with the limits of human knowing (Gadamer: A Biography, 20-23).

In 1918 Gadamer began his studies at Breslau and then moved to the University of Marburg, where his father received a teaching position and later became rector. At Marburg, Gadamer first studied with Richard Hönigswald, who introduced him to neo-Kantianism, and then with Nicolai Hartmann, whose brand of phenomenology presented challenges to the neo-Kantianism of Hönigswald. Hartmann’s critique of neo-Kantianism proved a crucial impetus for Gadamer’s own thinking, including his subsequent turn away from neo-Kantianism. Yet Gadamer eventually came to question Hartmann’s rigid epistemology due to the fact that it remained committed both to Aristotelian realism and to an impoverished form of phenomenology, which failed to take seriously the importance of the knower’s perspective. Gadamer accused Hartmann’s phenomenology of not being radical enough since it ignored the more fundamental conditions of human knowing.

In 1922 Gadamer wrote his (unpublished) thesis with Paul Natorp on “The Nature of Pleasure according to Plato’s dialogues” (despite Natorp’s initial suggestion to write on Fichte). Natorp, himself a prominent Plato scholar and neo-Kantian at the time, took over in the wake of the declining influence of the neo-Kantians at Marburg. In Gadamer’s thesis we find the seeds of his later writings on Plato and Aristotle, gleaned from Natorp, that emphasized the unity of the one and the many, the forms, and the realm of sensuality. Gadamer was not only influenced by the mysticism of Natorp but also by the esotericism of the poet Stefan George, of whose circle he was a member. While a definitive causality is impossible to prove, one can detect connections between the recurrent challenge to scientism that pervades Gadamer’s later, explicitly hermeneutic philosophy and the various “mysticisms” of Plato, Natorp, George, and Heidegger. What can be defended, however, is that what united the “mysticisms” of these thinkers, and thus inspired Gadamer, was their gesturing towards the realm beyond being that exposes the limitations of human understanding. While some used their “mysticism” to avoid the prosaic cares of daily life—cares that only blocked our access to this loftier, more radical and thus worthier realm—Gadamer rejected such an escapism and instead extolled “mysticism” for its propensity to insist on the finitude of human existence. True to his own unique interpretation of Plato that sought to refuse simplistic dualisms, Gadamer advocated acknowledging the beyond while at the same time insisting on our practical existence. In other words, human thinking always requires an acknowledgment of what cannot be fully captured in language, yet at the same time language, as that part of Being that can be understood, functions to create our human world and funds meaning. These themes of the productivity of the liminal or “horizonal”(for example, as developed by his notion “fusion of horizons”), and language’s in-between status, were born out of his early “Platonism” and served to undergird his later hermeneutic philosophy.

b. Middle Years: Under the Influence of Heidegger

Gadamer first encountered the written work of Heidegger in 1921 after reading one of Heidegger’s papers on Aristotle. Heidegger’s Aristotelian phenomenology, which refused the reductionism of Husserl’s phenomenology, provided Gadamer with the tools and impetus to deal the final blow to his earlier tendencies toward neo-Kantianism. During the summer of 1923 he pursued studies with Heidegger in Freiburg, where he also attended classes of Edmund Husserl, who although Heidegger’s teacher, stood in his shadow. When Heidegger was offered a position as chair at Marburg in October 1923, Gadamer followed him, a move that exacerbated the tension between Heidegger and Hartmann since many of Hartmann’s students ended up leaving him to study with Heidegger. Fellow students at Marburg during that period included Hannah Arendt, Hans Jonas, Jakob Klein, Karl Löwith, and Leo Strauss. Gadamer’s work with Heidegger was initially delayed due to Gadamer’s contraction of polio in 1922, which later served to exclude him from military service. It was during Gadamer’s convalescence that Hartmann worked to arrange a marriage for Gadamer to Frida Katz in 1923, with whom he had a daughter, Jutta, in 1926.

It should be noted that Gadamer’s relationship with Heidegger was an ambivalent one. Early on, Gadamer had thought he would write his Habilitation (doctoral dissertation) with Hartmann, but then he set his sights on Heidegger. However, Heidegger was initially unimpressed by Gadamer’s philosophical potential and encouraged him to pursue philology instead. Gadamer followed his advice and spent a number of years studying Plato with Paul Friedländer, from whom he learned about Plato’s dialogic and dialectic philosophy, an emphasis that would prove central to Gadamer’s later hermeneutics. In 1928, upon hearing of Gadamer’s plan to write his Habilitation with Friedländer, Heidegger reversed his earlier view of Gadamer’s incompetence as a philosopher and wrote a letter inviting Gadamer to work with him. In 1929 Gadamer took up a teaching position at Marburg and completed his Habilitation with Heidegger, published in 1931 as Plato’s Dialectical Ethics.

In 1933, while teaching courses on ethics and aesthetics at Marburg, Gadamer signed a declaration in support of Hitler and his National Socialist regime. Did this mean that like his teacher, Heidegger, he was an unabashed supporter of National Socialism? If so, as some suggest (Orozco), why would Gadamer have expressed shock months earlier when Heidegger had announced his own support for National Socialism? And why did Gadamer intentionally cultivate and maintain friendships with Jews during those years, while distancing himself from Heidegger until after the war? Gadamer’s biographer, Jean Grondin, offers details of Gadamer’s actions and inactions during this vexed period, and concludes that while Gadamer may have lacked the political savvy and courage for resistance, he was, unlike Heidegger, no Nazi. Reflecting back in later years Gadamer describes his shortsightedness: “it was a widespread conviction in intellectual circles that Hitler in coming to power would deconstruct the nonsense he had used to drum up the movement, and we counted the anti-Semitism as part of this nonsense. We were to learn differently” (Gadamer: A Biography, 75).

c. Later Years: Truth and Method and Beyond.

In 1939 Gadamer became a professor at Leipzig, where his first course was “Art and History,” which, as Grondin maintains, paved the way for his magnum opus, Truth and Method, published in 1960. In the same year, his first festschrift, which includes an essay by Heidegger, was also published. At Leipzig, Gadamer served as dean of the Philology and History Department and the Philosophy Faculty, as well as director of the Psychology Institute and in 1946 became rector. Unhappy due to political criticism launched at him, he sought a position in the west and initially taught at Frankfurt (1948) before accepting Karl Jasper’s offer to chair the philosophy department at Heidelberg (1949), where he taught until his official “retirement” in 1968. In 1950 he married again, this time to his former student and member of the resistance, Käte Lekebusch, with whom he had a daughter, Andrea, in 1956.

It was not until after his retirement that he gained status as an international thinker and a philosopher in his own right. This influence was due to several reasons. First, important debates with Jürgen Habermas and Jacques Derrida served to distinguish philosophical hermeneutics as a serious contender against both the critique of ideology and deconstruction. Second, he spent nearly twenty years teaching and lecturing in the United States each fall semester. Finally, Truth and Method was published in English in 1975. He continued to teach and lecture internationally and in Germany into his one-hundredth year. Gadamer died on March 13, 2002 in Heidelberg, while recovering from heart surgery. Today he is recognized as the preeminent voice for philosophical hermeneutics. Four claims focus the significance and originality of his hermeneutics: 1) hermeneutic philosophy is fundamentally practical philosophy, 2) truth is not reducible to scientific method, 3) all knowing is historically situated, and 4) all understanding reflects the ubiquity of language.

2. Hermeneutic Inceptions

a. Plato

Gadamer acknowledged that Plato, far more than Hegel or any other German thinker, motivated and inspired all his hermeneutics. Gadamer, though, remains no “traditional” Platonist, for, his early work on the Ancient Greeks is devoted to an attentive and nuanced re-reading of the significance of Plato for us today. What distinguishes Gadamer’s work on Plato is his desire to understand the questions and problems that motivated Plato. This approach stands opposed to attempts, common in Ancient Greek scholarship of the early twentieth century (for example, Leo Strauss and his followers), to uncover the “hidden doctrine” of Plato. In attempting to answer why Plato wrote his dialogues and what he was arguing against, Gadamer incites us not just to put questions to Plato—which can lead to an excessively distanced criticism of Plato—but to allow Plato to question us. The radical return to Plato made Gadamer all the more receptive to and excited by the thinking of Heidegger who also sought to understand Aristotle anew and in a more radical way.

As a result of his unique approach, Gadamer’s interpretation of Plato avoids the standard dualism (entrenched in part, Gadamer tells us, by Aristotle’s literalist readings of his teacher) that pits the Good-Beyond-Being against the good-for-us. Gadamer emphasizes the productive, rather than problematic, nature of the chorismos (the separation) between the sensual world of appearances and the transcendent realm of the forms. In other words, pace Aristotle, this separation was necessary and productive and not something to be overcome. Gadamer follows Plato in insisting on the ontological nature of the Good. Far from an empty concept, as Aristotle charged, the Good serves as an assumption that makes possible all understanding. The Good symbolizes the way in which thinking always “points beyond itself” (Philosophical Apprenticeships, 186). The plethora and variety of appearances must be made sense of in light of the assumption that something lies beyond our present understanding—namely, the Idea of the Good. Plato appealed to the Good in order to criticize the ethical relativism of the Eleatics. Gadamer draws our attention to how Plato’s appeal to the Good allowed him to transform Eleatic dialectic in two important ways: 1) to direct it towards getting clear about the “subject matter” (die Sache) as opposed to having as its goal the defeat of one’s opponent with logical prowess, and 2) to ground it in Socratic dialogue. Gadamer himself sought to recover the emphasis on the early Platonic dialectic, while refusing its later Hegelian instantiation, in order to return philosophy to Plato’s original intention as a dialectic defined primarily as the “art of carrying on a conversation” (Philosophical Apprenticeships, 186). The key to Gadamer’s later hermeneutics is grasping the significance of how Gadamer understands the connection between Platonic dialectic and Socratic dialogue.

b. Aristotle

Gadamer also returns anew to Aristotle. By stressing the import of Aristotle’s practical philosophy as that which emphasizes the background, that is, the conditions, for knowing, Gadamer challenged one of the leading Aristotelians of his day, Werner Jaeger. All knowing always starts from practical human concerns and must not lose its way in abstraction (a charge Gadamer later made against the Critique of Ideology). Gadamer’s interest in practical philosophy and its basis in human experience motivated hermeneutics’ ethical sensibilities, for instance, as witnessed in Gadamer’s esteem of phronesis as a key hermeneutic principle. What Gadamer wants to draw out from phronesis is the way in which knowledge is for the sake of acting, in other words, for the sake of living. An excessively theoretical or scientific knowledge forgets that knowledge stems out of and must return to praxis. But what sort of knowledge is sufficient for action conditioned by the variability of human life? The knowledge appropriate for the task is what Aristotle names as “phronesis.” Such a knowledge requires application but not in the way that modern science understands application: namely, the secondary and discrete step that follows from a prior theoretical knowledge. Neither is it adequately expressed by “judgment” (as in its later Kantian instanciation that subsumes a particular under a universal). Phronesis rejects the theory-practice dualism of both of these models of knowledge and instead entails the ability to transform a prior communal knowledge, that is, sensus communis, into a know-how relevant for a new situation. It is this requirement for human judgment emerging forth from a specific human community that Gadamer describes as reflective of hermeneutic understanding. The ethical overtone of phronesis as a hermeneutic concept suggests the way in which this knowledge is directed toward right action based on a “universal” (that is, communal rather than transcendent) knowledge. As Gadamer explains in Truth and Method, while “hermeneutical consciousness is involved neither with technical nor moral knowledge” (315) there is an overlap with the latter to the extent to which it entails right action based primarily on the ability to make one’s own that which comes to one out of a community. Such knowledge emerges out from and returns to praxis. Accordingly, one of Gadamer’s key contributions to philosophy, and one that took him beyond his teacher, Heidegger, was to insist that hermeneutics is practical philosophy. Gadamer clarifies that practical philosophy is rooted in human existence, which is never solipsistic but always communal. Rejecting the absolutism of modernity, Gadamer’s philosophy emphasized experience, but not the isolated existence of much 19th and 20th century existentialism. Rather, for Gadamer, existence means existing with others, which requires dialogue born of humility and an openness for inquiry: “hermeneutic philosophy understands itself not as an absolute position but as a way of experience. It insists that there is no higher principle than holding oneself open in a conversation” (Philosophical Hermeneutics, 189).

3. “Foundations” of Philosophical Hermeneutics: Truth and Method

a. Truth Beyond Science

Heidegger referred to his own early work as “hermeneutical philosophy,” and after his “turn” quipped that he wanted to leave the business of hermeneutics to Gadamer. Gadamer himself was never sure whether this was a compliment or a criticism! Nonetheless, Gadamer did develop hermeneutics beyond Heidegger’s use of that term, which can be seen foremost in Gadamer’s unique concept of truth, as developed most fully in Truth and Method.

Originally titled by Gadamer as Foundations of a Philosophical Hermeneutics, Truth and Method is just that. Following Heidegger’s initiative to increase the scope of hermeneutics beyond that of texts, Gadamer endorses the insight that humans are fundamentally beings who are given to understanding. Our task, if we are to truly know ourselves, is to figure out what such understanding entails, taking into account both its possibilities and limitations. Gadamer, however, goes further than Heidegger and asks if this is the case, what specifically does this mean for the humanities (Geisteswissenschaften)? Gadamer’s answer has both negative and positive components. Negatively, Truth and Method is critical of not only the methodologism and scientism underlying the hermeneutics of Dilthey and the phenomenology of Husserl, but also the twentieth century proclivity for positivism and/or naturalism. Yet in his move to put science “in its place,” so to speak, one finds a positive attempt to reinvigorate our appreciation of art, showing not only how it speaks truth but also how it serves as the paragon of truth. He argues not only that meaningful knowledge sought by the humanities is irreducible to that of the natural sciences, but that there is deeper, richer truth that exceeds scientific method. However, this commitment does not mean, as Jürgen Habermas and Paul Ricoeur maintained, that Gadamer opposes truth to method. For such a conclusion misses the crucial point that for Gadamer all forms of methodological truth are dependent on this deeper sense of hermeneutic truth. What sort of truth is it that underlies yet is not limited to natural scientific truth?

Over and against traditional conceptions of truth, Gadamer argues that truth is fundamentally an event, a happening, in which one encounters something that is larger than and beyond oneself. Truth is not the result of the application of a set of criteria requiring the subject’s distanced judgment of adequacy or inadequacy.  Truth exceeds the criteria-based judgment of the individual (although we could say it makes possible such a judgment). Gadamer explains in the last lines of Truth and Method that “In understanding we are drawn into an event of truth and arrive, as it were, too late, if we want to know what we are supposed to believe” (490). Truth is not, fundamentally, the result of an objective epistemic relation to the world (as put forth by correspondence or coherence theories of truth). An objective model of truth assumes that we can set ourselves at a distant from and thus make a judgment about truth using a set of criteria that is fully discernible, separable, and manipulable by us. Gadamer’s point is that there is a more fundamental happening of truth that is irreducible to such methodological applications, which perhaps we could call verisimilitudinous in regards to the deeper, hermeneutic, sense. Gadamer aims not to negate scientific method but to elucidate 1) what makes it possible and 2) the limitations of its scope. Gadamer is interested in dispelling the hubris of science (that is, scientism born of positivism) and not denigrating the practice of science per se. Furthermore, Gadamer took pains to clarify in his foreword to the second edition of Truth and Method that he is not offering a new method for hermeneutics or the social sciences. His work is not prescriptive. But neither is it descriptive of human behavior. He tells us: “My real concern was and is philosophic: not what we do or what we ought to do, but what happens to us over and above our wanting and doing” (xxviii). This statement also reveals the influence that Heidegger’s retrieval of the question of Being had on Gadamer’s thought in general, and his account of truth in particular. Gadamer’s critique of a scientific or modern theory of truth was, like much of Heidegger’s thought, a critique of subjectivism. Specifically, Gadamer maintained that the knower is never able to fully conceptualize and judge his or her own belief structure. Yet Gadamer’s account of truth went further than Heidegger’s and entailed a second claim, namely, that truth is fundamentally practical. Let us take a closer look at each of these two claims.

Regarding his anti-subjectivism, Gadamer describes the event of truth as an experience in which one is drawn away from oneself into something beyond oneself. To experience truth requires losing oneself in something greater and more extensive than oneself. The paradigmatic example of such an anti-subjective experience is play, to which Gadamer devotes quite a bit of space in Truth and Method. In order to appreciate the anti-subjective emphasis of play, it is helpful to understand its “medial” (Truth and Method, 103, 105) nature: players do not direct or control the play but are caught up in it. Play has “primacy over the consciousness of the player” (104), follows its own course, and plays itself, so to speak. Play is not played by a subject but rather absorbs the player into itself. Gadamer’s primary concern is to elucidate what it means to be caught up in the game in a way that diminishes the subjectivity of the player. In fact, the subject of the game is not the player but the game itself. However, this emphasis does not mean that the player relinquishes all power or consciousness and dons a zombie-like state—in which case there would be no mediality. Rather, Gadamer’s point is that play is effortless, without strain, and spontaneous (105), always enticing one into more play. The fact that in play one experiences oneself as in-between oneself and the play, that is, one neither exerts full control nor is passively swept along, reflects its mediality.

The constant back-and-forth movement of play eludes the grasp and guidance of an agent’s will, and yet, at the same time, is seemingly full of initiative. Play succeeds when the player engages in it with ease and where the player is never awkward or removed. But neither is the play excessively competitive. Gadamer’s insistence on the “contested” nature of such movement emphasizes the fact that one always plays with something or someone else. By “contest” Gadamer means to suggest only that play is never the act of a lone individual—not that it is necessarily agonistic. The negative component of competition that some (Lugones) read into Gadamer is difficult to defend given Gadamer’s insistence that the goal of play is not to end the game by winning but to keep on playing. While there is an initial assertive and intentional choice of entering into a game, once the game has gotten underway, being caught up in the game replaces any prior intentionality. To play, as Gadamer suggests, is to choose to give up our choice. In play, one substitutes one’s “free, individual choice,” so to speak, for the experience of a new sort of freedom which entails losing oneself in reciprocal play with someone or something else. The alleged “freedom” to remain isolated, in control, and able to choose is replaced by the freedom found in relinquishing oneself to the play of the game.

In addition to its medial nature, Gadamer highlights a second feature of play, namely “presentation,” which is what ultimately allows Gadamer to explain how play becomes transformed into art. Gadamer insists that human play is always marked by self-presentation: in play we present ourselves as something/someone else. While there is self-presentation in nature, according to Gadamer, human play-as-self-presentation is different:

The self-presentation of human play depends on the player’s conduct being tied to the make-believe goals of the game, but the “meaning” of these does not in fact depend on their being achieved. Rather, in spending oneself on the task of the game, one is in fact playing oneself out. The self-presentation of the game involves the player’s achieving, as it were, his own self-presentation by playing—that is, presenting—something. Only because play is always presentation is human play able to make representation itself the task of the game. (Truth and Method, 108)

What Gadamer is getting at here is that the purpose of play is not a presentation of a final, completed product for a third-party observer. Rather, he clarifies how in play our only goal is to figure out how to represent ourselves so that the game continues, thus recalling the contestial nature of play that requires two and aspires to keep playing. In other words, in true play the goal is not to achieve the prize but to present oneself as something in such a way that furthers the play.

Gadamer describes how play becomes “art” when the presentation is aimed at the absence of the “fourth wall”—that is, the viewer. Whereas in games the presentation is self-contained, in art, play-as-presentation does aim at something beyond itself. The playful self-presentation characterizing mediality gets transformed into pure presentation in art, signifying a potential for truth not found in the anti-subjective dimension of play. However, Gadamer warns, “when we speak of play in reference to the experience of art, this means neither the orientation nor even the state of mind of the creator or of those enjoying the work of art, nor the freedom of subjectivity engaged in play, but the mode of being of the work of art itself” (Truth and Method, 101). To grasp exactly what Gadamer means by “the mode of being of the work of art itself” we can now attend to the second claim Gadamer raises about truth, namely, its practical importance. Art exemplifies how truth is a matter of being spoken to, being claimed, and being changed. The truth emerging from art is an existential, practical one, rather than a purely theoretical one.

For Gadamer, truth is inextricably tied to our ability to recognize “something and oneself” (Truth and Method, 114). Unlike previous theories, however, that tied recognition to the ability to recognize the original presented by art, Gadamer emphasizes the future, rather than the past, as defining recognition. Recognition aimed at the truth of art stems not from its ability to mimic (or correspond to) an original but from its ability to bring to presence that which is truer than the original. To encounter the truth in art is not to look back to an original; art serves not as the mirror to the world-that-is-really-there, but as a means to opening one’s eyes to new ways of seeing and future possibilities. It is new visions not past ones that can count as true, and for this reason Gadamer insists that what is presented in art is actually more true than the alleged original it purports to imitate. But what does this mean and how does it reflect truth’s practical bent? Recognition thus requires more than objective seeing where one brackets one’s subjectivity and remains at an existential distance from the art. Recognition means being played by, drawn into, the work of art in such a way that one’s own being is altered. As Gadamer puts it, our encounter with art that produces truth occurs when we hear the art speaking as if directly to us: “it is not only the ‘This art thou!’ disclosed in a joyous and frightening shock; it also says to us; ‘Thou must alter thy life!’” (Philosophical Hermeneutics, 104). The neutral gaze of aesthetic consciousness affords no truth, for nothing is at stake, nothing is disturbed, and everything is left as it was before. For Gadamer, the truth of art refers to its practical ability to speak to, that is, change, the viewer. Art’s “mode,” then, is “presentation” (Truth and Method, 115) to the extent to which it presents an “essential” truth, where “essence” refers not to a stable, a priori, but to the relation established by our encounter with the art. To lose oneself in the play of art that then leads to a finding and a recognition of oneself—one that activates an envisioning of oneself in the future and not the past—is to experience truth. Gadamer writes, “In being played the play speaks to the spectator through its presentation; and it does so in such a way that, despite the distance between [the play and the spectator], the spectator still belongs to play” (116). The belongingness is not one that suggests a “deep, hidden truth,” as Dreyfus and Rabinow maintain, but rather one in which we experience ourselves made present with the art—which is possible only as we look ahead, envisioning ourselves anew.

To maintain the evential character of truth is to expose the dynamic nature of understanding, specifically in terms of a “double movement” (Barthold). Gadamer’s account of truth requires not only that one be drawn away from oneself and caught up in something larger than oneself, one must also “return to oneself.” Here, the “return to self” means the ability to grasp the meaning for oneself in a way that changes one. As we have seen, Gadamer does not just offer a critique of modern subjectivism, he also argues for the practical moment in which one feels compelled to change one’s life. The anti-subjective implication of Gadamer’s account of truth, to the extent it is a move away from oneself, is suggestive of the Platonic motion of ascendance. And the subsequent impetus for practical application, the return to oneself, reflects the descendance also reminiscent of Plato. If we do not engage in such a dynamic experience, one both in which one is caught up and from which one emerges changed, then one has not experienced truth. This hermeneutic account of truth refrains from explicating the method or the criteria required to arrive at a correct judgment. Instead it attempts to elucidate the more primordial sense of truth that underlies, but does not oppose, traditional accounts of truth like the correspondence and coherence theories.

b. Prejudice, Tradition, Authority, Horizon

In part II of Truth and Method Gadamer develops four key concepts central to his hermeneutics: prejudice, tradition, authority, and horizon. Prejudice (Vorurteil) literally means a fore-judgment, indicating all the assumptions required to make a claim of knowledge. Behind every claim and belief lie many other tacit beliefs;  it is the work of understanding to expose and subsequently affirm or negate them. Unlike our everyday use of the word, which always implies that which is damning and unfounded, Gadamer’s use of  “prejudice” is neutral: we do not know in advance which prejudices are worth preserving and which should be rejected. Furthermore, prejudice-free knowledge is neither desirable nor possible. Neither the hermeneutic circle nor prejudices are necessarily vicious. Against the enlightenment’s “prejudice against prejudice” (272) Gadamer argues that prejudices are the very source of our knowledge. To dream with Descartes of razing to the ground all beliefs that are not clear and distinct is a move of deception that would entail ridding oneself of the very language that allows one to formulate doubt in the first place. To further understand the vital role of prejudices, we must examine the role Gadamer assigns to tradition.

“Tradition,” like “prejudice,” is a term Gadamer develops beyond its everyday meaning. To affirm, as Gadamer does, that one can never escape from one’s tradition, does not mean he is insisting we endorse all traditions writ large. Gadamer is not espousing a conservative approach to tradition that blindly affirms the whole of a tradition and leaves one without recourse to critique it. Critics like Habermas and Ricoeur have faulted Gadamer for failing to insist on a critical response to tradition. These criticisms miss the mark for two reasons. First, accepting the fact that we can never entirely reflect oneself out of tradition does not mean that one cannot change and question one’s tradition. His point is that in as much as tradition serves as the condition of one’s knowledge, the background that instigates all inquiry, one can never start from a tradition-free place. A tradition is what gives one a question or interest to begin with. Second, all successful efforts to enliven a tradition require changing it so as to make it relevant for the current context. To embrace a tradition is to make it one’s own by altering it. A passive acknowledgment of a tradition does not allow one to live within it. One must apply the tradition as one’s own. In other words, the importance of the terms, “prejudice” and “tradition,” for Gadamer’s hermeneutics lies in the way they indicate the active nature of understanding that produces something new. Tradition hands down certain interests, prejudices, questions, and problems, that incite knowledge. Tradition is less a conserving force than a provocative one. Even a revolution, Gadamer notes, is a response to the tradition that nonetheless makes use of that very same tradition. Here we can also perceive the Hegelian influences on Gadamer to the extent that even a rejection of some elements of the tradition relies on the preservation of other elements, which are then understood (that is, taken up) in new ways. Gadamer desires not to affirm a blind and passive imitation of tradition, but to show how making tradition our own means a critical and creative application of it.

Similarly, true authority always requires an active acknowledgment by others. Without such an acknowledgment, one finds not true authority but passive submission resulting in tyranny. For, acknowledgment requires an active implementation of and reflection on the meaning of that authority for oneself—one based in knowledge not ignorance. Hence, understanding always has a built-in possibility for critique as we strive to make something our own and do not simply passively mimic it. Memorizing a text, for example, is no indication that one understands it; one has understood only when one can put the text into one’s own words, enlivening the text and allowing it to speak in new ways. That Gadamer’s point is not a conservative one is seen by the fact that change resulting in a new creation is the necessary result of all understanding.

Gadamer’s attention to the historical nature of understanding is captured by what he terms, “historically effected/effective consciousness” (Wirkungsgeschichtliches Bewusstein). But against historicism’s objectifying tendencies, Gadamer contends that historical situatedness does not result in restrictive limitations. For, limits are precisely what allow one to be open to what is new. It is in this context that one of Gadamer’s most misunderstood terms, namely, the “fusion of horizons,” is discussed. “Horizon” suggests the limits that make perspective possible and is marked by two main features. First, the concept of horizon suggests the situated and perspectival nature of knowing. Just as the visual (that is, literal) horizon provides the boundaries that allow one to see, so the epistemic horizon provides boundaries that make knowledge possible. Just as the literal horizon delimits one’s visual field, the epistemic horizon frames one’s situation in terms of what lies behind (that is, tradition, history), around (that is, present culture and society), and before (that is, expectations directed at the future) one. The concept of horizon thus connotes the way in which a located, perspectival knowing is yet a fecund one: without the limitation of a horizon there would be no seeing. The back- and fore-grounds requisite for knowledge are not hindrances to be overcome. For, the “view from nowhere” sees not; it is blinded by its own solipsism. A horizon, as Gadamer tells us, bespeaks the productively mediated relation between what is distant and near; it enables us to discern both what is close up and what is far away without excluding either of these positions (Truth and Method, 302). We could say that the concept of horizon meaningfully integrates the interpreter’s immediate environs and the more distant world-at-large.

Second, Gadamer stresses the open and dynamic nature of horizons. This point has been neglected in some of the secondary literature devoted to Gadamer’s conception of horizon and for this reason it is important to note that when Gadamer speaks of the horizon it is in a context in which he is trying to explain how we can have an intellectually vital relation with tradition or, as he puts it later, between “text and present”  (306). Against historicism, Gadamer argues that the ability of a contemporary interpreter to understand a text of the past does not presuppose two entirely distinct, reified horizons. It is the work of understanding to expose the unity to what at first glance is taken to be two distinct horizons, that is, past and present. Hence the “fusion” of horizons that signifies understanding. Rather than delineating a fixed and impenetrable space, Gadamer wants to highlight the capaciousness and expansiveness of a horizon: “horizon is. . . something into which we move and that moves with us. Horizons change for a person who is moving” (304). To defend horizons as distinct and fixed affirms the closed (304), incommensurable nature of horizons, where understanding, and thus truth, remains thwarted (303).

Since Gadamer denies the original diremption (separation) of discrete horizons, he rejects the assumption that understanding requires us to transpose ourselves into another, alien horizon. Horizons are not self-contained locations that can be entered into or departed from at will; they are not “objective” locations distinct from us as “subjects.” It is not the case, then, that understanding requires an act of will by which we transpose ourselves into the horizon of the other. The Hegelian themes are clear when Gadamer tells us that the transposition that occurs in the attempt to understand

always involves rising to a higher universality that overcomes not only our own particularity but also that of the other. The concept of “horizon” suggests itself because it expresses the superior breadth of vision that the person who is trying to understand must have. To acquire a horizon means that one learns to look beyond what is close at hand—not in order to look away from it but to see it better, within a larger whole and in truer proportion. (305)

The Hegelian aufhebung (sublation) underlying horizontal fusions means that whenever we are tempted to say that there are two completely distinct and incommensurate horizons we should confess the superficiality and incompleteness of such a description. That is to say, our initial efforts at trying to interpret an ancient text might make it seem as if the text does belong to an entirely different world, and Gadamer does not deny that the foreignness of the text sometimes seems to suggest its complete otherness. Misunderstanding can exacerbate the otherness of the other. But, accepting the initial challenge of difference as entailing ontologically real differences precludes change, and thus understanding. Instead, Gadamer invites us to conceive of difference as a means to transformation, which Gadamer terms “fusion of horizons.” The temptation to treat difference as an impossibility reflects a superficial response and affirms a rigid, reified notion of horizon. Noting the difference of temporally or spatially distant worlds, is, as Gadamer puts it, “only one phase in the process of understanding,” and we must take care not to “solidify” the “self-alienation of past consciousness” (306, 307). If we do so, then we will prevent the “real fusing of horizons. . . which means that as the historical horizon is projected, it is simultaneously superseded” (307). Refusing to reify difference means acknowledging that the process of understanding requires the ability to allow one’s own horizon to shift and change in light of the acknowledgment of the other, and vice versa. True understanding not only begins with difference but also requires all horizons to change; neither one’s own horizon nor that of the other is left intact (306-307). Fusion of horizons is not a war in which the dominant horizon swallows up the weaker one. In keeping with Gadamer’s anti-subjectivism, it is crucial to note that the “fusion of horizons” happens beyond our willing; the expanding of our horizon is not something we can fully control or bring about. Rather, it is through our effort to understand that a new horizon emerges.

But if there are not two reified horizons, neither is there a single, bounded horizon that occludes difference. Fusion refers to the active and the on-going nature of understanding—not a static, hegemonic unity. Any unity wrought by understanding is its effect—not its cause. Furthermore, such unity will never be total: understanding refers to a process not a final end. To defend a mono-culture is akin to positing a single, definite horizon and is thus to deny the very difference that initiates understanding in the first place. The productivity of such difference is attested to by Gadamer’s statement in his “Afterword” to Truth and Method: “what I described as a fusion of horizons was the form in which this unity [of the meaning of a work and its effect] actualizes itself, which does not allow the interpreter to speak of an original meaning of the work without acknowledging that, in  understanding it, the interpreter’s own meaning enters in as well. . . Working out the historical horizon of a text is always already a fusion of horizons” (576, 577).  Acknowledging that one can only access the viewpoint of another from within one’s own horizon is not a totalitarian effort to defend a mono-culture but a humble admission that one never can access directly the other’s perspective. Neither an imposed nor feigned sameness is the starting place; if they were there would be no work for understanding to do. Ascriptions of a mono-horizon belong to historicist positions that fail to note the complex nature of horizons that always, at least potentially, grant provisions for us moving beyond them. Gadamer’s account of horizon emphatically maintains that only where one is open to new horizons emerging—and hence difference—can one claim to understand. It falls to the work of the historical consciousness, which Gadamer seeks to undermine, to defend such a mono-cultural and reified picture of history and tradition. Hence, Gadamer’s theory is not forced to assume either a mono-cultural view of tradition or to posit mono-culture as the telos of understanding. Putting it in a slightly different way: difference is the occasion for—not an impediment to—understanding.

c. Dialectic, Dialogue, Language

Part II of Truth and Method closes with an analysis of Plato’s dialectic and the significance of dialogue for Gadamer’s hermeneutics. Gadamer’s understanding of these terms as well as how they are related bears comment. As we have seen, Gadamer distinguishes between early Platonic, later Platonic, and Hegelian dialectic and relies most heavily on the early Platonic dialectic due to its reliance on Socratic dialogue. The later Platonic and Hegelian dialectic he faults for their propositional and sentential reductionism. For Gadamer, dialectic instructs his own hermeneutics in so far as it suggests a productive tension that, contrary to Hegel’s view, is never resolved. The lack of resolution suggests the fecundity of the “chorismos” (the separation between the sensual and transcendent realms) marking human existence and affirms our human status as “in-between.” If Gadamer’s hermeneutics can be called “dialectic” it is in the sense that Gadamer affirms that understanding is inseparable from dialogue and is marked by a constant and productive “chorismatic” tension between these two realms (Barthold).

For Gadamer, as for Plato, dialectic is inseparable from (although not reducible to) dialogue. One can point to four main components of dialogue in Gadamer’s philosophical hermeneutics. First, a dialogue is focused on die Sache, the subject matter. The aim of dialogue is not to win the other over to one’s side—it is not a debate. Nor does it aim at a subjective understanding of the other. Rather, both parties open themselves to coming to an agreement about the matter itself. Secondly, a dialogue requires that each party possesses a “good-will” to understand, that is, an openness to hear something anew in such a way as to forge a connection with another. Thus one could say that dialogic openness aims at solidarity. Third, a good dialogue entails a willingness to offer reasons and justifications for one’s views. One must be open not only to the voice of the other, but to make the effort to explain oneself to another. Finally, a good dialogue requires a commitment that one “knows one doesn’t know.” Dialogue requires a humble playfulness in which we get caught up and lose ourselves in the connection with another. A good dialogue is one that, like engaging play, is one we want to keep going. Thus we could see that the play of dialogue indicates the central motif of Gadamer’s notion of truth: “To reach an understanding in a dialogue is not merely a matter of putting oneself forward and successfully asserting one’s own point of view, but being transformed into a communion in which we do not remain what we were” (379). The intertwined nature of dialectic and dialogue, combined with dialogue’s connection to solidarity, reflects what Gadamer meant when he referred to his philosophical hermeneutics as “dialectical ethics” (“Gadamer on Gadamer”, 15).

Part III of Truth and Method turns to an analysis of language where Gadamer draws on his early fascination with Socratic dialogue in order to defend the importance of the linguistic nature of human existence. Referencing Augustine and Nicholas of Cusa, he goes on to stress the speculative nature of language in order to contend against those who would reduce language to propositions. Gadamer shows us how meaning comes through linguistic expression that relies on a whole (that is, Being) that is greater than its part (what is expressed in language, for example, propositions). This “totality” makes language possible and functions “not [as] an object but the world horizon that embraces us.” But it is crucial to emphasize that the sense of the speculative and the totality Gadamer insists upon here refuses the Hegelian finality: understanding does not aim at having the final word.

But neither is there the worry that we are somehow trapped inside language. Instead, Gadamer stresses the open and on-going nature of understanding that manifests itself in two ways. First, as we have seen, one is to remain open toward the other in order to keep the conversation going. Second, Gadamer stresses the openness on the part of language, which is never a restrictive, non-porous boundary, but a productive limit that makes possible the continual creation of new words and worlds. The first of these, that is, our openness to the on-going conversation we have with others is made possible by the second, that is, our shared pre-linguistic world of being. Thus when it comes to language, Gadamer refuses to reduce language to propositions—that is, tools that we use objectively. Instead he summons poetry as that which embodies what is essential to all language, namely, its status as “a medium where I and world meet, or, rather, manifest their original belonging together” (Truth and Method, 474). In this section, Gadamer proclaims his famous utterance, “Being that can be understood is language” (474). This claim means neither that everything is language nor that all Being is reducible to language. Language, Gadamer tells us towards the end of this section, is a type of presentation, a coming-into-being, that reveals the unity of beauty (that is, what we desire) and truth (what speaks to and changes us). Language, in other words, makes visible both truth and beauty. In this way, language reflects the hermeneutic experience in terms of being captivated by beauty and changed by truth, a truth that is irreducible to scientific method.

4. Critical Encounters

a. E.D. Hirsch

Two years prior to his 1967 book, Validity and Interpretation, E.D. Hirsch wrote a journal article criticizing Gadamer’s hermeneutics. Against Gadamer, Hirsch argued that meaning can only be found in the author’s intention and thus a good interpretation is one that successfully reconstructs and reproduces this original meaning. He accused Gadamer’s hermeneutics of substituting this sort of reconstruction of authorial intention with the interpreter’s own subjective construction. Essentially, Hirsch rejected Gadamer’s move to replace mimesis with application. Hirsch also attacked Gadamer’s reliance on prejudice, tradition, historicity and his notion of fusion of horizons. None of these notions, according to Hirsch, gives adequate emphasis to the importance of the interpreter suspending and bracketing her own subjective consciousness and taking on that of the author. (Thus Hirsch followed Dilthey’s and Schleiermacher’s emphasis on divining the intention of the author as the method of interpretation.) As a result, Gadamer’s hermeneutics is thought to lose its ability to claim objective status and remains unable to defend itself against charges of relativism. What this criticism overlooks, however, is that Gadamer insists his work is not a prescriptive or normative call to endorse prejudice, tradition or authority. It does not defend the passivity of the interpreter but the active and creative force at play in all interpretation. Neither did Gadamer intend “to offer a general theory of interpretation and a differential account of its methods. . .” Instead, Gadamer maintains that the insights of Truth and Method aim “to discover what is common to all modes of understanding and to show that understanding is never a subjective relation to a given ‘object’ but to the history of its effect; in other words, understanding belongs to the being of that which is understood” (Truth and Method, xxxi). Gadamer nowhere denies the importance of striving to be objective when interpreting a text; what he denies is the sufficiency and primacy of such “objectivity.”

b. Jürgen Habermas

In the nineteen-sixties Gadamer had been a supporter of Jürgen Habermas, urging against Max Horkheimer that Habermas be offered a job at Heidelberg before he had completed his Habilitation. While Habermas and Gadamer were united in their attack on the hubris of positivism, during the seventies an important philosophical disagreement between them took place that served to expand the sphere of Gadamer’s philosophical influence. While there were many fundamental points of agreement between Habermas and Gadamer, such as their starting place in the hermeneutic tradition that attempts a critique of the dominance of natural scientific method as well as their desire to return to the Greek notion of practical philosophy, Habermas argued that Gadamer’s emphasis on tradition, prejudice, and the universal nature of hermeneutics blinded him to ideological operations of power. Habermas interpreted Gadamer as calling for the elimination of method altogether and went on to argue that Gadamer’s hermeneutics thus leaves one without the ability to reflect critically upon the sources of ideology at play in the theoretical and material levels of society. Habermas asserted, “Hermeneutical consciousness is incomplete so long as it has not incorporated into itself reflection on the limit of hermeneutical understanding” (The Hermeneutic Claim to Universality, 302). Essentially, he accused Gadamer of failing to recognize the need to critique tradition, inferring that Gadamer disallows such a critique and endorses a dogmatic stand toward tradition. How do we know that the understanding we arrive at is distortion-free? Gadamer’s appeal to tradition, prejudice, and authority would seem to thwart any such critique. Gadamer, in turn, argued, that to refuse the universal nature of hermeneutics is itself the more dogmatic stance, for in so doing we affirm modernity’s deception that the subject can free itself from the past.

c. Jacques Derrida

While both Gadamer and Derrida were attentive to the role of language in life and philosophy, and both were followers of Heidegger, the content as well as the style of their philosophy differ greatly. For Gadamer, the very possibility of understanding requires a devotion to die Sache, the subject matter. Derrida’s deconstructionist claim is that to assume a subject matter, a singular point unifying the attention of understanding, is to endorse and remain ensnared by a metaphysics of presence. According to Derrida there is no subject matter, no “Truth,” only multiple perspectives and their deferral. In 1981, a “meeting” or “conversation” was arranged between Gadamer and Derrida at the Goethe Institute in Paris. However, what occurred fell far short of anything that could be called a philosophical dialogue. Why? Gadamer’s initial presentation aimed to defend Heidegger against Derrida’s charge that Heidegger fails to achieve the more radical philosophy of Nietzsche who insists that there is not truth, no single correct interpretation or agreement over a singular subject matter. Derrida’s “reply,” however, ignored the main trajectory of Gadamer’s points and instead attacked Gadamer for relying on a Kantian notion of the good will. Since Gadamer had mentioned only once (and in passing) the importance of being open to the other in a dialogue, Derrida seemed to overreach with his charge that Gadamer was therefore defending a Kantian notion of good will. Then, even more puzzlingly, in Derrida’s subsequent presentation, he addressed himself only to Heidegger and Nietzsche and made no mention at all of Gadamer’s hermeneutics. Yet if we characterize Gadamer’s hermeneutics as the elucidation of how understanding can succeed, and if we generalize Derrida’s deconstruction as the exposure of the misunderstandings, ruptures, and deviances that always present themselves when we try to understand, then perhaps, to the extent to which each philosopher embodied his own philosophy, a certain encounter (albeit not a dialogue) between philosophies did in fact occur.

5. Practical Philosophy: Hermeneutics Beyond Gadamer

a. Hermeneutics as Dialogue: Ethical and Political Interventions

Tracing the trajectory of Gadamer’s philosophical career, one might question whether Truth and Method deserves to be called his magnum opus or whether it is not one moment in his more important quest to recover the spirit of Plato.  If we are to take him at his word that Truth and Method offered us the foundations of hermeneutics, then we must ask, what is the magnum opus such a foundation undergirds? It would seem as if practical philosophy is the work, the edifice, Gadamer hoped would be sustained by his “foundations.”  This fact can be substantiated by his 1996 claim: “By hermeneutics I understand the ability to listen to the other in the belief that he could be right” (quoted in Gadamer: A Biography, 250). In other words, Gadamer realizes more fully the universalizing tendency in the history of hermeneutics: the event of understanding occurs not just in the realm of texts, and certainly not just in philosophy, but in the myriad ways we interact with and seek to connect with others.

The eagerness to conceive of the dialogical impetus of hermeneutics as a possible resource for resolving certain contemporary social and political crises in our world is found in much of the secondary literature on Gadamer. Gadamer’s work proves relevant for contemporary issues to the extent to which it neither appeals to prior, transcendent, eternal truths nor devolves into incommensurability. The desire to forge a third way “beyond objectivism and relativism” (Bernstein) captures the move by some thinkers to find social and political relevance in Gadamer’s hermeneutics (Warnke, Sullivan, Dallmayr). Political theorist and philosopher Fred Dallmayr, for instance, drawing on Gadamer, stresses “integral pluralism” as a way to avoid the isolated pluralism resulting from incommensurability. To what extent is it possible to interact rationally and dialogically in order to listen to the other and to advance human understanding that values the whole (that is, community) over the part (individual)? And feminist philosophers Georgia Warnke and Linda Martín Acloff have relied on Gadamer’s hermeneutics in their writings about justice, contemporary social issues, and gender.

b. Twentieth Century Anglo-American Appropriations

While Gadamer’s thought has been primarily formed by his interaction with German and Greek thinkers, it has been taken up by three of the most influential American philosophers of the later twentieth century, namely, the pragmatist Richard Rorty, and the philosophers of language, Robert Brandom and John McDowell. While coming from a very different philosophical tradition than Gadamer, both Brandom and McDowell have argued for the usefulness of Gadamer’s thought for contemporary discussions in philosophy of mind and philosophy of language. Richard Rorty, in his 1979 work, Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature, was one of the first Anglo-American philosophers explicitly to attest to the import of Gadamer’s hermeneutics. And while the term “hermeneutics” drops out of use in Rorty’s later work, evidence of Gadamer’s continued influence remains. In fact, one can find increasing connections among pragmatism and Gadamer. For example, contemporary American pragmatist Richard Bernstein finds Gadamer’s conception of the fluidity of horizons more promising than that of static paradigms for forging our way through contemporary multiculturalism and globalization. For, Gadamer’s rich and nuanced conception of dialogue avoids promoting either incommensurability or facile dialogue that denies the workings of power in language.

c. Applied Hermeneutics

That Gadamer’s work has also found application in psychology (Chessick), education (Gallagher), ethics (Foster, Smith, Vilhauer), political theory (Dallmayr, Kögler, Sullivan, Warnke), sports (Hyland), and theology (Ringma, Thiselton) affirms Gadamer’s claim that “a good test of the idea of hermeneutics itself” is its ability to find translation in other fields (The Philosophy of Hans-Georg Gadamer, 17). How to make the questions of our history, of our tradition, speak again to us—not solely within the halls of the academy with its “scholarshipism” (as Gadamer terms it) but to the practical concerns of our age? This is the task Gadamer’s hermeneutic philosophy calls us to.  Thus the continued relevance of Gadamer’s thought for contemporary philosophy, particularly of a social and political bent, serves to endorse Gadamer’s own claim about the practical relevance of his hermeneutics: “The hermeneutic task of integrating the monologic of the sciences into the communicative consciousness includes the task of exercising practical, social, and political reasonability. This has become all the more urgent” (Philosophical Apprenticeships, 182).

In closing, we can concur with Robert Dostal who clarifies that although Gadamer himself wrote no ethics or political philosophy per se, there is in his hermeneutics a “basic posture” oriented toward just these concerns, to the extent that he urges us to listen, truly listen, to what the other says in trust that she or he may be right. And that this is a posture that extends beyond the realm of academic philosophy can be seen in Gadamer’s own life. Dostal reflects, “The ethic of this hermeneutic is an ethic of respect and trust that calls for solidarity. Gadamer himself embodies this ethic, not only in his work, but also in his life. All those who have encountered him, whether they find themselves in agreement with him or not, have found him, like the Socrates he so much admired, always ready for conversation” (32). And like Socrates’ death, Gadamer’s death did not put an end to our conversation with him.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Collected Works in German

  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Gesammelte Werke. Tübigen: J.C.B. Mohr (Paul Siebeck).

b. Main Books by Gadamer in English

  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Hegel’s Dialectic: Five Hermeneutical Studies. Trans. P.      Christopher Smith. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1976.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Philosophical Hermeneutics. Trans. and ed. David E. Linge. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1977.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Dialogue and Dialectic. Trans. P. Christopher Smith. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1980.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Philosophical Apprenticeships. Trans. Robert R. Sullivan. Cambridge, Mass: MIT Press, 1985.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Idea of the Good in Platonic-Aristotelian Philosophy. Trans. and with an introduction and annotation by P. Christopher Smith. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1986.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Dialogue and Deconstruction. Ed. Diane P. Michelfelder and Richard E. Palmer. Albany: SUNY Press, 1989.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. “Gadamer on Gadamer.” In Gadamer and Hermeneutics, ed. Hugh Silverman. New York: Routledge Press, 1991a.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Plato’s Dialectical Ethics. Trans. Robert M. Wallace. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1991b.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Hans-Georg Gadamer on Education, Poetry, and History. Ed. Dieter Misgeld and Graeme Nicholson. Trans. Lawrence Schmidt and Monica Reuss. Albany: SUNY Press, 1992.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Truth and Method. 2nd ed. Trans. Joel Weinsheimer and Donald G. Marshall. N.Y.: Crossroad, 1992.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Reason in the Age of Science. Trans. Frederick G. Lawrence. Mass.: MIT Press, 1992.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Heidegger’s Ways. Trans. John W. Stanley. Albany: SUNY Press, 1994.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Enigma of Health. Trans. Jason Gaiger and Nicholas Walker. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1996.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Relevance of the Beautiful. Ed. Robert Bernasconi. Trans. Nicholas Walker. N.Y.: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Beginning of Philosophy. Trans. Rod Coltman. N.Y.: Continuum, 1998.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg.. Praise of Theory. Trans. Chris Dawson. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1998.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Hermeneutics, Religion, and Ethics. Trans. Joel Weinsheimer. New Haven: Yale University Press, 1999.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. Gadamer in Conversation. Ed. and trans. Richard E. Palmer. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2001.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Beginning of Knowledge. Trans. Rod Coltman. N.Y.: Continuum, 2002.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. A Century of Philosophy. Trans. Rod Coltman with Sigrid Koepke. N.Y.: Continuum, 2004.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Gadamer Reader: A Bouquet of the Later Writings. Ed. Richard E. Palmer. Ill.: Northwestern University Press, 2007.

c. Selected Secondary Literature

  • Alcoff, Linda Martín. Visible Identities. New York: Oxford, 2006.
  • Barthold, Lauren Swayne. Gadamer’s Dialectical Hermeneutics. Lanham, MD: Lexington, 2010.
  • Bernstein, Richard. Beyond Objectivism and Relativism. Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania, 1983.
  • Brandom, Robert. Tales of the Mighty Dead. Massachusetts:  Harvard University,   2002.
  • Chessick, Richard. “Hermeneutics of Psychotherapists,” American Journal of Psychotherapy 44 (1990), 256-73.
  • Dallmayr, Fred. Integral Pluralism: Beyond Culture Wars. Kentucky: University of Kentucky, 2010.
  • Dostal, Robert J. ed. The Cambridge Companion to Gadamer. New York: Cambridge, 2002.
  • Foster, Matthew. Gadamer and Practical Philosophy. Atlanta: Scholars, 1991.
  • Gallagher, Shaun. Hermeneutics and Education. Albany: SUNY, 1994.
  • Grondin, Jean. Gadamer: A Biography, trans. Joel Weinsheimer. New Haven: Yale University, 2003.
  • Grondin, Jean. Introduction to Philosophical Hermeneutics. New Haven: Yale University, 1994.
  • Habermas, Jürgen. “The Hermeneutic Claim to Universality.” The Hermeneutic      Tradition. Gayle Ormiston and Alan Schrift, ed. Albany: SUNY, 1990.
  • Habermas, Jürgen. “A Review of Gadamer’s Truth and Method.” The Hermeneutic Tradition. Gayle Ormiston and Alan Schrift, ed. Albany: SUNY, 1990.
  • Hahn, Lewis Edwin, ed. The Philosophy of Hans-Georg Gadamer. Chicago: Open Court, 1997.
  • Hirsch, E.D. “Truth and Method in Interpretation.” Review of Metaphysics 18 (1965), 488-507.
  • Hirsch, E.D. Validity in Interpretation. New Haven: Yale University, 1967.
  • Hollinger, Robert, ed. Hermeneutics and Praxis. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame, 1985.
  • Hyland, Drew. Philosophy of Sport. St. Paul, Minn.: Paragon House, 1990.
  • Kögler, Hans Herbert. The Power of Dialogue: Critical Hermeneutics after Gadamer and Foucault. Translated by Paul Hendrickson. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT, 1996.
  • Krajewski, Bruce, ed. Gadamer’s Repercussions. Berkeley: University of California, 2004.
  • Lugones, Maria. “Playfulness, “World”-Traveling, and Loving Perception,” Hypatia 2 (1987), 3-19.
  • McDowell, John. Mind and World. Cambridge, Mass.,: Harvard, 1996.
  • Michelfelder, Diane P. and Richard E. Palmer. Dialogue and Deconstruction: The  Gadamer-Derrida Encounter. Albany: SUNY, 1989.
  • Orozco, Theresa. “The Art of Allusion: Hans-Georg Gadamer’s Philosophical Interventions Under National Socialism,” Radical Philosophy 78 (1996), 17            26.
  • Ringma, Charles Richard. Gadamer’s Dialogical Hermeneutics. Heidelberg: Universitätsverlag C. Winter, 1999.
  • Rorty, Richard. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature. New Jersey: Princeton, 1979.
  • Rorty, Richard. “Being That Can Be Understood Is Language.” Gadamer’s Repercussions. Ed., Bruce Krajewski. Berkeley: University of California, 2004.
  • Smith, P. Christopher. The Ethical Dimension of Gadamer’s Hermeneutical Theory. Research in Phenomenology 18 (1988), 75-91.
  • Sullivan, Robert. Political Hermeneutics. Pa.: Pennsylvania State University, 1989.
  • Thiselton, Anthony C. The Two Horizons. Grand Rapids: W.B. Eerdmans, 1980.
  • Vilhauer, Monica. Gadamer’s Ethics of Play. Lanham, MD: Lexington, 2010.
  • Warnke, Georgia. Gadamer: Hermeneutics, Tradition and Reason. Stanford: Stanford University, 1987.
  • Warnke, Georgia.Walzer, Rawls, and Gadamer: Hermeneutics and Political Theory. In Festivals of Interpretation, ed. Kathleen Wright. Albany: SUNY, 1990.
  • Warnke, Georgia. Justice and Interpretation. Mass.: MIT, 1993.
  • Warnke, Georgia. Legitimate Differences. Berkeley: University of California, 1999.
  • Weinsheimer, Joel C. Gadamer’s Hermeneutics. New Haven: Yale University, 1999.

 

Author Information

Lauren Swayne Barthold
Email: lsbarthold@gmail.com
Endicott College
U. S. A.

Marie de Rabutin-Chantal, Marquise de Sévigné (1626—1696)

De SevigneMadame de Sévigné was France’s preeminent writer of epistles in the seventeenth century. She appears at first glance to possess few philosophical credentials because she neither received formal philosophical instruction nor composed philosophical treatises. Yet in her extensive correspondence, De Sévigné develops a distinctive position on the philosophical disputes of her era. Rejecting the mechanistic account of nature, she supports a realist philosophy of nature, especially sensitive to the aesthetic structure of the cosmos. Sympathetic to Jansenism, De Sévigné develops a philosophy of God that stresses the divine will and the omnipresence of divine causation. Her moral psychology explores the amatory structure of human desire and the difficulty of accepting one’s mortality. Representative of neoclassicism, her philosophy of art privileges the values of harmony, proportion, and balance. An avid reader of theological and philosophical works, she provides a running commentary on the theories of her favorite contemporary authors. Her letters reflect the intellectual sophistication of the period’s salon culture, where the philosophical controversies spawned by Cartesianism had become the object of everyday discussion.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Works
  3. Philosophical Themes
    1. Nature
    2. Religion
    3. Moral Psychology
    4. Art
    5. Philosophical Chronicle
  4. Reception and Interpretation
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Born on February 5, 1626, Marie de Rabutin-Chantal belonged to an ancient Burgundian aristocratic family. Her most famous ancestor was her paternal grandmother Jeanne de Chantal, the founder of the Visitation order of nuns, who was canonized a saint in 1767. Her father Celse-Bénigne de Rabutin, baron de Chantal, died during battle with the English on the island of Rhé in 1627. Her mother Marie de Coulanges, baroness de Chantal, died in 1633. The guardianship of the orphan passed to her maternal uncle Philippe de Coulanges, abbé de Livry.

Under Coulanges’s direction, the young Marie received a solid classical education.  She studied Italian, Spanish, and Latin. She read passages from Virgil in the original Latin. The poet Jean Chapelain and the linguist Gilles Ménage, who would later write The History of Women Philosophers in1690, served as tutors.

On August 4 1644, Marie married Marquis Henri de Sévigné, scion of an ancient Breton noble family. The newly married couple shared their time between the husband’s ancestral Breton residence, Les Rochers, and their Parisian townhouse in the Place des Vosges, where they participated in the life of the capital’s salons. Madame de Sévigné gave birth to a daughter, Françoise in 1646 and to a son, Charles in 1648. Her husband perished ingloriously in 1651 in the course of a duel he fought over his mistress.

The handsome and wealthy widow was the object of numerous marriage proposals, but Madame de Sévigné never remarried. She became a regular participant in the literary salon of the Hôtel de Rambouillet. During the civil war of the Fronde in1648-52, she alternately opposed and supported the royalist party. She formed a close friendship with finance minister Nicolas Fouquet, whom she would openly support during his trial and imprisonment after he fell from power in the court of Louis XIV.

Among her salon acquaintances, Sévigné counted numerous prominent authors: the memorialist Cardinal de Retz, the novelist Madame Lafayette, the moralist La Rochefocuauld, and the Cartesian essayist Corbinelli. She participated in the literary quarrels of the time, championing Corneille over Racine and becoming the object of satire in works by her cousin, the chronicler Bussy-Rabutin. An avid reader, Sévigné studied a wide range of ancient and modern works. Among the classics, she preferred Virgil, Quintilian, and Tacitus; among Italian authors, Tasso and Ariosto; among French authors, Corneille, Molière, La Fontaine, Montaigne, and Rabelais. In theological literature, she preferred Saint Augustine and the neo-Augustinian authors of the Jansenist movement: Pascal and Nicole. She had a pronounced taste for pulpit oratory, the Jesuit Bourdaloue being her favorite preacher. Her correspondence frequently cited the conversations and books she has encountered. The writings of the neo-Augustinian moralistes proved particularly influential in the development of Sévigné’s philosophical theories.

In 1669 her daughter Françoise de Sévigné married François d’Adhémar, count of Grignan. When the Grignans moved to Provence in 1671 so that the Count of Grignan could fulfill a military commission, Madame de Sévigné faced an emotional crisis. Openly admitting her idolatrous love for her daughter, Sévigné could not accept the daughter’s absence. The solution was the initiation of a correspondence between mother and daughter, which would eventually include hundreds of letters. Her other correspondents included Charles de Sévigné, Abbé de Coulanges, and Bussy-Rabutin.

During her last decades, Sévigné alternated her residence between the estate at Les Rochers and her celebrated Parisian mansion, Hôtel de Carnavalet. She made numerous trips to visit her daughter, who became a partisan of Descartes. Sévigné’s ardent attachment to her daughter was not reciprocated by Madame de Grignan, who found her mother’s frequent letters and visits suffocating. Sévigné fared little better with her son Charles, whose career as a military officer was followed by a life of profligate expenses and sexual dissipation.

Madame de Sévigné died from small pox at Madame de Grignan’s estate on April 17, 1696.

2. Works

The letters of Madame de Sévigné only slowly became a published collection of correspondence. During her lifetime, individual letters were already copied and read by members of her social circle. Circulation of letters and memoirs was not unusual in the era’s salons. The preeminent literary quality of the letters quickly established them as favored salon reading.

Bussy-Rabutin provided the first print version of Sévigné’s letters, embedded within editions of his own writings, published in 1696, 1697, and 1709. Her granddaughter Madame de Simiane supervised the first edition of her letters to Madame de Grignan in 1726; Chevalier de Perrin published a corrected edition of these letters in 1734, 1737, and 1754. An edition of newly discovered letters was published in 1773. The eighteenth-century editions of Sévigné’s correspondence should be treated with caution since the editors often corrected the prose of the letters to suit the tastes of the period.

In the nineteenth century the recognizable canon of Sévigné’s correspondence emerged. L.-J.-N. Monmerqué, after publishing editions of previously unpublished letters in 1824 and 1827, edited the 14-volume edition of the complete correspondence of Sévigné. This volume included letter fragments and newly discovered, previously unpublished, letters in 1862-66. After many expanded editions of her writings, Roger Duchêne’s 3-volume critical edition of Sévigné’s correspondence published in 1972-78 became the standard reference for scholars.

The wide diffusion of Sévigné’s writings was due primarily to the French academic establishment. Beginning in the nineteenth century, French secondary school officials used textbook and anthology versions of Sévigné’s letters to provide students with a model of epistolary French prose. Countless French courses throughout the French empire and the non-Francophone world followed the lead of French education ministers and incorporated the works of Sévigné into their curriculum.

3. Philosophical Themes

Madame de Sévigné repeatedly admits to her daughter, an ardent disciple of Descartes, that she is not a systematic philosopher. Despite this, in her correspondence, Sévigné presents her personal position on contested philosophical questions of the day. In many passages she defends her theories concerning nature, religion, moral psychology, and art. If conversant with the Cartesianism of the salons, she is personally more sympathetic to the austere Jansenism of Pascal. Her correspondence is a chronicle of the philosophical debates of her era. As Sévigné recounts in salon conversations and in comments on her extensive reading, one overhears the philosophical quarrels which agitated the learned aristocracy of the period.

a. Nature

As commentators have long noted, Sévigné’s account of nature often appears to be a forerunner of romanticism. Nature is the place of an incomparable beauty best pursued in disciplined solitude. Sévigné opposes the Cartesian conception of nature as a machine reducible to mathematical attributes of extension and movement.

Sévigné’s opposition to the mechanistic theory of nature appears most clearly in her defense of nonhuman animals as ensouled beings. The easily observable conduct of pets indicates the mental and volitional actions of which they are capable.

Speak…about your machines, the machines which love, the machines which make an election of someone, the machines which are jealous, the machines which fear. Now go on; you are mocking us. Descartes never should have tried to make us believe this [Letter to Madame de Grignan; September 15, 1680].

The Cartesian theory of the machine-beast defies the data of common sense and empties nature of the various ensouled entities which populate it.

Sévigné praises those Cartesians who reject the mechanistic account of animals and defend the theory of the thinking animal.

He [Abbé de Montigny] spoke about the small parts [Cartesian language for atoms, the smallest particles of material objects] with this bishop [Bishop of Léon], who is a red-hot Cartesian, but with the same passion he also supported the theory that animals think [Letter to Madame de Grignan; September 2, 1671].

Opposed to the mechanistic conception of nature, Sévigné conceives nature in aesthetic terms. Nature is a place of enchantment where the engaged observer experiences a beauty which exists in no other physical setting.

These woods are always beautiful; their greenness is a hundred times more beautiful than that of Livry. I do not know whether it is due to the quality of the trees or to the freshness of the rains, but there can be no comparison. Everything today has the same green it had during the month of May. The leaves which fall are dead but those holding on are still green. You have never gazed on such beauty [Letter to Madame de Grignan; October 20, 1675].

The site of ecstatic beauty, nature becomes quasi-miraculous.

Such beautiful natural sites serve a key anthropological purpose: they permit human beings to exercise the soul’s highest faculties in solitude. In many passages Sévigné summons her daughter to experience the spiritual peace possible only within the solitary embrace of nature.

You are thirsting to be alone. Then by God, my beloved, come to our woods! It is a perfect solitude. We are having such splendid weather there that I spend all day there until night arrives. I think about you there a thousand or two thousand times with such tenderness that I would betray it if I believed I could describe it in writing [Letter to Madame de Grignan; December 22, 1675].

It is in such a natural oasis that the soul’s capacity for introspection, religious contemplation, and loving desire can flourish.

The garden constitutes the summit of human art, perfecting the bounty of nature and transforming it for the purposes of the meditative soul.

We are in a perfect solitude here and I find myself better for it. This park is much more beautiful than anything you have ever seen. The shade created by my small trees creates a beauty that was not so well projected by the sticks we used to have [Letter to Madame de Grignan; July 19, 1671].

In such a perfected natural refuge human thought and desire can reach their apex.

b. Religion

Many passages in the correspondence deal with theological issues. Sévigné’s concept of God draws primarily from Jansenism.This neo-Augustinian movement stresses divine sovereignty, predestination, the depth of human sinfulness, and complete dependence on grace for salvation. Her letters reference the many Jansenist authors who shape her theological perspective: Blaise Pascal, Pierre Nicole, Antoine Arnauld, Robert Arnauld d’Andilly, and Saint-Cyran. She describes the convent of Port Royal-des-Champs, the citadel of the Jansenist movement, with the enthusiasm of an acolyte.

This Port-Royal is a Thebiade [an austere, secluded place similar to that inhabited by the desert fathers of the church]. It is paradise. It is a desert where all the devotion of Christianity is spread out. It is a holiness radiating out into all the territory for a mile around it. There are five or six unknown solitaries [lay male auxiliaries of the convent] who live like the penitents in the days of John Climacus [a theologian of the desert fathers]. The nuns are angels on earth [Letter to Madame de Grignan; January 26, 1674].

Nonetheless, Sévigné absorbs this Jansenist theological culture with her characteristic moderation and irony. When a dispute breaks out over whether Jansenists should give written submission in relation to a church condemnation of several theses allegedly defended by Jansenius, she sides with neither the seigneuses nor the nonseigneuses.

Here is another example of caution. Our sisters of Saint Martha told me, “At last, may God be praised!  God has touched the heart of this poor child [a signeuese]; she has been placed in the path of obedience and salvation.” From there I went to Port-Royal.  There I found a certain esteemed solitaire that you know.  He started by telling me, “Well, this poor gosling has signed.  Finally, God has abandoned her.  She has jumped away from him.”  As for myself, I thought I would die laughing in reflecting on their preoccupations.  Now, here is the world in all its natural color.  I believe that the middle between these extremities is always better [Letter to Madame de Grignan; November 21, 1664].

Faithful to Jansenist theology, Sévigné stresses the divine will as God’s central attribute.  Even the smallest occurrences in everyday life reflect the silent work of God’s ordering of time.  The fulcrum of Sévigné’s emotional life, the rhythm of physical separation and union with her daughter is ultimately governed by God’s volition.

My dearly beloved, we’ve arrived at the point where we must go, must desire, and must pass our days one after the other just as God has pleased to give them to us. Following your example, I want to abandon myself to the sweet hope of seeing and embracing you in the upcoming month.  I want to believe that God will permit us to have this perfect joy, although nothing in the world is so easy as adding some bitterness to this joy, if we so desire. There is no moment of rest in this life. It is a goodness of Providence that that we make a truce concerning those sad reflections which could clearly disturb us on a daily basis [Letter to Madame de Grignan; Letter of July 1, 1685].

Psychological movements and physical actions reflect God’s sovereign will in the working out of history.

This omnipresence of the divine will’s activity is expressed as divine providence in the life in the individual. Discrete events in an individual’s life express in fact a providential design for the person.

Providence guides us with so much goodness in all these different times of our life that we practically do not feel it at all. This movement takes place very gradually; it is imperceptible. It is the quiet hand of the sundial we do not see at work. If at the age of twenty, we were given a glimpse of our older state in our family and someone made us see in the mirror the face we have now and the face we will have when we are sixty, the comparison between the two would make us collapse. We would be terrified. But we advance day by day. Today we are like yesterday; tomorrow we will be like today. Thus, we move on without feeling it. This is one of the miracles of Providence which I adore [Letter to Moulceau; January 27, 1687].

Under the guise of Providence, the divine will’s actions become an object of devotion.

The light of faith reveals the presence of divine providence at work in what appear to be unrelated episodes of human action, although the nature and outcome of the divine will’s actions remain obscure.

We cannot see underneath the cards, but it is this Providence which guides us along these extraordinary paths. Far from revealing the end of the novel, this action does not permit us to draw any conclusions from it or to offer any reproaches against it. Therefore, we must return to our starting point and accept without murmuring all that it pleases God to do to us [Letter to Bussy-Rabutin; August 13, 1688].

This emphasis on the inscrutable nature of divine providence echoes the Jansenist insistence on the radical darkening of the human intellect, occasioned by the fall and propagated by human concupiscence.

Sévigné’s emphasis on the omnipresence of divine providence tends to reduce all causation to one cause: God. Like other Jansenist philosophers, Sévigné so underscores the omnipotence and sovereignty of God that secondary causes tend to recede, if not to disappear.

As Monsieur d’Angers says, one must let God do as he wills and ceaselessly look to his will and his providence. Without that, there is no other way to live in the world. Otherwise, one will do nothing but complain about all these poor secondary causes [Letter to Madame de Grignan; July 1, 1685].

Part of metaphysical wisdom is to grasp the unique divine causation operative behind the apparent and often contradictory secondary causes. These causes wrongly dominate the concerns of most human beings.

The philosophical emphasis on divine causation is tied to a theological emphasis on the doctrine of predestination. Even in small gestures of piety, it is the divine will which causes the virtuous actions of the Christian subject. The sacramental action of a friend of Sévigné illustrates this truth.

God gave her a very particular grace, one which indicates a true predestination. It is that she went to confession on the octave of Corpus Christ with a perfect disposition and an affection that could only come from God. She then received Our Lord [in communion] in the same manner [Letter to Madame de Guitaut; June 3, 1693].

The devout soul died shortly afterward in the state of grace.

Given the centrality of the will among the divine attributes, surrender to God’s will becomes the central spiritual disposition to be cultivated by the human subject. Indeed, sanctity is nothing but complete submission to the divine will. Sévigné’s moral portrait of her friend Corbinelli underscores the volitional foundation of sanctity.

He is a man who only thinks about destroying his own willfulness, who never ceases to commune with the enemies of the devil, who are the saints of the church, a man who counts as nothing his miserable body, who suffers poverty Christianly (you would say philosophically), who never ceases to celebrate the perfections and the existence of God, who passes his life in charity and service of his neighbor, who does not seek his own delights and pleasures, and who is completely submitted to the will of God [Letter to Madame de Grignan; January 15, 1690].

Like other Jansenist authors, Sévigné does not explain why this submission to the divine will is so important and so difficult, given the existence of a deterministic universe in which the divine will is omnipresent.

Authentic abandonment to the divine will manifests itself by a sharp opposition to the world. Sévigné’s portrait of a friend who has recently undergone a religious conversion indicates the strictness of this separation.

She told me it was true that God had given her graces, for which she was profoundly grateful. These graces are nothing other but a profound faith, a tender love of God, and a horror of the world, accompanied by a great distrust of herself and of her weaknesses. She is convinced that if she takes a pause from this for a moment, the divine grace would evaporate [Letter to Madame de Grignan; January 15, 1674.]

Echoing neo-Augustinian theology, this rigorous flight from the world stresses the grave sinfulness and concupiscence of a world disfigured by the fall and original sin.

Sévigné openly admits her own incapacity to live the austere renunciation from the world which she commends in her writing. She often laments her own spiritual mediocrity.

One of my great desires is to be devout….I belong neither to God nor to the devil. This state disturbs me, but between us, I find it the most natural thing in the world. We are not given to the devil because we fear God and at bottom we have religious principles; we are not given to God because his law is hard and because we don’t like to destroy ourselves. This is how the tepid operate. Their great number doesn’t bother me at all. But God hates them. So I must leave this state; there is the problem [Letter to Madame de Grignan; June 10, 1671].

Like many salonnières sympathetic to Jansenism, with its rigorous asceticism, Sévigné discovers that her aristocratic lifestyle would permit her to follow the path of renunciation only so far.

In developing her religious philosophy, Sévigné criticized two intellectual currents which she finds to be erroneous: libertinism and the Molinism of the Jesuits. Among the libertines, she singled out Ninon de Lenclos (1620-1705) for specific criticism. A religious skeptic and an emblem of sexual license, Lenclos embodied the anti-Christian creed of the more freethinking salons. “This Ninon is dangerous! If you knew how she dogmatized about religion, you would be horrified. Her zeal for perverting young people is similar to that of Monsieur Saint-Germain, whom we once saw at Livry” [Letter to Madame de Grignan; April 1, 1671]. Sévigné’s invective against Lenclos was sharpened by the fact that her own son Charles had been involved in a liaison with the famous courtesan. She also recognizes that Lenclos represented an intellectual threat to Christian orthodoxy because  the courtesan promoted her sensual Epicureanism through a series of lectures she presented at her salon and a series of letters distributed by her admirers.

Luis de Molina (1535-1600) and his Jesuit confreres propagated  another extreme in the long-simmering theological quarrel over grace ,the error of Molinism, an exaggerated defense of the role of free will in the act of salvation. Sévigné lamented the leaning of one of her granddaughters toward Molinism after having abandoned the strict Augustinianism of the convent of Gif. “It is certain that after having been at the school of Saint Augustine she finds herself at the school of Molina. This is not something to be endured” [Letter to Madame de Grignan; July 1, 1685]. Both the materialism of the salon libertines and the spiritual libertarianism of the Jesuits erred in their divergences from the Jansenist theories of divine causation, divine sovereignty, human sinfulness, free will, and the operations of grace.

c. Moral Psychology

Like other moralistes of the period, Sévigné studies the various psychic states of the human subject, especially those states which reveal a divided heart. She openly admits the many occasions when she herself participates in this psychological perplexity. Two phenomena in particular attract her analytic attention: the experience of human love and the difficulty in accepting one’s mortality.

In the era’s salon debates, the passion of love held pride of place. Salon authors disputed the nature of love, puzzled over its power, and distinguished the various gradations of love. In her own reflections on love, Sévigné considers love a passion so powerful that it structures personal time. The beginning, end, and recommencement of loving relationships constitute one’s personal history.

I don’t believe that I have ever read anything as moving as the account you [Bussy-Rabutin] have given me of your farewell to your mistress. Your point that love is a true re-commencer is so beautiful and so true that I am astonished that, although I’ve thought this a thousand times, I never had the wit to say it. Sometimes I’ve even noticed that friendship wanted to insert itself into this in order to alter love and that in its own way it was also a true re-commencer [Letter to Bussy-Rabutin; October 7, 1655].

The passage attends to the gradations of love, such as the difference between romantic love and more disinterested friendship. In its various guises, this passion shapes the human psyche by its incessant starts, ends, and revivals.

The empire of love reveals the irreducible power of emotions in human life. Sévigné openly admits that the passions are so dominant in her own personality that she could never subscribe to the fashionable Stoicism of the salons; a moral code based on reason and duty alone would be insupportable.

Love my tenderness, love my weaknesses. As for myself, I am very well adjusted to them.  I like them far more than the sentiments of Seneca and Epictetus. My dear child, I am sentimental and affectionate up to the point of madness [Letter to Madame de Grignan; March 18, 1671].

Sévigné recognizes that in her ardent affection for her daughter love has reached the level of idolatry. The attempt to eliminate and reduce the power of love and associated passions like anger can only end in failure.

The letters also reflect a preoccupation with death.  As many commentators have noted, Sévigné dwells at length on the state funerals of France’s leading political and military figures.  She has a particular love for the genre of the funeral oration. In Sévigné’s perspective, the capacity to face and accept one’s mortality constitutes an essential trait of psychological maturity. Only then can one grasp one’s proper position in a mortal, perishing universe governed by an eternal God.

Life is brief and you [Bussy-Rabutin] are already well advanced in age. There’s no need to become impatient about it. This consolation [during a moment of misfortune] is a sad one and this remedy to your ill is worse than bad. Nonetheless, it should have its effect; so should the scarcely happier thought of the little place we have in the universe and how, in the end, it matters little whether the Count de Bussy was happy or unhappy. I know that during the tiny moment we are in this life we want to be completely happy but we must be convinced that nothing is more impossible and that if you didn’t have the worries you currently have, you would have others, according to the order of Providence [Letter to Bussy-Rabutin; August 13, 1688].

Sobering, the frank recognition of one’s mortality and one’s finiteness in the divine scheme of the universe permits the human subject to place the emotional turmoil in the pursuit of happiness within a framework of resignation.

d. Art

From the time of her early correspondence with her tutor Ménage, Sévigné revealed her aesthetic preoccupations. Many letters present her critical judgments concerning particular authors, books, and dramas. Her aesthetic judgment reflects the neoclassical tastes of her milieu; harmony, balance, and proportion emerge as the central traits of artistic quality.  Questions of form dominate her critical evaluation of the artworks which pass under review.

In literature, the capacity to appreciate a work lies largely in the ability to detect and savor its interior harmony. The classics of antiquity and the Italian Renaissance reveal this interior proportion.

Your readings are good. Petrarch must entertain you with the commentary you have. The one Mademoiselle Scudéry has made for us on certain sonnets makes them pleasant to read. As for Tacitus, you know how I was charmed by him during your recitations and how I often interrupted you to make you understand the passages where I found some harmony [Letter to Madame de Grignan; June 28, 1671].

The ability to isolate and appreciate the interior balance of a literary work is the central condition for its proper aesthetic appreciation. Despite her preference for the dramas of Corneille, Sévigné admits her admiration for Racine’s Esther. Originally performed by the students at Madame de Maintenon’s academy at Saint-Cyr, the biblical drama perfectly allies religious truth to a careful balance of its component parts.

As for Esther, I am in no way taking back all the praise which I already gave it.  All my life I will be delighted by the perfection and the novelty of the show. I am thrilled by it.  I found in it a thousand things so right, so well placed, so important to say to a king, that I would be delighted with the greatest conviction to say that it presented the greatest truths as it entertained and sang to us. I was moved by all these different beauties [Letter to Madame de Grignan; Letter of March 23, 1689].

Allied to the scriptural truths of supplication by an oppressed Israel, Esther provokes this aesthetic delight through its careful arrangement of a thousand things in a perfect harmony. It is this formal composition of disparate parts which constitutes the poignant beauty of Racine’s drama.

As in literature and theater, harmony forms the key criterion in the judgment of visual art. A spectacular temporary mausoleum designed by Le Brun in the church of the Oratoire elicits Sévigné’s praise. The exhibit not only perfectly balances its physical decorations; it brilliantly evokes the spiritual balance among the fine arts and among the moral virtues.

The mausoleum touched the ceiling and was decorated with a thousand lights and several figures appropriate to the deceased one wanted to praise. Four skeletons at the bottom were decorated with marks of his dignity, as if they had removed his honors as they had removed his life. One of them carried his staff, another his ducal crown, another signs of his rank, another the vestment of chancellor. The four Arts were bent over and desolate because they had lost their protector: they were Painting, Music, Eloquence, and Sculpture. Four Virtues supported the previous presentation: Force, Justice, Temperance, and Religion. Four angels or four genies received this beautiful soul above it all. In addition, the mausoleum was decorated with angels who held up a funeral tent suspended from the ceiling. Nowhere has there ever been anything so magnificent, so perfectly imagined. It is the masterpiece of Le Brun [Letter to Madame de Grignan; May 6, 1672].

It is the intricate harmony among the varied physical, aesthetic, moral, and religious components which gives Le Brun’s baroque construction its overwhelming aesthetic impact.

In her valorization of aesthetic pleasure, Sévigné criticizes a censorship which would eliminate certain works of art on the grounds of alleged immorality. “You know that I do not accommodate myself well with all this prudery which does not come naturally to me. I don’t consent to no longer like these [morally questionable] books. I let myself be amused by them” [Letter to Madame de Grignan; July 5, 1671]. As an example of such morally questionable reading, she cites her reading of the works of Rabelais with her son Charles.

e. Philosophical Chronicle

In addition to the presentation of her own philosophical opinions, Sévigné provides a chronicle of the philosophical culture of the salon. Many of her letters describe the Cartesianism and anti-Cartesianism which had become a central feature of the intellectual culture of French salons in the middle of the seventeenth century. An avid reader, Sévigné often confides her reactions to the theories expounded by the fashionable philosophers of the day.

Among her chronicles of Cartesianism is Sévigné’s description of a philosophical debate which occurred in her own Breton home. The disputants weigh the merits of the Cartesian theory of innate ideas against the neo-Aristotelian theory of the role of sensation in the generation of knowledge.

We had here a little tempest of men and of theories and the next day was another scene.  Monsieur de Montmoron, who as you know is quite intelligent, arrived; then there was Father Damaie, who lives only twenty leagues from here; and then my son, whom as you know excels in debate; and then we had some letters from Corbinelli….Monsieur de Montmoron knows your [Madame de Grignan’s] philosophy and contests it on every point. My son defended your father [Descartes]; Damaie was with him and the letters supported him. But three against one wasn’t too strong for Montmoron. He said that we could only have ideas of what had entered our minds through our senses. My son said that we could think independently of our senses: for example, we think what we think [Letter to Madame de Grignan; September 15, 1680].

Typically, Sévigné takes no personal position on the dispute concerning the Cartesian theory of innate ideas, which she faithfully reports. With her usual irony she deflates the philosophical dispute by emphasizing the entertaining (divertissement) nature of the controversy.

Sévigné not only chronicles the Cartesian controversies which characterized her social milieu; her vocabulary is saturated with Cartesian terms. “Innate ideas” (idées innées) echo Descartes’s epistemology; “whirlwinds” (tourbillons) Descartes’s physics; “animal spirits” (esprits d’animaux )Descartes’s biology; “brain traces” (traces dans le cerveau) Descartes’s philosophy of mind. Sévigné’s allegiance to Cartesianism is at best ambiguous.  Her references to her daughter’s passion for Descartes are often ironic. Her philosophy of nature and of religion opposes central Cartesian theories.

A lifelong reader of philosophical works, Sévigné acquired a first-hand grasp of the philosophical controversies of the period through reading the most influential French philosophical authors of the day. Her correspondence alludes to Descartes’s Discourse of Method, Meditations, and Passions of the Soul; Malebranche’s Christian Conversations; and Pascal’s Provincial Letters and Pensées.  But her favored philosophical author was Pierre Nicole (1625-95), a priest closely associated with the Jansenist movement. During Sévigné’s lifetime, Nicole was best known as a moralist for his popular series of Essais morales (1671-78). In twenty-first century philosophy he is best known as the co-author of The Logic of Port-Royal (1662).

It is his presentation of the virtues essential for the Christian life that attracts Sévigné to Nicole. His concept of the virtue of detachment is especially helpful for the acquisition of personal peace.

I find your [Madame de Grignan’s] reflection very good and very right concerning the indifference he [Nicole] wants us to have concerning the approval or disapproval of our neighbors. Like you, I think this requires a little grace and that philosophy alone cannot bring it about. He places peace and union with our neighbor on such a high level and counsels us to acquire this at the expense of so many other things that there is no way after all this that we could be anything but indifferent as to what others think of us [Letter to Madame de Grignan; November 4, 1671].

This detachment from self-concern is the fruit of an austere charity which seeks nothing but the service of one’s esteemed neighbor. In a typically Jansenist note, this peaceful self-possession can only come about through the operation of grace; reliance on philosophical reason alone inevitably falls short.

Another Jansenist trait of Nicole’s theory of virtue lies in his unmasking of natural moral virtues as covers for vice. The declared love of truth in violent philosophical disputes barely conceals the pride and willfulness of the disputants. “What he [Nicole] says about the pride and self-love one finds in all the disputes, which one covers up with the fine name of love of truth, is a point which overwhelms me” [Letter to Madame de Grignan; November 4, 1671]. Rooted in complete submission to the divine will, only the theological virtues can lead the human subject to an authentic moral life. The natural virtues defended by philosophers in their ardent disputes are often little more than the expression of self-interest and self-love.

4. Reception and Interpretation

From the time of the first publication of Madame de Sévigné’s works in the eighteenth century, the reception of her writings has been primarily literary. Literary critics have long analyzed the limpid prose style of Sévigné with its distinctive mix of naturel with vivacité. More historical critics have studied how the letters of Sévigné reflect the society of her time, especially the aristocratic subculture of the salon. Historians have paid special attention to Sévigné’s detailed chronicle of the trial of Fouquet; it constitutes one of the most detailed descriptions of judicial procedure in early modern literature. Sévigné has proved especially influential in subsequent generations of women authors. George Eliot, Elizabeth Gaskell, and Virginia Woolf praised Sévigné as a pioneer of the writing woman.

Twenty-first century commentators have developed a more philosophical analysis of Sévigné’s thought. Lyons in 2011 explores in what sense Sévigné can be classified as a philosophe; Reguig-Naya in 2002 studies the specific link between Sévigné and Descartes and Cartesianism. Several commentators interpret Sévigné’s philosophy from a gendered perspective. Montfort in 2008 employs a feminist angle; Longino Farrell in 1991 uses the category of maternal thinking. Other studies analyze Sévigné’s epistemology (Racevskis, 2002), moral theory (Cartmill, 2001), philosophy of language (Allentuch, 2008), and concept of imagination (Lyons, 2005). Sévigné’s philosophy of nature and theology invite further research.

5. References and Further Reading

All French to English translations above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

  • Sévigné, Marie de Rabutin-Chantal, marquise de. Correspondance, 3 vols.,ed Roger Duchêne.  Paris: Gallimard, 1972-78.
    • Duchêne’s magisterial critical edition of Sévigné’s correspondence has become the edition of reference for scholars.
  • Sévigné, Marie de Rabutin-Chantal, marquise de. Selected Letters, trans. and ed. Leonard Tancock. London: Penguin Books, 1982.
    • Tancock’s popular translation of Sévigné’s letters provides a useful guide to the principal persons cited by Sévigné and who serve as her correspondents.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Allentuch, Harriet R. “Setting Feelings to Words: Language and Emotion in the Letters of Madame de Sévigné,” in Literature Criticism from 1400 to 1800, Vol. 140, eds. T. Schoenberg and L. Trudeau.  Farmington Hills, MI: Thomson Gale, 2008: 205-225.
    • The article explores the link between emotion and linguistic expression in the correspondence.
  • Bernet, Anne. Madame de Sévigné, Mère Passion. Paris: Perrin, 1996.
    • The biography examines the relationship between Sévigné’s personal emotions and her theory of the passions.
  • Cartmill, Constance. “Madame de Sévigné et les maximes du marriage,” Dalhousie French Studies 2001 Fall; 56: 98-107.
    • The article explores the moral positions defended by Sévigné in her counsels on marriage.
  • Duchêne, Roger. Madame de Sévigné, ou, La chance d’être femme. Paris: Fayard, 1982.
    • The book uses a gendered perspective to present the biography of Sévigné.
  • Duchêne, Roger. Naissances d’un écrivain: Madame de Sévigné. Paris: Fayard, 1996.
    • The biography underlines the central stages in the development of Sévigné’s writing.
  • Farrell, Michèle Longino. Performing Motherhood: The Sévigné Correspondence. Hanover, NH: University Press of New England, 1991.
    • This biography explores the various maternal poses adopted by Sévigné in her dealings with her daughter.
  • Lyons, John D. Before Imagination and Embodied Thought from Montaigne to Rousseau. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2005: 122-147.
    • The book’s chapter on Sévigné explores how she used the imagination to deal with various experiences of loss and grief.
  • Lyons, John D. “The Marquise de Sévigné: Philosophe,” in Teaching Seventeenth and Eighteenth-Century Women Writers, ed. Faith Beasely. New York, NY: Modern Language Association of America, 2011: 178-187.
    • The article examines the various ways in which Sévigné can be considered a philosophe.
  • Montfort, Catherine R. “Mme de Sévigné: Seventeenth-Century Feminist?” in Literature Criticism from 1400 to 1800, vol. 140, eds. T. Schoenberg and L. Trudeau. Farmington Hills, MI: Thomson Gale: 114-132.
    • The book chapter approaches Sévigné’s writing from a feminist perspective.
  • Racevskis, Richard. “Time and Ways of Knowing under Louis XIV: Molière, Sévigné, Lafayette,” in Bucknell Studies in Eighteenth-Century Literature and Culture. Lewisburg, PA: Bucknell University Press, 2003: 76-84.
    • The book chapter compares Sévigné’s epistemology with that of her artistic contemporaries.
  • Reguig-Naya, Delphine. “Descartes à la lettre: poétique épistolaire et philosophie mondaine chez Mme de Sévigné,” in Dix-septième siècle 2002: no. 216: 152-171.
    • The article offers a careful analysis of the various ways Cartesian concepts and terms penetrate Sévigné’s vocabulary.

 

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University Maryland
U. S. A.

Jeanne-Françoise Frémyot, Baronne de Chantal (1572—1641)

photo of de ChantalCanonized a Catholic saint in 1767, Jeanne de Chantal (Jane of Chantal) has rarely been the object of philosophical analysis.  Until recently, her influence has largely confined itself to the Visitation order she founded and to the network of schools sponsored by the Visitation nuns.  Contemporary theologians, however, have studied her works from the perspective of spirituality. Her extensive writings provide an elaborate map of the soul’s journey toward perfection; they also indicate the charismatic authority of women in the ministry of spiritual direction and moral counsel during the era.  De Chantal’s lectures, conferences, and letters merit philosophical attention inasmuch as they constitute an early modern chapter in moral psychology.  Their ascetical concept of moral virtue and their mystical account of the soul reflect a theory of human nature embedded in the convent culture of the Counter-Reformation in France.  Destined for a convent audience, her commentaries on the writings of Saint Augustine constitute a gendered Augustinianism adapted to the needs of an exclusively female public.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Works
  3. Theological Philosophy
    1. Virtue Theory
    2. Nature and Will
    3. Divine Attributes
    4. Augustinianism
  4. Reception and Interpretation
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Born on January 23, 1572 in Dijon, Jeanne-Françoise Frémyot belonged to a prominent Burgundian family of lawyers.  Her father, Bénigne Frémyot, was the president of the Parliament of Burgundy and a leader of the royalist party.  Her mother, Marguerite de Berbisey, a descendant of the family of St. Bernard of Clairvaux, died when Jeanne-Françoise was only eighteen months old.  Her widowed father then married Claire Jousset, who is believed to have died shortly after the marriage.

Educated at home, Jeanne-Françoise studied reading, writing, music, and dancing.  She excelled in embroidery; throughout her life she would be renowned for her needlework.  Her father personally supervised her study of history, morals, and religion.

On December 29, 1592, Jeanne-Françoise married Christophe II de Rabutin, baron de Chantal.  Residing at his ancestral castle of Bourbilly, Madame de Chantal soon revealed her skill as an administrator by reforming the economics and work habits of the dilapidated estate.  She also gained a saintly reputation for her work among the sick and the poor, especially during the region’s times of famine.  She bore six children, three of whom survived into adulthood: Celse-Bégnine (1596-1633), Marie-Aimée (1598-1617), and Françoise (1599-1684).  Her husband died as the result of a hunting accident in 1601.  During her prolonged period of mourning, Madame de Chantal made a private vow to God that she would remain celibate during the remainder of her life and that, once her children were sufficiently old, she would devote herself to works of charity.

In 1604, De Chantal’s spiritual life reached a turning point.  She met François de Sales, the bishop of Geneva who was living in exile in Annecy, due to Calvinist opposition. He delivered a series of Lenten sermons in Dijon.  Agreeing to serve as her spiritual director, De Sales introduced the widow to his own spirituality, most notably expressed in his Introduction to the Devout Life.  He also introduced her to his more philosophical works.  Drawing from Thomas Aquinas and Teresa of Avila, his Treatise on the Love of God provided an extensive Augustinian presentation of God’s attributes, the nature of the soul, and the virtues essential for the ascetical and mystical life.  In their correspondence De Sales shared with De Chantal extracts from the treatise in progress.

In 1610, believing that she was free to leave her adolescent children in the care of others, De Chantal left her home to join François de Sales in Annecy.  Her eldest child, Celeste-Bégnine, the future father of Madame de Sévigné, would long resent what he considered an unjustified abandonment.  In the same year, she founded a new female religious order, the Visitation of Holy Mary, with De Sales.  The new order was to differ from current religious orders in several details.  The nuns were not to be cloistered.  They would make simple rather than solemn vows.  They would wear the simple clothes of the poor rather than religious habits.  They would regularly leave the convent to minister to the poor, the sick, and the elderly in their homes.  The order’s rule of life would be comparatively gentle, proper for candidates for the convent who might be elderly or suffer from physical disabilities.  The order quickly grew from its original foundation in Annecy, but it underwent a crisis in 1615 when the Archbishop of Lyons insisted that the order adopt a constitution, which would impose strict cloister on the nuns.  De Chantal and De Sales protested since such restriction would destroy the announced apostolate of the order.  However, in 1618, with Pope Urban VIII supporting the demand for cloister, the co-founders acquiesced.  By the time of De Sales’s death in 1622, the order had thirteen houses. By the time of De Chantal’s death, it would count eighty-six.

From her headquarters in Annecy, De Chantal directed the order as its superior general.  Besides frequent visitations to the order’s daughter houses, she maintained an extensive correspondence with her fellow nuns, benefactors, and laypeople seeking spiritual direction.  Copied in manuscript form, her frequent lectures and conferences at Annecy were widely circulated among Visitation convents and other religious communities.  During her lifetime she acquired a reputation for sanctity, although she often confided in her more intimate writings that she suffered from spiritual aridity and desolation during the decade preceding her death.

Her letters and addresses indicate the philosophical and theological culture she had developed, especially under the tutelage of De Sales.  The works of De Sales constitute the most cited theological and philosophical sources.  Among patristic authors, she often quotes St. Augustine and St. Jerome.  She has a pronounced interest in the ascetical and mystical writers of the Spanish Counter-Reformation: Teresa of Ávila, Alphonsus Rodríguez, and Álvarez de Paz.  Her virtue theory is clearly influenced by these authors.  Other women authors cited by De Chantal include Catherine of Siena and Madame Acarie, the founder of the reformed French Carmelites.

Madame de Chantal died on December 13, 1641.  The Catholic Church beatified her in 1751 and canonized her a saint in 1767.

2. Works

The works of Jeanne de Chantal are exclusively religious in focus.  Several hundred letters from her extensive correspondence have survived.  She also wrote a long memorandum for the canonization process of François de Sales, Deposition for the Process of Beatification of St François de Sales and Responses Concerning Rules, Constitutions, and Customs, in which the superior general offered her interpretation of disputed points concerning the Visitation order’s charism and regulations.  Many of the works of De Chantal were originally oral in nature.  Visitation nuns transcribed her many addresses to nuns. These addresses included exhortations on spiritual topics such as the Rule of Saint Augustine, liturgical feasts, and occasional topics. More informal conferences, in which De Chantal answered questions posed by the nuns in assembly were also transcribed, as well as instructions given to novices at the very beginning of their convent life.  The written transcriptions of these addresses should be treated with caution, since De Chantal’s actual words are often altered by the taste and perspective of the particular amanuensis.  These addresses are of special philosophical interest because in these works De Chantal gives her most detailed theory of the virtues, of the nature of the soul, and of the divine attributes.  The Visitation nuns circulated manuscript copies of these writings among the Visitation convents.  Many of the original manuscripts remain in the archives at the Visitation motherhouse in Annecy.

During the lifetime of De Chantal, print versions of her works were already circulating.  De Chantal objected to some of these publications since she wanted to confine most of her writings to circulation within the order.  Shortly after her death, hagiographic biographies of the foundress circulated alongside the print versions of her writings.  The 1751 beatification and 1767 canonization stimulated new interested in writings by and about De Chantal.

In the nineteenth century, the Visitation nuns at Annecy published the collected works of Madame de Chantal in Ste Jeanne Françoise Frémyot de Chantal, Sa vie et ses oeuvres (1874-1879.)  The Visitation scholar Patricia Burns has recently published a critical edition of De Chantal’s letters in Jeanne-Françoise Frémyot de Chantal, Correspondance (1986-1996).  The Visitation nuns have also been largely responsible for the English translation of the works of De Chantal.  The Visitation convent of Harrow published Selected Letters of Saint Jane Frances de Chantal (1918). The Visitation convent of Bristol provided the translation for Saint Jane Frances Frémyot de Chantal, Exhortations, Conferences and Instructions (1929).  The Visitation scholar Péronne Marie Thibert translated De Chantal’s letters for Francis de Sales and Jane de Chantal, Letters of Spiritual Direction (1988).

3. Theological Philosophy

The philosophical arguments of De Chantal are embedded in a specific theological project: the guidance of nuns and laywomen toward perfection in Christ in the communion of the Catholic Church.  The virtues defended by De Chantal are distinctively Christian with a strong monastic coloration.  The analysis of the will emerges in the context of exhortations concerning the will’s perilous ascent toward union with God. Other faculties of the soul are studied through their relationship to the practice of prayer.  The moral theory and philosophical psychology of De Chantal are situated in a context which has the convent as its primary audience and pedagogical concern.

a. Virtue Theory

In De Chantal’s works the standard moral virtues receive comparatively little attention.  The discussions of temperance, fortitude, and justice are spare and indirect.  De Chantal instead emphasizes virtues with a clear theological, indeed monastic, color: charity, humility, abnegation, and abandonment to the divine will.  The moral habits prized by De Chantal reflect the distinctive culture of the convent, of the Visitation order with its stress on ascetical moderation, and of the Counter-Reformation with its mystical narrative of the soul in gradual ascent toward ecstatic union with God.

Humility constitutes the cornerstone of the edifice of virtue.  More than simple meekness, humility entails a recognition of one’s utter dependence upon God for existence and salvation.  “Humility of heart is nothing else than the genuine knowledge that we are nothing and that we can do nothing.  It is desiring with a true desire that others should hold and treat us as such.  What is called humility of heart makes us always annihilate ourselves in everything, without exception, and makes us consider ourselves always better treated and esteemed than we deserve” [Conference no. 40].  The emphasis on the annihilation of self as a psychological sign of true humility is typical of the era’s école française of spirituality, with its characteristic emphasis on annihilation (anéantissement) of personal desire as one of the signs of true union with God.

Humility enjoys a certain primacy among the virtues because it alone can perfect the internal life of the soul.  Once humility has been acquired, the moral agent’s other internal dispositions and even external actions will find their proper place.  “We do not apply ourselves to the true and solid interior virtues.  We apply ourselves too much to the exterior.  I do not mean to say that we should not practice and esteem the latter, but the interior ones are more precious to us.  We owe our chief concern and fidelity to the acquisition of these, because they are more in conformity with our vocation and because the inward virtues bring about the exterior ones…..If our spirit were very humble and brought low, all our actions, all our words, and all our exterior would also be this way” [Exhortation no. 3.6].  Without the foundation of humility, the ensemble of a moral agent’s other virtues and the expression of these virtues through external acts would suffer an inevitable distortion.

While central to the moral life, the virtue of humility is acquired only with great difficulty.  This difficulty springs from the disordered attachments that routinely enslave the moral subject.  “There are three things we rid ourselves of only with difficulty.  The first is honor, love, and self-esteem.  The second is love of our bodies and their comforts.  The third is the hatred we have for inward and outward submission … True humility tends to the contempt of this self-esteem and makes us love to be considered poor, ignorant, little, and imperfect, and to be forgotten by all creatures” [Conference no. 17] .  The triumph of humility in the soul destroys attachments to corporeal goods, social acclaim, and willfulness, which prevent the soul from attaining authentic happiness.

The social expression of this humility in the life of the nun entails a certain egalitarianism.  In dealing with either social superiors or peers, the humble nun exhibits a frank honesty that excludes flattery or condescension.  “If we were sent to the parlor to speak with princes or princesses, we should not need to think about what we should say to them nor try to compose a speech.  We should just tell them simply and without artifice what Our Lord might say to us, keeping ourselves humbly and faithful attentive to Him.  Similarly, we should be very simple, cordial, and unpretentious in dealing with our sisters.  We should respect and love them dearly, whether they be our superiors, equals, or inferiors.  We should prefer them all to ourselves and prefer ourselves to no one” [Exhortation no. 4.17].  Based upon a refusal of one’s claim to social superiority, humility levels social distinctions among the laity and among the members of religious orders.

The model and source of this humility is Christological.  It is Jesus himself who constitutes the perfect mirror of the humility the nun must cultivate.  “How did that gentle Lord not abase Himself in honor? … He reduced Himself to such an extremity on that point that He suffered like any other mortal creature … From all powerful He appears all powerless; from all great, all little; from all terrible, all gentle and kind, allowing Himself to be guided like a tiny lamb; from all rich with the eternal riches of the Father of light, of Whom He is by nature the Eternal Son, He is become all poor among mortals, born in an obscure stable, and has only what He barely needs” [Exhortation no. 4.3].  The paradoxes of the Incarnation, especially the self-emptying of Christ as he takes flesh, illustrate humility in its purest possible form.  Christ not only provides the model for humility, through grace, he infuses and strengthens the virtue within the pious moral subject.

Allied to humility is the virtue of simplicity.  In the life of the nun, the vow of poverty permits her to give tangible external expression to the internal disposition of simplicity.  Conventual simplicity involves both physical and spiritual renunciation.  “Poverty of spirit is a detachment from all created things, if we possess them.  This poverty of spirit requires us not to set our affections on them, so that we must be poor in affection and will concerning these things and have our heart detached and completely free … Another kind of poverty is to leave them for the love of God in order to serve Him more perfectly.  We must leave them in affection and not only in fact.  True and perfect poverty of spirit is to have nothing but God in our mind” [Conference no. 28].  The simplicity and poverty defended here have a contemplative end inasmuch as they free the moral subject to focus her attention on God alone.

In De Chantal’s writings, obedience ranks as one of the essential virtues, especially for the nun who has pronounced a vow of obedience to her superior.  De Chantal’s high esteem for obedience is rooted in her hierarchical vision of the cosmos, of the political order, and of the church.  “God, by His supreme wisdom, has arranged has arranged the order of the universe in the following way: He has made all creatures submissive and dependent on each other.  The whole universal Church obeys the Sovereign Pontiff as the Vicar of our Lord Jesus Christ; each part of this Divine Spouse has a head, a bishop, whom it obeys.  Moreover, all the religious orders have superior on which each subject depends.  All private families have a father to direct and govern the family.  I am not speaking here about political obedience and subjection.  That would concern kings, princes, governors, and how soldiers obey their captains and how the entire body of an army obeys its general―they often show such an exact obedience that they shame us before God― I am only speaking to you now to make you understand that we are appointed to obey.  We must do so in an exact following of the will of God, Who is the only end of the submission of our wills” [Conference no. 5.14].  In De Chantal’s perspective, the entire universe represents an elaborate hierarchy of command and submission ordained by God.  The political and religious orders of human society imitate and participate in this hierarchy.  The virtue of obedience involves the decision of the moral agent to respect these various hierarchies through the inclination of one’s personal will. In its purest form, that of the religious vow of obedience, obedience is the surrender of one’s will to the direction of one’s legitimate superior.

The virtue of obedience in religious life presupposes one’s obedience to the moral law, as interpreted by the church.  The nub of the virtue of obedience in cloistered life is one’s complete indifference at the hands of one’s superior.  This obedience reflects a personal spiritual freedom.  “We should be ready to accomplish obedience, as many times as it shall be pleased to send us to any place and under any pretext, without any excuse.  Some say they would prefer not to be sent to small towns under the apparently good pretext that they would have less spiritual help there or that they would be more exposed to danger in times of war or other similar excuses.  If these people would examine themselves carefully and see themselves as they really are, they will find that their position is nothing but the fruit of pride, a pride so covered by these apparently good pretexts that they are blinded and do not even know the truth about themselves” [Exhortation no. 3.4].  The reasons given to refuse commands of religious obedience are only rationalizations born out of the moral subject’s desire for comfort and fear of suffering.  Authentic obedience joins docility with indifference in the presence of a morally valid command from one’s superior.

Throughout her works, De Chantal stresses charity as the highest theological virtue.  If humility is the foundation of the moral life, charity constitutes its summit.  As with the other virtues, the monastic practice of charity possesses a note of detachment.  “Thanks to God’s goodness, I have no particular like or dislike for any of my sisters.  I love those who are good because God dwells them; I love those who are not so good because God wills that I should practice the holy virtue of charity.  Those who do best give me the most consolation; those who do not do will afflict my heart.  Still, my soul and my mind love all of them and I will spend and be spent in aiding, serving, and helping them” [Exhortation no. 4.13].  The affective indifference toward the different nuns as well as the fundamental virtue of charity is presented as the fruit of divine grace.

De Chantal not only privileges the theological virtues in her account of moral virtue, she often transforms ordinary moral virtues by redefining them in a monastic context.  Her treatment of patience is typical.  Patience emerges as a virtue central for the endurance of the seasons of spiritual aridity, which are inevitable in a serious life of contemplative prayer.  “We must live in the present moment, without forecast and without worry about ourselves, concerning either the future or the present.  We should do things just as they present themselves to us.  We should profit by everything in good faith and without any other concern than that of pleasing God, by the means supplied by our vocation alone and without searching for some external resources” [Conference no. 35].  An ascetical virtue, patience permits the contemplative to focus on one’s present duties and not be distracted by memories of a past where God’s consolations were more palpable or in a desired future where God’s graces would be more tangible.

Not all moral virtues are capable of such a theological transformation.  According to De Chantal, even some of the cardinal virtues oppose the proper moral formation of the Christian and nun.  Prudence, for example, often allies itself with self-love and thus prevents the exercise of charity.  “Self-love leads to the loss of everything in the spiritual life, because it brings forth its own seeking, which hinders us from seeking God and His good pleasure.  Human prudence also does much harm; as long as we nourish this false prudence, this human spirit will act in us … It will be difficult to overcome these two enemies, for they are dexterous and deal their blows with such subtlety that very often we are not aware of them until they have done their part” [Exhortation no. 3.3].  Rather than crowning the philosophical ensemble of natural moral virtues, the constellation of theological virtues defended by De Chantal provides an alternative set of moral habits to be cultivated by the human subject in the quest of a happiness tied to salvation.

Another obstacle to the cultivation of authentic virtue is the empire of passions upon the human soul.  De Chantal rejects the theory that some ascetical exercise or mystical experience could permanently extinguish the passions. Those who claim to live in such an emotion-free state are suffering from a serious spiritual illusion.  When the passions break out in the soul, the virtuous Christian must learn how to carefully negotiate a gradual calming of the emotions.  Violent efforts to oppose one’s passions will only result in failure.  “Here is a little model of what we are to do when, rowing peacefully in our little boat, we feel, without thinking about it,  all our passions arise and cause a great storm in us, as if they would overwhelm us and drag us after them.  We must not wish to calm this tempest ourselves, but we must gently draw near the shore, keeping our will firmly in God, and coast along the small waves, to reach, through humble self-knowledge, God, who is our sure port.  Let us go along gently, without effort and without yielding to our passions anything they wish.  By so doing, we will arrive later in that divine port with more glory than if we had enjoyed a perfect calm and had steered our boat without any difficulty” [Conference no. 6].  The passions constitute an essential part of human nature; any effort to deny their power rests on an illusion concerning the affective dimension of the human subject.  Providentially, God’s tolerance of the many unexpected eruptions of passion permits the virtuous Christian to recognize one’s finitude and to acknowledge the limits of the power of one’s will.

b. Nature and Will

De Chantal’s philosophy of human nature focuses primarily upon the faculty of the will.  Distorted by original sin and concupiscence, human nature must undergo a reformation if it is to achieve its proper fulfillment in union with God.  It is in abandonment to divine providence that the human will, often disfigured by self-love, finds its proper happiness.

Conventual life is a paradigm of how sinful nature must be transformed into a nature redeemed by grace.  This overcoming of self-loving human nature constitutes the purpose of the vowed life in community.  “We have not come within these walls to live according to nature; we are taught from the commencement that we must overcome it.  We must then do this with generosity and, instead of following self-love and the human spirit, live by a holy strength of the mind, according to the lights of grace and reason.  These two lights, properly followed, are enough for leading the soul to the highest perfection of divine love” [Exhortation no. 3.3].  Properly sanctified, human nature emerges at the end of a spiritual itinerary of conversion, not at its origin.  The insistence on the complementarity of reason and grace reflects the characteristic moderation of De Chantal’s theological positions.

The requisite conversion of nature requires a certain violence to oneself.  Vices can be eradicated and virtues cultivated only at the price of this internal spiritual combat.  “I tell you often that heaven suffers violence and that the conquerors and the strong carry it way.  He who will go on to perfection must renounce himself and carry his cross.  All these are words uttered by the Eternal Truth … We have love of God to the degree we mortify ourselves and earnestly subject our nature … We shall never truly please God except by destroying our nature.  We shall never enjoy interior peace unless we practice mortification and the entire renunciation of our interior inclinations” [Exhortation no. 4.14].  This ascetical anthropology conceives human nature as a nature to be morally purified and strengthened both by grace and by ascetical measures.  Rather than being a metaphysical given, human nature is to be resisted, transformed, and molded in an itinerary of strenuous personal reformation.

One of the prerequisites for this ascetical transformation is authentic self-knowledge.  Allied to the virtue of humility, accurate self-knowledge acknowledges one’s moral misery in the state of sin.  “We must really know ourselves, our nothingness, our meanness, and our vileness.  If our understanding is filled with this truth, we shall see clearly that there are many defects, imperfections, and many things to reform in us.  In truth, we are full of wretchedness and poverty” [Conference no. 1].  The self-knowledge prized here is the frank recognition of one’s morally depraved state.

The acquisition of such self-knowledge is difficult.  All too often human efforts at introspection are biased by self-love; it is only through divine grace that the human subject can make a realistic appraisal of his or her morally perilous state.  “There is a vast difference between looking at ourselves in God’s sight and looking at ourselves in our own.  If we look at ourselves in God’s sight, we shall see ourselves as we really are, but if we look at ourselves in our own sight, we shall see ourselves as self-love suggests.  This love of ourselves does us great harm.  Unless we mortify it and  overthrow its favorite pursuits and interests, its vanity and good opinion of oneself, we shall not advance on our way and we shall always remain dwarfs in virtue” [Exhortation no. 4.2].

At the center of this spiritual struggle lies the human faculty of the will.  The will’s intentions largely determine whether a particular soul will overcome its sinfulness and truly adhere to God through a process of purification.  In a virtuous soul, the desire to do God’s will should be the only motive in one’s conduct, regardless of emotional or economic circumstances.  “Solid virtue consists in attaching ourselves only to God, in wishing for God alone, in seeking God alone, and in depending on God alone, in serving him constantly and with perseverance in whatever state He places us, whether we be in prosperity or adversity, in consolation or affliction, in health or in sickness, in dryness or in sweetness.  The failing to take pleasure in the good actions we do takes away neither the power of doing them nor the merit of them.  On the contrary, they are more agreeable to God when there is less of us in them, because we are acting more purely for Him” [Conference no. 26].  It is in the subservience of the human will to the divine will that authentic union of the soul with God emerges.

The summit of this voluntaristic union with God lies in the act of spiritual abandonment.  The human agent abandons his or her will into the divine will. The moral life becomes the effort to permit the divine will to direct one’s actions as purely as possible.  “It is a true point that we find  the highest and most sublime perfection when we are entirely given over to, dependent upon, and submissive to the events of Divine Providence.  If we have indeed surrendered to this providence … it would be indifferent to us to be humbled or exalted, to be led by this hand or the other, to be in dryness, aridity, sorrow, and privation, or to be comforted by the divine unction and by the sensible enjoyment of God.  In fact, we should keep ourselves in the good hands of the great God like cloth in the hands of the tailor, who cuts it in a hundred ways for use as he pleases” [Conference no. 41]. The passage reflects the Salesian emphasis on abandonment to divine providence as the keystone of spiritual maturity and of psychological peace.  The climax of human will is in its durable immersion in the divine will.  This voluntaristic anthropology places the itinerary of the will at the center of the moral and spiritual journey of the human subject.

c. Divine Attributes

Practical in orientation, the writings of De Chantal rarely engage in speculative theology.  Several works, however, focus on the attributes of God.  De Chantal attempts to link the contemplation of the divine attributes to motivation for confidence in God in this life and to hope of possessing God in the next.

In seeking solid reasons for hoping in God’s providence, De Chantal underlines three divine attributes: omnipotence, perfect goodness, and perfect wisdom.  “You wish to know the foundations upon which we are to support our confidence in God.  Here you have three points: first, because He is all wise; second, because He is all good; third, because He is all powerful.  Consequently, He knows everything we need for our soul and body.  He is all good and goodness itself; He shows this by what He has done for us.  He is all powerful because He gives us what He sees to be necessary for us” [Instruction no. 1].  Confidence in divine providence is not based on a generic act of faith in God; it arises from a consideration of specific attributes in God, which render Him worthy of this act of trust in difficult circumstances.  Divine power, wisdom, and goodness permit the believer to understand why God, and only God, merits such a total act of faith and hope.

The divine attributes hold a particular prominence in De Chantal’s account of the faithful soul’s destiny after death.  In the beatific vision of God, the soul will contemplate the divine attributes it has only obscurely glimpsed during the laborious meditations of terrestrial life.  Divine goodness, immensity, and majesty are the particular objects of this celestial vision.  “When we shall be in possession of the glory of paradise, how great will be our astonishment on seeing the infinite goodness, the incomprehensible immensity, and the supreme majesty of God, who has lowered Himself so far as to desire the love of the creature, which is so vile and cruel!  If the soul were capable of dying, it would die at the sight of this excessive love, this immense greatness of its Creator, which has so favored it.  It would see how badly it has corresponded to this love and the wrong it did itself in being taken up with the things of life, with trifles which had the power to separate it from its God and make it lose the incomparable good of this immortal happiness and of the vision of the divine essence” [Conference no. 20].  The passage has echoes of the Augustinian theory of the ideas in the mind of God.  The infinite goodness, limitlessness, and majesty, which were perceived in an indirect and fleeting way during moments of terrestrial reflection, are now immediately grasped in the soul’s undying contemplation of the divine essence.  This beatific vision does not only contemplate God in all of the divine simplicity, it contemplates the eternal ideas that constitute God’s attributes.

d. Augustinianism

Augustinian influence suffuses the works of De Chantal.  After François de Sales, Saint Augustine is the most cited author in her writings.  Her theory of concupiscence and of divine ideas bears Augustinian traces.  Her Augustinianism emerges most clearly in her commentary on the Rule of Saint Augustine, delivered as a series of exhortations to the Visitation nuns.

The Rule of Saint Augustine is actually a compilation of documents written by Augustine of Hippo himself and by later Augustinian writers.  Saint Augustine authored Letter 211 to a community of nuns seeking to reform themselves and Sermons 355 and 356 on the life and death of clerics.  Aelred of Rievaulx composed Of the Eremitical Life in the twelfth century.  The authorship of Monastic Consortia, Rule for Clerics, and Second Rule remains uncertain.  The Rule of Saint Augustine describes the virtues of religious life but provides few detailed prescriptive laws.  When confronted by the proliferation of religious orders, the Catholic Church insisted that new orders must use one of the preexisting rules as the basis for their constitutions; many chose The Rule of Saint Augustine on account of its brevity and its flexibility.  The Visitation order chose the rule and adapted it to its own purposes.  De Chantal’s commentaries on the text transpose the rule in a gendered key by adapting it to the requirements of an exclusively female community.  Her exhortations echo the Neo-Platonism of Augustine himself by her repeated efforts to interpret physical realities in light of the spiritual realities or ideas to which they point.

Following Augustine, De Chantal designates love as the principal end and rule of religious community.  “In this Rule St. Augustine proposes to us, in the first place, the great commandment of God, and tells us that ‘God is to be loved before all things and after Him our neighbor.’  This commandment then must needs be the foundation and the basis of our perfection, for in the observance of this lies the sum of Christian and religious perfection” [Exhortation no. 1.1].  All the moral precepts of the Christian life are subsumed under the single commandment to love God and to love one’s neighbor.

Practical in orientation, De Chantal uses Augustine’s counsels on love as a criterion for an examination of conscience by the nuns.  The moral weaknesses of the community reflect the lack of fidelity to the demanding love proposed by the gospel and the Augustinian rule.  “Do we never do to our neighbor anything but what we wish should be done to ourselves?   Are we as pleased with her welfare as we are with our own?  Do we truly hide her faults? Are we indeed pliant toward all her wishes?  Have we a sense of her sorrows?  Are we very careful to console, serve, and comfort him?  No!  We commonly wish to be preferred to her; nevertheless, you see what this commandment obliges us to do” (Exhortation no. 1.1).  The Augustinian ideal of disinterested love becomes the measure by which the actions of community members are to be judged and corrected.

Addressing a convent audience, De Chantal specifies how the Augustinian norm of love is to be pursued by the nuns.  Her distinction between spiritual and natural love is gendered inasmuch as it cites personality traits traditionally associated with women rather than men.  “In a few words, St. Augustine tells us excellently how we must love our Sisters: ‘Now, there ought not to be any sensual love among us, but only spiritual love.’  This is the point: Do not love each other with natural, sensual fondness, founded on frivolous qualities, such as relationship, alliance, familiarity, correspondence, resemblance, mental sympathy, temperamental similarity, and a thousand other foolish things imagined by the human mind.  In the same way, our minds should banish such follies as natural beauty and the charms of good breeding.  We are to love our Sisters, not with a human love, not with a self-interested love, but as our holy Rule says, with ‘spiritual affection,’ with a certain interior and cordial attachment to virtue and not to other things” [Exhortation no. 1.14].  In this pursuit of spiritual love, the nuns should pay particular attention to their conduct during conversation.  Gossip and backbiting can prove particularly destructive in the conventual pursuit of a properly purified love.

At the antipodes of this spiritual love is the self-love that fosters a spiritual dishonesty.  Focusing on the specific challenges of conventual life, De Chantal describes how coyness in dealing with illness can subtly manifest this self-love.  “I want to … speak of a certain whimsicalness of self-love which creeps into some community members.  When they have something amiss, they will not tell it to their superior; someone else must tell it.  This behavior can proceed from no other cause but pride.  There is a wish to appear very generous and not to tell one’s ailment, but it must be made known.  To stand now on one foot, now on the other, to rub one’s forehead, to appear out of breath … I declare that when I see such trickiness, I will  simply avoid you.  I will let you suffer with your self-love and act as though I did not see you” [Exhortation no. 1.11].  Self-love is often expressed as emotional immaturity and veiled attention-seeking.  A spiritual love can emerge in the convent only if the superior firmly refuses to acknowledge demands for loving attention rooted in self-pity.

In numerous passages De Chantal follows the Neo-Platonic logic of Augustine by interpreting physical objects as the sign or embodiment of spiritual realities.  Her treatment of poverty is typical.  Augustine’s modest, concrete counsel to “keep all your clothes in one place, under the keeping of one or two Sisters” becomes the occasion for De Chantal to expand on a completely spiritualized concept of poverty.  Rather than a being a virtue confined to the treatment of material objects, poverty emerges as a virtue of strict spiritual detachment.  “In what do you think the purest poverty and finest observation of this virtue consists?  It consists, not only in having nothing of our own and in not being attached to what is given for our use, but it makes us rejoice in the lack of necessary things and that the least thing in the house is given to us … It stretches into the very recesses of the heart, unclothing the soul of the things that are most savory and spiritual, leading it to practice an excellent poverty of spirit, depriving it of the ardent superfluous desires of perfection, hiding from it its advances, and making it suffer with submission nakedness and withdrawal of interior goods” [Exhortation no. 1.7]. This spiritual poverty lies in a will completely abandoned to God’s good pleasure and no longer solicitous of either physical or spiritual consolations.

The Neo-Platonic strain of Augustinianism also emerges in De Chantal’s concept of God and the soul.  Both God and the soul are described under the rubric of the transcendental of beauty.  “We are enamored of spiritual beauty.  Now, you know that the nature of the will is such that as soon as it has discovered some fair and lovable object, it at once desires to possess and enjoy it.  All beauty, all goodness, all perfection, come down from God, who is supremely beautiful, good, and perfect.  This goodness which is in Him leads Him to communicate to the souls who serve Him some particles of these virtues … We shall arrive at the enjoyment of that spiritual beauty, more to be desired than all the delights of the palace” [Exhortation no. 1.18].  Framed in aesthetic terms, the soul’s pursuit of God emerges as the quest for infinite beauty, which gradually embellishes the soul with virtues as the questing soul becomes more like the image of perfect beauty, God.

4. Reception and Interpretation

The reception of the philosophy of De Chantal falls roughly into two periods.  Until the twentieth century, interest in De Chantal’s writings was largely devotional.  The Visitation order was the primary public for her writings.  The Annecy convent’s edition of the complete works of De Chantal (1874-1879) indicates the veneration accorded by the Visitation nuns toward the writings of their foundress.  By a quirk of ecclesiastical history, the Visitation order, reduced to strict cloister in the seventeenth century, began to conduct schools in the nineteenth century.  The students and alumnae of the Visitation academies become avid readers of the works of De Chantal and practitioners of her spirituality.

In the twentieth century a more scholarly approach toward the writings of De Chantal emerged.  Brémond (1912) presented De Chantal as a spiritual theologian with a complex variation on the Salesian theme of abandonment to divine providence.  Georges-Thomas (1963) and Ravier (1983) further pursued the exploration of De Chantal’s ascetical and mystical theology.  Gazier (1915) studied the relationship of De Chantal to Jansenism; Mézard (1928) analyzed her doctrine of the soul; Giraud (1929) considered the relationship of her writing style to her spirituality.  Recent studies have explored certain philosophical themes in De Chantal.  Wright (1988) and Bowden (1995) examine the gendered nature of her moral arguments; Bouchard (2004) and Kroug (2010) evaluate her philosophy of love; Wright (1985) considers her concept of perfection.  De Chantal’s philosophy of virtue and her relationship to the Augustinian revival of the seventeenth century invite further research.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • De Chantal, Ste Jeanne Françoise Frémyot. Sa vie et ses oeuvres, 8 vols., ed. Religieuses du Premier Monastère de la Visitation Sainte-Marie d’Annecy. Paris: Plon, 1874-1879.
    • Based primarily on manuscripts archived at the Visitation motherhouse in Annecy, this edition of the works of De Chantal still remains the standard text of reference.
  • De Chantal, Jeanne-Françoise Frémyot. Correspondance, 6 vols., ed. Patricia Burns. Paris: Cerf, 1986-1996.
    • This critical edition of the letters of De Chantal clarifies many strands of her spiritual theology and provides biographical information on her many correspondents.
  • De Chantal, Saint Jane Frances Frémyot. Selected Letters of Saint Jane Frances de Chantal, ed. Visitandines of Harrow-on-the-Hill. London: Washbourne, 1918.
    • This anthology highlights those letters tied to the foundation and direction of the Visitation order.
  • De Chantal, Saint Jane Frances Frémyot. Exhortations, Conferences and Instructions, ed. Visitandines of Bristol. Chicago: Loyola University Press, 1928.
    • This anthology offers the addresses of De Chantal, most of which were delivered to assemblies of Visitation nuns in Annecy.
  • De Sales, Francis and De Chantal, Jane. Letters of Spiritual Direction, trans. Péronne Marie Thibert, eds. Wendy M. Wright and Joseph F. Power. New York: Paulist Press, 1988.
    • Especially helpful is Wright’s essay on the gendered differences between the spiritual teaching of De Sales and that of De Chantal.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Brémond, Henri. Sainte Chantal 1572-1641. Paris: Lecoffre, 1912.
    • This groundbreaking presentation of De Chantal as a spiritual theologian was placed on the Index of Forbidden Books.  During the modernist controversy, the author was criticized for giving an account of Catholicism that placed too great an emphasis on subjective religious experience.
  • Bouchard, Françoise. Sainte Jeanne de Chantal ou la puissance d’aimer. Paris: Salvator, 2004.
    • The monograph analyzes De Chantal’s philosophy of love.
  • Bowden, Nancy Jayne. “Ma Très Chère Fille”: The Spirituality of Francis de Sales and Jane de Chantal and the Enablement of Women.  Ph.D. thesis, University of Washington, 1995.
    • From a feminist perspective, the dissertation examines the ways in which De Chantal’s philosophy promotes a mitigated emancipation of women.
  • Gazier, Augustin. Jeanne de Chantal et Angélique Arnauld d’après leur correspondance. Paris: Champion, 1915.
    • A partisan of Jansenism, Gazier studies the relationship between De Chantal and one of the leading Jansenist nuns through an analysis of their correspondence.
  • Georges-Thomas, Marcelle. Sainte Chantal et la Spiritualité Salésienne. Paris: Éditions Saint-Paul, 1963.
    • The commentary on this anthology of De Chantal writings examines her concept of the soul and her relationship to the broader Salesian movement.
  • Giraud, Victor. Sainte Jeanne de Chantal. Paris: Flammarion, 1928.
    • A literary critic, Victor examines the relationship between De Chantal’s spiritual doctrine and her writing style.
  • Kroug, Jean-Marie. Le désir de l’amant; le vocabulaire amoureux de quelques femmes mystiques au dix-septième siècle. Ph.D. Thesis: Université de Fribourg, 2010.
    • The dissertation compares De Chantal’s philosophy of love with that defended by other women mystics of the period.
  • Mézard, Denys. La Doctrine spirituelle de Sainte Jeanne-Françoise de Chantal. Paris: Lethielleux, 1928.
    • A Dominican theologian, Mézard analyzes the ascetical and mystical theology of De Chantal.
  • Ravier, André. Jeanne-Françoise Frémyot, Baronne de Chantal, sa race et sa grâce. Paris: Henry Labat, 1983.
    • A Jesuit specialist in spirituality, Ravier studies the social context of De Chantal and of her conception of the spiritual life.
  • Stopp, Elisabeth. Madame de Chantal: Portrait of a Saint. London: Faber and Faber, 1963.
    • This erudite biography remains an excellent introduction to De Chantal, with a good exploration of the intellectual influences on her.
  • Stopp, Elisabeth. Hidden in God―Essays and Talks on St. Jane Frances de Chantal. Philadelphia: Saint Joseph’s University Press, 1999.
    • Especially helpful is the study on the value of hiddenness and obscurity in the philosophy of De Chantal.
  • Wright, Wendy M. Bond of Perfection: Jean de Chantal and Francis de Sales. New York, Paulist Press, 1985.
    • This work studies the spiritual friendship between De Sales and De Chantal, as well as the concept of spiritual perfection to which they aspired.

 

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University Maryland
U. S. A.

Kristina Wasa (1626—1689)

WasaThe flamboyant life of Kristina, the Queen of Sweden, one of Europe’s most mercurial monarchs, has long overshadowed her contribution to philosophy. When histories of philosophy mention her at all, they usually present her as the pupil of Descartes and as the patron of philosophical salons. But Kristina’s relationship to philosophy transcends her auxiliary roles.  In her writings she makes her own distinctive contribution to moral and political philosophy. Her ethical texts explore the nature of virtue, defend gender equity, and posit criteria for religious truth. Her political works defend the civic tolerance of religious minorities. Like many a salonnière of the period, Kristina analyzes the nature and variations of love, but her theological and political interests provide her with a broader philosophical horizon than the predominantly romantic one of many French salons. Her philosophical work often explores the issue which bedeviled her political career: the nature and proper exercise of authority.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Works
  3. Philosophical Themes
    1. Critic of Descartes
    2. Moral Philosophy
      1. Critic of La Rochefoucauld
      2. Moral Psychology
      3. Sexual Equality
      4. Epistemology
      5. Political Philosophy
      6. Religious Philosophy
      7. Philosophical Eclecticism
    3. Apologist for Tolerance
  4. Reception and Interpretation
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Born on December 8, 1626, Kristina Wasa belonged to the Swedish royal family. Her father was King Gustav II Adolf and her mother Maria Eleonora of Brandenburg. The mother disdained her daughter, having hoped for a boy who would become king, but her father cherished the child, insisting on an exacting education for her.

In 1630 the king presented Kristina to the Swedish Estates as his successor to the throne. The army and the Estates ratified King Gustav’s proposal. The king appointed Chancellor Axel Oxenstierna as the regent of Sweden, to govern the nation during the king’s frequent military absences and to supervise Kristina until she reached her majority. King Gustav insisted that Kristina be provided with the princely education that would have been accorded a male heir. Headed by the theologian Johannes Matthiae, a group of tutors undertook the education of the crown princess. An irenic (peace-seeking) theologian whose views on pan-Christian unity disturbed the more sectarian Lutherans at court, Matthiae helped to form the young queen’s views on religious tolerance.

Killed at the battle of Lutzen in 1632, King Gustav was succeeded by Kristina on the Swedish throne. The young queen inherited an empire which included Finland, Estonia, and parts of Norway, Germany, and Russia. Kristina’s education intensified. She mastered a series of foreign languages: Latin, German, French, Italian, and Spanish. There is even evidence she knew some  Hebrew and Arabic. French would become her preferred language of written communication. She studied the major works of classical philosophy, indicating a predilection for the writings of the Stoics, notably Epictetus and Seneca. She also mastered the disciplines considered essential for a warrior king: equestrianship, fencing, and military strategy.

In 1640 Queen Kristina began to participate in the national government and attend meetings of the cabinet of ministers. In 1644 she reached her majority and was formally crowned as monarch of Sweden. She quickly moved to limit the influence of the regent Oxenstierna, who she believed had unnecessarily restricted her power during her minority. A patron of the arts and sciences, she pursued her dream of turning Stockholm into the Athens of the North. Fascinated by modern technology, she founded the first Swedish newspaper in 1645.

In 1646 Kristina began a correspondence with Descartes through the mediation of Pierre Chanut, the French ambassador to Sweden. The letters explored the nature of love, the question of the universe’s infinity, and the nature of the sovereign good. In 1648 she played a crucial role in ending the Thirty Years’ War with the Treaty of Westphalia. The controversial treaty attempted to resolve the religious quarrel among Protestants and Catholics by declaring that the religion of the state should be the religion of the one who rules the state.

During this period she also began to constitute her personal court of palace scholars. Isaac Vossius headed the coterie, which included Samuel Bochart, Nicholas Heinsius, Christian Ravius, Claudius Salmsius, and Johannes Scheffer. This predominantly Dutch circle of scholars adhered to the neo-Stoic theories defended by Justus Lipsius at the University of Leyden.  Her prize court scholar was Descartes. Arriving in Stockholm at Kristina’s invitation in 1650, Descartes tutored the queen in philosophy during 5:00 A.M. sessions at the palace in the freezing winter. Within four months, Descartes had died of pneumonia.

Kristina had often guardedly expressed her skepticism at the tenets of Lutheranism, the official Swedish state religion. In 1651 she began clandestine communications with the Jesuits Francesco Malines and Paolo Casati. She became more withdrawn and began to consider the possibility of abdication, for reasons which remain obscure. In June 1654 Kristina abdicated the Swedish throne and named her cousin Charles X Gustav as her successor. As soon as she left Swedish territory, she began a wandering journey across Europe, often baffling observers with her use of male clothing.

In 1655 Kristina converted to Catholicism. Publicizing this conversion of a monarch from the heart of Lutheran Europe, Pope Alexander VII greeted her with lavish ceremonies in Rome. Vatican circles provided the queen with an apartment and other financial benefits. Although Kristina would remain a practicing Catholic, her increasingly erratic behavior in Rome and rumors of her private skeptical remarks about religion later alienated her from church authorities.

After her Roman triumph, Kristina resumed her wandering through Europe. In 1656 she held a conference in France to debate issues concerning the essence and variations of love. She shocked public opinion with a visit to the most notorious courtesan of Paris, the Epicurean Ninon de Lenclos. In 1657 her political ambitions resurfaced. She plotted to take the throne of Naples. During a stay at Fontainebleau, she learned that one of her servants, Monaldeschi, had revealed her plot to her critics. She ordered the execution of the traitor in her presence, an act which shocked public opinion and intensified speculation on the former queen’s mental balance.

In 1660 Kristina visited her estates in Sweden. She later received tutorials in astronomy from Lubenitz. In 1667 she returned to Sweden with a new political project: a plan to have herself crowned the new queen of Poland. When the plan collapsed, she returned permanently to Rome and pursued her life as a writer and patron of the arts and sciences. In 1670 she began writing her maxim collections, Reasonable Sentiments and Heroic Sentiments. In 1686 her letter defending tolerance of the Huguenots was published in Pierre Bayle’s Nouvelles de la République des Lettres; she also wrote a manifesto defending tolerance for Roman Jews. She installed an astronomical observatory in her apartment and conducted a scientific academy which featured the astronomer Cassini and the physiologist Borelli. She founded a philosophical academy, served as a patron of the musicians Scarlatti and Corelli, and commissioned a book defending the controversial architect Bernini. Spiritually later in life, she indicated a sympathy for Quietism, a controversial mystical movement then agitating the Catholic world.

On April 19, 1689 Kristina died in Rome.

2. Works

A prolific writer, Kristina of Sweden left behind her a disparate collection of texts, written principally in French. Her immense correspondence includes epistolary exchanges with numerous philosophers, notably Descartes, Pascal, Gassendi, and Grotius. The many female correspondents include Anna Maria Van Schurman and Madeleine de Scudéry. Her uncompleted autobiography, modestly entitled The Life of Queen Kristina, Written by Herself, Dedicated to God, must be read with caution. Many incidents in the queen’s life are altered or embellished to suit the hagiographic purposes of the book. Kristina’s moral philosophy appears in three collections of maxims, laconic aphorisms inspired by the maxime literature of the salon of Madame de Sablé. They are Commentaries on the Maxims of La Rochefoucauld, Commonplace Book: Reasonable Sentiments, and Heroic Sentiments. In many ways the most typical of Kristina’s writings are two historical essays: Reflections on the Life and Actions of Alexander the Great and Reflections on the Life and Works of Caesar. They celebrate the historic models of the heroic life which Kristina considered the moral ideal of the monarch. Only with the edition of Johann Arckenholtz (1750-60) were the writings of Kristina presented as a unified canon.

3. Philosophical Themes

Kristina’s philosophical preoccupations are primarily ethical in nature. Like other salon philosophers, her interest in moral psychology pivots around the question of love and friendship. As a monarch, her virtue theory focuses on the heroic virtues which she believes essential for the successful ruler. Her political theory and religious philosophy emphasize the issue of authority and the legitimate use of power. Embedded in her moral philosophy are secondary epistemological and metaphysical concerns.

a. Critic of Descartes

Kristina’s philosophical dialogue with Descartes is pursued principally through the intermediary of Pierre Chanut, French ambassador to Sweden. Starting in 1646, a series of letters between Descartes and the monarch reveals Kristina as a critic of several key points of Cartesian philosophy.

The initial dialogue concerns the nature of love. Chanut presents Kristina in a vaguely Cartesian light as a being liberated from the constraints of tradition: “having the wonderful disposition of being freed from the servitude of popular opinion” [Letter of Chanut to Descartes; December 1, 1646]. He then poses Kristina’s question on love: “When we  use love or hatred poorly, which is the worse of these disorders or poor usages?  The term ‘love’ must be understood in a philosophical manner and not the way it is often understood in girlish talk” [Letter of Chanut to Descartes; December 1, 1646].

Descartes’s lengthy response is a veritable treatise on love. He subdivides Kristina’s question into three considerations: “1. What love is. 2. Whether the natural light alone teaches us to love God. 3. Which of the disorders and poor usages is worse: love or hate?” [Letter of Descartes to Chanut; February 1, 1647]. His response theologizes the questions. In presenting his theory of love, certain distinctive themes of Cartesian philosophy emerge. Inasmuch as love is simply a passion, it is only a mechanical response of the body to some desired external object. Love can become properly intellectual and more than a passion when human reason decides that some spiritual object should be possessed and deliberates on the means to possess it. The love of God is a particularly thorny issue since the divine attributes detected by natural reason alone (that is, reason unaided by supernatural revelation, faith, and grace) are minimal. Nonetheless, the human experience of free will enables the human agent to acquire some knowledge and love of God, since it is in the will that human beings most closely resemble God. Finally, disordered love is more dangerous than disordered hatred because disordered love more easily distorts our judgment.

Kristina’s response to the Cartesian theory of love is a mitigated assent. She admits that she could not respond properly to Descartes’s theory of love as a passion because “never having personally experienced this passion, she could not render a good judgment concerning a portrait when she had never known the original” [Letter of Chanut to Descartes; May 11, 1647]. However, Kristina agrees with Descartes’ theory of intellectual love since it closely resembles the love of virtue she has long tried to cultivate. “Nothing prevented her from examining what Monsieur Descartes said about intellectual love, which considers a good [that is] purified and separated from sensible things, since she could at least feel within herself the love of virtue” [Letter of Chanut to Descartes; May 11, 1647]. The Cartesian concept of intellectual love touched on the question of the sovereign good which had long interested the queen.

Kristina moves from the question of love to a new question concerning Descartes’ doctrine of the infinity of the world. Does not this theory dangerously confuse the difference between God and the creature?  Are not all created things, including the cosmos itself, strictly finite?  And does not such a theory contradict the clear teaching of the Church and Scripture on the finite nature of the world?

Descartes provides a cautious response to this fraught theological question. First, he insists that perfectly orthodox theologians, such as Nicolas of Cusa, have supported the theory of the world’s infinity. “I argue that the Cardinal of Cusa and several other theological doctors have believed the world to be infinite without any correction by the Church on this subject. On the contrary, it is actually honoring God to conceive His works in terms of such greatness” [Letter from Descartes to Chanut; June 6, 1647]. Second, he insists that he only supported the theory of the world’s indefiniteness, not its infinity. “I do not say that the world is infinite; I only say that it is indefinite. There is a very important difference here. To say that the world is infinite, one must have some reason in order to know it as such; one could only receive this from God. But to say that the world is indefinite, it is sufficient that one simply find no reasons by which one could prove it has limits” [Letter of Descartes to Chanut; June 6, 1647].

Descartes also answers Kristina’s previous ancillary question on love: How does one explain the experience of loving one person over another, especially the experience of spontaneous friendship, where one immediately loves a person one has never known?  Descartes’ response again draws on his mechanistic theory of the body and the brain. “[This attraction] consists in the disposition of the parts of our brain….The objects which touch our senses move through the intermediary of the nerves to some part of our brain….When we are drawn to love someone without knowing the cause, we can believe that this comes from something in the object which is similar to what was in a previous object we once loved” [Letter of Descartes to Chanut; June 6, 1647].

Kristina’s next question concerns the nature of the sovereign good. What is the supreme good for humanity?  Descartes’ answer hedges. He admits that properly speaking, only God is the sovereign good of humanity, but he is skeptical that this good could be grasped outside the light of faith. He argues that the sovereign good could be understood in another, secular manner. The sovereign good here is a collection of those goods a human agent could possess; preeminent among them is a good will. “It seems to me that the sovereign good of all human beings together is a collection or an assemblage of all the goods, whether of the body or of the soul or of fortune, which could exist in anyone…and the most important consists in a firm will to do what is right and to seek the happiness which this produces” [Letter of Descartes to Chanut; November 20, 1647].

In later correspondence, Descartes recognize that Kristina does not share all of his views on the sovereign good, despite their common interest in the Stoic literature where it had been previously explored. “The grand esteem that I have for this incomparable princess [Kristina] gives me the occasion to fear that having already taken the trouble to see it [the letter on the sovereign good], as you have stated, she still did not want to give me her opinion of it” [Letter of Descartes to Chanut; May, 1648]. Descartes fears that Kristina’s non-response indicates disapproval and that he might have erred in the opinions he defended concerning the sovereign good. “I see so many other people who are mistaken in their opinions and their judgments that it seems to me a universal illness” [Letter of Descartes to Chanut; May 1648].

In their few direct epistolary exchanges, Kristina and Descartes express the highest regard for each other. In the philosophical dialogue carried out through the intermediary of Chanut, however, the disagreements between the two thinkers are stronger than their agreements. Kristina clearly expresses her skepticism concerning Cartesian dualism, religious orthodoxy, and virtue theory.

b. Moral Philosophy

Kristina’s moral philosophy emerges in three works tied to the maxime literature of the salon. These are her Commentaries on the Maxims of La Rochefoucauld [CMLR] and her two collections of personal maxims, Reasonable Sentiments [RS] and Heroic Sentiments [HS]. Although the three works examine a number of ethical issues, they concentrate on questions of moral psychology, such as the virtues and the passions. They also reflect Kristina’s longstanding theological and political preoccupations.

i. Critic of La Rochefoucauld

In her commentary on La Rochefoucauld’s maxims, Kristina often indicates her agreement with his skeptical exposure of virtue as a mask for vice. But in many passages she indicates her opposition and sketches an alternative theory of human nature.

Kristina disagrees with La Rochefoucauld’s negative account of the passions. While La Rochefoucauld considers the passions strong emotions which distort human reason, Kristina places the passions at the summit of human perfection. “’Passion often turns the brightest man into a fool and often makes the greatest fools bright.’ I think that passion perfects everything” [CMLR no.1]. She also criticizes his misogynistic interpretation of how women deal with the passions. “’Women often believe they love although they do not love. Preoccupation with some intrigue, the heightened emotions of a romance, the natural inclination toward the pleasure of being loved and the pain of being refused such love convinces them they possess passion when they only experience some coquettishness.’  This could be true of either sex. There are very few people who are capable of authentic passion” [CMLR no.73]. The stereotype of the emotional woman opposed to the rational man is critiqued. Both genders are equally susceptible to passion and capable of rational reflection.

Kristina challenges the link established by La Rochefoucauld between passion and virtue. She does not believe that disordered emotion could cause or strengthen moral virtue. “’Passions often engender what is contrary to them. Avarice sometimes produces generosity and generosity avarice. We are often firm because we are weak and audacious out of timidity.’  I do not believe this at all” [CMLR no.4]. Not only is La Rochefoucauld’s link between virtue and passion faulty; Kristina challenges his concept of virtue itself. “’Virtue would not go so far if vanity did not hold company with it.’  Talking this way shows a poor knowledge of virtue. Virtue and vanity never find themselves housed together” [CMLR no.56]. Kristina rejects La Rochefoucauld’s witty paradoxes. Just as virtue is not a passion, it is not a vice nor does it share a mysterious kinship with the vices.

Similarly, Kristina corrects La Rochefoucauld’s account of the principal human passion: love. Against La Rochefoucauld’s cynical sociological account, Kristina emphasizes the power of love and its presence in the fundamental structure of the human person. “’There are people who would never have experienced loving feelings if they had never heard others speak about love.’  This is false. Love does not enter by the ear; it enters by the eye” [CMLR no.46]. Similarly, friendship deserves greater esteem than that given by La Rochefoucauld. Betrayal by a friend constitutes a grave injustice which justifies a thorough distrust of the former friend. “’It is more shameful to distrust one’s friends than to be betrayed by them.’ I do not agree. There are times when one may and one must distrust one’s friends without offending either friend or friendship. To be a traitor is the shame of those who do the betraying but to undergo the betrayal is our shame” [CMLR no.34]. Literary critics have long pointed out that many sympathetic female commentators on La Rochefoucauld strongly disagreed with his cynical account of love and friendship. Kristina’s critique is one example of this gendered dissent from La Rochefoucald’s theory of the emotions surrounding friendship.

Certain Cartesian phrases punctuate Kristina’s critique of La Rochefoucauld. The mechanistic theory of human nature is reflected in her discussion of La Rochefoucauld’s thesis that mental states are tightly linked to corporeal causes. “’Strength and weakness of mind are not well named. In fact, they are only the good or bad disposition of the organs of the body.’  There is such a great union between body and soul that even if some small thing is bothering this machine, everything goes wrong” [CMLR no.14]. The problem of the nature of the interaction between mind and body is raised.

ii. Moral Psychology

In Reasonable Sentiments and Heroic Sentiments, Kristina presents her own reflections on a series of moral, theological, and political issues. These collections of maxims must be interpreted with caution. The brief statements are fragmentary and often opaque. Like her political life, the maxims contain contradictions and abrupt transitions. Nonetheless, the hundreds of maxims indicate a pattern in Kristina’s thought on moral psychology and on questions of authority in politics and religion.

The theory of moral virtue defended by Kristina stresses the heroic virtues. The outsized virtues of conquerors represent the summit of moral habits. “Magnificence and liberality are the virtues of conquerors. They impress everyone” [RS no. 323]. Similarly, military courage inspires awe. “Invincible courage is troubled by nothing” [RS no.59]. The virtues of the heroic are not limited to the martial virtues displayed in public moments of triumph; the heroic moral agent often displays discreet virtues in the face of adversity. The capacity to accept ingratitude is one of the quieter virtues. “There is a type of pleasure in suffering ingratitude which is reserved to great souls, who alone are capable of relishing it” [RS no.31].

Her treatment of vices similarly focuses upon the world of the politically powerful. While the line between virtue and vice is clear, certain vices typical of rulers actually promote the common good in society. One such vice would be luxuriousness. While a taste for luxurious possessions might corrupt a ruler, it could embellish a society where the ruler acts as a patron of the arts and sciences. “Luxuriousness does not destroy states; it enriches and civilizes them” [RS no.338]. Despite its potential for personal corruption, the vice could have a charitable effect. “Luxuriousness is a type of secret alms” [RS no.239].

The passions constitute a particularly powerful influence upon the moral agent. Not only are they necessary; they provide a positive vitality to the human person. “The passions are the salt of life. Life would be insupportable without them” [RS no.148]. Kristina criticizes those neo-Stoic philosophers who consider it possible and desirable for the soul to live in a state of equanimity freed from all emotion. “This tranquility so vaunted by philosophers is a dull and insipid mental state” [RS no.149]. Even momentary liberation from the sway of passion is rare. “We only triumph over our passions when they are weak” [RS no.160]. Despite their central and positive role in human psychology, the passions can easily mislead the moral agent. Certain passions easily align themselves with vice. “Avarice and envy are ridiculous passions” [RS no.161]. Even hope, a passion often aligned with theological virtue, can bitterly disappoint a moral agent possessed by it. “Hope is the passion which gives the falsest pleasure and the truest sadness” [RS no.153].

The passion receiving the most extensive analysis by Kristina is love. Love possesses an incomparable intensity and duration. Even when it has faded, it permanently marks the moral subject. “Whether love is happy or unhappy, it always endures” [HS no. 71]. Love is so powerful that it defines the personality of the one who loves. “As our love is so we are” ([RS no.15]. Despite its power, love is rare. The greatest of affective relationships, friendship is difficult to find and sustain. “Great friendships are as rare as great loves” [RS no.182].

According to Kristina, authentic love is ultimately religious. Only in God can the human lover find the perfect and imperishable object of love’s drive. “Love and ambition must have God as their aim. Only in Him can they find what will abundantly and worthily satisfy them” [HS no.62]. Love can never remain at the level of the purely intra-human. The dynamic transcendence of love toward the most infinite and lovable of beings inevitably leads it to a religious object. “When a heart is capable of love, it is impossible that sooner or later it will not love God, Who alone is capable of fulfilling it and lifting it up” [HS no.84].

In light of her theory of love, Kristina severely criticizes the institution of marriage. The practice of arranged marriages for the sake of social prestige or economic gain guarantees that marriage will usually be loveless. “There are no happy marriages because the spouses do not truly love each other” [RS no.168]. The lack of affection between spouses renders marital commitment impossible to bear. “Marriage is insupportable because it is nearly always incompatible with love” [RS no.169]. So bereft of love are most marriages in the society of the period that the existence of a happy marriage is a moral miracle. “It would be too much happiness to be both married and in love” [RS no.168].

Kristina builds her critique of marriage into a defense of the superiority of the single life. “Socrates said, ‘Whether you are married or unmarried, you will be sorry.’ Personally, I believe infallibly that everyone who marries will regret doing so, but I do not see why anyone who is unmarried will regret it. I am the example from experience” [HS no.111]. In her praise of the single life, Kristina’s philosophical argument becomes autobiographical.

iii. Sexual Equality

In her treatment of the relationship between the sexes, Kristina’s maxims show a marked ambiguity. Many maxims insist upon strict gender equality, but several maxims argue that women are not fit to serve as political rulers.

In the more egalitarian maxims Kristina insists that the biological difference between men and women neither indicates any intellectual difference nor dictates any particular social role for either sex. Seat of the intellect and will, the soul has no gender. “It is true that the soul has no sex” [RS no.268]. So separate is the soul from the body that the traditional social roles assigned to each sex are easily violated. “There are men who are as much women as their mothers and women who are as much men as their fathers, because the soul has no sex” [RS no.266]. The observable differences in intellectual achievement and social position between men and women can be explained by social institutions, especially by the period’s educational institutions. “Temperament and education explain all the differences one can observe between the two sexes” [RS no.270]. The argument for gender equity carries echoes of the Cartesian thesis that the mind remains a completely separate substance from the body and thus unmarked by gender.

In other passages, however, Kristina insists that one type of work should be closed to women: that of political governance. “Women must not reign” [RS no.261]. The rule of women in the past is dismissed as untypical; the exceptions of female political rule in the past only prove the wisdom of limiting rule to men. “If in the past there were queens who gloriously reigned, these examples are so rare that we shouldn’t rely on such miracles” [RS no.263]. The political rule of women in the present is only the occasion for mockery. “Nothing is more ridiculous than government by women. I knew several cases which reduced me and still reduce me to pity” [RS no.264]. Given Kristina’s own efforts to exercise political sovereignty in Naples and Poland, these maxims against female rule are difficult to explain. They clearly reflect her own contrarian spirit or possibly her bitter experience of rule during her tenure as queen of Sweden. Still, they stand in counterpoint to the sexual equality she champions in her broader reflections on gender.

iv. Epistemology

In Kristina’s theory of knowledge, practical is to be preferred to speculative knowledge. Despite her interest in recent scientific discoveries, empirical science seems to be of little value. “The sciences are only pompous titles for human ignorance. One is not any wiser for knowing them” [RS no.46]. Only moral knowledge can truly render human beings wise and direct them to genuine happiness. “Everything which does not render humanity wiser and happier is useless in the area of science” [RS no.47]. The supreme science is that which teaches a certain wisdom of life. “Knowing how to live well and die well is the science of sciences” [RS no.48].

In this science of wise living, one diplomatic art is pre-eminent: the art of being able to understand the psychological motivation of others. This art provides the key to effective government of others. “The art of penetrating other human beings is rare, but those who possess it are made to rule” [RS no.82]. Even when used by a mature agent, this psychological science is difficult to wield successfully. “One must employ this art with discretion and not believe it to be infallible” [RS no.83]. Historical knowledge can also assist the moral agent who is attempting to govern others through the use of psychological insight. “The science of the past is very useful for the future” [RS no.81].

Unsurprisingly, for Kristina the supreme knowledge is the science of governing others well. This knowledge rests upon a combination of psychological and historical science. Given its capacity to promote human happiness, the science of government enjoys a pre-eminence over other sciences, whose truths have little direct impact upon the practical life of humanity.

v. Political Philosophy

Kristina’s political philosophy focuses on the question of authority and sovereignty. The prosperity of the state depends upon the character and skill of its ruler. The ideal political regime is an absolutist one where an audacious ruler has acquired heroic virtues.

Moral character determines the political power of a ruler. “It is personal merit, not differences between states, which explains the difference between kings” [HS no.30]. In the constellation of personal virtues a sense of grandeur is the most indispensable for a successful reign. “Princes must love their grandeur above all things” [RS no.315].

History has provided a series of rulers who demonstrate this political grandeur to a heroic level. “If [Julius] Caesar, Alexander [the Great], and Cyrus [of Persia] once succeeded in making themselves masters of a part of the world, it is because they had all the necessary qualities to a heroic degree” [HS no.128]. Despite her censure of women who exercise political rule, Kristina includes female rulers in her catalogue of heroic governance. “Semiramis and Cleopatra and so many others earned esteem and admiration despite their personal faults” [RS no.275].

In exercising rule, the monarch must not fail to use absolute authority. This can even include the execution of members of his own family if the security of the state is at stake. The controversial action of Spain’s Phillip II in authorizing the death of his son receives Kristina’s praise. “If it is true that Phillip II brought about the death of his only son either out of reasons of jealous love or out of reasons of state, that is a great gesture” [RS no.316]. The praised action carries an eerie echo of the controversial execution of Monaldeschi at Kristina’s command.

The absolute authority of the monarch is not arbitrary. A heroic ruler must represent the interests of the entire nation he governs and must refuse to be the agent of one partisan faction. The ruler can only encourage justice by publicly acting justly. “A prince must be perfectly neutral. His only concern should be to reign and to render justice according to the merit of each subject, thus obliging everyone through proper punishments and rewards, but chiefly by his own example, to do one’s duty with care, application, and fidelity” [RS no.120]. To ensure this commitment to the common rather than the partisan good, the ruler must consult as widely as possible. “A prince must give everyone access to him. He must be as publicly exposed to everyone’s gaze as is the sun. He must not let himself be isolated by either his ministers or his favorites” [RS no.121].

The ideal ruler must be cultured as well as virtuous. A commitment to personal learning is essential for the success of a political reign. “It is the duty of the prince to give some of his time to the reading of good books. These times are not taken away from his public duties because they instruct and correct princes” [HS no.42]. The daily moments of retreat must also serve to permit the ruler to engage in personal reflection on his conduct in office. “No matter how busy the prince is, it is necessary for him to put aside several hours of retreat each day. This time must be used to reflect on his conduct, to correct his faults, and to ask strength and grace from God, without which nothing valuable can be done” [HS no.122]. The ruler must not only develop a personal intellectual and spiritual culture; the ruler must act as a patron of arts in the conduct of government. “It is necessary to know how to use cultured people as if they were living libraries, esteem them, reward them liberally, employ them and consult them on what they know” [HS no.123]. This portrait of the ruler as cultured patron of the arts is the standard Renaissance portrait of the good prince. It is also a self-portrait of Kristina in her ambition to be both a learned monarch and to transform her nation into a center for European high culture.

The absolute authority of the ruler has religious limits. The good ruler must recognize that political authority comes from God and that God will demand an account from each ruler on how that authority has been used. “A prince who rules must make God rule everywhere where he exercises command. He must give back to God all his greatness and all his glory and all his works. He must make of them a perpetual homage to God” [HS no.12]. Authentic political rule is thus a kind of regency; the source and end of the authority exercised by the political ruler resides in God alone.

vi. Religious Philosophy

Like her political philosophy, Kristina’s religious philosophy focuses on the issue of authority. The truth of Catholicism is found in the authority with which God has vested it. Salvation is found only in submission to the Church’s authority. “God only explains His will by his unique oracle, which is the Roman Catholic Church, outside of which there is no salvation. One must submit oneself blindly and without reservation to all of its decrees” [HS no.1].

Her concept of ecclesiastical authority is militantly ultramontane; it is papal authority which is supreme in the Church’s governance. Unlike other Catholic authors of the period, who considered ecumenical councils equal with or superior to the pope in the Church’s government, Kristina exalts the monarchial governance of the Church in the person of the bishop of Rome. “God wanted to give authority to the pope and the Church in such an admirable way, by so many miracles, so many councils, and so many other marvels that no reasonable person can doubt the fulfillment of the magnificent promise God made that Church will prevail over hell until the end of time. He wanted the government of His Church to be monarchial. He has given His infallibility to the pope and not to councils. The pope is everything without them and they are nothing without him” [HS no.2]. As in the political order, where the monarch exercises absolute authority, the pope alone must exercise absolute authority in the religious order. The pope is only accountable to God for his actions.

The submission of intellect and will to the teachings of the Church is accompanied by a spiritual abandonment of the soul to God’s will. Echoing the Quietist movement which had interested her for a time, abandonment to divine providence is a central spiritual posture. “One must blindly resign oneself to God’s will in time and in eternity” [RS no.349]. This abandonment is so important and difficult that Kristina describes it as a type of martyrdom to divine providence.

Despite her enthusiasm for Catholicism in its most Roman forms, Kristina criticizes the omnipresent abuses of religion. The devout who want to believe in supernatural occurrences beyond those essential to the Catholic creed easily fall into superstition. An enlightened faith can never be confused with credulity. Many maxims denounce the hypocrisy of the overly devout. “Bigots are very concerned about the sins of their neighbors but they show little concern about their own” [RS no.374]. Kristina expresses skepticism about members of religious orders. “Too many people are making vows of chastity to be able to keep them actually” [RS no.379]. She also criticizes the clericalism of the devout. The vogue of many cultured Catholics for long interviews with spiritual directors illegitimately reduces personal freedom. “We should not be the dupes of confessors or of spiritual directors” [RS no.366]. Kristina’s enthusiasm for the institution of the papacy does not eliminate her rationalist skepticism toward certain practices of her new religious community.

vii. Philosophical Eclecticism

In the presentation of her moral positions in the maxims, Kristina reveals her indebtedness to other philosophers. Strikingly, Kristina makes no mention of Descartes or of the other modern philosophers she had clearly known or read. She references only classical philosophers. Although the philosophers cited represent an eclectic group of thinkers defending some mutually exclusive theories, Kristina leans toward the more Stoic philosophers as her guides.

The philosophers praised by Kristina are eclectic in their orientation. “Among philosophers, Socrates, Plato, Aristotle, Diogenes, Epicurus, and Epictetus merit admiration” [RS no.63]. Few students of philosophy simultaneously admire both Plato and Aristotle, both Epicureans and Stoics. “Among philosophers, Socrates, Aristippus, and Diogenes are strongly to my taste” [HS no. 33]. Few philosophers believe that the dialectics of Socrates, the Cyrenaic philosophy of Aristippus, and the Cynicism of Diogenes can be reconciled. Kristina’s philosophical heroes indicate the somewhat contradictory philosophical eclecticism she often espoused in her writings.

In other maxims, Kristina indicates a preference for the Stoic strand of classical philosophy. The Stoic philosopher Epictetus is singled out for particular praise. “Born a slave, the wise Epictetus proved himself so illustrious that he made his slave irons more glorious than many others have made their scepters” [HS no.142]. Kristina’s emphasis on the will and its virtuous fortification against adversity indicate her sympathy with the neo-Stoicism of the period.

c. Apologist for Tolerance

Despite the absolutism of her political philosophy, Krisitina emerged as a major European theorist of religious tolerance. In her final years she defended two persecuted religious minorities: French Protestants and Roman Jews. Published by Pierre Bayle, her celebrated letter condemning the persecution of French Huguenots indicates the humanitarian and pragmatic nature of her theory of tolerance.

First, the renewed persecution of the Protestants contradicts the sentiments of charity and compassion which should be the preeminent virtues of the Catholic Church and its adherents. “I pity so many ruined families, so many honest people reduced to dependence on charity. I cannot look at what is happening today in France without being deeply shaken. I feel sorry that these people were born in religious error, but they seem to me more worthy of pity than of hatred. Just as I would not share their error for all the kingdoms of the world, I would not want to cause them any unhappiness” [Letter of Kristina to Terlon; February 2, 1686].

Second, this violent policy of forced conversion will only damage rather than benefit the church. The military campaign against the Huguenots will harden the image of the church as a persecutor and ultimately drive would-be converts away from it. “Because you want to know my sentiments concerning the alleged wiping out of heresy in France, I am delighted to tell you what I think…..I frankly admit that I am not at all convinced of the success of that great plan. I cannot perceive in it anything which will bring a benefit to our holy religion. On the contrary, I can only envision the prejudice against the Church which this novel way of proceeding will give rise to” [Letter of Kristina to Terlon; February 2, 1686]. The apparent military victory in forcing religious conversions only discredits religion.

4. Reception and Interpretation

The reception of Kristina of Sweden has been both popular and scholarly. Even before her death, the dark legend of Queen Kristina had begun to circulate. Her execution of Monaldeschi, a legal punishment of a traitor by a reigning monarch (due to her sovereignty over several fiefs she maintained in Sweden after her abdication), was presented as the irrational deed of a bloodthirsty tyrant. Her taste for male attire was attacked as a sign of lesbianism. Her Platonic friendship with Cardinal Azzolino was denounced as a sordid liaison within the walls of the Vatican. Countless anti-Catholic Swedish pamphlets decried Kristina’s conversion to Catholicism as part of a Jesuit plot to destroy Protestantism in Scandinavia.

The image of Kristina as an irrational virago has influenced popular artistic portraits of her. Countless novels and fictionalized biographies have emphasized the willfulness and eccentricities of her personality. August Strindberg’s play Kristina (1901), Rouben Mamoulian’s film Queen Christina (1933), Anthony Harvey’s film The Abdication (1974), and Laura Ruohonen’s play Queen C (2002) circulate some of the fictitious elements of the legendary Kristina.

A more scholarly approach began with Johann Arckenholtz’s edition (1750-60) of writings by and about Kristina. This multivolume work permitted readers to study the actual writings of Kristina and to counter the legends surrounding the queen by reading eyewitness testimonies by close associates. Varied philosophical interpretations of Kristina’s thought have been offered. Gaukroger’s biography of Descartes (1995) stresses the personal philosophical culture of Kristina as well as her relationship with Descartes. Raymond (1993) emphasizes the centrality of the concept of sacred royalty in his study of the Descartes-Kristina relationship. Pintard (1943) and Åckerman (1991) analyze the libertine and skeptical dimensions of Kristina’s philosophy. Åckerman also stresses the Stoic character of the queen’s philosophical outlook. Børresen (1996, 2007) studies her religious thought, with attention to its paradoxical nature. Kristina’s heroic concept of moral virtue invites further research.

5. References and Further Reading

Translations from French to English above are by the author of this article.

a. Primary Sources

  • Christine de Suède. Mémoires concernant Christine, Reine de Suède, 4 vols., ed. Johann Arckenholtz. Amsterdam: Mortier, 1750-60.
    • This groundbreaking collection of writings by and about Kristina challenged the legends which had grown up around her since her death. A digital version of this work is available in the Gallica section of the webpage of the Bibliothèque nationale de France.
  • Christine de Suède. Apologies: Christine de Suède, ed. Jean-François de Raymond. Paris: Cerf, 1994.
    • This contemporary edition of Kristina’s French writings is a useful introduction to her work, especially her unreliable autobiography.
  • Christine de Suède. Maximes, ed. Chantal Thomas. Paris: Payot & Rivages, 1996.
    • Thomas’ introduction ably underscores the absolutist nature of Kristina’s thought.
  • Christina of Sweden, The works of Christina, Queen of Sweden, Containing maxims and sentences, in twelve centuries: and reflections on the actions of Alexander the Great; first translation from the French. Farmington Hills, MI: Gale ECCO, 2010; reprint of London 1753 translation.
    • This reprint of the 1753 English translation of Kristina’s works contains her maxims and historical essays.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Åckerman, Susanna. “Kristina Wasa, Queen of Sweden,” in A History of Women Philosophers, Vol. 3, ed. Mary Ellen Waithe. Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1991: 21-40.
    • This study stresses the neo-Stoic roots of Kristina’s philosophy but the effort to present Kristina as a religious skeptic is less convincing.
  • Åckerman, Susanna. Queen Christina of Sweden and her Circle: The Transformation of a Seventeenth-Century Philosophical Libertine. Leiden: Brill, 1991.
    • This monograph contextualizes the philosophy of Kristina by placing it within the broader libertine circle of her associates.
  • Børessen, Kari Elisabeth, “Concordia Discors: La pensée de Christine de Suède sur Dieu et l’humanité,” Augustinianum 36 (1996): 237-254.
    • This study draws out the paradoxical nature of Kristina’s religious philosophy.
  • Børessen, Kari Elisabeth, “Christine de Suède: Autonomie et foi rationelle,” in Scandinavian Critique of Anglo-American Feminist Theology, eds. Stenström, Vuola, Bieberstein, and Rapp. Leuven: Peters, 2007: 163-176.
    • This essay interprets Kristina’s abdication and conversion as an effort to develop a personal, autonomous faith which corresponds to her own free use of reason rather than to the demands of Swedish royal tradition.
  • Cassirer, Ernst. Descartes, Corneille, Kristina. Paris: Vrin, 1942.
    • Written during his professorship at Gothenburg University in Sweden (1935-41), Cassirer’s study emphasizes Descartes’s influence on Kristina’s religious convictions. It tends to exaggerate Descartes’s role in the queen’s conversion to Catholicism.
  • Gaukroger, Stephen. Descartes: An Intellectual Biography. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1995: 412-16.
    • Gaukroger’s sketch of Kristina stresses the complexity of her philosophical culture by the time she entered into dialogue with Descartes.
  • Pintard, René. Le libertinage érudit dans la première moitié du XVIIe siècle, 2 vols. Paris: Buin, 1943.
    • Pintard characterizes Kristina’s philosophy as libertine and skeptical.
  • Raymond, Jean-François de. La reine et le philosophe: Descartes et Christine de Suède. Paris: Lettres Modernes, 1993.
    • Raymond’s interpretation of the Kristina-Descartes relationship explores how Kristina’s understanding of the sacral nature of royalty influenced her approach to philosophy.
  • Rodén, Marie-Louise. Church Politics in Seventeenth-Century Rome: Cardinal Decio Azzolino, Queen Christina of Sweden and the Squadrone Volante. Stockholm: Almqvist & Wichsell, 2000.
    • This monograph contextualizes Kristina’s philosophy by situating it within the theological and political concerns of the Roman ecclesiastical coterie in which Kristina participated.
  • Rodén, Marie-Louise. Queen Christina. Stockholm: Swedish Institute, 1998.
    • This biography is a solid introduction to Kristina from a literary perspective.

 

Author Information

John J. Conley
Email: jconley1@loyola.edu
Loyola University Maryland
U. S. A.

William David Ross (1877—1971)

W D RossSir William David Ross was a British philosopher, college administrator, WW I veteran, civil servant, and humanities scholar best known for his important contributions to moral philosophy and the study of classical literature. In the field of classical studies, in addition to shorter works on Plato and Aristotle, his major triumph was his editorship of the Oxford English translations of Aristotle’s complete works, a production of historic magnitude and impact. In moral philosophy, in addition to a short critique of Kantian ethics, his great accomplishment was the formulation of a major new ethical theory, a unique and still controversial system that combines deontological pluralism, ethical intuitionism, non-naturalism, and so-called prima facie duties. Taken as a whole, Ross’s work represents an impressive and in some respects singular and unprecedented achievement. Indeed, apart from Sir Isaiah Berlin who was his peer at Oxford University, it is hard to think of another modern British academic philosopher who similarly distinguished himself not only as a first-rate critic and original theorist, but also as a high-level scholar, educator, editor, translator, administrator, and public official. Dry, rigorous, unostentatious, Ross resembles Aristotle and Kant. Like them, he is seldom electrifying, but always thoughtful, provocative, and edifying. Certainly, the “worthy thane of Ross,” as his namesake is hailed in Macbeth, rates as a key figure in modern intellectual history and as one the most important British philosophers of the twentieth century.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Ross and Plato
  3. Ross and Aristotle
  4. Ross and Virtue Theory
  5. Ross and Kant
  6. Ross’s Ethical Theory: Main Components and Principles
    1. Ethical Non-naturalism
    2. Ethical Intuitionism
    3. Deontological Pluralism and Prima Facie Duties
  7. Ross’s Critique of Ideal Utilitarianism
  8. A Critical Assessment of Ross’s Theory
    1. Problems with Non-natural Properties
    2. Problems with Intuitionism
  9. Conclusion: Ross’s Status and Legacy
  10. References and Further Reading
    1. Works Written, Edited, or Translated by W.D. Ross
    2. Other Relevant Books, Articles, and Resources

1. Biography

Sir William David Ross was born in Thurso, a small industrial, fishing, and tourist community in the county of Caithness on the northern coast of Scotland. He was the son of John Ross, an eminent teacher and school administrator. After spending the first six years of his life in India, where his father served as the first Principal of the Maharajah’s College at Travancore, Ross returned to Scotland and received his early education at the Royal High School in Edinburgh. He attended college at the University of Edinburgh and in 1895 graduated with first-class honors in classical studies. He continued his education at Balliol College, Oxford, graduating in 1898 with firsts in classics and humanities. In 1900 he was offered a lectureship at Oriel College, Oxford. In 1906 he married the former Edith Helen Ogden (d. 1953) with whom he had four daughters. Ross remained at Oxford for nearly fifty years, serving on the faculty and in various administrative positions, including Provost of Oriel College (from 1929 to 1947) and Vice-Chancellor of the University (from 1941 to 1944).

In the course of his distinguished academic career Ross achieved international recognition and acclaim for his contributions to ethical theory and classical studies. In addition to studies of Plato, Aristotle, and Kant, he also published two important and highly influential works of moral philosophy: The Right and the Good (1930) and Foundations of Ethics (1939). One of his foremost academic accomplishments was his editorship of the Oxford English translations of the complete works of Aristotle, a production of 11 volumes (1908-1931), to which he himself contributed well received and still widely used translations of the Metaphysics and the Nichomachean Ethics. In 1939 Ross served as President of the Aristotelian Society, the London-based organization founded in 1880 and dedicated to the promotion of philosophy as an intrinsically rewarding, life-enhancing communal enterprise.

In addition to his academic work, Ross also compiled a notable record of public service and civil administration. In 1915 he joined the British army and served in the Ministry of Munitions, rising to the rank of major and the position of Deputy Secretary. After the war he was awarded the OBE, and in 1938, in further recognition of his military accomplishments, he was officially knighted. From 1936-1940 he served as President of the British Academy, and in 1947 he was named president of the world’s oldest and largest academic federation, the Union Académique Internationale, an organization noted for its promotion of international cooperation in the pursuit of learning.

During and after WW II, Ross continued to serve in some type of public capacity or civic role, occupying a seat on an appeals panel for conscientious objectors and also serving as a member of Britain’s National Arbitration Tribunal (which set wage and price controls, arbitrated work stoppages, established anti-inflation policies, and settled economic conflicts and legal disputes during the war). After his retirement from academic and public life, Ross continued his lifelong study of philosophy. He died at Oxford on May 5, 1971.

2. Ross and Plato

In 1948, at the invitation of Queen’s University, Belfast, Ross delivered the annual Dill Memorial Lecture, named in honor of Sir Samuel Dill, a respected scholar and professor of Greek and Roman history. This lecture became the basis for an eventual book, Plato’s Theory of Ideas, which was originally published in 1951 and then later revised and corrected in a second edition of 1953.

Ross’s book is a formidable work of scholarship on Plato’s metaphysics and epistemology with special emphasis on the philosopher’s celebrated, historically important, and still highly controversial doctrine of Ideas. Ross’s method is that of classical philology, and his study follows in the footsteps of the previous work of James Alexander Stewart (1846-1933), his predecessor in the White’s chair of moral philosophy at Oxford. In essence, Ross provides close readings and commentaries on selected Platonic dialogues, with his main purpose being to show how each dialogue adds to, revises, or modifies Plato’s evolving theory.

Ross begins his inquiry by offering his best guess as to the probable chronology of Plato’s works, drawing not only on the consensus of scholarly opinion but also on the internal stylometric evidence of the dialogues themselves. (Stylistically and structurally, the earlier dialogues tend to be relatively simple and straightforward, the middle ones – especially the Cratylus and the Symposium – tend to be more playful, ironic, and experimental, and the later ones tend to be less fanciful and more controlled, though still relatively intricate and complex)

Ross contends that it is in the Euthryphro, a comparatively early work, that the word ἰδέα (literally something visible; something that can be seen) first appears in its “special Platonic sense” of an ideal Form or universal.  He goes on to argue that the theory of forms is more fully developed and explained in two relatively late dialogues, the Philebus and the Timaeus, and maintains that it is in two of the latest and most complex of Plato’s writings, the Laws and the Seventh Letter, that the doctrine is given its richest and most mature formulation.

According to Ross, the pivotal text in the development of Plato’s philosophy is the Parmenides, a middle to late text in which the title character and his colleague Zeno probe for defects and attempt to punch holes in the theory of universals as maintained by the young Socrates. Ross was one of the first scholarly commentators on Plato to interpret this dialogue not, as several previous critics had viewed it, as a mere whimsical parody or “philosophical jest,” but as a serious experiment in self-criticism on Plato’s part in which the philosopher takes the opportunity to cross-examine himself and evaluate the strengths and weaknesses of his own doctrine.  In effect, Ross sees Plato here articulating and attempting to come to grips with two major objections to his theory. The first is the so-called “third man” argument, which accuses the theory of leading to an infinite regress. (It is claimed, for example, that if a man is a man by virtue of his sharing or imitating the Form of Man, there must also be another Form of Man that both the man and the Form of Man share, and so on ad infinitum). Ross defends Plato’s theory against this argument and shows that it arises as a result of the slipperiness and ambiguity inherent in Plato’s own language (specifically, in the Greek verbs for “share,” “imitate,” and “participate.”)

The second criticism that Plato anticipates and tries to defend himself against (not entirely successfully in Ross’s view) is an objection that was later raised by Aristotle: namely, to affirm that the Ideas and their appearances are completely separate (that is, to claim that they indeed inhabit two entirely different realms with no interconnection or relationship of any kind), would seem to lead to a logical contradiction and philosophical absurdity. At some level, and to at least a minimal extent, Forms must stand in some type of relation with the particulars that exemplify them.

Ideal Redness, that is to say, has to share at least some definable relationship with apples, cherries, fire trucks, and other actual red things. Unfortunately, as Ross points out, Plato is seldom clear or consistent in describing the exact nature of this relationship. In the early dialogues, for instance, he seems to view the Ideas as immanent attributes or qualities (that is, as universal properties present within and manifested through sensible things). However, in the later writings he more often describes the Ideas as if they were transcendent paradigms; indeed he describes them (in the Phaedrus) as if they inhabited a pure realm or space of their own – a “hyper-uranian” or “supra-celestial” world entirely separate and independent from the world of material things and the objects of sense.

According to Ross, what makes this issue especially problematic is that even in the later dialogues Plato frequently reverts to the language of immanence. Ross speculates that this is probably because Plato himself never reached a definitive view of the matter and thus found it convenient to use the language of immanence in some cases (as, for example, when he suggests that a particular may exemplify or partake of a universal property) and the language of transcendence in others (as when he describes a particular as being an imperfect copy or imitation of a paradigmatic Form).

According to Ross, even though Plato is vague and inconsistent on the exact relationship of the Ideas to the objects of sense, he is clear and emphatic on two other important points:  (1) He maintains that there is at least one respect in which Ideas are essentially different from the sensible things that embody or imitate them: namely, the Ideas are eternal and immutable whereas the objects of sense are impermanent and subject to change. (2) He holds that Ideas aren’t merely subjective phenomena that exist only in the mind, but are instead ultimate realities and “completely objective.” In other words, they would exist even if there were no human minds to apprehend or perceive them.

In the end, Ross winds up in the camp of critics who view Plato as ultimately closer to the metaphysics and ontology of Aristotle (according to whom Ideas and particulars are deeply intertwined and practically inseparable) than to the view of Plotinus (who viewed the realm of being as a grand hierarchy, emanating from and ultimately surmounted and transcended by an indefinable, absolute, ideal reality, The One).

Surprisingly, Plato’s Theory of Ideas contains hardly any discussion at all of Platonic ethics. Indeed, despite Ross’s deep personal interest in and original contributions to moral theory, he never actually comments on any of the ethical concerns or lively moral disputes (for example, whether right and wrong are objective or subjective, whether all wrong-doing is due to ignorance on the part of the agent, whether virtue and goodness can be taught, and so on) that occupy Socrates in several of the Platonic dialogs.

Although Ross foregoes any direct commentary on these debates, he does make several references to Plato’s enigmatic Idea of the Good, the ultimate object of knowledge in Plato’s philosophy and the font and origin of all being and value in the Platonic system. This idea, most famously expressed via the simile of the Cave and the Sun (in the Republic, Book VII), appears to have exercised a considerable influence on Ross’s own philosophical thought (indeed, Ross’s notion that we grasp moral truths “intuitively,” as if via some type of innate knowledge or through an immediate, subliminal process of recognition and intellection is essentially Platonic in origin). In the end, it is therefore a bit disappointing not to find, if not a detailed examination of the Idea of the Good or of the intimations of moral intuitionism present in Platonic ethics, at least some acknowledgment on Ross’s part of his personal debt and kinship to his great Greek predecessor.

3. Ross and Aristotle

Even if he had never published The Right and the Good and become one of the leading figures of the analytic school and an important name in twentieth-century moral philosophy, Ross would still have gained lasting renown as a classics scholar. Indeed, during his lifetime, he earned as much acclaim for his accomplishments as the general editor of the 11-volume (eventually 12-volume) Oxford translation of the complete works of Aristotle as he did as for his innovative and provocative work in ethics.

The “Oxford,” as it is still popularly known, is a magisterial and historic literary achievement. At the time of its undertaking, there was but one extant English-language edition of Aristotle’s complete works, Thomas Taylor’s 10-volume translation of 1810. And since Taylor’s century-old edition had received only a limited printing, copies of it were scarce and nearly impossible to come by. Consequently, there was an urgent need for a new and authoritative set of translations in a format suitable and convenient not only for students and scholars but for non-academics and general readers as well. Along came Ross and his team of translators, a mix of veteran scholars and rising young talent specially selected to meet this exacting new challenge.

The project, spearheaded by Ross and his assistant editor J. A. Smith, took more than two decades. The first volume to be published (which became volume 8 in the completed series) was Ross’s own translation of the Metaphysics, which appeared in 1908. The final published volume (volume 3 of the completed edition) appeared in 1931. It contained translations of Meteorology, On the Soul (De Anima), the so-called Short Physical Treatises (Parva Naturalia), and On the Universe (De Mundo; a work that Ross himself dismissed as either spurious or of dubious authorship and which is now generally considered pseudepigraphical). In 1952 Ross added his own translation of various fragments of Aristotle. Although not part of the original project, this compilation was published as volume 12 of the Oxford series.

As general editor, Ross carefully reviewed existing English translations of Aristotle’s works and solicited and supervised the production of new ones from colleagues both within and outside the walls of Oxford. The final collection included an earlier (1885) translation of The Politics by the former Oxford vice-chancellor and renowned translator of Plato and Thucydides Benjamin Jowett. Jowett’s translation had already been hailed as “an English classic,” so Ross apparently judged that it was unnecessary and probably even futile to try to come up with a better one.  The complete edition of the Oxford also included the still unsurpassed translation of the History of Animals (Historia Animalium) by Ross’s fellow countryman (and later fellow peer) Sir D’Arcy Wentworth Thompson.

The Oxford bears many earmarks and virtues of Ross’s own style and editorial preferences: plain diction; lucidity; straightforward syntax; precise logical organization; a tone that is serious, but not grave or ponderous; and an utter absence of needless adornment, euphuism, and gaudy rhetoric. Moreover, since Ross himself seemed to model his own prose after that of the scientific and analytic Aristotle, rather than the more poetic and dramatic Plato, it is neither surprising nor coincidental that the Oxford translations faithfully reproduce many of the best qualities and typical attributes of Aristotle’s own expository style. These attributes include clarity, directness, orderly and systematic presentation, and a meticulous exactness and thoroughness. Aristotle and Ross even share some of the same vices:  both can be dry and over-technical at times and both (in time-honored professorial fashion) have a tendency to over-explain things.

Aristotle spiced his discourse with quotations and examples from the Homeric poems and indulged an occasional fondness for wordplay and neologisms (he invented the word “syllogism” along with terms like energeia – translated by Ross as “actuality” – and entelecheia – translated by Ross as “complete reality”). Ross favored examples and analogies from math and physics rather than imaginative literature – though he does light-heartedly quote Milton’s Satan at one point (“Evil, be thou my good,” R&G, 163). And despite his general preference for plain English, he was not averse to using an occasional jargon term or fancy Latinism (for example, “optimific” and “bonific”) as well as phrases of actual Latin, most notably his customized use of the tag prima facie (which, thanks to his usage, took on a new and specialized meaning in the field of deontological ethics).

Aristotle is highly metaphorical; Ross’s translations are not. The famous opening sentence of the Metaphysics provides a good example. Joe Sachs, perhaps the finest contemporary translator of Aristotle, renders it “All human beings by nature stretch themselves out toward knowing”(Metaphysics, Sachs, trans., 1). Ross translates it simply as “All men by nature desire to learn.” Sachs’ version is truly Aristotelian (capturing both the motion and effort in ὀρέγονται), but it is not exactly ordinary English. Ross’s translation is plain, spare, unadorned. It has the virtue of delivering the essence of Aristotle’s thought without drawing attention to itself – which is pretty much the case with the Oxford as a whole.

4. Ross and Virtue Theory

In 1923, while supervising the production of the Oxford, Ross published a general overview of the works of Aristotle. In the introduction to the 6th edition of the book, the philosopher J.L. Ackrill, an Oxford colleague of Ross’s,  aptly describes it as a “concise and comprehensive account of Aristotle’s philosophical works,” pointedly adding that “no better account exists”(Ross, Aristotle, vii)

Besides being a convenient introduction to its subject, Ross’s Aristotle also serves as an illuminating guide to the author’s own philosophical thought, especially in the field of ethics. For even though Ross never became a major proponent of virtue ethics per se, his theory of prima facie duties has much in common with and was clearly influenced by core elements and principles of Aristotelian moral philosophy. To begin with, Aristotle’s pronouncement near the beginning of the Nichomachean Ethics that ethics is not an exact science like mathematics, but instead deals with “things that are only for the most part true” (1094 b 20), is a view frequently echoed by Ross. Of course in acknowledging this, Ross is by no means approving or endorsing relativism. He is simply pointing out that moral judgments are often difficult, and that people can (and frequently do) disagree about what is right or wrong in a given case. (The mere fact of their disagreement doesn’t mean that right and wrong are relative any more than, say, the fact that jurors may disagree on a verdict in a criminal trial means that the guilt or innocence of the accused is relative)

A key phrase in The Right and the Good is taken directly from the Nichomachean Ethics: — “the decision rests with perception” (Nichomachean Ethics, 1109 b 23, 1126 b 4; R&G, 42). In Aristotle this phrase is used in connection with the doctrine of the mean and refers to the fact that in many situations the exact mean (that is, the truly virtuous and appropriate action in a particular situation) may not be clear. In such doubtful instances the individual must rely on personal judgment to decide what is right. For example, suppose you observe a parent “correcting” a child in public. The behavior of the parent strikes you as lying somewhere in the twilight zone between extremely stern but still acceptable discipline and downright vicious and unacceptable verbal and physical abuse. What is your judgment of the situation, and how should you react? Should you say something to the parent? Should you intervene? According to Aristotle, “the decision rests with perception,” and if you are a person of good judgment and character, with a sense of what a truly virtuous person would do in the same situation, you’ll probably decide correctly and do the right thing.

In the case of Ross’s system of deontological pluralism and prima facie duties, “the decision rests with perception” refers to the resolution of ethical dilemmas, especially dilemmas that arise from the fact that rules of proper action and conduct may at times contradict each other. For example, my duty to tell the truth may conflict with my duty not to cause harm to another person. According to Ross, we typically resolve such dilemmas through an intuitive faculty and reasoning process similar to the personal judgment that Aristotle says we must employ when determining the truly virtuous action in a given case. Indeed, Ross even goes so far as to suggest that there is no moral decision or action that is not fraught with at least some element of conflict, however slight (R&G, 33-34). In many cases the conflict may seem relatively easy to resolve. For example, most of us would have little difficulty telling a lie if it saved innocent lives. Similarly, few of us would approve of enriching ourselves if it meant putting other people’s health at serious risk. On the other hand, many people find certain dilemmas (such as so-called “trolley problems” in which they must choose between causing the death of one person or permitting the death of several others) difficult and even stressful.

Another feature that Ross’s theory of prima facie duties shares in common with Aristotelian ethics is the respect that each theory gives to well established moral traditions and commonly held beliefs – the considered views, that is to say, of “the many and the wise.” At the beginning of the Nichomachean Ethics, Aristotle argues that a critical inquiry into moral values properly begins with and must take into account the “common opinions” (endoxa) of persons with broad life experience (1095 a 5) and of those who have been “brought up in good habits” (1095 b 5). His underlying assumption is that every reasonable and thoughtful adult will have at least a partial grasp of basic moral truths; and so wherever we find widespread agreement among a large number of such individuals, or among the most knowledgeable and experienced members of such a group, the more likely we are to discover moral perceptions and principles that are accurate and reliable (1098 b 27-29). Such commonly held principles and basic perceptions represent the appropriate starting point for any higher ethical inquiry or theoretical investigation:

We must . . . set the observed facts before us and, after first discussing the difficulties, go on to prove, if possible, the truth of all the common opinions about these affections of the mind, or, failing this, of the greater number and the most authoritative; for if we both refute the objections and leave the common opinions undisturbed, we shall have proved the case sufficiently. – Aristotle, Nichomachean Ethics, 1145 b 2-7 (emphasis added).

Ross’s theory rests on similar assumptions. Like Aristotle, Ross regards the common-sense moral opinions of “ordinary people,” and especially the views of “the many and the wise,” as a kind of ground zero or point of departure for moral theory. By ordinary people he means not just anyone or everyone, but only those who have reached a certain level of “mental maturity” and personal development (R&G, p. 12, 29). In addition, he looks upon principles and perceptions that have persisted for generations as having particular moral force and authority, and thus any theory that repeatedly contradicts those principles becomes immediately suspect. For example, if an ethical theory proved to be irreconcilably at odds with our “common-sense” or “everyday” conviction that we ought to keep promises, that fact in itself would be reasonable grounds for suspecting it of being erroneous or defective:

The existing body of moral convictions of the best people is the cumulative product of the moral reflection of many generations, which has developed an extremely delicate power of appreciation of moral distinctions; and this the theorist cannot afford to treat with anything other than the greatest respect. The verdicts of the moral consciousness of the best people are the foundation on which he must build; though he must first compare them with one another and eliminate any contradictions they may contain. (R&G, 41)

According to adherents of virtue theory, doing the right thing ultimately has less to do with defining and upholding basic ethical rules and duties than with molding good character and cultivating good habits of behavior. Ross, on the other hand, departs from virtue theory by insisting that there are certain fundamental rules or duties (such as our duty to keep promises or our duty to assist people in need) that are self-evident, duties that we know to be true and that we are obligated to uphold.

Despite the fact that Ross himself never fully subscribed to virtue ethics, he was nevertheless, through his scholarly work and through his leadership role in helping to make Oxford a magnetic center and focal point for Aristotle studies, highly instrumental in facilitating the rebirth and resurgence of Aristotelian ethics that began in England during the 1950’s. That resurgence effectively started with the ground-breaking work of Elizabeth Anscombe and continued during the latter half of the century with the contributions of Philippa Foot and Alasdair MacIntyre. Anscombe, Foot, and MacIntyre all had Oxford connections, and their achievement can thus be viewed as in some degree a continuation and extension of Ross’s philosophical legacy.

5. Ross and Kant

In 1954, well after the publication of his own important contributions to ethical theory (R&G and FofE), Ross produced a brief introduction and critique of Kantian ethics. Subtitled A Commentary on the Grundlegung zur Metaphysik der Sitten, Kant’s Ethical Theory is written from the point of view of a rival theorist and skeptical critic who is at the same time a scholarly student and admirer of the great German philosopher. The book remains one of the best and handiest short introductions to Kant’s moral philosophy.

After analyzing Kant’s concept of goodwill, Ross takes up his argument that a morally good action must not simply conform with the moral law, but must be performed in order to conform with the moral law; that is, the act must be performed in recognition of and out of respect for the moral law. Ross basically accepts this claim and agrees that it is not enough merely to do the right thing. For an act to be morally good, we must perform it because it is the right thing. For example, if I repay a loan simply to avoid a heavy fine or some form of legal penalty, I will have done the right thing but my action will have no genuine moral significance. Only if I repay the loan out of a sincere sense of personal obligation and a willing adherence to principle will my right action also be morally good. However, while conceding this important point, Ross takes issue with Kant’s further claim that only actions performed in conformity with a priori moral laws can be morally good. Why, Ross wonders, shouldn’t an action performed in accordance with a moral rule that we have formulated or adopted based on personal experience also be morally good? For example, suppose that based on his experience in armed service and through contact and interviews with other war veterans a soldier abandons his earlier belief that active participation in warfare is virtuous and honorable and instead comes to a new understanding (which now strikes him as self-evident and unassailably true) that engaging in war is wrong and that he has a moral obligation to oppose it. According to Ross, he would have the same duty to act in accordance with his newly formulated a posteriori moral conviction as he would an a priori moral principle. (Ross, by the way, had to deal with several cases of exactly this type in his role on a British panel reviewing applications for conscientious objector status during WW II. After the war, British law was modified to allow even veteran servicemen, based on their experience in combat, to redefine themselves as CO’s)

Over the course of his commentary, Ross repeatedly demonstrates his adroit critical powers and relentless skill in semantic and logical debate. Again and again he takes Kant to task for drawing some dubious distinction, or for using a term or phrase in some vague, questionable, or inconsistent way. “It is extremely hard to see what Kant’s meaning here is,” he wryly observes at one point (KET, 71). Elsewhere he chides Kant for his tendency to divide things into formal and material components, inevitably honoring the former and disparaging the latter, as if matter itself and the things of earth, as in the view of Christian neo-Platonism, were defective or corrupt. He even quibbles with Kant’s use of the phrase “categorical imperative” for his central principle, rightly pointing out that any unconditional rule or command is technically and by definition a categorical imperative, and so it is incorrect to speak of the categorical imperative as if there were only one.

Ross’s main objection to Kant’s system is its super-abstract, indeed virtually seraphic, and absolutist character.  He argues that Kant’s absolutism makes his theory impractical and contrary to plain thinking and common-sense morality and shows how the test of universalizability comes out differently if it is applied in very specific cases rather than in general, abstract ones.

The whole method of abstraction, if relied upon, when used alone, to answer the question ‘What ought I to do?’, is a mistake. For the acts we have to choose between, say the telling of the truth or the saying of what is untrue, in some particular circumstances, or the keeping or the breaking of a promise, are completely individual acts, and their rightness or their wrongness will spring from their whole nature, and no element in their nature can safely be abstracted from. To abstract is to shut our eyes to the detail of the moral situation and to deprive ourselves of the data for a true judgment about it. . . . The only safe way of applying Kant’s test of universalizability is to envisage the act in its whole concrete particularity, and then ask ‘Could I wish that everyone, when in exactly similar circumstances, should tell a lie exactly similar to that which I am thinking of telling?’ But then universalizability, as a short cut to knowing what is right, has failed us. For it is just as hard to see whether a similar act by someone else, with all its concrete particularity, would be right, as it is to see whether our own proposed act would be right (KET, 33-34).

However, Ross acknowledges that although the method of abstraction, “cannot safely be relied on as the sole method of judging right or wrong, it is a necessary part of the true method.” The true method, he goes on to show, is a process of minute and careful analysis and “successive abstraction,” and if at any level in the abstractive process “we come across a feature of the proposed act that is prima facie wrong, then Kant is right in holding that no gain to our own convenience will make the act right” (KET, 35). In the end, despite all his criticisms and reservations, Ross winds up with a ringing endorsement of both Kant the ethical theorist and Kant the man:

Kant’s doctrine has both theoretical and practical value in insisting ruthlessly on the need for sensitiveness to every questionable feature of a proposed act. It is his own moral sensitiveness, and his insistence on sensitiveness in others, that makes him, to my mind, the most truly moral of all moral philosophers. (KET, 35)

Advanced students of Kant will probably find relatively little in Kant’s Ethical Theory that they have not already learned or encountered elsewhere. But for beginning students it is hard to imagine a better introduction or starting point for deeper study. Ross’s handling of a wide assortment of thorny Kantian terms and concepts (objective desires vs. subjective desires; necessary duties vs. contingent duties; perfect duties vs. imperfect duties, and so forth) is deft and expert, and his explication and critique of the categorical imperative (in all three of its formulations) is acute and unsurpassed.

6. Ross’s Ethical Theory: Main Components and Principles

At the time of his death in 1971, Ross was as well known and as widely esteemed for his work as a classical scholar as for his contributions to moral philosophy. However, in the four decades since his death the general estimate of his achievement has altered, and while he is still revered for his accomplishments as a scholar and editor he is now more highly regarded for his vital and original contributions to ethical theory.

There are several reasons for this critical revaluation. First of all, there’s the simple fact that the illustrious “Oxford,” which at the time of its publication represented one of the truly landmark achievements in modern classical scholarship, has gradually become, with the passage of two generations, a largely forgotten historical relic, a collector’s item for bibliophiles. Second, during the same time period, classical philology and the scholarly study of Latin and Greek have become contracting disciplines and no longer form a central or growing part of the university curriculum. Meanwhile, the study of ethics has seen its role in higher education expand, and as a result ethical theory is now taught not just in philosophy departments in liberal arts colleges but in most business and professional schools as well. Not surprisingly, Ross’s reputation has followed this same general trend, with a continuing but only moderate appreciation for his work as a classicist and an increasing interest in his writings on ethics. Furthermore, it was not long after the original publication of The Right and the Good (1930) that ethical intuitionism, of which Ross was a leading advocate, fell into general disfavor among moral philosophers. The intuitionist approach, its critics argued, smacked of metaphysics and even theology, and the doctrine was roundly criticized and even ridiculed, especially by ethical naturalists and logical positivists. One exasperated reviewer dismissed it as a “strange” and “totally unilluminating” phenomenon (Warnock, 16). In the last twenty years, however, intuitionism has enjoyed a substantial rebirth and has gained new theoretical support and new adherents. This recent revival was in part spearheaded by a superb new edition of The Right and the Good (2002), freshly edited and introduced by Philip Stratton-Lake, and it was further strengthened by the publication of Robert Audi’s The Good in the Right, a strong re-statement of the intuitionist view.

What follows is a general exposition and critical assessment of Ross’s theory, its basic components, principles, foundations and implications, limitations and strengths.

Ross’s system of ethics, originally set forth in his classic work The Right and the Good (1930) and then revised and supplemented by a later, more methodical, more analytical presentation in Foundations of Ethics (1939), combines elements and insights from several earlier moral theories and philosophical traditions. As noted above, it has certain affinities and features in common with the thought of Plato (notably the Idea of the Good), Aristotle (such as the view that ethics is an inexact science and inevitably involves some degree of individual judgment), and Kant (for example, anti-consequentialism and the idea that good actions involve a sense of duty and a respect for moral law). Ross himself acknowledged as the most significant and immediate influences on his ethical ideas two of the leading figures in early twentieth-century British moral philosophy: H.A. Prichard and G.E. Moore.

Prichard’s provocative essay “Does Moral Philosophy Rest on a Mistake?” outlined several key insights (that ethical theory ought to accord with common-sense morality, that “goodness” and “rightness” and “desire” and “duty” are distinct and by no means equivalent terms, that the terms “end,” “motive,” and “purpose” are also problematic and need to be precisely defined, and so on) that influenced Ross’s thinking and eventually worked their way into his theory. And in Moore, Ross found both an important ally (both philosophers were proponents of non-naturalism) and perhaps his greatest opponent (The Right and the Good can be viewed as essentially a forceful critique and counter-theory to Moore’s ideal utilitarianism)

Ross’s ethical theory, commonly known as the theory of prima facie duties, is a deontological system with three key elements or basic principles: a. Ethical Non-naturalism. b. Ethical Intuitionism. c. Ethical Pluralism.

a. Ethical Non-naturalism

Non-naturalism refers to the meta-ethical view, originally propounded by Moore in Principia Ethica, that moral properties such as goodness are simple, non-natural properties of certain acts or objects and are neither equivalent to, reducible to, nor definable in terms of some other natural, empirical property (such as “pleasure”). According to Moore, any attempt to define “good” in terms of a natural property – for example, by making the statement “X is good” equivalent to the statement “X is pleasant” or “X is harmonious” or “X is highly evolved,” and so forth – is an instance of a category error that he termed the Naturalistic Fallacy.  In the case of Ross’s ethical theory, non-naturalism refers not only to this claim about the uniqueness and irreducibility of goodness and other moral properties but includes two other meta-ethical claims (characteristic of moral realism and cognitivism) as well. These are:

1. Moral statements are propositions and are either true or false independently of human opinion or belief.

2. Moral propositions are true when they accurately describe or correspond to an actual state of affairs (that is, when they reflect actual objective features of the real world) and are false when they do not.

In essence Ross claims that whenever we make a judgment such as “capital punishment is wrong” or “same sex marriages are bad” we are stating propositions that are either true or false. They are true if they correspond to actual, real-world states of affairs and false if they do not. Furthermore, since these statements purport to describe objective reality, they are essentially different from and cannot be reduced to statements that merely express personal emotions or describe states of mind. Contrary to emotivism and other forms of non-cognitivism and naturalism, the statement “Capital punishment is wrong” is not equivalent or reducible to statements like “I dislike capital punishment” or “Capital punishment is barbarous” or “Down with capital punishment.”

b. Ethical Intuitionism

Intuitionism is the epistemological view that some moral truths can be known without logical inference or systematic thought; such truths, it is argued, can be known directly either through a “moral sense” (the empiricist view) or by means of non-empirical a priori knowledge (the rationalist view). Ross’s intuitionism is in the rationalist, Common Sense tradition of figures like Thomas Reid, William Whewell, and Henry Sidgwick.

Kant was among the first to use the term “intuition” (Anschauung; literally, an act of “looking at” something) in a special sense to mean a form of cognition characterized by perceptual immediacy. It is a way of knowing an object by sensation and immediate perception rather than by an intervening process of reason, analysis, or logical consideration.

Going well beyond Kant, Henri Bergson later used the term “intuition” almost mystically to refer to a kind of holistic, in-depth act of cognition – a direct and immediate apprehension of the object in its totality rather than as a sum of partial perspectives or fragmentary views. An example here would be a direct and total immersion or thorough sensation of the city of Paris vs. a sense or knowledge of it put together from various maps, overlays, photographs, perspectives, histories, and so forth. According to Bergson, no matter how many incremental elements you add to the latter, you can never achieve the full and absolute knowledge provided by the former.

Ross’s use of the term “intuition” is different from and extends beyond the limited, non-inferential, perceptual ability described by Kant yet falls well short of the vast, clairvoyant, ultra-sensory power delineated by Bergson. His use was anticipated to some degree by William Whewell, who adapted the term to explain the operations of conscience and to describe the way that we come to know fundamental moral principles: “Certain moral principles being, as I have said, thus seen to be true by intuition, under due conditions of reflection and thought, are unfolded into their application by further reflection and thought” (Whewell, xx).

Michael Huemer, a modern-day rationalist intuitionist, uses intuition in a sense that seems close to the way that Ross uses and understands the term. “Reasoning” Huemer observes, “sometimes changes how things seem to us. But there is also a way things seem to us prior to reasoning; otherwise, reasoning could not get started. The way things seem prior to reasoning we may call an ‘initial appearance’. An initial, intellectual appearance is an ‘intuition’” (Huemer, 102).

Ross also uses the term to mean something like an “initial intellectual appearance,” but in his usage an intuition is a great deal more than just a mere presentiment or a kind of “seeming” since it typically results in a high level of conviction, indeed in the kind of confident knowledge conveyed by the phrase “moral certainty” in both its original Aristotelian and modern legal sense.

In short, “intuition” in Ross’s sense is simply the means by which we apprehend and know moral truths. It may begin as little more than an initial impression or “gut feeling,” a more or less instinctive reaction which may then be strengthened and approved by further consideration and reflection. And although it is essentially different from deduction or induction or any other purely rational, logical procedure or mathematical process, the moral knowledge that it provides can nevertheless strike us with something like the full force of recognition and sense of certainty of a mathematical demonstration.

Indeed, according to Ross, certain moral propositions, such as the claim that we should fulfill promises or that we should promote the good of others, strike us as “self-evident”:

. . . not in the sense that it is evident from the beginning of our lives, or as soon as we attend to the proposition for the first time, but in the sense that when we have reached sufficient mental maturity and have given sufficient attention to the proposition it is evident without any need of proof, or of evidence beyond itself. It is self-evident just as a mathematical axiom, or the validity of a form of inference, is evident. The moral order expressed in these propositions is just as much part of the fundamental nature of the universe (and, we may add, of any possible universe in which there were moral agents at all) as is the spatial or numerical structure expressed in axioms of geometry or arithmetic. In our confidence that these propositions are true, there is involved the same trust in our reason that is involved in our confidence in mathematics; and we should have no justification for trusting it in the latter sphere and distrusting it in the former. In both cases we are dealing with propositions that cannot be proved, but that just as certainly need no proof. (R&G, 29-30)

It is in this deep sense of the term that Ross and other rationalist intuitionists consider “intuition” to be a way of knowing equal or superior to discursive argument and dialectic and beyond mere casuistical disputation and logical debate. One is reminded of Dr. Johnson settling the issue of freedom of the will with abrupt finality: “Sir, we know our wills are free, and there’s an end on it!”

c. Deontological Pluralism and Prima Facie Duties

Ross’s ethical system is deontological and anti-consequentialist since it is based on adherence to rules or duties rather than outcomes. It is pluralist in the sense that, unlike Kantian ethics and utilitarianism (monist systems based on a single, pre-eminent, all-encompassing rule or principle – namely the categorical imperative and the principle of utility, respectively), Ross recognizes several different fundamental rules or principles that he terms prima facie duties. Moreover – and this is a key element and a distinctive feature of his theory – he acknowledges that these duties can, and invariably do, collide and come into conflict with one another.

The phrase prima facie, since it has the connotation of a mere initial appearance or first impression, is to a certain extent unfortunate and misleading. In fact Ross uses it somewhat apologetically. But he is careful to explain that a prima facie duty is by no means simply an apparent duty or an obligation that we might seem to have at first glance, but which later reflection or deeper analysis might very well invalidate. On the contrary, he stresses that a prima facie duty is entirely real and self-evident, though it is always contingent on circumstances and never absolute.

Ross initially identifies seven distinct prima facie duties:

1. Fidelity. We should strive to keep promises and be honest and truthful.

2. Reparation. We should make amends when we have wronged someone else.

3. Gratitude. We should be grateful to others when they perform actions that benefit us and we should try to return the favor.

4. Non-injury (or non-maleficence). We should refrain from harming others either physically or psychologically.

5. Beneficence. We should be kind to others and to try to improve their health, wisdom, security, happiness, and well-being.

6. Self-improvement. We should strive to improve our own health, wisdom, security, happiness, and well-being.

7. Justice. We should try to be fair and try to distribute benefits and burdens equably and evenly.

In Foundations of Ethics, Ross suggests that the duties of beneficence, self-improvement, and justice could be subsumed under a single duty to promote intrinsic values (that is, things that are intrinsically good). Doing this would reduce the number of prima facie duties from seven to five. However, the important thing here is not so much the exact number of duties that we recognize (Robert Audi lists ten) or the precise terminology that we use to identify or describe them, but to agree that the duties enumerated and described are all valid and certified. As Stratton-Lake points out, “Ross is not simply listing whatever moral obligations we think we have . . . . He is, rather, attempting to systematize as much as possible the moral convictions we have” (R&G, xxxvi).

Ross doesn’t try to establish a ranked hierarchy among his prima facie duties since he acknowledges that context and circumstances matter decisively and that individual cases must be judged accordingly. (For example, a promise to attend a beach party or golf outing doesn’t carry the same moral weight as a promise to attend a wedding or funeral) But he also observes that certain duties seem likely to take precedence over and tend to over-rule others. For example, most people would probably agree that our duty of non-maleficence trumps our duty to be beneficent and that in most cases it would be wrong to steal something from one person in order to give it to someone else. On the other hand, there are classic cases like that of Jean Valjean and the loaf of bread. Would you approve stealing from a wealthy aristocrat to feed a starving infant? Many people would. But they might also think there was something morally dubious about the action, or they might approve it in an abstract way but not feel wholly comfortable performing it themselves.

The claim that not only do we have multiple moral obligations (instead of a single imperative or rule – for example, “always treat yourself and others as an end and never solely as a means”) but that these various obligations can also come into conflict with one another constitutes a core insight and distinctive feature of Ross’s theory. For example, my decision to stop and assist an accident victim (duty of beneficence) might conflict with my promise to attend an important meeting (duty to fulfill promises) or run counter to my doctor’s recommendation that I avoid high-stress situations (duty of self-improvement). What is one to do in such cases? According to Ross, there will always be one duty that will have a greater urgency or priority than the others, and that will be the right thing to do, or as Ross terms it one’s duty proper, in a given case. Of course that doesn’t meant that we’ll always be able to identify with certainty exactly what that duty is. “The decision rests with perception.”

7. Ross’s Critique of Ideal Utilitarianism

In both The Right and the Good and in Foundations of Ethics, Ross offers his theory of prima facie duties as a major and in his view much-needed corrective to Kantian ethics and to the ideal utilitarianism of G.E. Moore. Ross’s critique of Kantian ethics, in essence a rejection of Kant’s monism and absolutism, has been dealt with above (see section 5 of this article). This section provides a brief overview of his critique of ideal utilitarianism.

Ideal utilitarianism, a form of consequentialism associated with Moore, can be defined as the view that right actions are those that in any given situation result in a maximum of overall good or (what amounts to the same thing) that produce the best possible outcome. Ross strongly opposes this view, although it should be pointed out that he doesn’t argue that ideal utilitarianism is completely wrong. He simply says that it is counter-intuitive (that is, contrary to common-sense ethics) and incomplete. In his view there are more duties and complications than are dreamt of in Moore’s philosophy.

In general, Ross has three main complaints against utilitarianism.

1. Ross claims that utilitarianism is simplistic and reductive. He argues that it overlooks or conflates the complicated ways in which human beings stand in relation, and thus in moral obligation, to one another:

[Utilitarianism] says, in effect, that the only morally significant relation in which my neighbors stand to me is that of being possible beneficiaries of my action. They do stand in this relation to me, and this relation is morally significant. But they may also stand to me in the relation of promisee to promiser, of creditor to debtor, of wife to husband, of child to parent, of friend to friend, of fellow countryman to fellow countryman, and the like; and each of these relationships is the foundation of a prima facie duty, which is more or less incumbent upon me according to the circumstances of the case. (R&G, 19)

2. Ross claims that utilitarianism is too general and abstract. He argues that it ignores or glosses over the “highly personal character” of moral relationships:

The essential defect of the “ideal utilitarian” theory is that it ignores, or at least does not do full justice to, the highly personal character of duty. If the only duty is to produce the maximum of good, the question of who is to have the good – whether it is myself, or my benefactor, or a person to whom I have made a promise to confer that good on him, or a mere fellow man to whom I stand in no such special relationship – should make no difference to my having a duty to produce that good. But we are all in fact sure that it makes a vast difference. (R&G, 22, emphasis added)

3.  Ross claims that the fundamental principle of utilitarianism – that an act is right if it produces the most overall good – is at odds with common sense morality. He uses a series of hypothetical examples to illustrate his point:

Suppose . . . that the fulfillment of a promise to A would produce 1000 units of good for him, but that by doing some other act I could produce 1001 units of good for B, to whom I have made no promise . . . . Should we really think it self-evident that it was our duty to do the second act and not the first? I think not.

. . . Or again, suppose that A is a very good and B a very bad man, should I then, even if I have made no promise, think it self-evidently right to produce 1001 units of good for B rather than 1000 for A? Surely not. (R&G, 35)

One further example presents a classic showdown between Ross’s ethics and Moore’s. Suppose B promises A that upon A’s death he will pass A’s entire fortune on to C.  However, it is evident that far more overall good will result from giving it to D. Should B give the estate to C or D? According to Moore and ideal utilitarianism, the answer is D. According to Ross, the answer is C.

Ross thinks this example is decisive and that it clearly illustrates the extent to which ideal utilitarianism contradicts our basic, common-sense morality. But does the example really do this? Wouldn’t our intuitive response to the dilemma depend a great deal, and perhaps decisively, on the specifics of the case and the actual identities of C and D? For example, what if C were a family pet and D were a charitable foundation with a spotless record of beneficence, efficiency, and goodwill? In that case, wouldn’t common-sense opinion judge that it is right for B to break his promise to A and to pass his estate on to D rather than C – in effect concluding that in this particular instance the duty to benefit others outweighs the duty to keep a promise?

The fact is, the apparently large theoretical distance between utilitarianism and Ross’s system of prima facie duties shrinks appreciably when the actual details of a given situation are filled in. And this is especially true if we compare later versions or modifications of each theory.  For example, the “two-level” preference utilitarianism of R.M. Hare has a Level-1 “intuitive” component that takes into account our immediate, common-sense judgments as well as a Level-2 “critical” component that makes more advanced judgments based on a deeper and fuller scrutiny of the facts in the case. Robert Audi’s deontological system also makes provision for both intuitive and inferential/critical thinking. Hare’s theory focuses on outcomes; Audi’s is based on intrinsic values and prima facie duties. But when it comes down to making practical judgments about right actions, the two theories aren’t all that far apart. “The decision rests with perception.”

8. A Critical Assessment of Ross’s Theory

“Metaphysics,” F.H. Bradley famously observed, “is the finding of bad reasons for what we believe on instinct” (Bradley, p. xiv). Error theorists, non-cognitivists, and other moral skeptics have said much the same thing about ethics, and especially about moral realism in all its forms.

Ross’s theory has been criticized by anti-realists and realists alike. And, not surprisingly, in most cases the main targets have been Ross’s intuitionism and non-naturalism, undoubtedly the most controversial features of his theory. Some of these criticisms are the result of confusion or misunderstanding and can be easily rebutted. But some are pointed and well-aimed and cannot be so easily dismissed.

a. Problems with Non-natural Properties

The whole concept of non-naturalism – that is, of properties (such as moral goodness) that are supposedly not subject to any form of empirical observation or detection and which, so it is claimed, cannot be reduced to, equated with, or defined in terms of some other natural property – has long been the object of skeptical criticism and occasionally even of ridicule. Such properties are often accused of being ineffable or other-worldly, indeed of being downright spooky, as if they defied comprehension and existed (if they exist at all) only in some timeless, trans-mundane or supra-celestial realm of their own, like the ideal Forms of Plato or the hidden, all-transcending God of the Gnostics. But as Philip Stratton-Lake has shown, it is a misconception or distortion of Ross’s theory to attribute to him anything like such a mystical or other-worldly view of moral properties (R&G, xxiii-xxiv).

What Ross actually claims is that some things in this world – namely certain human actions (such as sincere acts of honesty and beneficence) and certain pursuits like knowledge and pleasure – have intrinsic value and possess a property of being good or of being right. Of course he also admits there is no way for him to prove or authenticate that they have these qualities. Such a position (which is essentially no different from maintaining that moral judgments can be true or false even if we can never empirically confirm or disprove them) is indeed problematic, especially when viewed from the standpoint of naturalism or positivism. But it is nevertheless wrong to characterize Ross’s non-naturalism as in any way mystical or unearthly. Ross, after all, makes no appeal to an invisible moral order or to some type of supra-sensual reality to justify his view; on the contrary, he appeals directly to our ordinary, day-to-day experience – that is, to common-sense morality and the way things actually seem to us.

b. Problems with Intuitionism

In addition to being assailed for its non-naturalism, Ross’s theory has also been sharply criticized for its embrace of intuitionism. Moral intuitionism has been controversial in virtually all its forms, starting with the early 18th century “moral sense” theories of Lord Shaftsbury and Francis Hutcheson. However, these empiricist versions of intuitionism, which claim that we have a special moral faculty (indeed a kind of moral sense, analogous to our primary senses of sight, hearing, touch, taste, and smell) that enables us to directly perceive right and wrong, are essentially different from and in some ways at odds with the rationalist form of intuitionism upheld by Ross. Ross in fact denies that we directly “see” or perceive moral properties or moral truths. What he claims is that we have an intuitive (that is, non-inferential or proto- or meta-logical) ability to apprehend certain self-evident, fundamental moral facts – such as that lying and harming others are prima facie wrong. He says that we can then test and confirm these initial, intuitive impressions on the basis of further reflection or deeper consideration. Such a process is no more mysterious nor any more a matter of some type of uncanny, preternatural perception than the fact that we can instantly know the truth of a mathematical axiom. Intuition then, as Ross uses and understands the term, is an act of cognition, more or less immediate, whereby we apprehend prima facie duties. These duties then serve as a foundation or touchstone for further moral inquiry.

So much, then, for the accusation that Ross’s intuitionism is magical or strange. A more serious and wounding indictment of intuitionism comes from critics who are less bothered by its alleged mysteriousness than by the fact that it can be unreliable and lead to moral judgments that are highly questionable and possibly even false.  Peter Singer, for example, accuses intuitionists of forging normative ethical rules out of “moral intuitions” that are actually little more than biochemical reflexes, instinctive emotional responses that are in large part the product of our evolutionary past. (Singer, 338-9). Singer acknowledges that these “intuitions” are both very common and very compelling; and far from regarding them as being of mysterious or supernatural origin, he readily admits that they are entirely natural, intelligible, and real. Indeed, he regards their existence as to a large extent scientifically proven, since we can now actually “see” intuitive thinking at work using fMRI scans. Similarly, the compelling force and prevalence of many common moral intuitions can be neatly explained by evolutionary psychology.

But Singer questions whether intuitive judgments that can be traced to biologically-based instincts or semi-automatic emotional responses should be given special priority as a foundation for normative moral values – especially when research shows that such judgments are prone to error and are not easily overturned by further reflection. Intuitionists can respond by pointing out that regardless of their origin, and regardless of whether we call them intuitions, instincts, first impressions, or whatever, such judgments still provide the initial starting point for ethics and a vital platform for further inquiry. Ross, in particular, doesn’t claim that our moral intuitions and initial, common-sense judgments are infallible; instead, he acknowledges that they may benefit from and sometimes require deeper reflection and consideration. In this respect his intuitionism actually bears a slight resemblance to the “reflective equilibrium” of John Rawls (Rawls, 48). Of course Ross also admits, and indeed repeatedly emphasizes, that ethics is an approximate and inexact science which deals in probabilities, not certainties. In the final analysis, making accurate moral judgments is difficult since moral acts always “have certain characteristics that tend to make them at the same time prima facie right and prima facie wrong” and “there is probably no act . . . that does good to any one without doing harm to someone else, and vice-versa” (R&G, 33-34). The final decision, as is always the case with Ross’s theory, rests with perception.

9. Conclusion: Ross’s Status and Legacy

W. D. Ross is one of a select number of modern intellectuals who made important and lasting contributions to two different academic fields: in his case, ethics and classical letters. In the area of classical studies, his signal achievement was undoubtedly his editorship of the “Oxford,” the 11-volume English translation of Aristotle’s complete works that ignited a renewal of interest in the philosopher throughout the English-speaking world and to which he himself contributed elegant translations of the Metaphysics and the Nichomachean Ethics. One of the important secondary effects of this renewed interest in Aristotle was the re-discovery and eventual re-flourishing of virtue ethics during the second half of the 20th century. This powerful revival of virtue theory and eudaimonism would have been practically impossible if it had not been prepared and facilitated decades earlier by the appearance of the Oxford.

In the case of ethics, Ross occupies a well-deserved place in the long and distinguished line of British moral philosophers in the analytical-critical tradition, a group that includes such important names as Bentham, Mill, Sidgwick, Moore, Prichard, Hare, and Ayer. The Right and the Good (1930), his critique of ideal utilitarianism and exposition of this own deontological system, remains a classic text and a key document in the history of modern ethical theory, influencing later revisions or variations of intuitionism by Philip Stratton-Lake, Robert Audi, Michael Huemer, and others. C.D. Broad called the book “the most important contribution to ethical theory made in England in a generation” and applauded Ross for applying his considerable “good sense, acuteness, and clarity” to “elucidating questions of perennial significance” (Broad, 228).

10. References and Further Reading

a. Works Written, Edited, or Translated by W.D. Ross

  • Aristotle. Metaphysics. W.D. Ross, trans. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1908. Reprint. Stillwell, KS: Digiread, 2006.
  • Aristotle. Nichomachean Ethics. W.D. Ross, trans. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1925. Reprint: Stillwell, KS: Digiread, 2005.
  • Aristotle. Select Fragments. W.D. Ross, trans. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1952.
  • Ross, W.D. .Aristotle (1923). 6th ed., with an introduction by J.L. Ackrill. New York and London: Routledge, 1995.
  • Ross, W.D. The Right and the Good (1930). Philip Stratton-Lake, ed. New York: Oxford University Press, 2002.
  • Ross, W.D. Foundations of Ethics: the Gifford Lectures Delivered at the University of Aberdeen, 1935-6. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1939.
  • Ross,W.D. Plato’s Theory of Ideas. 2nd Edition. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1953.
  • Ross, W.D. Kant’s Ethical Theory: A Commentary on the Grundlegung zur Metaphysik der Sitten. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1954.

b. Other Relevant Books, Articles, and Resources

  • Anscombe, G.E.M. “Modern Moral Philosophy.” Philosophy, 33, 1958.
    • A key document in the modern revival of virtue ethics.
  • Aristotle. The Complete Works of Aristotle: The Revised Oxford Translation. Ed. Jonathan Barnes. 2 vols. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984.
    • A revised 2-volume version of the “Oxford.”
  • Aristotle. Metaphysics, Joe Sachs, trans. Santa Fe, NM: Green Lion Press, 2002.
    • Excellent modern translation with helpful introduction, glossary, and notes.
  • Audi, Robert. The Good in the Right: A Theory of Intuition and Intrinsic Value. Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 2005.
    • An important recent addition to and revision of traditional intuitionism.
  • Bradley, F. H. ”Preface” to Appearance and Reality. 2nd ed., rev. New York: McMillan and Co, 1908.
  • Broad, C.D. “Review of Foundations of Ethics by WD Ross.” Mind, 48, 1940. 228-239.
    • One renowned moral philosopher reviews and pays tribute to the work of another.
  • Ewing, A.C. The Definition of Good. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1947.
    • A meta-ethical work in the non-naturalist tradition of Moore and Ross.
  • Ewing, A.C. Second Thoughts in Moral Philosophy. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 1959.
    • The author revises and partly rejects his earlier support for non-naturalism.
  • Foot, Philippa. Virtues and Vices. Oxford: Blackwell, 1978.
    • A strong case for a return to virtue ethics as a normative alternative to utilitarianism and deontology.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg. The Idea of the Good in Platonic-Aristotelian Philosophy. P. Christopher Smith (trans). New Haven: Yale University Press, 1986.
    • Argues for an essential continuity in Platonic and Aristotelian thinking about the foundations of ethics and the nature of the good.
  • Hare, R. M. Moral Thinking: Its Levels, Method, and Point. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1981.
    • Finds a place for moral intuitions within utilitarian theory.
  • Huemer, Michael. Ethical Intuitionism. New York and London: Palgrave Macmillan, 2005.
    • A theoretical exposition and defense of intuitionism.
  • Kahneman, Daniel. Thinking, Fast and Slow (New York: Farrar, Straus and Giroux, 2011).
    • A detailed analysis and demonstration of the pervasiveness as well as the strengths, limitations, and occasional perils of intuitive thinking by the famed psychologist and Nobel prize winner.
  • MacIntyre, Alistair. After Virtue. London: Duckworth, 1985.
    • Makes a case for the rejection of modern moral philosophy and a return to Aristotelian ethics.
  • Moore, G.E. Principia Ethica. 1903. Rev. ed. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1993.
    • One of the seminal documents in modern moral philosophy, setting forth the basis and rationale for non-naturalism and ideal utilitarianism.
  • Prichard, H.A. “Does Moral Philosophy Rest on a Mistake?” Mind. Vol. 21, 21-37, 1912.
    • A classic essay in favor of intuitionism and an important influence on Ross’s thinking.
  • Rawls, John. A Theory of Justice. Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1971.
    • One of the great works of modern moral, social, and political thought. Introduced the phrase “reflective equilibrium” as an account of how we reach an ultimate balance or harmony among competing beliefs or moral judgments.
  • Singer, Peter. “Ethics and Intuitions.” Journal of Ethics. Vol. 9. No. 3 and 4. 2005, 331-352.
    • A critique of intuitionism on grounds that “moral intuitions” are essentially biologically driven emotional responses and are prone to error.
  • Stewart, John Alexander. Notes on the Nichomachean Ethics of Aristotle. 2 vols. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1892.
    • An early work in the Oxford tradition by Ross’s mentor and predecessor in the Whyte’s chair of moral philosophy.
  • Stewart, John Alexander. Plato’s Doctrine of Ideas. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1909.
    • A forerunner and model for Ross’s later study on the same topic.
  • Stratton-Lake, Philip. Ethical Intuitionism: Re-evaluations. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2002.
    • A review and assessment of intuitionism by the editor of  Ross’s The Right and the Good.
  • Taylor, Thomas. The Rhetoric, Poetics, and Nichomachean Ethics of Aristotle. 2 vols. London, 1818.
    • A classic selection from the original English translations of Aristotle’s complete works.
  • Warnock, C.J. Contemporary Moral Philosophy. London: MacMillan, 1967.
    • A survey of modern theories, including a dismissive account of intuitionism.
  • Whewell, William. The Elements of Morality, Including Polity. Vol. 1. Revised edition. London: John Parker, 1848.
    • An important early document in the development of rationalist intuitionism.

 

Author Information

David L. Simpson
Email: dsimpson@depaul.edu
DePaul University
U. S. A.

Feminist-Pragmatism

Feminist-Pragmatism is a philosophical tradition, which draws upon the insights of both feminist and pragmatist theory and practice. It is fundamentally concerned with enlarging philosophical thought through activism and lived experience, and assumes feminist and pragmatist ideas to be mutually beneficial for liberatory causes. Feminist-pragmatism emphasises the need to redress false distinctions, or dualisms, as these usually result in a denigration of one oppositional by another. Thus, feminist-pragmatists critique such bifurcations as thought/action, mind/body, universal/particular, and they show how the skewed favouring of one over the other results in philosophical theories which are incapable of explaining our gendered existences, positions in society, understandings of knowledge, or learning experiences. Feminist-pragmatists contribute to current debates in epistemology, social and political philosophy, philosophy of education, ethics, and metaphysics. Their work reflects the theoretical advances made by feminist theorists especially over the course of the latter part of the twentieth century, while being rooted in the principles and criticisms of the classical pragmatists.

Importantly, contemporary feminist-pragmatists have highlighted the fact that women, indeed feminist women, played a central role in the development of classical pragmatism itself, either by influencing the work of male pragmatist philosophers, or by constituting formidable thinkers in their own right. This means, then, that feminist-pragmatism can be traced to the origins of pragmatism itself, which developed primarily in North America from about the mid-nineteenth century to the mid-twentieth century, coinciding with the Progressive Era of 1890–1920.

This article will begin by presenting early feminist-pragmatism in section one, and will then move on to discuss contemporary feminist-pragmatism in section two. Throughout, the philosophical tradition under discussion will be referred to as feminist-pragmatism, although some theorists refer to it as pragmatist-feminism, or indeed, use both terms interchangeably. Present terminology does not imply a favouring of feminism over pragmatism, but simply indicates a tradition of joint feminist and pragmatist philosophising.

Table of Contents

  1. Early Feminist-Pragmatism
    1. Classical Pragmatism and the Recovery of Feminist- Pragmatist Work
    2. Jane Addams
    3. Early Feminist-Pragmatist Legacy
  2. Contemporary Feminist-Pragmatism
  3. Conclusion
  4. References and Further Reading
    1. Early Pragmatist and Feminist-Pragmatist Sources
    2. Contemporary Feminist-Pragmatist Sources:
      1. Introductions or Overviews
      2. More Advanced or Specialised Sources

1. Early Feminist-Pragmatism

a. Classical Pragmatism and the Recovery of Feminist- Pragmatist Work

In the 21st century pragmatism has experienced something of a renaissance, with contemporary philosophers returning to the works of the classical pragmatists, by re-appropriating their insights and methods for current philosophical problems. Among such neo-pragmatists is a growing number of feminist thinkers and activists who seek to particularly utilise pragmatism’s theories and concepts to ameliorate problems originating in oppressive systems structured by gender, race, class, and other markers of difference. As this article will demonstrate, there are several aspects of pragmatist philosophy which appear to overlap with the priorities of feminists, making pragmatism an attractive and valuable resource for a joint feminist-pragmatist approach.

While feminists have therefore found a useful ‘ally’ (Siegfried 1993a, 2) in pragmatism as a means of thinking about selves and the worlds they inhabit, this feminist reengagement with pragmatism has also uncovered hitherto unknown or neglected historical thinkers from the classical period. More often than not, historiographies of pragmatism identify the classical pragmatists as Charles Sanders Peirce, William James, John Dewey, and sometimes to a lesser extent George Herbert Mead, George Santayana, or Josiah Royce (for more on these topics, see Pragmatism). However, feminists have shown that historical accounts, which are limited to only these figures, omit the contributions made by women to the development of pragmatism, and fail to recognise the important role women pragmatists play as classical pragmatists.

For instance, Alice Chipman Dewey, John Dewey’s wife, had a significant impact upon the latter’s thought, indeed, she ran the experimental Lab School at the University of Chicago, where Dewey’s educational theories were given real-life application (see John Dewey). Moreover, Alice’s feminism and religious unorthodoxy formed an important influence in the trajectory Dewey’s idealism and theism took, and it is now generally acknowledged that Dewey’s concern with the social problems of his day can be attributed to Alice (West, 78–79). Dewey and Alice met at the University of Michigan, where women had only recently been allowed to undertake studies, and where Dewey was employed as a young philosophy instructor. They married in 1886, and throughout her lifetime, Alice continued to affect Dewey’s beliefs, being particularly concerned with women’s rights, while going on to expand her knowledge and practice in the field of education – a field she had entered as a teacher before beginning college. Describing her mother as a woman with a “brilliant mind…a sensitive nature combined with indomitable courage and energy,” Jane Dewey held Alice largely responsible for Dewey’s “early widening of…philosophic interests from the commentative and classical to the field of contemporary life” (Dewey 1987, 21). Given that Dewey understood philosophy as a means to redressing the problems of his time, and given that Alice awakened a sort of social consciousness in Dewey, it is obvious what a pivotal role she played in Dewey’s thought, and, in turn, in the development of pragmatism more generally.

While several women influenced pragmatism in such a manner, there are examples of women thinkers from this early period who could legitimately be classed alongside the traditionally acknowledged pragmatists. Thus, recent efforts to recover women pragmatist work have resulted in the identification of Jane Addams as a philosopher and social reformer, whose name should be listed in conjunction with Peirce, James and Dewey in the historical annals of pragmatism. Like Alice Chipman Dewey, Addams had a profound effect on Dewey, however, she was also a prolific writer and activist, who sought to bring about the real-life changes she theorised. Many other pragmatists at the time were connected to Addams, particularly through her activist headquarters and home, Hull House. Addams set up Hull House as a hub for local activities and community organising, as she shared her life with the diverse immigrant groups of one of Chicago’s poorest areas. Hull House soon became a centre for people wishing to contribute to Addams’s vision, and several women emerged from this environment having already effected substantial changes in such diverse areas as education, industrial relations, and architecture, and subsequently going on to establish successful careers, often as the first leading women in their respective chosen fields.

Charlotte Perkins Gilman, for example, stayed in Hull House for a month, and was a prominent social reformer, drawing particular attention to women’s domestic role and the politics of urban planning. Gilman argued that the division of labour disadvantaged and trapped women in the domestic sphere, and she maintained that household work should be professionalised. As such, Gilman has been understood as occupying a place in the history of material feminism, however, she has also been shown to rightfully “belon[g] in pragmatism’s pantheon” (Upin, 56). Beyond Gilman’s obvious relationship with Jane Addams and Hull House, Jane Upin also outlines her possibly personal, but certainly intellectual, connection to John Dewey. In fact, Gilman is said to expand upon the latter’s pragmatist insights by extending the basic principle of ‘environmentalism’ (that is, the notion that human nature can be altered by one’s environment), by theorising women’s confinement in the domestic realm, and the effect this has on women as human beings (Upin, 48–54). Sharing Dewey’s and Addams’s regard for Darwinism, and their opposition to a deterministic reading thereof, Gilman joins her pragmatist contemporaries by coupling Darwinism with a belief in the capacity for human beings to bring about change. Like Addams, she takes such change to be especially pertinent for women, and she is therefore a prime example of an early feminist-pragmatist.

While Hull House formed a focal point for pragmatist activism and intellectualism, the universities at which pragmatists taught fulfilled a similar role. For example, Ella Flagg Young studied with John Dewey at the University of Chicago and earned her doctoral degree on “Isolation in the School” before taking up the post of supervisor of the Lab School. Young was a mature student, having already had a successful career as an educator, and Dewey drew upon her vast experience in developing and applying pragmatist concepts and ideas of education. Both Dewey and Young influenced each other, though, and Dewey actually maintained that Young often underestimated her own pragmatist work, which he described as a “concrete empirical pragmatism with reference to philosophical conceptions before the doctrine was ever formulated in print” (quoted in Seigfried 1996, 81). Following Dewey’s departure from the University of Chicago, Young went on to become the first woman superintendent of Chicago’s public schools, and was also the first woman president of the National Educational Association.

Upon leaving Chicago, Dewey taught Elsie Ripley Clapp at Columbia University, who acted simultaneously as his graduate assistant. This was a long and fruitful collaboration, with Clapp not only helping Dewey to structure and develop courses, but also contributing to research, particularly on education. Dewey appears to have gained insights from her, which he acknowledges in private correspondence, or rather obtusely in his published work. For example, Charlene Haddock Siegfried points out that Dewey states his indebtedness to her (and to other women influences) not in the main text of his works, but rather in the preface (or in footnotes, as the case may be), leaving Clapp’s precise input obscure, and obfuscating the exact nature and scale thereof. And yet, her role is a significant one, as Dewey describes in a letter his indebtedness in profuse terms, noting that “such a generous exploitation of your ideas as is likely to result if and when I publish the outcome, seems to go beyond the limit” (Seigfried 1996, 50). Indeed, Dewey supported Clapp as his successor when he retired, although his enthusiasm was not met by the administration of Teachers College, as she was bypassed for the post. Clapp subsequently ran two experimental rural schools in Jefferson County, Kentucky, and in Arthurdale, West Virginia, the latter being a project conceived by Eleanor Roosevelt. She wrote books on education, incorporating pragmatist ideas developed during her time with Dewey, and acted as editor for Progressive Education. Sadly, her work, and influence on Dewey’s work, became neglected, with accounts of the latter’s academic life omitting Clapp altogether, hence the importance of recovering such historically overlooked figures (Seigfried 1996, 47–52).

Lucy Sprague Mitchell, another student of the pragmatists, was influenced not only by Dewey (with whom she developed a life-long intellectual relationship through her parents, and whose classes she went to at Teachers College in 1913), but she also benefited from being exposed to the Harvard pragmatists, including William James, Josiah Royce, George Herbert Palmer, Hugo Münsterberg, and George Santayana. She became the first dean for women at the University of California at Berkeley, while also taking on a faculty position in English. Mitchell sometimes looked after a friend’s child, Polly, whom she studied intensely, and her enthusiasm for seeing Polly develop, issued in a career change toward childhood education. Polly died when she was only four years old, yet undoubtedly she had a profound effect on Mitchell, who took her cue for pragmatist educational theory from the real-life experiences gained with Polly. Thus, although Mitchell had attended several philosophy classes, she had no interest in becoming a philosopher, finding the (male) philosophers she knew eccentric or aloof. In Alice Freeman Palmer, wife of Herbert Palmer, though, she found a role model, and since Alice had been president of Wellesley in an age where women’s education was still a controversial topic, Mitchell followed in her footsteps, as it were, by opting for an administrative career at Berkeley. The pervasive sexism she encountered there, and her growing belief in “public education [as] the most constructive attack on social problems” (Seigfried 1996, 55), when coupled with her emphasis on experience, resulted in the focus on education in the latter part of her life. Notably, Mitchell’s pragmatist educational theory and practice took hold in the Bank Street School (Seigfried  1996,  52 – 57).

A student of George Herbert Mead, Jessie Taft, is another forgotten pragmatist figure recently ‘unearthed’ by contemporary scholars engaged in recovering women pragmatist work. Taft completed, in 1913, her doctoral thesis, which formed possibly “the first Ph.D. dissertation in philosophy on the women’s movement” (Seigfried 1993b, 215). Entitled “The Woman Movement from the Point of View of Social Consciousness,” it is remarkably contemporary in tone, and appears to anticipate several important issues and conceptual ideas debated by feminist theorists today. Taft argues that women are hampered in both the domestic and public spheres, having control over neither, ultimately resulting in a disconnected and under-developed self with limited social awareness. Drawing parallels with the labour movement, she thus explains the task of the women’s movement as a twofold venture, consisting first of the need to “make women conscious of their relations to a social order, second, to show society its need of conscious womanhood” (Taft 225). She notes that the situation of women is not only inhibitive for women’s selfhood, but also for men’s, and for the “growth,” as Dewey would term it, of society more generally. Writes Taft:

This stage of social development [wherein we shall have conditions favourable for the control of social problems] can never be reached as long as any large class of people, such as its women, are permitted, encouraged, or forced to exist in an unreal world wilfully maintained for that purpose. Nor will the selves of men, in so far as they are formed by their relations to women, ever reach the full possibilities of selfhood while women remain only partially self-conscious. (Taft 229)

Taft extends Mead’s theory of selfhood, and couples it with a tripartite categorisation of consciousness, rejecting individualism in favour of a social reading of selfhood in the context of feminists’ attempts to institute suffrage. Sadly, Taft’s own life story appears to be a stark reminder of the rather slow progress made by the movement she theorised, as it took over two decades for her to find a full-time post after completing her doctorate (Seigfried 1993b, 215 – 218).

Discriminatory and sexist treatment like this undoubtedly impacted upon the lives and work of many of the early women pragmatists. Universities were often loath to recognise women on a par with men, either as students or as faculty members. Several women students of pragmatists, though, found in their teachers male philosophers supportive of women’s education, who repeated their courses at attached women’s colleges (Radcliffe in the case of Harvard), or who committed themselves to coeducation. Unfortunately, such progressiveness was not always matched by the university hierarchy, and women scholars struggled to gain the legitimate and deserved recognition for their work. For instance, Mary Whiton Calkins completed with distinction her Ph.D. in 1895 under the supervision of Hugo Münsterberg. However, she never received her doctorate from Harvard, despite undertaking studies there. She was asked, instead, to take the degree from Radcliffe, but as Seigfried explains, since Radcliffe only provided undergraduate courses, acceptance of such an intermediary would have legitimised Harvard’s continued discriminatory treatment of women. Calkins went on to become a professor at Wellesley, and was the first woman president of both the American Psychological Association and the American Philosophical Association (Seigfried 1993c,  230 – 231).

Given the off-putting nature of such overt sexism, it is not surprising to find that several women pragmatists either left universities, or had only a limited direct involvement with them. Seigfried, for instance, cites Lucy Sprague Mitchell’s letter, in which she details her reaction to encountering misogyny at Berkeley. Mitchell states that she was shocked upon realising “that most of the faculty thought of women frankly as inferior beings” (Seigfried 1996, 54). While many women scholars tried to remain within the university system, one can understand how such a pervasive sexism may pose a deterrent to a continued career in academia. On the other hand, several women pragmatists felt confined not only by the hostility of university administrations and faculty members, but by the largely theoretical nature of academic work. Since pragmatism emphasises experience as a counter-weight to theory, and insists upon the mutually reinforcing and informing nature of experience and theory, many women pragmatists found the university setting constricting.

Thus, Mitchell notes of Jane Addams, that she became for her “a symbol of the ‘real’ world – a world of work and of people that I longed to reach but could not” (Seigfried 1996, 56). The “real world” referred to by Mitchell, although promoted through initiatives such as the Lab School, remained, to too large an extent, inaccessible for pragmatists such as Mitchell, and they therefore sought actual experience outside of the realm of academia. It is for this reason, also, that the most prominent woman pragmatist, Jane Addams, kept her focus on the “real world” outside of universities, despite giving lectures at the University of Chicago. The next section explores the life and thought of this influential pragmatist in greater detail, as her work and impact merits further elucidation, if women’s role in the development of pragmatism is to be fully understood. It is important though, to note in sum, that pragmatism is not confined to universities, but is very much a philosophy inspired by and concerned with “the real world,” whether this is found in academia or outside of it.

b. Jane Addams

Jane AddamsJane Addams epitomises this quest, typical of many women pragmatists, for a life in the “real world” wherein pragmatist insights can be gained and fed into theory production. Thus, Addams’s writings are replete with quotidian experiences and scenes taken from Hull House.  Many of her essays and books concentrate on the personal lives of immigrant neighbours she came to know through her settlement activities, and her diverse intellectual influences lead to a polyvocality rarely seen in more traditional philosophical writing. The voices of her neighbours, novelists, poets, Greek dramatists, and philosophers, mingle in her texts, problematising lived experiences and drawing important theoretical insights therefrom.

The topics she discusses are far from typical Victorian era academic fare. Prostitution, juvenile delinquency, world peace, folk tales, and democracy are just some of the themes covered in her extensive philosophical output. Perhaps because Addams’s writing is unconventional in content and style, has she been dismissed as a mere practitioner. She is often erroneously viewed as an implementer of the male pragmatists’ ideas, and her philosophical insights are denigrated while she is labelled a social worker rather than a philosopher. Although Addams was simultaneously a social worker, sociologist, political activist, labour mediator, and educator, importantly, she was also a formidable pragmatist thinker. Her multiple roles informed a unique body of work so intimately linked to experience that it is perhaps most quintessentially pragmatist, in that there really is no separation between theory and practice in her work.

The recovery work undertaken by contemporary scholars acknowledges this, and has sought to re-establish Addams as a classical pragmatist who captures the progressive era’s spirit in her very being, by living the principles pragmatism espouses. For although Addams was somewhat of a celebrity in her time, just like many other women pragmatists, she was left out of the philosophical canon, being remembered, instead, as a pacifist or suffragist. Renewed interest in Addams, though, has led to a re-examination of her work, and her impact upon the development of pragmatism is now increasingly recognised. For instance, Dewey and Addams had an intimate intellectual relationship, with Dewey becoming a trustee of Hull House, and visiting there frequently to deliver lectures to the Plato Club, Hull House’s philosophical society. Dewey acknowledged his philosophical indebtedness to Addams, and both thinkers influenced each other mutually, developing pragmatist ideas and theories in tandem. Addams’s close links with the University of Chicago meant that a cross-pollination of ideas between faculty members and Hull House residents was inevitable. Further, owing to the fame she achieved in her lifetime, she was in close correspondence with many influential thinkers, writers, activists, and policy makers beyond the realms of academia and the Chicago settlement.

Addams was a sought-after public speaker, and although she had a steadfast belief in the principles she developed in her work, she never spoke on behalf of those whose interests she defended, but chose to speak with them by engaging in an inclusionary approach to transformation. This, perhaps, most aptly characterises Addams’s conception of the settlement, as she rejected the negative stereotyping of people found in supposedly benevolent charity work, and instead opted for understanding and supporting her neighbours through what we would today call a ‘bottom-up’ approach to activism. Hence, Addams understands the settlement as:

an experimental effort to aid in the solution of the social and industrial problems which are engendered by the modern conditions of life in a great city…It is an attempt to relieve, at the same time, the overaccumulation at one end of society and the destitution at the other; but it assumes that this overaccumulation and destitution is most sorely felt in the things that pertain to social and educational advantages. (Addams 2008, 83)

While Hull House counteracted such ‘overaccumulation at one end of society’ through various initiatives – establishing educational courses, art classes, child care and sports facilities, or rallying against corruption in politics and providing space for labour organising – Addams remained non-committed in ideological terms.

She rejected divisiveness and although she supported several causes, she avoided adopting specific labels. In her autobiographical book Twenty Years at Hull House, she wrote of the settlement, that “from its very nature it can stand for no political or social propaganda. It must, in a sense, give the warm welcome of an inn to all such propaganda, if perchance one of them be found an angel” (Addams 2008, 83). This non-ideological attitude was often criticised by commentators, as was, ironically, the one ideology she did assume, that is, pacifism. Addams was an outspoken opponent of war, and campaigned against the U.S.’s entry into World War I. For this, she was vilified and her work was frequently maligned. In later years, though, her activism for peace, which included the co-founding of the Women’s International League for Peace and Freedom (WILPF), was recognised, and she was awarded the 1931 Nobel Peace Prize.

Throughout Addams’s varied career, during which she gradually moved from settlement work to more global activism, she developed a pragmatism, which was intimately concerned with instituting progress, particularly for the politically, socially and economically marginalised. Since women made up a large part of this constituency, her work represents a formidable example of early feminist-pragmatism. Addams explicitly addressed the concerns of women, which were largely neglected by the male pragmatists, and her texts provide invaluable insights informed by the gendered nature of our experiences. Her attribution of moral import to pluralism in democracy (Addams 2002a), her cosmopolitanism (Addams 2002b), her meliorism (Addams 2005), her quest for knowledge through ‘perplexities’ (Addams 2002a), her understanding of memory in terms of its transformative potential of past and future (Addams 2002c), and her interpretation of art and beauty as relief from the dreariness of industrial life (Addams 2008), form just some of the significant theoretical contributions to a pragmatist philosophy, which was both lived and intellectually conceived. As such, Addams constitutes a towering figure in the history of feminist-pragmatism and of classical pragmatism more generally.

c. Early Feminist-Pragmatist Legacy

Owing largely to Charlene Haddock Seigfried’s seminal work Pragmatism and Feminism, contemporary feminist-pragmatists have managed to unearth hitherto unknown early pragmatist work undertaken by women. Some of these women were not necessarily feminists, nor were they necessarily primarily concerned with theorising the experiences of women. However, their influences have shaped the development of pragmatism itself, and the work of expressly feminist-pragmatists constitutes a particularly rich resource for contemporary feminist-pragmatist theorists. Thus, the writings of early women pragmatists are being utilised by theorists today, and increased interest in their work has resulted not only in several updated biographies and a reissuing of their texts, but also in new, original books and articles engaging with their arguments and theories (see for example, Hamington, 2010 and Fischer 2009).

Importantly, some of the themes contemporary thinkers are concerned with, are also topics previously explored by their feminist-pragmatist forerunners. For instance, Judy D. Whipps (2006) draws upon the work of Emily Greene Balch to trace the thematic continuity between Balch’s priorities and the priorities of contemporary feminist peace activists. Balch was a pragmatist thinker, economist, and social scientist. Like Addams, she was a co-founder of the Women’s International League for Peace and Freedom (WILPF), and was awarded the Nobel Peace Prize fifteen years after Addams had received that same honour. Balch’s activism similarly grew out of her engagement with the settlement movement, although being involved with the foundation of Denison House in 1982, she re-entered academia after two years to continue her studies both in the United States and in Europe. Together with Addams and Alice Hamilton she wrote Women at The Hague (Addams et al.2003), an account of the 1915 International Congress of Women.

Although employed by Wellesley as a professor, her peace activism hampered her academic career, and she subsequently focused solely on advocating for peace. She championed anti-colonialism, being largely responsible for a critical report on United States de facto control over Haiti (1927), criticised unjust trade relations between more or less powerful states, and sought U.N. control of all military bases. Her theoretical work enshrined a cosmopolitanism and pluralism reminiscent of Addams’s ‘bottom-up’ conceptualisation of meliorism. She held that shared work could facilitate shared understanding, arguing that “cooperation in practical, technical tasks is one of the best ways of learning the indispensable art of getting along with one another” (Whipps 126). Importantly, Balch is a predecessor to contemporary women peace activists, who can learn from her pragmatist understandings of international affairs in terms of cooperation and the desire to realise progressive change (Whipps 123 – 130).

Several early women pragmatists seem to anticipate contemporary feminist debates, and formulate concepts, which are part and parcel of today’s theoretical vocabulary. Thus, in “Follett’s Pragmatist Ontology of Relations: Potentials for a Feminist Perspective on Violence,” Amrita Banerjee (2008) makes use of Mary Parker Follett’s work to shed light on the ontological implications of gendered violence. Follett became a leading management consultant in her time, however, she also developed pragmatist theories on politics in works such as The New State (1998). Follett distinguished between ‘power-over’ and ‘power-with’, arguing that “whereas power usually means power-over…it is possible to develop the conception of power-with, a jointly developed power, a co-active, not a coercive power” (Banerjee 4). While Banerjee employs this reconceptualisation of power in terms of ‘power-over’ and ‘power-with’ in an analysis of gender based violence, it is easy to see how this hybrid understanding of power has become engrained in our contemporary minds, and has been utilised by feminist theorists, peace activists, and others, to advance a more sophisticated comprehension of a variety of political issues.

In this sense, then, early women pragmatists, even when not explicitly feminist, can be engaged by current feminist thinkers in feminist causes and can contribute to critical feminist-pragmatist reflections on problems facing women and men in today’s world. Also, the thematic continuity between early and later women pragmatists – whether they wrote on democracy, international governance, peace, education, community activism, gender roles, or employment – indicates the abundance of theoretical material which can be fruitfully mined by contemporary theorists. Thus, the writings of Addams, Balch, Follett, Gilman, Mitchell, Young, Clapp and Taft constitute a rich legacy for the feminist-pragmatists of today.

2.Contemporary Feminist-Pragmatism

Beyond the conduciveness of early women pragmatist work to contemporary feminist projects, theorists and activists of today also draw upon the work of the male pragmatists. This is because pragmatism, in general, is a tradition which rejects many of the philosophical claims feminists reject, and promotes many of the objectives feminists promote. Due to the extensive proliferation of feminist theory, particularly over the latter part of the twentieth century and into the present, feminists are in a position to bring sophisticated philosophical insights and concepts to bear upon early pragmatist thought. Indeed, many feminist theoretical analyses, which may have developed in isolation from pragmatism, nonetheless find resonance in pragmatist theory and practice. For example, there is a large body of work, in feminist philosophy, on embodiment. Feminists have argued that physicality is often denigrated in our societies, and is theorised as being subservient or inferior to intellect. Pragmatists, such as John Dewey, have rejected this demarcation of body and mind, and oppose the devaluing of the former in favour of the latter. Contemporary feminist-pragmatists, like Shannon Sullivan (2001), have therefore been able to use pragmatist and feminist work to advance feminist-pragmatist theories of embodiment.

Dewey calls such false axiological bifurcations as mind/body dualisms, and he identifies several of these in the history of philosophical thought. Self/environment, change/stasis, universal/particular, thought/practice─all of these are distinctions, which erroneously create oppositionals, with one oppositional being valued at the expense of the other. Feminists have similarly found such dualisms in philosophical theories, and have shown that they hold distinctly gendered implications. Thus, connections have been made between the philosophical denigration of the body in favour of the mind, and the devaluation of women’s bodies in particular (owing to the common identification of womanhood in bodily terms). Feminists can therefore use pragmatist understandings of dualisms to counter the traditional juxtaposition of body and mind, and in conjunction with feminist theoretical insights, can argue against the subjugation of gendered bodies in particular.

Another dualism prevalent in much philosophical thought, is reason/emotion. As several feminist-pragmatists have pointed out, both pragmatists and feminists reject this dualism and recognise the importance of feeling and the affective in our daily interactions with people, while accepting the political potential this may also hold for our societies. Indeed, the feminist re-valuing of the affective has issued in a branch of feminist moral philosophy called care ethics. Charles Sanders Peirce’s work recognises the emotional or felt dimension of thought (Peirce 1934-1963), while William James emphasises the centrality of care and sympathy particularly in women’s lives (James 1983, see also Seigfried 1996). Pragmatist philosophy and care ethics can be mutually conducive bodies of work, allowing feminist-pragmatists to reconceptualise the relationship between reason and emotion, and redressing the skewed favouring of one over the other. Several feminist-pragmatists have done precisely that, by theorising the affective in the context of care ethics and pragmatist thought (see Leffers, 1993; Pappas, 1993; and Seigfried, 1989).

Many feminists, including care ethicists, critique a dominant view of selfhood, which assumes us to be isolated, self-sufficient beings. This abstract individualism attendant in much philosophical theorising is also, however, undermined by pragmatist thinkers. George Herbert Meade, for instance, problematises the development of selves in community with other human beings, and explicitly discusses what is later to become a central theme in feminist theory, that is, self as it exists in relation to the other (1934). Pragmatists reject a clear opposition between self and society, and argue instead that true selfhood can only take place through community. Hence, for pragmatists and feminists, the self needs to be understood with regard to its relationality. This conception of the self and its interdependent existence with others is important both for ontology, and for moral and political philosophy, as our dependency, our sociality, and our power to transform each other hold important implications for debates on gender and liberalism, communitarianism, and libertarianism, amongst others. Thus, theorists such as Judy Whipps (2004) have developed feminist-pragmatist models for comprehending selves in the context of their shared existences with others.

Feminists and pragmatists also oppose the practice/thought dualism alongside the closely related experience/theory dualism. As noted earlier, for many women pragmatists of the classical period, the university setting stifled any real, sustained engagement with experience. This is why they often practiced pragmatism outside of academia, where experience could be focused on more intensively, thereby allowing the reciprocal relationship between theory and practice to really take hold. Today, as well, pragmatism exists outside of the academic world, and this is perhaps why it is such an attractive philosophy for feminists, as feminism also usually entails activism outside of the academy. The intimate relationship between practice and thought is also significant in terms of education, and the early pragmatists, such as Dewey and Addams, developed educational theories which captured the symbiotic nature of doing and thinking (Dewey, 2008 and Addams 2008). These insights are still relevant today, and have epistemological import, especially when coupled with the pragmatist prioritising of pluralism.

For pragmatists, diversity leads to vibrant democracies, however, it also enriches knowledge. Given that women’s knowledge is often dismissed, feminism is fundamentally akin to pragmatism in this respect, as it promotes inclusionary epistemologies, which stem directly from our gendered life experiences. Feminists seek the legitimisation of women’s knowledge through epistemological models, such as standpoint theory, which recognise women’s unique experiences knowable only to them. Pragmatists also reject a bird’s eye view of the world, wherein objective knowledge can be achieved by appealing to singular accounts of the Truth, but instead propose that there are multiple truths. Dewey, for example, views truth as a working hypothesis, which we’ve come, for the time being, to agree upon, but which needs to be continuously reviewed (Dewey, 1986). Pragmatism thus anticipates the post-modern critique of totalising narratives of truth, without falling into an inescapable relativism. Feminism, which has had to come to terms with its own exclusions – in terms of omitting the experiences and attendant truths of women of colour, for example – can utilise pragmatist epistemological insights to its advantage to promote pluralist and egalitarian epistemologies. Several contemporary feminists have proceeded in such a manner to devise feminist-pragmatist approaches to knowledge, building upon pragmatist explanations of , for example, the impetus for thought provided by Addams’s ‘perplexities’ or Peirce’s ‘irritation of doubt’ (see Rooney, 1993). Shannon Sullivan has also developed a feminist-pragmatist standpoint theory with which to overcome the “false dilemma of objectivism and relativism” (Sullivan 211).

The early pragmatists were ardent defenders of democracy, although they eschewed labels and the blind adoption of ideologies. This is due to pragmatism’s meliorism, but also to pragmatism’s view of the world and its inhabitants as constantly evolving. Hence, the dualism of change/stasis is undercut in pragmatist philosophy, as continuity and stability exist simultaneously with dynamism and change. Precisely because metaphysically everything is in the making, should we avoid rigidly clinging to certain structures, as these should not retain their current form. Thus, Dewey recognised that American society had changed immensely since democracy was instituted, and yet, the same out-dated ideas seemed to underpin democracy several hundred years later. For Dewey, this was hugely destructive to the values and aims democracy sought to promote, and he repeatedly criticised the abstract individualism and false universalism attendant in liberal theory, which were originally, perhaps, appropriate, but which hampered the further development of democracy into a more modern ethico-political system (Dewey, 1985). In her book The Task of Utopia, Erin McKenna appropriates Dewey’s adaptive ontology, and draws upon feminist utopian literature to advance a “process model of utopia” which counters the “end-state model of utopia” by positing utopia as always in the making (2001). Contemporary feminist-pragmatists have also developed and extended pragmatist theorising on democracy, and have built upon pragmatism’s espousal of pluralism and the political implications of the often problematic nature of selves in community with others (see Singer 1999, Greene 1999, and  Sullivan 2006).

Finally, it should be noted that there has been feminist engagement with neo-pragmatist philosophers, particularly with Richard Rorty. However, this has sometimes been controversial, as Rorty’s philosophy has been criticised for undermining some of pragmatism’s core principles, including its social and political commitments (Brodsky, 1982). Contemporary feminist-pragmatists have thus critically evaluated Rorty and his post-linguistic turn interpretation of pragmatism, while Rorty, on the other hand, has explicitly problematised feminism’s relationship to deconstructionism and pragmatism (1993). Themes covered in this neo-pragmatist and feminist exchange include masculinist ideology, the rejection of language over experience (Kaufman-Osborn, 1993), and the functioning of power (Bickford, 1993).

3. Conclusion

Feminist-pragmatists of the 21st century benefit from the confluence of feminism and pragmatism, being able to draw upon both feminist and pragmatist theory and practice. Early feminist-pragmatist work, of course, already exhibits a convergence of feminist and pragmatist insights, hence the wealth of material available for ‘mining’ by contemporary feminist-pragmatists. Given that the recovery of women pragmatist work is still ongoing, it is likely that such feminist-pragmatist resources will continue to grow, as more and more women pragmatists are rescued from historical oblivion. In the meantime, though, pragmatists provide the inspiration for many feminist-pragmatists writing on themes dear to the hearts of their feminist-pragmatist predecessors, bringing contemporary feminist concepts and debates to bear upon pragmatist lessons from metaphysics, epistemology, political philosophy, ethics, and philosophy of education.

The philosophical kinship between pragmatism and feminism can also be attributed to both their liberatory aspirations. Early pragmatists, such as Addams, Dewey, and Balch, were part of progressive movements for equality for women and people of colour, for world peace, for increased access to quality education, and for an end to political corruption and economic greed. Contemporary feminist-pragmatists will likely continue pursuing some of these progressive goals, while also trying to achieve new goals arising from the present historical context.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Early Pragmatist and Feminist-Pragmatist Sources

  • Addams, J., Twenty Years at Hull House, Dover, New York, 2008.
  • Addams, J., Writings on Peace, (edited by Fischer, M. & Whipps, J. D.), Continuum London, 2005.
  • Addams, J., Democracy and Social Ethics, University of Illinois Press, Urbana and Chicago, 2002a.
  • Addams, J., Peace and Bread in Time of War, University of Illinois Press, Urbana and Chicago, 2002b.
  • Addams, J., The Long Road of Woman’s Memory, University of Illinois Press, Urbana and Chicago, 2002c.
  • Addams, J. et al., Women at The Hague: The International Congress of Women and its Results, University of Illinois Press, Urbana and Chicago, 2003.
  • Balch, E. G. (ed.), Occupied Haiti, New York, Garland Publishing, 1972.
  • Dewey, John, Democracy and Education in John Dewey: The Middle Works, Vol. 9: 1916, Boydston (ed.), Southern Illinois University Press, Carbondale and Edwardsville,    2008
  • Dewey, John, Logic: The Theory of Inquiry in John Dewey: The Later Works, Vol. 12: 1938, Boydston (ed.), Southern Illinois University Press, Carbondale and Edwardsville, 1986.
  • Dewey, John, The Public and its Problems in John Dewey: The Later Works, Vol. 2: 1925 –1927,Boydston (ed.), Southern Illinois University Press, Carbondale and      Edwardsville, 1985.
  • Elshtain, J. B. (ed.), The Jane Addams Reader, Basic Books, New York, 2002.
  • Follett, M. P., The New State: Group Organization the Solution of Popular Government, Pennsylvania State University Press, University Park, PA, 1998.
  • James, W., Talks to Teachers on Psychology in The Works of William James, Burkhard et. al., (ed.), Harvard University Press, Cambridge,1983.
  • Meade, G. H., Mind, Self and Society: From the Perspective of  Social Behaviorist, Morris (ed.), University of Chicago Press, Chicago, 1934.
  • Mitchell, Lucy Sprague, Two Lives: The Story of Wesley Clair Mitchell and Myself, Simon and Schuster, New York, 1953.
  • Peirce, C. S., Collected Papers of Charles Sanders Peirce, Hartshorne et al. (ed.), Belknap Press of Harvard University Press, Cambridge, 1934-1963.
  • Taft, J., “The Woman Movement as Part of the Larger Social Situation” [excerpt from doctoral thesis “The Woman Movement from the Point of View of Social Consciousness”],Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.

b. Contemporary Feminist-Pragmatist Sources:

i. Introductions or Overviews

  • Duran, J., “The Intersection of Pragmatism and Feminism,” Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.
  • Miller, M., “Feminism and Pragmatism: On the Arrival of a ‘Ministry of Disturbance, a     Regulated Source of Annoyance, a Destroyer of Routine, an Underminer of Complacency’”,The Monist, Vol. 75, No. 4, October 1992.
  • Radin, M. J., “The Pragmatist and the Feminist”, Southern California Law Review, Vol. 63, 1990.
  • Seigfried, C. H., Pragmatism and Feminism: Reweaving the Social Fabric, University of Chicago Press, London, 1996.
  • Seigfried, C. H., “Shared Communities of Interest: Feminism and Pragmatism”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993a.
  • Seigfried, C. H., “The Missing Perspective: Feminist Pragmatism”, Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society, Vol. 27, No. 4, Fall 1991.
  • Seigfried, C. H., “Where Are All the Pragmatist Feminists?” Hypatia, Vol. 6, No. 2, Summer 1991.

ii. More Advanced or Specialised Sources

  • Aboulafia, M., “Was George Herbert Mead a Feminist?”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.
  • Banerjee, A., “Follett’s Pragmatist Ontology of Relations: Potentials for a Feminist Perspective on Violence,” Journal of Speculative Philosophy, Vol. 22, No. 1, 2008.
  • Bickford, S., “Why We Listen to Lunatics: Antifoundational Theories and Feminist Politics”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993, pp. 104 – 124.
  • Brodsky, G., “Rorty’s Interpretation of Pragmatism”, Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society, Vol. 18, No. 4, pp. 311 – 337.
  • Dewey, Jane, “Biography of Dewey” in The Philosophy of John Dewey, Schilpp et al. (ed.), La Salle, IL, Open Court, 1989, pp. 3 – 46.
  • Deegan, M. J., “‘Dear Love, Dear Love’: Feminist Pragmatism and the Chicago Female World of Love and Ritual”, Gender & Society, Vol. 10, No. 5, October 1996.
  • Fischer, M. et al., Jane Addams and the Practice of Democracy, University of Illinois Press, Urbana and Chicago, 2009.
  • Fischer, M., “Addams’s Internationalist Pacifism and the Rhetoric of Maternalism”, NWSA Journal, Vol. 18, No. 3, Fall 2006.
  • Gatens-Robinson, E., “Dewey and the Feminist successor Science Project”, Transactions of  the Charles S. Peirce Society, Vol. 27, No. 4, Fall 1991.
  • Greene, J. M., Deep Democracy: Community, Diversity and Transformation, Rowman & Littlefield, Lanham, MA, 1999.
  • Hamington, M., Feminist Interpretations of Jane Addams, Pennsylvania State University Press, University Park, PA, 2010.
  • Hamington, M., The Social Philosophy of Jane Addams, Urbana and Chicago: University of Illinois Press, 2009.
  • Heldke, L., “John Dewey and Evelyn Fox Keller: A Shared Epistemological Tradition”, Hypatia, Vol. 2, No. 3, Fall 1987.
  • Kaufman-Osborn, T. V., “Teasing Feminist Sense from Experience”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993, pp. 124 – 144.
  • Jannack, M., Feminist Interpretations of Richard Rorty, Penn State University Press, University Park, 2010.
  • Leffers, “Pragmatists Jane Addams and John Dewey Inform the Ethic of Care”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.
  • Mahowald, M. B., “A Majority Perspective: Feminine and Feminist Elements in American Philosophy”, Cross Currents, Vol. 36, Winter 1986.
  • McKenna, E., The Task of Utopia: A Pragmatist and Feminist Perspective, Rowman & Littlefield, Lanham, MA, 2001.
  • Moen, M. K., “Peirce’s Pragmatism as Resource for Feminism”, Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society, Vol. 27, No. 4, Fall 1991.
  • Pappas, G. F., “Dewey and Feminism: The Affective and Relationships in Dewey’s Ethics”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.
  • Rorty, R., “Feminism, Ideology, and Deconstruction: A Pragmatist View”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993, pp. 96 – 103.
  • Rooney, P., “Feminist-Pragmatist Revisionings of Reason, Knowledge, and Philosophy,”  Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.
  • Schilpp et al. (ed.), The Philosophy of John Dewey, Open Court, La Salle, IL, 1989.
  • Seigfried, C. H. (ed.), Feminist Interpretations of John Dewey, Pennsylvania State University Press, University Park, PA, 2002.
  • Seigfried, C. H. (ed.), Hypatia: Special Issue on Feminism and Pragmatism, Vol. 8, No. 3, Spring 1993.
  • Seigfried, C. H., “Introduction to Jessie Taft, ‘The Woman Movement from the Point of   View of Social Consciousness’”, Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993b.
  • Seigfried, C. H., “1895 Letter from Harvard Philosophy Department,” Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993c.
  • Seigfried, C. H., “Pragmatism, Feminism, and Sensitivity to Context” in Who Cares? Theory, Research, and Educational Implication of the Ethic of Care, Brabeck (ed.), Praeger, New York, 1989.
  • Singer, B., Pragmatism, Rights and Democracy, Fordham University Press, New York, 1999.
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  • Sullivan, S., “The Need for Truth: Toward a Pragmatist- Feminist Standpoint Theory” in Feminist Interpretations of John Dewey, Seigfried (ed.), Pennsylvania State University Press, University Park, PA, 2002.
  • Sullivan, S., Living Across and Through Skins: Transactional Bodies, Pragmatism, and Feminism, Indiana University Press, Bloomington and Indianapolis, 2001.
  • Upin, J., “Charlotte Perkins Gilman: Instrumentalism beyond Dewey,” Hypatia, Vol. 8, No. 2, Spring 1993.
  • Whipps, J. D., “The Feminist Pacifism of Emily Greene Balch, Nobel Peace Laureate,” NWSA Journal, Vol. 18, No. 3, Fall 2006.
  • Whipps, J. D., “Jane Addams’s Social Thought as a Model for a Pragmatist-Feminist Communitarianism,” Hypatia, Vol. 19, No. 2, Spring 2004.
  • West, C., The American Evasion of Philosophy: A Genealogy of Pragmatism, University of Wisconsin Press, Madison, 1989.

 

Author Information

Clara Fischer
Email: fischecc@tcd.ie
Trinity College Dublin
Ireland

Deconstruction

Although deconstruction has roots in Martin Heidegger’s concept of Destruktion, to deconstruct is not to destroy.  Deconstruction is always a double movement of simultaneous affirmation and undoing.  It started out as a way of reading the history of metaphysics in Heidegger and Jacques Derrida, but was soon applied to the interpretation of literary, religious, and legal texts as well as philosophical ones, and was adopted by several French feminist theorists as a way of making clearer the deep male bias embedded in the European intellectual tradition.

To deconstruct is to take a text apart along the structural “fault lines” created by the ambiguities inherent in one or more of its key concepts or themes in order to reveal the equivocations or contradictions that make the text possible.  For example, in “Plato’s Pharmacy,” Derrida deconstructs Socrates’ criticism of the written word, arguing that it not only suffers from internal inconsistencies because of the analogy Socrates himself makes between memory and writing, but also stands in stark contrast to the fact that his ideas come to us only through the written word he disparaged (D 61-171).  The double movement here is one of tracing this tension in Plato’s text, and in the traditional reading of that text, while at the same time acknowledging the fundamental ways in which our understanding of the world is dependent on Socrates’ attitude toward the written word.  Derrida points out similar contradictions in philosophical discussions of a preface (by G. W. F. Hegel, D 1-69) and a picture frame (by Immanuel Kant, TP 17-147), which are simultaneously inside and outside the respective works under consideration.

Since the distinction between what is inside the text (or painting) and what is outside can itself be deconstructed according to the same principles, deconstruction is, like Destruktion, an historicizing movement that opens texts to the conditions of their production, their con-text in a very broad sense, including not only the historical circumstances and tradition from which they arose, but also the conventions and nuances of the language in which they were written and the details of their authors’ lives.  This generates an effectively infinite complexity in texts that makes any deconstructive reading necessarily partial and preliminary.

Table of Contents

  1. Destruktion
  2. Deconstruction
    1. Early Formulations
    2. Literary Deconstruction
    3. Contentions and Confrontations
    4. Later Versions
  3. Feminist Deconstruction
  4. References and Further Readings
    1. References
    2. Additional Readings

1. Destruktion

Heidegger’s use of the word Destruktion suffers from the same problem as Edmund Husserl’s use of Intentionalität. Neither is an ordinary German word; both were borrowed from Latin almost as neologisms to express a concept their creators perceived as relatively new to the philosophical domain, only to have the words become confused with their more common cognates when translated into French or English.  The usual German word for “destruction” is “Zerstörung”, but Heidegger’s concept of Destruktion is also closely related to Abbau or dismantling.  Derrida uses the word deconstruction to capture both German terms. (EO 86-6).

In Being and Time, Heidegger says that the purpose of Destruktion is to “arrive at those primordial experiences in which we achieved our first ways of determining the nature of Being—the ways which have guided us ever since” (BT 44).  This is the double gesture referred to above, one that takes apart the European traditions and in so doing finds the basic understanding of Being beneath its surface. This goal separates Destruktion from deconstruction, not because deconstruction is purely negative, but because it has no fixed endpoint or goal.  Deconstruction is always an on-going process because the constantly shifting nature of language means that no final meaning or interpretation of a text is possible.  Subsequent ages, grounded in a different language and different ways of life, will always see something different in a text as they deconstruct it in the context of the realities with which they live.  What is meant by “the written word”, for example, has already evolved substantially since Derrida wrote “Plato’s Pharmacy” due to the explosion in electronic media.  All deconstruction can reveal are temporary and more or less adequate truths, not more primordial or deeper ones.  For Heidegger, on the other hand, the “primordial experiences” of Being revealed through Destruktion result in a single interpretation that offers a more authentic alternative to philosophy’s misunderstanding of the temporality and historicality of human existence.

Temporality and historicality are essential components of Dasein, Heidegger’s term for human existence, because it is “thrown projection”, that is, an entity necessarily oriented toward an unknown future, but always based on a past for which it is not itself fully responsible and which it can never fully know.  Time, then, is not only a category of experience (as in Kant), but the very core of our existence. As beings in a present moment are  defined in terms of a past that creates our possibilities and a future into which we project them.  On a larger scale, this temporality of Dasein (as opposed to Hegelian Spirit) is what creates history; our ability to project forward and interpret backwards not only the circumstances of our lives, but also those of the entire social world to which we belong.  For Heidegger, Destruktion of the traditions in that social world can lead us back to a past that can be re-interpreted in ways that reveal the deeper understanding of Being hidden in the earliest texts of the European tradition; it  can offer ways to project a different, more authentic future for Dasein based on the new way of seeing the past.

2. Deconstruction

a. Early Formulations

As already noted, deconstruction differs from Destruktion in that it has no fixed or expected endpoint or map, but is rather a potentially infinite process.  Although obviously a critical tool, it also lacks the sense, evident in Heidegger, that the text to be deconstructed is part of how European thought has somehow gone wrong and needs correction.  This is because deconstruction rejects both the idea that there is a fixed series of eras (ancient, medieval, modern) in European history that mark a downward path, and the idea that there is some determinate way in which that path might be reversed, by a re-interpretation of early Greek philosophy.  Rather, Derrida insists that what he deconstructs are texts that he “loves” (EO 87) and they  are vital parts of our intellectual world, with a view to revealing their underlying complexities and hidden contradictions.  He does not seek to undo Kant, for example, or interpret his writings in ways closer to Derrida’s own vision of what philosophy should be, but rather shows us the ways in which Kant both changes and continues the metaphysical tradition, as well as the ways in which Kant’s texts undo themselves along the same “fault lines” that have undermined that tradition throughout its history.

In 1967, Derrida offered this definition:

To ‘deconstruct’ philosophy, thus, would be to think—in the most faithful, interior way—the structured genealogy of philosophy’s concepts, but at the same time to determine—from a certain exterior that is unqualifiable or unnameable by philosophy—what this history has been able to dissimulate or forbid, making itself into a history by means of this. . .motivated repression (P 6).

What is outside of, or excluded from the realm dominated by the philosophical tradition, although unnamed in it, provides a vantage point and a key with which to find the flaws and lacunae that domination seeks to hide.  The opposition between the spoken and written word in Plato, the text and its introduction in Hegel, the painting and its frame in Kant belong to a series of oppositions (good/evil, mind/body, male/female, center/margin, necessary/contingent, and so forth .) that run though and in many ways structure the European philosophical tradition.  Each of these pairs is also a hierarchy meant to exclude both the non-dominant member of the pair (the body, the female, the margin, the contingent) and anything outside the opposition (the ambiguous, the borderline, the hybrid) from the philosophical realm.  These hierarchical oppositions, in turn, create the basis for political hierarchy and social domination (male/female, freeman/slave, propertied/landless, Christian/other, citizen/immigrant), power differentials that motivate the repression to which Derrida refers. This is why deconstruction denies the possibility of some pre-Socratic “primordial experience” of Being to be found through dismantling the metaphysical tradition which could then solve the problems that tradition has created, because that experience, too, would be subject to deconstruction along these same lines.

What deconstruction reveals, among other things, is that the repression that is necessary for creating a history of philosophy is in large part a repression of what philosophy itself cannot control, of what escapes the grasp of philosophy while being part of it.  The fault lines that deconstruction follows are the traces left inside philosophy by what it must define as exterior to it in order to be philosophy.  Derrida’s early work connects these fault lines to what is represented by the written word:  our inability to control or limit the meaning that might be given to our words because of the historical development of language, the ambiguity of linguistic meaning, and the ability of written text to be excerpted, reproduced and read in contexts we can neither imagine nor control (as opposed, supposedly, to the immediate and limited context of the spoken word).  This is why any text can be deconstructed (even Friedrich Nietzsche’s fragmentary message “I have forgotten my umbrella” in Spurs), but canonical texts (Plato, Kant, Hegel, later Heidegger himself) offer the richest and most productive grounds for deconstruction.  We learn more about ourselves by seeing the traces of a fear of absolute loss that motivate the Aufhebung in Hegel’s texts, than we might from finding the same anxiety in the writing of someone whose influence on European philosophy (and politics) has been less profound.

As an example of deconstruction here, however, it seems advisable to choose a text closer to Nietzsche’s umbrella, than Hegel’s phenomenology of Spirit.  The Truth in Painting takes its title from a letter in which Paul Cézanne tells Émile Bernard, “I owe you the truth in painting [la verité en peinture] and I will tell it to you.”  Derrida points out that the philosophy of language would assert that in writing this, Cézanne must have known what he meant, but in fact the sentence itself has no determinate meaning.  “The truth in painting” escapes and exceeds the boundaries philosophy wants to draw with regard to language because it has at least four meanings, none of which is reducible to any of the others:  1) the truth about truth itself to be found in or through a painting or other work of art, such as the truth Heidegger finds in Van Gogh’s painting of the shoes in “Origin of the Work of Art”; 2) the truth of the painting as painting, that is, how “true to life” it is, how well it succeeds in representing what it is meant to represent; 3) the truth about its object that can be found through the painting, such as when a portrait lays bare the character of its subject; and 4) the truth about painting in the sense of what is true in painting as a human enterprise or art form.

This ambiguity of the French sentence is compounded by the fact that Cézanne promises, not to paint the truth, but to tell or say it in language, thus linking text and painting in a complex nexus of possible meanings and realizations.  There is, and can be, no single meaning of this sentence simply because of the rather ordinary (but untranslatable) French phrase “en peinture”.  As is sometimes the case with the deconstruction of such partial and cryptic texts, Derrida’s target here is not Cézanne’s words themselves, but rather the account of truth and promises (the implicit debt in Cézanne’s “I owe you”) found in contemporary philosophy of language.  Not only does this sentence fail traditional philosophical tests for having a truth value, due to its ambiguity, it also fails to have the conditions of satisfaction, with which more recent philosophy of language hoped to replace those tests and determine whether Cézanne paid his “debt”.  By deconstructing the phrase “the truth in painting”, Derrida hopes to underscore the pragmatic reality that how language functions as a living phenomenon makes it impossible to develop purely formal criteria for identifying or cataloguing true statements.

b. Literary Deconstruction

One notable fact about the reception of deconstruction in the United States was its relatively early acceptance by departments of literature compared to departments of philosophy.  Undoubtedly , there are several reasons for this, but one may be that, as Geoffrey Hartman notes, “Deconstructive criticism does not present itself as a novel enterprise” because the ambiguity and contextuality, the interplay of the spoken and written word, that deconstruction emphasizes in philosophical texts are both more obvious and more acknowledged in literary ones.  At the same time, deconstruction, by foregrounding the fact that “Everything we thought of as spirit, or meaning separable from the letter of the text, remains within an ‘intertextual’ sphere” (DC viii), opened important channels of communication between philosophy and literary studies.

The tools of deconstruction and the sorts of truths they reveal, are similar in both spheres.  The basic strategy is still to follow the trace of a key ambiguity or blind spot through the text to illuminate hierarchical oppositions it relies on and the fault lines along which it can be undone, while still acknowledging its power and importance in European thought.  Ernest Jones’ classic psychoanalytic reading of “Hamlet”, for instance, is deconstructive in that it foregrounds the suppressed patricide in “Julius Caesar” (Shakespeare ignores the fact that Brutus was Caesar’s illegitimate son, thus implying an invariant (beloved-)father/(legitimate-)son pair), and then uses this omission as one key in tracing the Oedipal fault line in the later play.  Here deconstruction yields, not a new meaning to “Hamlet”, as one could say Derrida does in his discussion of prefaces in Hegel, but a new richness to our understanding of Shakespeare’s work.

This highlights the fact that deconstruction plays a different role in literature than in philosophy.  Deconstruction tends to be used in literary theory in arguments between and among theorists about the value of their theories, rather than about the value of the texts under discussion.  One deconstructs Kant to argue with Kant (and perhaps others), but one doesn’t deconstruct Shakespeare to argue with Shakespeare (or, as we saw above, Cézanne to argue with Cézanne).  In addition, literary deconstruction is about texts that are of a different nature than the deconstruction itself, while the deconstruction of one philosophical text results in another philosophical text.  This makes it much clearer in philosophy that deconstructive texts can themselves be, in fact must be, deconstructed.  What literary deconstruction produces, on the other hand, is not itself literature.  This doesn’t mean that literary deconstructions cannot be deconstructed, but that they are not deconstructed in the same way that they are constructed. The context in which such a deconstruction might be carried out, is quite different from the context in which the original deconstructive text was created.  Put another way, literary deconstruction assumes the possibility and reality of literature in at least some sense of the term, whereas deconstruction as a philosophical enterprise questions, at its most basic level, the possibility of philosophy itself.

c. Contentions and Confrontations

Deconstruction has always been engaged in active dialogue with other contemporary approaches to philosophical and literary texts.  The most productive of these conversations have been with those schools of thought that are closest in history and orientation to deconstruction, often sharing its roots in Heidegger’s work.  At the same time, the issues raised in those debates are often similar to those raised by more strident critics completely opposed to the deconstructive enterprise.  A brief summary of some of the most notable confrontations, across more than twenty years, offers an opportunity to consider the most powerful objections to deconstruction, from the end of the 20th century, onwards.

The 1981 conversation between deconstruction (in the person of Derrida) and hermeneutics (in the person of Hans-Georg Gadamer) raises at least two recurrent themes.  The first has already been indirectly discussed—the charge that deconstruction is a negative enterprise.  Gadamer, who speaks of the debate as one between Heidegger’s reading of Nietzsche and Derrida’s, calls deconstruction a “repudiation” of the “language of concepts” that is the legacy of European philosophy (DD 101).  As already noted, however, deconstruction is always a question and a double movement aware of its own debt to the texts it deconstructs, and so never a repudiation.  The second charge is that deconstruction does not allow for the possibility that a word can be redefined or used independently of its traditional metaphysical meaning.  Gadamer raises this point with regard to “understanding” in general, “self-understanding” and “dialectic”, asking why these terms must be considered part of metaphysics when used in the way he uses them.  This argument is weakened, however, by Gadamer’s own reference to “an older wisdom that speaks in living language”, thus affirming the continuing echo of the tradition even in the most carefully redefined or well-intentioned philosophical terms (DD 95-99).

Although directed at postmodernism, the 1990 exchange between major feminist theorists recorded in Feminist Contentions raises some of the same themes as the earlier debate, but also bears directly on the feminist reception of deconstruction in the United States. The feminists who argue here against postmodernism, and by extension against deconstruction, make the case that political action requires a stronger basis than either of these is capable of providing.  Seyla Benhabib, for instance, acknowledges that subjectivity is largely shaped by language and other symbolic structures, but insists that there must remain some sense in which “we are both author and character at once” in our own life histories.  She argues that, in order to be politically effective in the face of women’s sometimes tenuous sense of self and lack of autonomy, feminist philosophy requires a core of irreducible selfhood and agency that deconstruction would deny (FC 21-22).  As Judith Butler points out however, this line of argument precludes the possibility of any “political opposition” to the self as traditionally understood because it allows us no political way to move beyond the traditional metaphysical dualisms (author/character, authority/submission, self/other, autonomy/heteronomy, and back to, e.g.,  male/female) (FC 36).

In her response to Butler, Benhabib emphasizes another recurring theme in debates about deconstruction:  “how can one be constituted by discourse without being determined by it?”  That is, how does the deconstructive understanding of the self as opaque and internally divided provide a starting point for social and political critique (FC 110)?  We have seen, however, that for deconstruction discourse is neither monolithic nor unequivocal, which means that it cannot be fully determinative of the self, either.  The very lack of a permanent, substantial self in the usual sense that Benhabib and others criticize in deconstruction, is at the same time, what creates the possibility of agency outside and beyond the world of fixed essences and meanings envisioned by the philosophical tradition.  (A Cartesian self, Descartes himself tells us in the Meditations, is most free when it has no choice but to follow Reason.)  The complexities here can be seen in the way deconstructive texts themselves often grapple with these same questions about the possibility of personal and political agency (see below) but, as might be expected, come up with no final answer.

The 1993 confrontation between deconstruction and the neo-pragmatism of Richard Rorty raises similar points.  Rorty accuses Derrida of being a humanist in the sense of a follower of the Enlightenment, while he suggests that deconstruction itself diverts attention, at least in the United States, away from real politics (which he later defines as “a matter of pragmatic, short-term reforms and compromises”).  He embraces the deconstructive understanding of language, which he likens to Ludwig Wittgenstein’s, but denies that the consequences of a Wittgensteinian theory of language can be meaningfully applied to the natural sciences.  He argues instead for an empiricist and naturalist position in science, that he sees to be in conflict with the “transcendental” side of deconstruction, that is, its continuing concern with metaphysics and the resultant tendency to see science as a form of metaphysical materialism (DP 14-17).

In response, Derrida accepts some commonality between pragmatism and deconstruction, but defends the asking of the transcendental question and the refusal to do away with metaphysics altogether as a defense against “empiricism, positivism, and psychologism”.  He also refers to his work on the inevitability of violence in the political realm, which counters the tacit optimism in Rorty’s political views (DP 81-83).  Derrida’s argument is that the political state relies on the rule of law, and the rule of law, in turn, relies on the power to punish, that is, on violence, which is therefore the ground of the political state.  His later work on immigration also underscores the dependence of the political state on a sharp and often violent boundary between who has the full rights of  democratic citizenship (“fraternity” in the French context)–that is, the citizen, the landowner, the freeman, all always male–and who does not (aliens, peasants, slaves, women).

Philosophy in a Time of Terror (2003) is not a direct confrontation between deconstruction and Jürgen Habermas’ theory of communicative action, but illustrates the continuity of themes among those critical of deconstruction over the preceding twenty years.  In the context of 9/11, Habermas’ remarks acknowledges the structural violence that underlies the successful societies of what he terms the West. But then questions the “deconstructivist suspicion”, that the model of communication that works reasonably well in everyday situations, will no longer be adequate when we move to larger conversations between political and social groups.  He argues that insisting dialogue is “nothing but” displaced violence obscures the potential of dialogue for ending violence without creating new pretexts for it (PT 35-38).  He similarly objects to the deconstruction of the concept of tolerance as always an exercise of the power to tolerate or not, because the toleration demanded in a democracy is one between equals and thus mutual rather than paternalistic.  He also finds a certain circularity in deconstruction, since it seems to rely on the same universalism, tolerance, and so forth , it seeks to undo.

As already noted, however, this double gesture is itself the essence of deconstruction.  Derrida, for his part, points out that the “major events” that provoke the kind of communication between groups Habermas refers to are more often, if not exclusively, those that directly affect Europe and the United States and not, for instance, an equal number of deaths in Somalia or the Sudan.  What is threatened by 9/11, he goes on, is exactly a particular context of interpretation that has dominated the dialogues between “the West” and its Other, legitimating some forms of violence while disallowing others (PT 92-93).  He reasserts his reading of toleration as an exercise of paternalistic, or specifically religious, power (PT 127).  One does not ask an oppressed group to “tolerate” their oppressors; it is something asked only of those in a position to grant or deny such toleration.  He also questions the possibility of an actually existing democracy, due to the violence of power relations (PT 120), much less the possibility of a democracy in which different groups would be sufficiently equal for toleration to be genuinely mutual.

This last contestation between Habermas and Derrida, is indirect because it was in the form of separate interviews, illustrates three main points.  One, already noted, is the continuity of objections to deconstruction over an extended period of time, primarily focused around issues of the everyday vs. the transcendental (a dualism that deconstruction seeks to undermine) and the political implications of deconstruction.  The second is the lingering impression that these confrontations rely more on contradiction than on real attempts at communication, or even argument.  A method that questions everything, including itself and even the concept of method, as deconstruction does, leaves critics little concrete substance to criticize, except the circularity and the double gesture that deconstruction embraces.  At the same time, the third point to be noted is the increasing engagement of deconstruction with politics after 1989, if not directly in response to these challenges, at least in the context of their persistence.

d. Later Versions

In the 2001 interview about 9/11, Derrida makes a series of statements about the nature of deconstruction that suggest both similarities and differences from his earlier pronouncements.  He defines the deconstructive philosopher as someone “who analyzes and then draws the practical and effective consequences of the relationship between our philosophical heritage and the structure of the still dominant juridico-political system that is so clearly undergoing mutation” (PT 106).  The explicit emphasis on both politics and the pragmatic is as marked as the much more obscure references that were more common thirty years earlier.  At the same time, he emphatically repeats the double gesture of affirming his faith in and allegiance to the idea of an international law that is, like democracy, unrealizable and, again like democracy, undecidable, that is, impossible even to envision without contradiction (PT 115).  Finally, he refers back to “Plato’s Pharmacy” to suggest that the political state is, like writing for Socrates, “at once remedy and poison”, something we can live neither with, because of its inherent violence, nor without, because only the state can protect us from the violence it engenders (PT 124).

Deconstruction retains it critical edge well into the 21st century, even when directed against closely allied texts.  For instance, the 2001 address Derrida gave upon receiving the Theodor Adorno Prize turns back on Adorno himself, specifically on his privileging of the German language even as he champions globalism and a united Europe.  This deconstruction centers in the familiar manner on the untranslatably ambiguous French word fichu (n. neckerchief; adj., lost or done for).  The word appears in French in a letter to Adorno’s wife by Walter Benjamin, who uses it in describing a dream where he speaks of “changing a poem into a fichu” in the first sense (neckerchief or scarf).  This fichu is then associated in the dream with the letter “d”, which Derrida suggests might refer to a name Benjamin used in signing letters, or to his sister or his wife, both named Dora.  Derrida then goes on to point out that “dora” in Greek can mean scorched or scratched skin, hence linking it to fichu in the second sense, but also to Auschwitz and to 9/11, which was Adorno’s birthdate (PM 164-181).  In an excellent example of the deconstruction of a deconstruction, the English translator of this address inserts a footnote here to add that “dor”, meaning gift, is also part of Adorno’s given name, Theodor, “gift of the gods” (PM 203).

Clearly gender plays a central role in the deconstructive process in “Fichus”.  If the fault line or rifts in traditional philosophical texts are the result of attempts to exclude from philosophy what it cannot control, Woman (i.e., Adorno’s wife, Benjamin’s wife and sister, any woman who wears a fichu) will be one of the constant sites of deconstructive undoing.  Death also becomes of increasing importance in deconstruction, as shown in Derrida’s late works focused on the death of the father, the mother, and eventually his own.  In addition to the connection psychoanalysis makes between women and death, both these themes are revealed by deconstruction to be at the root of what the philosophical tradition has always sought to avoid.  Writing, for Socrates, can be deceptive (like a woman), or wander from the source like an illegitimate son (born to such a woman).   Socrates does not say either “woman” or “death”,  but the hatred of writing, deconstruction argues, as of all manifestations of our embodiment in Plato and the tradition he inaugurates, is fundamentally a “motivated repression” of what always exceeds philosophy, the philosopher’s body, his desires, and ultimately his death.

3. Feminist Deconstruction

The connection between deconstruction and feminist readings of the European tradition, although implicit in Derrida’s work since “Plato’s Pharmacy” (1972), was made explicit in a 1981 interview with Christie V. McDonald called “Choreographies”.  Much earlier, however, feminist theorists in France were incorporating deconstructive strategies in their work.  In their 1975 book The Newly Born Woman, for instance, Hélène Cixous and Catherine Clément underscore the series of hierarchical oppositions (good/bad, life/death, day/night, culture/nature, male/female) that provide most, if not all, of the key terms that open a text to a deconstructive reading.  The list, which carries a footnoted reference to Derrida, is not, as we have already seen, an innocent one.  In Plato the pair speech/writing is one central theme; in the ancient Greeks generally, active/passive; in religion God/man, later Christian/Jew; in René Descartes and the moderns mind/body; in colonial or racist ideology Western/Oriental, white/black.  In a further repetition of Derrida’s method, Cixous and Clément’s move is not to reverse these hierarchies, which would only create another system of power.  They seek instead to think in a third way.  This third way is called “bisexuality” here, meaning the refusal to focus on a single sexual organ in favor of undifferentiated pleasures of the flesh (NBW 84-85).  This move to rethink sexuality as part of a deconstructive strategy, drawing on psychoanalysis and anthropological texts such as Marcel Mauss’ “Essay on the Gift”, is a common theme in French feminist deconstruction, also found, for example, in the work of Luce Irigaray and Julia Kristeva (and in later texts by Derrida himself).

Given the importance of Sigmund Freud’s work to this strain of feminist deconstruction, Sarah Kofman’s 1980 book on Freud provides a detailed example of the potential power of this method for feminist thought.  One major fault line she examines is the concept of “penis envy”, a phenomenon that is supposedly central to the process that transforms bisexual creatures into women.  Kofman notes, however, that this process amounts to transforming into a woman “a little girl who has first been a little boy” because within psychoanalysis pre-Oedipal bisexuality affirms the “original predominance of masculinity (in both sexes)” (EW 111-122).  She draws extensively on Freud’s biography, as well as his texts, to make clear how he characterizes women as defined both by lack (their penis envy) and their excess (“her narcissistic self-sufficiency and her indifference” which leaves the male “emptied of this original narcissism in favor of the love object” [EW 52]), another classic deconstructive self-contradiction.  Ultimately, she argues that penis envy, Freud’s “idée fixe”, and indeed his whole account of femininity and female sexuality, “allows him to blame nature for the cultural injustice by which man subordinates woman’s sexual desires to his”.  She also notes Freud’s surprise that, given all this, women might be hostile to men or frigid (EW 208-209).

In The Man of Reason (1984) Genevieve Lloyd undertakes a feminist reading on a larger historical scale, deconstructing (although she does not use that term) major philosophical texts from Plato to Simone de Beauvoir along a fault line that would equate reason with the masculine.  The hierarchical dualism found in deconstruction (speech/writing, male/female, and so forth.)  in epistemologically-oriented English language philosophy take the form rational/irrational, knowledge/ignorance, and so forth.  Lloyd traces the ways in which these last two pairs maintained a powerfully gendered meaning as the concept of Reason itself evolved through the history of European philosophy.  After 1600, public/private and universal/particular became politically important additions to the list; in the twentieth century existentialism adds transcendence/embodiment.  Most important, Lloyd says, has been the underlying pair superior/inferior.  As we have already seen, whatever is on the masculine side of the dichotomy is assumed, simply from that fact, to have value; whatever is the feminine side, to have none.  Again, like Derrida, Cixous and Clément, Lloyd rejects a move to reverse this polarity because “ironically, it [would] occur in a space already prepared for it by the intellectual tradition it seeks to reject” (MR 105).  Perhaps more optimistic than her French counterparts, Lloyd ends with her own version of the deconstructive double gesture:  “Philosophy has defined ideals of Reason through exclusions of the feminine.  But it also contains within it the resources for critical reflection on those ideals and on its own aspirations” (MR 109).

4. References and Further Readings

a. References

  • Benhabib, Seyla, Judith Butler, Drucilla Cornell, and Nancy Fraser. Feminist Contentions: A Philosophical Exchange. New York: Routledge, 1995. (FC)
  • Bloom, Harold, Paul de Man, Jacques Derrida, Geoffrey Hartman, and J. Hillis Miller. Deconstruction and Criticism. New York: The Seabury Press,1979. (DC)
  • Borradori, Giovanna. Philosophy in a Time of Terror: Dialogues with Jürgen Harbermas and Jacques Derrida. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2003. (PT)
  • Cixous, Hélène, and Catherine Clément. The Newly Born Woman, Betsy Wing, trans. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1986. (NBW)
  • Critchley, Simon, Jacques Derrida, Ernesto Laclau, and Richard Rorty. Deconstruction and Pragmatism, Chantal Mouffe, ed. New York: Routledge, 1996. (DP)
  • Derrida, Jacques. Positions, Alan Bass, trans. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1981. (P)
  • Derrida, Jacques. Dissemination, Barbara Johnson, trans. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1981. (D)
  • Derrida, Jacques. The Ear of the Other: Otobiography, Transference, Translation, Christie V. McDonald, ed., Peggy Kamuf, trans. NewYork: Schocken, 1985. (EO)
  • Derrida, Jacques. The Truth in Painting, Geoff Bennington and Ian McLeod, trans. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1987. (TP)
  • Derrida, Jacques, and Christie V. McDonald. “Choreographies”, in Feminist Interpretations of Jacques Derrida, Nancy J. Holland, ed. University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press, 1997.
  • Derrida, Jacques. Paper Machine, Rachel Bowlby, trans. Palo Alto, CA: Stanford University Press, 2005. (PM)
  • Descartes, René. The Philosophical Words of Descartes, Volume I, Elizabeth S. Haldane and G. R. T. Ross, trans. (Cambridge, UK: Cambridge University Press, 1911).
  • Heidegger, Martin. Being and Time, John Macquarrie and Edward Robinson, trans. New York: Harper, 1962. (BT)
  • Heidegger, Martin. “The Origin of the Work of Art” in Poetry, Language, Thought, Albert Hofstadter, trans. New York: Harper, 1971.
  • Jones, Ernest. Hamlet and Oedipus. New York: Doubleday, 1954.
  • Kofman, Sarah. The Enigma of Woman: Woman in Freud’s Writings, Catherine Porter, trans. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1985. (EW)
  • Lloyd, Genevieve. The Man of Reason: “Male” and “Female” in Western Philosophy. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1984. (MR)
  • Michelfelder, Diane P., and Richard E. Palmer, eds. Dialogue and Deconstruction: The Gadamer-Derrida Encounter. Albany, NY: State University of New York Press, 1989. (DD)

b. Additional Readings

  • Armour, Ellen T.  Deconstruction, Feminist Theology, and the Problem of Difference. Chicago:  University of Chicago Press, 1999.
    • Excellent, but dense, example of the political use of deconstruction.
  • Bordo, Susan R.  The Flight to Objectivity:  Essays on Cartesianism & Culture.  Albany, NY:  State University of New York Press, 1987.
    • Excellent, accessible feminist deconstruction of Descartes.
  • Cornell, Drucilla.  Beyond Accommodation:  Ethical Feminism, Deconstruction, and the Law. Lanham, MD:  Rowman & Littlefield, 1999.
    • Excellent, but dense, example of the use of deconstruction in legal theory.
  • Derrida, Jacques.  Writing and Difference, Alan Bass, trans.  Chicago:  University of Chicago Press, 1978.
    • Early deconstructions of Foucault, Hegel, Husserl, and others.
  • Derrida, Jacques.  Margins – Of Philosophy, Alan Bass, trans.  Chicago:  University of Chicago Press, 1982.
    • Early deconstructions of Heidegger, Hegel, and J. L. Austin.
  • Derrida, Jacques, and Anne Dufourmantelle.  Of Hospitality, Rachel Bowlby, trans. Palo Alto, CA:  Stanford University Press, 2000.
    • Addresses issues of gender, immigration, and the political state.
  • Derrida, Jacques.  Rogues:  Two Essays on Reason, Pascale-Anne Brault and Michael Naas.  Palo Alto, CA:  Stanford University Press, 2005.
    • Excellent political and feminist late deconstruction.
  • Derrida, Jacques.  Psyche:  Inventions of the Other, Volume II, Peggy Kamuf and Elizabeth Rottenber, eds.  Stanford, CA:  Stanford University Press, 2008.
    • Includes both “Geschlecht” articles on Heidegger and gender, plus other important papers from 1998-2003.
  • Fraser, Nancy.  Unruly Practices:  Power, Discourse and Gender in Contemporary Social Theory.  Minneapolis:  University of Minnesota Press, 1989.
    • A major feminist theorist who is critical of deconstruction.
  • Kofman, Sarah.  Selected Writings, Thomas Albrecht, ed., with Georgia Albert and Elizabeth Rotten berg.   Stanford, CA:  Stanford University Press, 2007.
  • Moi, Toril, ed.  The Kristeva Reader.  New York:  Columbia University Press, 1986.
  • Sellers, Susan, ed.  The Hélène Cixous Reader.  New York:  Routledge, 1994. (CR)
  • Silverman, Hugh J., and Gary Aylesworth, eds.   The Textual Sublime:  Deconstruction and its Differences.   Albany, NY:  State University of New York Press, 1990.
    • Several interesting articles on deconstruction, including one by Paul DeMan.
  • Taylor, Mark C., ed.  Deconstruction in Context:  Literature and Philosophy.  Chicago:  University of Chicago Press, 1986.
    • Collection of philosophical writings from Kant onward that provides some of the historical context for deconstruction.
  • Whitford, Margaret, ed.  The Irigaray Reader.  Malden, MA:  Blackwell, 1991.

Author Information

Nancy J. Holland
Email: nholland@gw.hamline.edu
Hamline University
U. S. A.

Roger Bacon (1214–1292)

Roger BaconRoger Bacon’s most noteworthy philosophical accomplishments were in the fields of mathematics, natural sciences, and language studies. A conspicuous feature of his philosophical outlook was his emphasis on the utility and practicality of all scientific efforts. Bacon was convinced that mathematics and astronomy are not morally neutral activities, pursued for their own sake, but have a deep connection to the practical business of everyday life. Bacon was committed to the view that wisdom should contribute to the improvement of life. For example, his extensive works on the reform and reorganization of the university curriculum were, on the surface, aimed at reforming the study of theology; yet, ultimately, they contained a political program whose goal was to civilize humankind as well as to secure peace and prosperity for the whole of the Christian world, both in the hereafter and in this world.

During his long and productive life, he was a Master of Arts and Franciscan friar who was committed to a philosophical outlook that was deeply imbued with Christian principles as well as scientific curiosity and ambition. In many cases, his ideas betray him as a child of his time, and yet his thinking was well in advance of his contemporaries.

Bacon is noteworthy for being one of the West’s first commentators and lecturers on Aristotle‘s philosophy and science. He has been called Doctor Mirabilis (wonderful teacher) and described variously as a rebel, traditionalist, reactionary, martyr to scientific progress, and the first modern scientist. Unfortunately, these romantic epithets tend to blur the actual nature of his philosophical achievements.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Works
    1. Life
    2. Works
      1. Early Works: 1240s–1250s
      2. Works for Pope Clement IV: 1266–1268
      3. Later Works: Late 1260s–1292
  2. The General Trajectory of Roger Bacon’s Philosophy
    1. Utility and Wisdom
    2. The Critique of University Learning
    3. Reform of Education
    4. Human Happiness and the Sciences
  3. Bacon on Language
  4. Mathematics and Natural Sciences
    1. General Remarks
      1. Bacon’s Modification of the Quadrivium
      2. Bacon’s Scientific Views and the Condemnation of 1277
    2. The Nature and Value of Mathematics
      1. The Object and Division of Mathematics
      2. The Methodological Relevance of Mathematics
      3. The Physical Relevance of Mathematics
    3. Bacon’s Theory of Physical Causation and Perspective
    4. Experimental Science
      1. Experience and Experiment
      2. The Three Prerogatives of Experimental Science
      3. Bacon as Experimenter
    5. Alchemy and Medicine
  5. Moral Philosophy
    1. General Scope and Nature of Bacon’s Moral Philosophy
      1. Morality and Happiness
      2. The Place of Moral Philosophy within the Hierarchy of Sciences
      3. Practical Sciences and Human Practice
      4. The Functional Division of Moral Philosophy
    2. Moral Philosophy in the Service of Human Moral Agency
      1. The Conversion of Non-Christians
      2. Moral Works and Eloquence
      3. Rhetoric and Poetics as Branches of Moral Philosophy
  6. Conclusion
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. Bibliographies
    2. Primary Sources
      1. 1240s–1250s
      2. 1250s–1268
      3. 1268–1292
    3. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Works

a. Life

Any attempt to reconstruct Bacon’s life must rely on very few sources, among which the most important is one of Bacon’s own works, Opus Tertium (c. 1267). Since Bacon’s personal report is ambiguous, his biographical data as well as the chronology of his education and career are still a matter of dispute among scholars. Scholars argue as to whether he was born in 1210, 1214, 1215, or even as late as 1220. Despite these disagreements, it is at least agreed that, in view of the funds available to him to pursue his private research, he was likely born into a well-to-do family.

Bacon described his intellectual biography as being divided into two distinct periods: a first “secular” period lasting until around 1257, during which he worked as an academic, and a second period, which he spent as a Franciscan friar “in the pursuit of wisdom.” As a secular scholar, Bacon pursued his academic career at two of the earliest European universities. First he attended the University of Oxford and then the University of Paris. He probably earned his Master of Arts around 1240 and continued his career as a lecturer in the Faculty of Arts at the University of Paris throughout the 1240s. He probably resigned from his post as Regent Master of Arts in Paris in 1247 and returned to Oxford. After this time, Bacon does not seem to have ever held academic office again. The next ten years of Bacon’s life have proven difficult for scholars to reconstruct. It is known that during this time Bacon continued to pursue his scientific and linguistic studies. During this time he probably also received some training in theology by Adam Marsh (d. 1258), the first Regent Master of the Franciscans in Oxford. This training, however, never culminated in a degree in theology. In or around 1257, he joined the Franciscan Order, probably in Oxford. The exact reasons for why he chose this order are unknown, but there are reasons to think that he hoped the Franciscans would support his scholarly interests. After all, the Oxford Franciscans had attracted prominent scholars such as Robert Grosseteste (d. 1253) and Adam Marsh.

The beginning of the 1260s found Bacon again in Paris. It has been speculated that he was transferred there by the superiors of his order because of growing suspicion about his scientific studies. While in Paris, he finished several of his major works, including Opus Maius (OM), Opus Minus (OMi), and Opus Tertium (OT). The exact details of Bacon’s whereabouts and doings in the decades before his death remain uncertain. It seems clear, however, that he returned to Oxford sometime after 1278. Between 1277 and 1279, he was supposedly condemned to house arrest by the Franciscans’ Master General Jerome of Ascoli. The charge against him was that some of his doctrines contained “certain suspected novelties.” What these novelties were—whether relating to his teachings on alchemy, astronomy, experimental science, or his radical spiritual leanings—cannot be determined with precision (Easton, 1952, 192-202). Bacon’s punishment  can likely be explained in the context of the Parisian Condemnations of 1270 and 1277. In the last years of his life, Bacon continued to work on what was, in all likelihood, his last treatise, Compendium Studii Theologie. He died in 1292, or soon thereafter, in Oxford.

b. Works

i. Early Works: 1240s–1250s

During his time at the Faculty of Arts at the University of Paris, Bacon lectured on many Aristotelian texts, the so-called libri naturales, including On the Soul, On Sense and the Sensible, Physics, Metaphysics, and probably On Generation and Corruption. Not all of these lectures have survived. We possess copies of two lectures on Physics, three lectures on different books of Metaphysics as well as lectures on the pseudo-Aristotelian works, Book of Causes and On Plants. The form of these lectures is that of quaestiones, or ‘questions’, which involve the presentation of expository and critical questions combined with explanatory comments. These lectures represent Bacon’s earliest teachings on topics such as causality, motion, being, soul, substance, and truth. Bacon’s quaestiones were not written by Bacon himself, but consist in notes that his students took during his lectures. These notes might have been checked later by Bacon for accuracy. With the exception of a set of quaestiones on Physics II–IV, these writings survive in one single manuscript. These lectures—together with the lectures of Richard Rufus of Cornwall (d. 1260) —mark some of the earliest known examinations of Aristotle’s Metaphysics and the libri naturales from the Faculty of Arts at Paris.

During the 1240s and 1250s, Bacon composed a series of works on logical and grammatical matters dealing with syntactic as well as semantic issues. These include the Summa Grammatica (‘Summary of Grammar’; c. 1245), Summa de Sophismatibus et Distinctionibus (‘Summary of Sophisms and Distinctions’; c. 1240–1245) and Summulae Dialectices (‘Summary of Dialectics’; probably completed after Bacon’s return to Oxford in the 1250s). These works show that Bacon was one of the earliest proponents of the so-called terminist logic. Terminist logic was referred to by medieval scholars as Logica Modernorum or Moderna (‘contemporary logic’), and was originated by scholars such as William of Sherwood (d. 1266/72) and Petrus Hispanus (d. 1277). Contemporary logic was so-called by the medieval masters themselves in order to describe and distinguish their new, contextual approach toward logic, which consisted in an emphasis on the analysis of the signifying properties of terms in a propositional as well as a pragmatic context.

Sometime in the late 1250s or early 1260s Bacon composed another treatise entitled De Multiplicatione Specierum (‘On the Multiplication of Species’). In this work Bacon developed a doctrine that he considered to be central to his natural philosophy. Specifically, he aimed in this work to explain natural causation through the concept of species; more will be said about this matter this below.

ii. Works for Pope Clement IV: 1266–1268

The works for which Bacon is most widely known are a group of writings commissioned by Pope Clement IV, comprising the Opus Maius, Opus Minus, and Opus Tertium. All of these works are rhetorical in the sense that Bacon attempted to persuade the Pope to support his research and to help him to implement his projected reform of studies. The reform program suggested by Bacon was very extensive and encompassed the study of languages, mathematics, the natural sciences, moral philosophy, and theology.

The circumstances under which Bacon composed these works are well documented in his own statements. Sometime in the early 1260s, Bacon sought the patronage of Cardinal Guy de Foulques, papal legate to England during the Civil War. From the ensuing correspondence it became clear that the cardinal would not provide the funds Bacon needed to complete his writings but that he was nevertheless interested in Bacon’s reform ideas. He asked Bacon to send him his writings. Bacon had nothing to send to the cardinal, however, because completing his works required money for books, scientific equipment, and copyists—money Bacon did not have. In 1265, however, the situation changed dramatically when Cardinal Guy de Foulques was elected Pope Clement IV. Bacon soon sent the new Pope a letter asking for aid, to which the Pope replied in June 1266, asking Bacon to send the writings containing “the remedies for the critical problems” Bacon had mentioned to him a few years before and to do so “as quickly and secretly as possible.” Yet, in 1266 Bacon’s financial needs were no different from a few years before. In addition to Bacon’s financial predicament, there was another complicating factor at work: the Franciscan Order was in a time of crisis over dogmatic issues, and in response to these issues, the General chapter at Narbonne (1260) imposed strict censorship on the Order and forbade direct communication with the papal curia. Under these conditions—insufficient funds, time pressure, forbidden communication with the Pope, and growing suspicion within the order against Bacon’s own scientific and spiritual leanings—Bacon was forced to compose a much shorter, more rhetorical work (or persuasio), rather than the longer work (scriptum principale) he originally envisioned. In a short period of time, Bacon completed several writings, rhetorically structured in a way so as to best persuade the Pope of his ideas. Late in 1267 or early in 1268 he sent out the Opus Maius, partly patched together from previous writings, and the Opus Minus. It was common practice for Bacon to borrow from his other works; the fourth part of the Opus Maius contained an abbreviation of the earlier De Multiplicatione Specierum. The Opus Tertium was probably never sent. The works arrived safely. However, since the Pope died in 1268, it remains unknown whether he had a chance to study Bacon’s works, and, if he did, how he received them.

iii. Later Works: Late 1260s–1292

Although historical evidence for Bacon’s whereabouts during the final stage of his career is scarce, it is certain that he remained active. In the late 1260s and early 1270s, while still in Paris, he may have worked on the Communia Mathematica and Communia Naturalium; the polemic Compendium Studii Philosophiae (CSP) was probably written around 1272. He put together basic grammars for both Greek and Hebrew, and he also wrote two medical treatises, De Erroribus Medicorum and Antidotarius. Sometime in the two decades before his death, he completed his elaborate edition of the pseudo-Aristotelian Secretum Secretorum for which he prepared a redaction of the text, annotated it, and wrote an accompanying introductory treatise (Williams, 1994). His last work, written when he was around seventy years old, was a treatise on semiotics, the Compendium Studii Theologie, which is incomplete.

2. The General Trajectory of Roger Bacon’s Philosophy

a. Utility and Wisdom

The length of Bacon’s career and the diversity of his philosophical interests and accomplishments make it impossible to capture his philosophy in a simple summary. In regard to Bacon’s work on Aristotle and the Arab commentators during his first stay in Paris, one could speak of Bacon as a pioneer in Aristotelian studies.  Yet these early works give little hint of his later and much more specialized interests in science, semantics, moral philosophy, and Christian theology. Bacon’s later work as a Franciscan scholar differed significantly from his earlier work in both content and purpose.

A possible reason for the change in Bacon’s scholarly interests may have been his encounter with the pseudo-Aristotelian work Secretum Secretorum while at Paris during the 1240s. The Secretum Secretorum was composed in the form of a pseudo-epigraphical letter from Aristotle to Alexander the Great, belonging to the literary genre mirrors for princes. With the purpose of providing insight into the art of government, the anonymous author treats of secret doctrines useful to a political ruler, among which are ethics, alchemy, and medicine. It might be the case that Bacon, after reading the Secretum, was inspired to develop the vision that henceforth guided his philosophical efforts and consisted of a conception of Christian learning applicable to the needs of humankind, both worldly and otherworldly. For a critical evaluation of the supposed influence of the Secretum Secretorum on Bacon’s views see Williams, 1997, 368-372. The principles around which his thoughts subsequently developed had a strong connection to concrete socio-political affairs, and his outlook on the sciences became focused on applicability, practicality, and usefulness. This practical outlook on the sciences, as being in the service of humankind, manifested itself in positive and negative remarks made in writings like the Opus Maius or Compendium Studii Philosophiae. His negative remarks consisted of incessant critiques of what he perceived to be the desolate, that is, practically useless, state of learning during his time. His positive remarks focused on proposals about the benefits and possibilities of the practical application of the different branches of knowledge.

The medieval use of the term science should not be confused with the modern use, which is distinct from philosophical and  theological inquiry. Rather, 13th century thinkers understood the term science in accordance with the Aristotelian framework of epistemic or apodeictic knowledge. According to Aristotle in Posterior Analytics, science denotes intellectual comprehension of a true, necessary, and universal proposition, known or presented in the form of a demonstrative proof and providing an understanding of why the proposition is true. In other words, Aristotelian science involves knowledge of a reasoned fact—an understanding of science that is far broader than the modern understanding of empirical science. Despite the fact that almost all scholastics endorsed the Aristotelian paradigm of science, there was wide variation in the medieval scholars’ accounts of the foundation and scope of Aristotelian science, depending on their ontological, epistemological, and logical commitments.  Bacon, like other thinkers, oftentimes used the terms science and philosophy interchangeably, thereby referring to a group of disciplines that conform to the aforementioned Aristotelian paradigm. According to Bacon, the sciences or philosophy comprise disparate disciplines such as moral philosophy and metaphysics.

The pivotal concepts around which all of Bacon’s philosophical efforts revolved were utilitas (‘utility’) and sapientia (‘wisdom’). Bacon used the concept of utility in the context of his reflections on the relation, scope, and goal of the sciences. More specifically, he used the term in two senses: (1) to describe the hierarchy between the sciences and (2) to refer to the function of the sciences, namely, the improvement of the physical and spiritual well-being of humankind in this world and the next. With respect to the hierarchy of the sciences, he regarded the theoretical sciences to be subordinate to the practical sciences. For him, the former is instrumental in achieving the goals of the latter. Here it is important to keep in mind that Bacon’s conception of philosophy did not entail the patristic idea that philosophy is merely a handmaiden of theology (philosophia ancilla theologiae). Philosophy, although useful for theology, is not reduced to theology. On the contrary, Bacon believed that theology, in order to fulfill its purpose, was heavily reliant on philosophy (OM II, vol. 3, 36). And yet, the utility of both philosophy and theology ultimately refer to the God-ordained purpose of the created world, which Bacon recognized in the return of all creatures to their divine origin.

Concerning wisdom, Bacon uses the term to refer to the complete body of knowledge given by God to humankind for the purpose of humankind’s happiness and salvation. In a sense, all knowledge for Bacon was contained in the Scriptures and should be unfolded by philosophy and canon law.  The manner, however, in which philosophy unfolds the basic truths in the Scriptures is different from the manner of theology. According to Bacon, these “exegetic” disciplines, philosophy and canon law, were first revealed to the early prophets and patriarchs and then handed down through generations of true “lovers of wisdom, ” like prophets, patriarchs, and pagan philosophers, in the form of divine and secular texts. Bacon presented the process of the transmission of knowledge by way of an elaborate genealogy (OM I, vol. 3, 53f). He deemed it necessary to provide a comprehensive defense of wisdom together with the means by which it could be restored because he perceived his contemporaries to be limiting wisdom in scope and content, in fact to be corrupting it.  The transmission of knowledge  was unfolded imperfectly due to the sins of some philosophers.. The targets of Bacon’s critique very well may have been the Parisian “Artists,” some of whom understood the search for wisdom to be a purely theoretical and specialized endeavor, or Bacon’s own Minister General Bonaventure who condemned suspicious disciplines like experimental science and alchemy. Thus the scientific vision Bacon began to promote in the 1260s consisted of very detailed and specific normative reflections on the status of learning, for which he sought the support of Pope Clement IV.

b. The Critique of University Learning

The critique of university learning that Bacon developed in several of his writings encompassed philosophy as well as theology. According to Bacon, neither the philosophy nor theology of his time adequately embody the wisdom God revealed to humankind. On the contrary, in both philosophy and theology Bacon perceived numerous errors, lacunae, and forms of corruption.  Thus he neither held back from denouncing them nor balked at accusing individual scholars of contributing to the demise of learning. In regard to the content of the curricula, for example, Bacon criticized the erroneous emphasis on logic and a particular kind of grammar and instead called for emphasis on rhetoric and the study of foreign languages. In several of his writings, most prominently in Opus Maius, Compendium Studii Philosophiae, and Compendium Studii Theologiae, he presented examples of ignorance, corruption, and error.

The scope of his critique of learning extended beyond the academy as well. Bacon drew connections between the state of affairs in the academy and the state of affairs in society because he did not regard these two spheres as separate but rather intimately connected. Bacon often stated that “by the light of wisdom the Church of God is governed, the republic of the faithful regulated, the conversion of infidels accomplished, and those who are obstinate in their malice, are more efficiently swayed toward the goals of the Church by the power of wisdom than by the shedding of Christian blood” (OM I, vol. 3, 1). Following from this, Bacon believed that the ultimate purpose of eradicating academic errors extended to the improvement of society. Bacon held that vain and useless academic practice was the cause of the ecclesiastic corruptions of pride, greed, and lust. In addition, Bacon did not spare worldly rulers from criticism (CSP, ch. 1, 398-400).

In his Opus Maius, Bacon pointed out four causes of error: (1) the example of unreliable and unsuited authorities, (2) the long duration of habit, (3) the opinion of the ignorant masses, and (4) the propensity of humans for disguising ignorance by the display of pseudo-wisdom. Bacon judged that all human evil is a result of these errors, and thus the reform that Bacon intended had to begin with reform in the educational institutions and the sciences. For example, Bacon identified one group of obstacles to wisdom in the practices of university teachers.  The teachers wasted time and money on useless things and subjects because, instead of intellectual humility, they indulged in conformity and vanity (OM I, vol. 3, 2f). Thus scientific errors cast a long shadow, and the reform of learning was the only way  by which to remedy society’s academic, social, and political troubles as they existed within the Christian community or even beyond it, in regard to the interactions with non-Christians such as Saracens or Jews.

c. Reform of Education

The reform program that Bacon proposed to Pope Clement IV was comprehensive in that it involved theology as well as most philosophical disciplines. Bacon revealed his depreciatory judgment of certain theological practices when in his Opus Minus he listed “the seven sins of the principal study which is theology”  (OMi, 322). He included the “modern” practice of theologians introducing questions into theology that properly belong to the province of philosophy, such as questions about celestial bodies, matter and being, how the soul perceived through images or similitudes, and how souls and angels moved locally. In addition to questions of content, Bacon also found fault with the methods employed by modern theologians. For example, Bacon complained that questions about the sacraments or the Trinity were addressed using philosophical methods involving philosophical terminology, arguments and conceptual distinctions rather than using proper traditional Scriptural exegesis. Exegesis, on the other hand, suffered because of (1) the overemphasis placed on Peter Lombard’s (d. c.1160) Four Books of Sentences, (2) the deficient state of the Paris Vulgate, and (3) the neglect and ignorance of those sciences most useful for an accurate literal understanding of the text, which would advance exegesis according to the spiritual senses (OMi, 322-359).

Bacon proposed extensive reform measures to remedy these problems. He advised providing new translations of philosophical works and the Scriptures prepared by translators who were experts not only with regard to mastery of the respective languages but also the philosophical and theological material. Bacon called for an extensive modification of the curricula. He wanted to  implement disciplines that were of real value to the progress of learning and that were not being studied properly at the time, like perspective (optics), experimental science, and alchemy. He also wanted to reform disciplines that, although being taught and studied, were studied with a wrong focus; here Bacon pointed to logic. For the use of the term progress in relation to Bacon see Molland, 1978, 567-571. For Bacon, studying logic was neither an end in itself nor the basis for the other sciences. On the contrary, Bacon held that logic is instrumentally valuable to theology and philosophy only insofar as it promotes understanding through semiotic and semantic analyses. It becomes superfluous when practiced as an inquiry into rules of argumentation. This was judged to be so because, according to Bacon, the knowledge of such rules is innate, which explains why logic does not provide scientists with special methodological principles or rules (OT, ch. xxviii, 102f). To counteract his contemporaries’ emphasis on logic, Bacon proposed to focus instead on mathematics.  He believed neither philosophical nor theological matters could be properly understood without employing mathematics (OM IV, vol. 3, 175). Bacon’s reform program included the introduction of five main sciences that he thought were neglected or misunderstood by his contemporaries. Apart from mathematics, these were the science of languages, perspective, moral philosophy, experimental science, and alchemy. According to Bacon, these sciences were more conducive to the advancement of the mind, the body, and society than some of the sciences preferred by his contemporaries, such as logic, the less significant parts of natural philosophy, and a part of metaphysics. (OMi, 323f).

d. Human Happiness and the Sciences

Bacon’s later research in logic and languages, moral philosophy, and the natural sciences were fueled by his conviction that the spheres of scientific work and of everyday life were intimately connected. Bacon believed that the status of learning affects the quality of individuals’ lives in a variety of ways. After all, erroneous ideas or theories can yield harmful social consequences.  Knowledge and learning are not private affairs but have a socio-political dimension. Thus he was persuaded that the sciences, both secular and divine, should serve human society as a whole in reaching happiness and salvation. He subsequently determined the respective rank of each science by the degree of its usefulness, that is, how much each of them contributed to human happiness. The theoretical sciences were thus subordinated to the practical goal of human happiness, as mentioned above. Since, according to Bacon, human happiness consists in salvation as understood by Christians, the highest science is Sacred doctrine or theology. Yet despite its formal supremacy, theology is still dependent on philosophy in that theology is incapable of accomplishing its goal without philosophy, that is, grammar, mathematics, experimental science, and moral philosophy (OM II, vol. 3, 36). In relation to theology, Bacon held moral philosophy to be the second highest discipline because it aims at salvation within the secular context of natural reason rather than revelation (MP I, §4, 4). In turn, Bacon held that the theoretical sciences, such as mathematics, are subordinate to moral philosophy. The goal of mathematics consists of explaining and describing the structure of the natural world, providing a kind of knowledge that contributes to practical ends only indirectly. Whereas, by contrast, the knowledge provided by moral philosophy is of immediate practical value.

According to Bacon, then, scientific research has an overall moral orientation, with both an emphasis on the afterlife and also an eye on practical worldly affairs. (CSP, ch. i, 395). The unifying purpose of all scientific study for Bacon is practical, which is why the practical sciences have priority over the theoretical. The practical value of a science is determined by the degree to which each science contributes to the improvement of human life. Improvements can be secondary, by technical innovation, or primary, by guiding the moral and spiritual life of humans, exhorting people to a virtuous and law-abiding practice that will ultimately be rewarded with eternal happiness: salvation in union with God.

3. Bacon on Language

Like many of his contemporaries, Roger Bacon attached great value to issues pertaining to the so-called Trivium. The Trivium, or the ‘three ways’ or ‘three roads’ of learning, was comprised of grammar, logic, and rhetoric.  The Trivium constituted the trivial, that is, fundamental, part of the learning system, which consisted of the seven liberal arts, that was in place during late antiquity and much of medieval times. The remaining four arts, called the Quadrivium, were the mathematical disciplines: arithmetic, geometry, astronomy, and music.

Bacon’s study of language was broad, extending from semantics and semiotics to philology as well as to the socio-cultural question of the place of language studies within institutions of higher learning and society as a whole. Bacon’s study of speech and languages was not merely theoretical. His interest in understanding language, and his personal study of foreign languages like Hebrew and Greek,was motivated by his belief in the eminent practical importance of the study of speech and language. Bacon considered language mastery necessary for four purposes: (1) ecclesiastical functions, (2) the reform of knowledge, (3) the conversion of infidels, and (4) the battle against the Antichrist. Generally speaking, the goal of Bacon’s concern for languages was, in both his linguistic as well as his philological efforts, situated within the wider context of his intended reform of learning, aimed at the “Church and the Republic of the Faithful.”  In addition, Bacon considered the knowledge of language, including an understanding of how words signify, an important prerequisite for any kind of philosophical or theological pursuit.

In Bacon’s work on linguistic and philological matters one can distinguish between two different stages. In the first stage, represented by the Summa grammatica, Summa de Sophismatibus et Distinctionibus, and Summulae Dialectices, we find Bacon’s contributions to the problem of universal quantification and to semantic problems revolving around the properties of terms. In particular, Bacon worked here on the problem of univocal appellation and predication in regards to what are called empty classes.  Bacon’s solutions, especially to the semantic problems, provide the theoretical background against which he continued to develop his doctrines during the second stage of his work on logic and linguistic matters. In the second stage, represented by the De Signis and Compendium Studii Theologiae, Bacon worked on a theory of analogy, developed a theory of the imposition of signs, and, related to this, developed a view of the definition and classification of signs. The Compendium Studii Theologiae represents a later adjustment of the material brought forth in the De Signis.  His work on philology stems largely from this later phase and is contained mainly in the Opus Tertium and Compendium Studii Philosophiae. He also wrote a Greek grammar, Oxford Greek Grammar, the first of its kind in the west and a work which he considered to be no more than an “introduction to the Greek language.” In these writings Bacon studied grammar insofar as it (1) pertained and contributed to the reading and speaking of languages and (2) contributed to an improvement of the methods and instruments of textual criticism.

Bacon’s views on logic and language included some unique claims and arguments. Bacon’s work on semantic problems—such as connotation and equivocation—was especially noteworthy. In his early work Summa de sophismatibus et distinctionibus, written in Paris, Bacon contributed to the debate on semantic information contained in ambiguous sentences.  The theory of so-called natural sense, popular among some 13th century logicians, proposed that semantic information is grounded in the order in which terms are organized in a sentence. Bacon believed, however, that other aspects of communication must be considered. Sentence structure alone is not sufficient to decode the semantic information contained in a sentence. He challenged the theory of natural sense in his doctrine of the “generation of speech” by emphasizing the relation between the intention of the speaker, linguistic form, and interpretation of the hearer in the context of understanding meaning. In short, understanding semantic information is, for him, a matter of interpretation. Another important claim of Bacon’s, which connects the early Summulae dialectices with the later De signis, relates to the question of whether terms can univocally signify existent and nonexistent, or universal and particular entities. For Bacon, terms like Caesar or Christ signify presently existing entities only and signify equivocally when predicated of a dead person. This semantic position, which would classify Bacon today as a semantic externalist, put Bacon in opposition to a number of his contemporaries, most famously Richard of Cornwall.

In addition to semantics, Bacon also did important work in semiotics and signification and developed views which in some cases were radically different from 13th century mainstream opinion. He challenged a number of common tenets on the nature of signs. Bacon worked within the Augustinian framework, according to which signs are in the category of relation,  and emphasized that signification is a three-term relation. A sign, take a word for example, is a sign of something to some interpreter.  More specifically, Bacon’s theory of signs stressed the “pragmatic” relation of the sign to the interpreter and thus underscored the context in which a sign is situated instead of the sign’s relation to the significate, as was the commonly held opinion. Another important element in his work in semantics is his analysis of imposition, that is, the act of name-giving. He distinguishes between two modes of imposition: (1) the very first imposition by the first name-giver and (2) subsequently applying a name to something different than what the name signifies according to its first imposition. Bacon thought of the very first imposition as an act similar to baptism. He understood it in terms of a situation in which a word is chosen as a label for a present thing. After which, the thing is called by that name.  In other words, the first imposition is the act by which a human name-giver decides to use a sound to refer to a thing and thereby endows that sound with meaning, and a word is created. However, according to Bacon, speakers have the power to change the meaning of words in situations in which they need to express something they currently lack a word for or in which the particular thing which the word originally named ceases to exist. Bacon argued that the use of a word is not restricted to the meaning endowed to it during the first act of imposition. On the contrary, a speaker may apply a word to any other object, thereby imposing a new meaning and making the term equivocal. The term’s interpretation then depends on the speaker’s intention. Bacon believed that these kinds of modifications of meanings of words occur tacitly and constantly and sometimes even without people being conscious of it. Bacon considers metaphors as a prevalent example of second imposition. In addition, Bacon also developed a comprehensive classification of signs or modes of signification, into which he integrated substantial semantic analyses. According to Bacon’s notion of signification, as part of his theory of imposition, signs immediately signify the things themselves rather than mental concepts or representations of things in the mind of the speaker.

4. Mathematics and Natural Sciences

a. General Remarks

Among Roger Bacon’s most widely known contributions to philosophy are his reflections and arguments pertaining to the fields of mathematics and the natural sciences.  Within the latter, Bacon is especially known for his emphasis on experience and on experimental science (scientia experimentalis), including optics, also called perspective (perspectiva or scientia de aspectibus). Many of his reflections on the physical world were presented in the context of his extensive critique of university learning dating from the 1260s, which oftentimes lent a rhetorical and pedagogical tenor. However, Bacon’s contributions to this field were not restricted to polemics. Apart from the papal opera (Opus Maius, Opus Minus, and Opus Tertium), his most important works on mathematical and physical topics were the De Multiplicatione Specierum (‘On the Multiplication of Species’; dated prior to the papal opera), the Communia Naturalium, and the Communia Mathematica, both dated after 1267.

Bacon’s accomplishments in these fields do not consist of reports of concrete scientific practice or specific methodological guidance in experimentation. On the whole, his work in mathematics and the natural sciences was more theoretical. He defended noteworthy pedagogical and methodological insights pertaining to the mathematization of natural philosophy for example. He also made the somewhat successful effort to reconcile the disparate Platonic and Aristotelian scientific approaches and thereby present a practicable and convincing synthesis (Fisher and Unguru, 1971, 375; Lindberg, 1979, 268).

i. Bacon’s Modification of the Quadrivium

In the Latin medieval tradition, arithmetic, geometry, music, and astronomy were subsumed into the Quadrivium. Together with the so-called Trivium (grammar, logic, rhetoric), they formed the two parts of the seven liberal arts (septem artes liberales). At the time the seven liberal arts were considered to be branches of philosophy. All of the quadrivial or mathematical arts dealt with quantity, the principle according to which things were said to be equal or unequal. Arithmetic and music dealt with discrete quantities, or numbers, whereas geometry and astronomy dealt with continuous quantities, such as lines. Traditionally, the mathematical or quadrivial disciplines constituted the medieval “scientific syllabus” in that they studied the natural world. Under the metaphysical assumption that every physical entity was formed through the essence of number and that physical phenomena could thus be “broken down” into arithmetical or geometrical terms, the natural world could be described using the quadrivial disciplines. Astronomy, for example, studied the motion of celestial bodies by employing numerical calculation and geometry.

Bacon’s concern for the quadrivial disciplines was ultimately ethical. By procuring the Pope’s support for a reform of liberal arts studies, he hoped to improve student learning and to boost scientific progress, which would ultimately serve the development of moral persons. (For the use of the term progress in regard to Bacon see Molland 1978.) For this purpose, Bacon modified the inherited division by adding new sciences to the traditional four. He identified a list of seven “special sciences,” among which he included perspective (optics), judicial astronomy (astrology), the science of weights, medicine, experimental science, alchemy, and agriculture. Bacon held that three of these sciences are especially important: judicial astronomy, alchemy, and experimental science (CN, I, 5). Yet, beyond just listing sciences worthy of study, Bacon made the case for new ways in which to approach some of the more established sciences, thereby introducing hitherto less known or neglected sources. In the case of perspective, for example, he advocated the use of Alhazen’s (al-Hasan ibn al-Haytham) De Aspectibus, or Perspectiva.

Bacon considered his contemporaries’ neglect of these “special sciences” to have detrimental consequences not only for the progress of learning but for the state of society as a whole. He reproached teachers and scholars of medicine for approaching their field in the wrong way because they neglected mathematics and experimentation. He scolded theologians for ignoring the “greater sciences” in their study of the Scriptures. Bacon thought a reform of liberal arts studies in general, and the Quadrivium in particular, was imperative because of the eminent utility of the mathematical and natural sciences. An improved understanding of the natural world would benefit Scriptural hermeneutics in that an understanding of the Scriptures’ literal sense would lead to an improved understanding of their spiritual sense. Bacon believed his reforms would also foster a practical operative knowledge capable of alleviating all sorts of human ailments or of ensuring Christians’ supremacy in warfare. Although dissatisfaction with the status quo of teaching and research constituted much of Bacon’s apology of the sciences, he also presented  original material on scientific method, in Scientia Experimentalis for example, as well as original scientific content,  like in his doctrine of physical causation.

ii. Bacon’s Scientific Views and the Condemnation of 1277

In advocating the “special sciences,” Bacon was concerned with the intellectual climate in which he found himself. The climate in Paris prior to Bishop Étienne Tempier’s issuance of a condemnation in 1277 was that of suspicion against Bacon’s most favored sciences: judicial astronomy, alchemy, and experimental science. With regard to the atmosphere in the Franciscan order, it is possible that Bonaventure, Bacon’s superior, partly had Bacon in mind when in his Collationes (1273) he accused “Aristotelian” philosophy of being at odds with Christian dogma. Thus much of Bacon’s presentation of, for example, judicial astrology and celestial influence was informed by wariness. He did not want to be charged with necessitarianism, the view that celestial events determine worldly events;among the doctrines impugned by Bishop Tempier was astrological determinism. In the context of alchemy and experimental science Bacon heeded the danger of being denounced for magic (OM IV, vol. 1, 137-139). However, Bacon was an outspoken supporter of natural magic, and he accused his opponents of “infinite stupidity” and deserving of being ridiculed as asses (asini) for ignoring the utility and benefits of judicial astronomy (OT, ch. lxv, 270). To forestall possible objections and charges, Bacon went to great lengths to distinguish magic proper, doctrines and practices accomplished with the help of demons, from “natural magic,” wondrous and awe-inspiring physical phenomena. He defended the respective sciences by naturalizing them. He provided arguments showing that seemingly magical effects imitate nature in their operations and do not use the aid of demons. One very important element in Bacon’s naturalistic explanation of supposedly magical phenomena, like astrological influence, was his theory of physical causation, best known as the multiplication of species (multiplicatio specierum, discussed further below). For Bacon’s view on magic see Molland 1974.

It is commonly agreed, however, that in certain respects Bacon’s views bordered on magical traditions. This is evident from his text De Secretis Operibus Artis et Naturae (‘On the Secret Works of Art and Nature,’ c. 1267) as well as from the third prerogative of experimental science in which Bacon’s imagination ran wild, projecting marvels like ever-burning lamps. These writings were kindled by the desire to benefit State and Church (OM VI, vol. 2, 217).

b. The Nature and Value of Mathematics

Secondary literature is not entirely favorable towards Bacon’s achievements in mathematics. It is commonly agreed that Bacon was not a creative mathematician. Yet it is also widely recognized that Bacon was well read and had a solid comprehension of the standard sources of 13th century mathematics. Bacon’s originality was more “in his thoughts about mathematics” rather than in his theoretical innovations (Fisher and Unguru, 1971, 355).

i. The Object and Division of Mathematics

Bacon adopted an Aristotelian abstractionist view of the objects of mathematical inquiry. Mathematics is the science dealing with objects whose principle was quantity. The form of quantity, though, had to be abstracted from motion and corporeal matter before it could be investigated by arithmetic or geometry. Although quantity exists in matter, in mathematics quantity is considered as abstracted from matter and motion. Bacon insisted, however, that in this abstracting procedure the imagination does not run the risk of positing quantity to exist by itself, in the manner of a Platonic form. That would defeat the purpose of mathematical inquiry, which is performed for utilitarian reasons, specifically for the sake of “corporeal quantity,” not for the sake of quantity itself (CM, 59).

One element that stands out in Bacon’s reflections about mathematics has to do with the division of the mathematical sciences, mainly presented in the third distinction of his Communia Mathematica. For pedagogical purposes, Bacon thought it important to distinguish between two principal branches of mathematical study. One branch deals with the universal themes of mathematics in terms of its “elements and roots;” this first branch can be termed common mathematics. The second branch deals with the specialized domains of geometry, arithmetic, music, and astronomy.

The second principal branch of mathematics is divided into two main parts: a speculative and a practical part. Following from this, each of the proper mathematical sciences can be seen, according to Bacon, to have a speculative as well as a practical side. For example, while the speculative part of geometry considers contiguous quantity removed from any practical concerns, the practical part of geometry applies geometrical insights to operational, concrete interests (CM, 38f) In either case, speculation must precede practice, which meant that Bacon considered mathematical theory to be subjugated to technological practice.

The postulation of “common mathematics” is considered to be the most original element of Bacon’s division of mathematics. In this context, Bacon leveled a critique of Euclid’s Elements, despite the fact that he believed Euclid was an important authority in the history of mathematics. Again, for Bacon, mathematics is the science dealing with quantity. The different specialized parts of mathematics deal with different kinds of quantity. Arithmetic and music deal with discrete quantities such as numbers. Geometry and astronomy deal with continuous quantities such as lines. The concept of quantity in general, however, could not be fully understood without a comprehension of the meaning of related concepts such as finite, infinite, position, and contiguous. Bacon criticized Euclid for being oblivious to a thorough treatment of these concepts. Such a treatment could be made by separating out a realm of common mathematics, which deals with quantity in general, and could be expressed by basic principles common to all mathematics (Molland, 1997, 165-168).

ii. The Methodological Relevance of Mathematics

Bacon’s favorite maxim in scientific matters consisted in emphasizing the utility of each science. As we have seen, this lead him to subjugate scientific research to the spiritual and concrete practical needs and interests of human beings. Since, for Bacon, the utility of a science is linked to its end, the end informs choices of content and form for each science. In other words, it did not only matter what was studied, but also how the results of those studies were presented to those needing instruction. In this respect, mathematics is no exception. A considerable part of Bacon’s reflections on mathematics were characterized by this “utilitarian” approach. It is not surprising, then, that Bacon considered mathematics to have no intrinsic value. According to Bacon, the mathematical disciplines (arithmetic, geometry, music, and astronomy) are of solely instrumental value. Doing mathematics should by no means be a purely theoretical inquiry. Yet, while emphasizing Bacon’s conviction that mathematics has no intrinsic value, it should not be overlooked that Bacon regarded mathematical study as instrumentally good for all the other sciences, including theology. Indeed, almost the whole of the fourth part of the Opus Maius is devoted to the presentation of the utility of mathematics in matters secular and divine.

According to Bacon, mathematics is “the gate and key” to the other sciences. Bacon regarded the comprehension of mathematical truth as being among the first steps in the order of cognition because “it is, so to speak, innate in us.” Mathematical objects by their very nature “are more knowable by us,” therefore, it is with these objects that our learning should commence (OM IV, vol. 1, 103-105). Indeed, Bacon went on to claim that a scientist who is ignorant of mathematics cannot have certain knowledge of either the other sciences or worldly matters. Mathematics, Bacon stressed, trained the mind for future study and raised the degree of knowledge acquired by the mind to the level of certainty (OM IV, vol. 1, 97). In other words, in order to practice the other sciences with a proper level of sophistication, or at all, mathematics is required. If the scientist’s goal is to truly understand the physical world, then she had to employ mathematics. This means that although mathematics is epistemologically vital to the progress of other sciences, it is not their queen in terms of dictating ends. In the order of learning, mathematics is ranked on the lower end (Molland, 1997, 164).

When Bacon stated that scientific study seeks to attain truths about the world, the term truth connotes a kind of knowledge in virtue. The human mind becomes peaceful in its scientific quest (ut quiescat animus in intuitu veritatis). To reach this state requires sense-based experience that brings the truth of scientific conclusions face-to-face with the scientist. In Bacon’s view, mathematics as well is subject to the general rule that the empirical dimension is essential to proper knowledge. For example, for a student to fully grasp the proof of the Euclidian equilateral triangle, she needs to see it actually being constructed (OM VI, vol. 2, 168). However, it is not simply the case that mathematics requires a verification of its conclusions through the aid of experiencing, as if this kind of experience were external to mathematical procedure. The reason why mathematical procedures are a guarantor for scientific certainty, according to Bacon, lies exactly in the fact that sense experience is an integral part of it. In mathematics there are necessary demonstrations that, because proceeding by way of necessary cause, achieve full and certain truth without error. In addition mathematics contains certifying experience as an intrinsic component of its basic operations, insofar as it has examples and tests that can be perceived by the senses, such as drawing figures or counting (OM IV, vol. 1, 105f). Thus, for Bacon, in order for the human mind tograsp the truth, it requires freedom from error and doubt, both of which mathematics is able to provide because of its connection to experience. The certifying potential of experience was further developed by Bacon in the sixth part of the Opus Maius, under the name of the first dignity of experimental science (prima prerogativa) (Fisher and Unguru, 1971).

iii. The Physical Relevance of Mathematics

Bacon can be regarded as having been among the first scholars to emphasize the physical relevance of mathematics. Bacon’s rationale for emphasizing the physical relevance of mathematics has epistemic elements, as discussed above, but it also has metaphysical elements, which have to do with the way in which Bacon conceived the structure of the physical world.

Everything that exists in nature, Bacon stated, was brought into existence by two causes, the efficient and the material cause. Every efficient cause, however,

acts through its own force which it produces in the matter subject to it, like the light of the sun produces its force in the air which is the light which is spread out throughout the world from the light of the sun. And this force is called likeness, image, species, and many other names, and this [force] produces substance as well as accident, both spiritual and corporeal […] Thus, agents’ forces like these bring about every operation in this world […] (OM IV, vol. 1, 111).

To understand physical agency brought about by efficient causes, however, requires mathematics because physical operations occur by means of forces, or species, like light, which operates through rays. Not only physical agency but psychic and astrological agency require mathematics as well to understand. For Bacon, light is an instance of physical agency through forces or species following the geometrical rules of reflection and refraction. It is a privileged case of such agency because of its visibility. Herein also lay the reason why the science of light and vision (perspective) is embedded in the theory of the multiplication of species. If a natural philosopher wants to explain natural processes, she must focus on lines of physical action and employ mathematical methods. Natural philosophy must follow the principle of motion and rest, which involves instances of change  and species following geometrical principles (OM IV, vol. 1, 110).

c. Bacon’s Theory of Physical Causation and Perspective

Bacon’s treatises De Multiplicatione Specierum and Perspectiva, comprising the fifth part of the Opus Maius, represent his scientific work at its best. Although Bacon was well-read on all of the new sciences presented in the course of the Latin medieval translation movement, he was most accomplished in the fields of light, vision, and the universal emanation of force. However, the actual extent of his accomplishments in this field has been the subject of a good deal of debate. Both the De Multiplicatione Specierum and the Perspectiva are available in modern critical editions and accompanied by English translations, prepared by David C. Lindberg.

In developing an account of physical causation in his doctrine of the multiplication of species, Bacon stood in a long tradition of philosophical and biblical writers who used light metaphors in different epistemological, metaphysical, and physical contexts. Although unknown during the Middle Ages, Plotinus’ doctrine of emanation—with its physical consequence that all beings radiate likenesses of themselves—had an indirect influence on Bacon’s physical doctrine of the multiplication of species, a physical doctrine of emanation, so to speak (Lindberg 1983, xxxix-xlii). The channels through which Plotinian and Neoplatonic ideas reached Bacon included Augustine, Arabic sources such as al-Kindī’s (d. c. 873) De Radiis and De Aspectibus, Avicebron’s (d. c. 1058) Fons Vitae and the Book of Causes (Liber de Causis) transmitting ideas from Proclus’ Elements of Theology. Next to the newly translated Aristotelian works, other important sources for Bacon’s doctrine of physical causation were treatises on more technical subjects such as Euclid’s Optica, Ptolemy’s Optica, and Alhazen’s De Aspectibus.

Among the first scholars to embrace this body of knowledge was Robert Grosseteste, whose influence on Bacon has been much debated. For Grosseteste’s influence on Bacon see Hackett, 1995 and 1997a. In any case, crucial for both Grosseteste and Bacon in their physical and metaphysical considerations was al-Kindī’s notion that  “every creature in the universe is a source of radiation and the universe itself a vast network of forces” (Lindberg, 1983, xlv). In al-Kindī, both Grosseteste and Bacon found a mathematical and physical analysis of the radiation of force, or physical agency, following the rules of geometrical optics. According to this analysis rays of light spread out by rectilinear propagation, reflection, and refraction. In a similar manner, the radiation of other kinds of species could also be understood along optico-geometrical lines. In comparison to al-Kindī and Grosseteste, Bacon’s achievement consisted in the naturalization of Grosseteste’s physics of light, “itself an outgrowth of al-Kindī’s universal radiation of force.” Bacon took Grosseteste’s doctrine out of its metaphysical and cosmogonical context and modified it to become a doctrine of physical causation (Lindberg, 1983, liv). In other words, in the De Multiplicatione Specierum Bacon brought forth a doctrine with which he was able to explain all kinds of physical causation—optical, astrological, and psychic—and to answer the question of how one physical object was able to affect another physical object even if they are not contiguous.

In Bacon’s view, the technical term species was not to be confused with Porphyry’s universal species . The former denotes the likeness or similitude of any naturally-acting thing, or its “first effect, ” as he called it (DMS, 2). What this implies is that a substance or quality is able to affect its surroundings by sending forth a likeness of itself in all directions unless obstructed—an activity which makes recipients of their likeness like themselves. By this process, natural agents impact others by means of forces bearing the specific nature of the original agent. Yet, this process of causation takes place without the original agent emitting something since this would result in its corruption, a possibility which Bacon excludes. Bacon emphasizes that instead of comprehending the process of the production of species in terms of emission or material emanation, as the ancient atomists did, it should be understood in terms of a transmission “through a natural alteration and bringing out of the potentiality of the matter of the recipient” (DMS, 45). For the physical nature of the species, this meant that they were generated in the recipient matter by a “bringing forth” (eductio), an elicitation “out of the recipient’s matter active potentiality” that already exists there (DMS, 47). In cases in which the agent and the recipient are contiguous, “the active substance of the agent, touching the substance of the recipient without intermediary, can alter, by its active virtue and power, the first part of the recipient it touches. And this action flows into the interior of that part, since the part is not a surface, but a body” (DMS, 52f). In cases in which this “bringing forth” could not be continuous because the agent and the effect are not contiguous, it occurs in a stepwise manner through a medium. In those cases, natural causation takes place in the form of successive generation or multiplication of species along straight or direct, reflected, refracted, twisting, or accidental lines. The species are multiplied step by step, beginning in a small section of a medium contiguous with the original agent, from whence it draws out its likeness in the next adjacent part, and so forth, until finally the last part of the medium ultimately superimposes the nature of the agent on the recipient. In the Perspectiva, the fifth part of the Opus maius, Bacon applied his doctrine of the multiplication of species to the subjects of the propagation of light and vision. Although much of Bacon’s account of vision was borrowed from Alhazen and other predecessors, Bacon synthesized that account into a form that became historically important. Indeed, it remained the standard account of visual theory until the work of Johannes Kepler (d. 1630) (Lindberg, 1997, 265).

In developing his doctrine of natural agency, Bacon drew principally on the optical tradition because he regarded light, acting by means of rays, as a paradigmatic case of physical causation. In fact, he thought of light as a privileged case because of its visibility—the radiation of force being like the sun (OM IV, vol. 1, 111). Inspired by Aristotle, Bacon stated that we know everything through vision, and perspective is the science of vision by means of which one can understand the structure and laws of the universe (OT, chapt. xi, 36f.). Perspective became Bacon’s model science for physical causation and was, compared to all the other sciences, especially significant for human understanding of the world. According to Bacon, because the radiation of light follows the geometrical principles of rectilinear propagation, reflection, and refraction, it employs mathematical methods and involves the possibility of geometrical demonstration, what Bacon considered an “experiment”; moreover, it is a subdivision of mathematics. As far as Bacon’s accomplishments in this field are concerned, it is commonly agreed that he was one of the leading Western proponents of the doctrine of the multiplication of species. It was Bacon, “more than any other author in the Latin world, who taught Europeans how to think about light, vision, and the emanation of force ”  (Lindberg, 1997, 244).

d. Experimental Science

Following Aristotle, Bacon held that “all humans by nature desire to know” and are naturally drawn towards the beauty of wisdom and carried away by their love for it. Bacon emphasized that to ensure success in learning, it is necessary to first inquire into the method best suited for it, as there are better and worse ways to proceed in the sciences. In his Compendium Studii Philosophiae (CSP), Bacon distinguished between three ways of acquiring knowledge—knowledge through authority, reason, and experience—and he made it clear that not all three ways are of equal value. Neither authority nor reason are sufficient for knowledge because reliance on authority alone yielded belief but not understanding, while reason alone could not distinguish between true sentences and sentences having only the appearance of knowledge (CSP, ch. i, 396f). According to Bacon, achieving knowledge requires three things: (1) to heed the structure of the scientific material and to begin with what is first, easier, and more general then proceed to what is later, more difficult, and more particular, (2) to proceed using the clearest possible words without causing confusion, and (3) to reach a level of certainty that leaves behind all doubt. For this, Bacon considered it crucial to employ experience, and, in regard to the order of learning, to precede experience with mathematics. Thus, the only way for the human mind to arrive at the full truth, and to rest in the contemplation of truth, is through experience, a subjective comprehension based on sense perception. Bacon believed that experimental science (scientia experimentalis) was virtually unknown to the “rank and file of students;” thus he thought it necessary to present to the Pope its “powers and properties.” Bacon thus laid out his theory of experiential knowledge in the sixth part of Opus Maius, presenting scientia experimentalis as the penultimate science, second only to moral philosophy (OM VI, vol. 2, 172).

Many of Bacon’s writings bear witness to his concern not only for the content of knowledge (that is, the available material), but also the quality of the knowledge acquired (ideally, conclusions should be held in a manner that penetrates and reassures the soul and leaves it in a state of certainty and free of doubt). Thus, when Bacon said that “[…] nothing can be sufficiently known without experience,” he meant to emphasize the role that individual sense perception (and especially vision) plays in the process of learning. (OM VI, vol. 2, 167) For Bacon, learning denotes not only the process of the acquisition of knowledge, but also the process of the restoration of wisdom that was given by God at the beginning of time and subsequently lost through sin (see Section 2a). Therefore, experiential knowledge is of fundamental importance in Bacon’s project of the reform of studies. Its importance and utility extended far beyond the theoretical sphere, encompassing progress in applied science and technology, and ideally leading to broad improvements in both Church and State.

i. Experience and Experiment

The meaning of the Latin term experimentum is ‘test’ or ‘trial.’ Bacon used this term to cover a variety of testing practices, such as first-hand and second-hand sensory experience and the inner, spiritual experience of divine illumination. Experimentum also was used to refer to various kinds of practical knowledge that are more or less connected to empirical practice. The notion of experience or experiments as a basis for induction, that is, for inferences based on observation, was familiar to Bacon, but in the context of advancing scientific understanding he did not seem to attach much importance to it. In his attempts to discover the cause of the rainbow, however, there are some inductive elements (Fisher and Unguru, 1971, 376).

In his concept of scientia experimentalis, Bacon did not only consider experience through external senses, through vision, for example. His understanding was firmly grounded within the Augustinian tradition in affirming another kind of experience next to those provided by the external senses. Experience that consists in “internal illumination” (OM VI, vol. 2, 169). For Bacon, experience through the external senses does not completely suffice to provide certainty in regard to physical bodies, “because of its difficulty,” and it does not achieve anything in the realm of spiritual things. The ancient patriarchs and prophets received their scientific knowledge by way of this divinely granted internal illumination. Thus, experience-based knowledge according to Bacon was twofold: philosophical and divine. The philosophical was rooted in external senses and the divine was rooted in divine inspiration occurring internally (OM VI, vol. 2, 169-172).

ii. The Three Prerogatives of Experimental Science

The goal of the major section of the sixth part of the Opus Maius was to outline the different dimensions of the value and utility of scientia experimentalis. In his theory, Bacon explicitly and carefully distinguished three different “prerogatives” or functions of scientia experimentalis, each producing its own peculiar result. Bacon’s usage of the name scientia experimentalis referred not to one but to three different things, each being useful for the restoration of learning, yet in different ways. Scientia experimentalis was both an instrument used within other sciences like mathematics or alchemy and a science in its own right. Scientia experimentalis experientially confirms or refutes the theoretical conclusions of other sciences, first dignity; it provides observations and instruments needed for empirical practice, second dignity, and it actively investigates the secrets of nature, third dignity. Modernly speaking one can say that by dividing scientia experimentalis into three dignities, Bacon acknowledged the difference that exists between science and technology.

The first prerogative or dignity of scientia experimentalis, according to Bacon, was aimed at the conclusions of the other sciences (OM VI, vol. 2, 172-201). With this dignity, Bacon’s goal was not to render conclusions logically consistent with one another, but rather experientially test or challenge theoretical claims to knowledge and thereby aid in the process of attaining doubt-free, certain knowledge. . Thus, in its first dignity, scientia experimentalis puts universal theoretical claims to the test by confronting them with the actual experiential objects. It thereby completes science’s search for truth and certitude. Certitude, in turn, is a function of the way by which knowledge is acquired and describes the state in which the human mind has a direct intuition of an experiential object. According to Bacon, this dignity of scientia experimentalis also includes mathematical conclusions, which cannot be fully known based on demonstrations alone since they lack reference to concrete experiential particulars. In his discussion of the rainbow and the halo in the sixth part of Opus Maius, Bacon gave a detailed illustration of this function of scientia experimentalis. In particular, by referring to observation and the application of the laws of perspective, Bacon attempted to provide a causal account of the appearance of the rainbow (Lindberg, 1966; Hackett, 1997b, 285-306).

The second prerogative also situates scientia experimentalis as an instrument within the other sciences.  Yet it is not related to experience as a source of knowledge or certitude as described in the first dignity. In its second function, experimental knowledge serves the purpose of developing the other speculative sciences to their fullest potential by venturing into the unknown and the occult through experimental practice involving instruments. Scientia experimentalis, for Bacon, becomes a tool utilized in the other sciences through its ability to discover truths hidden in these sciences—truths whose unearthing went beyond the competence of those sciences. For example, although human life and health belong to the science of medicine, scientia experimentalis goes beyond the field of medicine by seeking out means by which to prolong life (OM VI, vol. 2, 202).

In the third prerogative Bacon gave scientia experimentalis the status of a science within its own right, independent of the other sciences. Experimental science investigates the secrets of nature by its own power. Its function includes the acquisition of knowledge of the future, past, and present in which it even exceeds astrology, and the accomplishment of marvelous works such as the manufacturing of antidotes against animal poisons or technologies that could be used in warfare. (OM VI, vol. 2, 215-219)

iii. Bacon as Experimenter

In many respects, Bacon’s experimental practice was not as  sophisticated and strategic as his theory of scientia experimentalis.   It is the general verdict arrived at by scholars that Bacon did not live up to his promise of the application of experimental methods. Bacon’s accomplishment as experimenter has been criticized for many reasons including his silence on the concrete question of how to conduct the experiments in practice outlined by him in theory. In regard to perspective, it has been pointed out that while Bacon’s theories were not primarily the result of his own experimental practice, he still engaged in some experimental practice that went beyond simple, everyday observation, like in the case of the rainbow where he performed more complex observations. These observations have been described as “geometrical tests” (Lindberg, 1997, 268-271). Bacon’s experimental practice also encompassed observations that were supposed to supply empirical data requiring explanations in the context of existing theories, for example when employing the rules of refraction to explain the rod that appears bent upon partially being submerged in water. The most usual function of experiment and experience, though, consisted in the verification of theoretical claims made by the other speculative sciences.

e. Alchemy and Medicine

Apart from experimental science, the other science in which Bacon’s practical, secular concerns became manifest was alchemy—the science of the “generation of things” from the four elements. Unsurprisingly, alchemy occupies a very high position in Bacon’s reform of studies. He presented his “alchemical manifesto” (Newman, 1997, 319) as part of the Opus Tertium and at the end of the Opus Minus (OT, ch. xii, 39-43; OMi, 359-389). Apart from the papal opera, there were in addition a few other works dealing with alchemical-medical questions, such as the De Erroribus Medicorum and the Liber Sex Scientiarum in 3° Gradu Sapientie. In Bacon’s judgment, alchemy needed an advocate because natural philosophers and the common run of students were ignorant of the true potential of alchemy. Due to the interconnectedness of the sciences, ignorance of alchemy was to the detriment of speculative and practical medicine, which in turn affected the very general state of human affairs. For Bacon’s views on alchemy see Newman 1997.

Because alchemy was on the blacklist of ecclesiastical authorities, it was necessary for Bacon to carefully qualify his understanding of alchemy and to thoroughly differentiate it from magic. Bacon attempted to do this in his Epistola de Secretis Operibus Artis et Naturae, et de Nullitate Magiae. Against magical practices that relied on the help of evil demons, Bacon argued that alchemy relied on the powers of science, which operated in accordance with nature by artificially employing and directing the potential latent in nature. Bacon argued that the powers of the sciences even surpassed those of nature when in their practice they used natural powers as their instruments. In effect Bacon claimed that alchemical theory would provide the necessary naturalization of seemingly magical natural processes (Epistola de Secretis Operibus, 523).

As was common for his approach in organizing the sciences, Bacon divided alchemy into two branches, one speculative and the other practical. Speculative alchemy teaches the generation of things from the four elements (fire, air, water, and earth). What arises from the elements, Bacon argued, are things like metals, salts, or precious stones, and two types of humors: the “simple” humors (blood, phlegm, and black and yellow bile) and the “compound” humors of the same names. Practical alchemy, on the other hand, applies those theoretical insights for the purposes of, say, manufacturing various items of chemical technology like precious metals or pigments (OT, ch. xii, 40).

The notion that the interplay of the humors directs human vital processes and that the alchemist has the ability to analyze and transmute material substances, based on the belief in the transmutability of the proportions of humors, lead Bacon to call for practical action. He wanted the so-called philosophers’ stone and the universal remedy, Panacea, to be produced with alchemy. In general, he thought alchemy should be applied to medicine, which, during his time, was a “significant novelty” (Newman, 1997, 335). In the course of his alchemical work, Bacon assigned two roles to alchemy in medicine. The first role consisted in purifying ordinary pharmaceuticals, and the second role concerned prolonging human life to its utmost. Bacon believed that the shortness of people’s lives during his time was due not to divine plan, but to bad health regimens. Over time, these regimes had corrupted human complexion. Because this corruption arose from natural causes it was susceptible to natural remedies that would help to reestablish “equal complexion,” that is, a state of incorruptibility where the elemental qualities of a substance existed in perfect harmony according to their virtue and active power.  In Bacon’s mind, nature, with the help of alchemy, could produce the same result by applying appropriate means.

The secular trajectory of Bacon’s reductio artium and his “utilitarian” scientific outlook emerged in  the most pronounced form in Bacon’s work in medical alchemy. Even though Bacon’s attempt to combine alchemy and medicine under the aegis of experimental science did not have a major impact on his contemporaries, “it did at least foreshadow the development of a medical alchemy in the following century” (Newman, 1997, 335).

5. Moral Philosophy

a. General Scope and Nature of Bacon’s Moral Philosophy

Roger Bacon presented his main thoughts and arguments on morality and human moral agency in a piece entitled Moralis Philosophia (MP), which formed the seventh and last part of the Opus Maius (1266–1268). As such, the Moralis Philosophia marked the culmination of Bacon’s proposals on the reform of the studies of language and the sciences commissioned by Pope Clement IV. The Moralis Philosophia is available in a modern critical edition prepared by Eugenio Massa (1953). A short résumé of the main elements of Bacon’s moral philosophy is contained in the Opus Tertium, chapters xiv, xv, and lxxv.

i. Morality and Happiness

Generally speaking, Bacon’s moral reflections were built on the assumption that the end or goal of human life (finis hominis) is happiness and that human moral practice in the form of virtuous agency is a decisive factor in humans’ attainment of happiness. For a human being, the proper way to live is in a human manner and, as Bacon said, “virtue is the life of a human being” (MP III, §§1-4, 50f). Bacon understood happiness to be synonymous with salvation and believed philosophy and faith are both indispensable for its attainment. On the nature of happiness, true philosophy and the principles of Christian faith are in complete agreement. Thus the topic around which Bacon’s main practical and normative concerns in moral philosophy revolved was human moral agency. This took three specific forms: (1) human moral practice in relation to God, (2) human moral practice in relation to one’s neighbor in the form of social relations, and (3) human moral practice in relation to persons themselves in the form of virtue or vice. Bacon’s moral philosophy was normative in the sense that it concretely prescribed the details of these relations, and practical in the sense that it exhorted agents to live according to these moral principles and laws (MP I, §4, 4).

Next to the concept of happiness, the idea of the utility of the sciences for humankind was an ever-present concern for Bacon. According to Bacon, all of the sciences presented in the Opus Maius are, in one way or the other, useful for human beings in providing the theoretical and practical means necessary for a better life. The way in which a science is important can be spelled out either in the worldly sense of being able to procure an amelioration of everyday life, or—and in this sense related to the secular and the divine—as contributing to achieving happiness. Since moral philosophy is the only science concerned with morally relevant human agency, and human moral agency is directly related to the attaining of happiness, which is the highest goal or end of human beings, moral philosophy is the highest science. Thus Bacon’s concern with the utility of the sciences was expanded to include a moral dimension insofar as moral philosophy guides humans in virtuous action.

ii. The Place of Moral Philosophy within the Hierarchy of Sciences

Because meritorious human practice is connected to human happiness, it follows that sciences like grammar, mathematics, or geography are not value-neutral activities but crucial instruments in humans’ pursuit of the highest good (summum bonum). Thus within philosophy, moral reflection is a distinct, yet not isolated task, and it informed Bacon’s treatments of language, mathematics, optics and experimental science insofar as it orients them towards human perfection and happiness. In Bacon’s hierarchy of the sciences, moral philosophy is the highest science. Even experimental science, which Bacon favored so much, is only penultimate. Moral philosophy uses the results and conclusions of the other sciences, for example the truths that were established about celestial bodies in astronomy, for its principles and starting points. All other sciences are subordinate to moral philosophy (MP, Part I, §6, 4). While in themselves all the sciences on Bacon’s agenda had their own distinctive subject matters and objects, their shared overall purpose, the improvement of human life, represents a unifying factor.

Another significant feature of Bacon’s conception of moral philosophy concerns the way in which he attempted to solve a problem prominent in the 13th century. Contemporaries were concerned with the ethical value of speculation (theoria), in particular, metaphysics, the speculative science par excellence, and the status of speculative statements about God and spiritual substances. Bacon approached these issues from a teleological, ethical angle. For him, the supreme way of human life consists in moral practice, the highest expression of which is love of God practiced in worship (cultus dei). Although metaphysics and moral philosophy are related in the sense that they share their subject matter,  including subjects like God, immortality, and happiness, they are methodologically distinct. Metaphysics deals with these topics speculatively, that is, in a fundamental manner (principaliter) and in general (in universali), whereas moral philosophy deals with them practically, that is, from the point of view of their concrete practical implications (in particulari). While metaphysics asks whether there is a God or whether the human soul is immortal, moral philosophy assumes the affirmative metaphysical conclusions as its principles in order to deduce from them content related to the particular, concrete sphere of human agency. While for Bacon moral philosophy is completely dependent upon metaphysical speculation, metaphysical speculation is still entirely subordinated to moral philosophy because, from a teleological point of view, speculation ranks lower than moral practice in regard to the highest good and because of the limitations of metaphysical speculation with regard to moral matters. Thus metaphysical speculation is not an end in itself; rather, its end consists in catering to the needs of moral philosophy.  By virtue of its relation to metaphysics, moral philosophy is prevented from diminishing into a mere discrete, action-guiding skill, but rather retains its scientific character (MP, ch. I, 7-9). The reason for the moral philosopher’s competence to amplify metaphysical conclusions, such as those involving creation or the Trinity, was grounded in Bacon’s conviction that philosophers share in divine revelation and illumination (OM II, vol. 3, 44-50). In his answer to the question of the status of speculative statements about the divine, Bacon drew strongly from Avicenna’s conception of the relation between moral philosophy, civil science, and metaphysics, as presented in his final book, Liber de Philosophia Prima.

Bacon perceived no competition between moral philosophy and theology. Bacon stated very clearly that theology, the primary discipline concerned with sacred Scriptures, addresses the same topics as moral philosophy albeit in a different manner, namely “in the faith of Christ” (MP I, §5, 4). According to Bacon, philosophy is not ancillary to theology in the sense that any philosophical endeavor would culminate in theology, as proposed by the contemporary Reduction of Arts to Theology, written by Bacon’s Minister General Bonaventure. Rather, Bacon emphasized that both theology and philosophy are results of divine revelation and illumination. Secondly, philosophy is superior to theology in some respects. for example in matters pertaining to morality and virtue. Therefore theology could not lead humans to salvation without the substantial aid of philosophy. In Bacon’s model of knowledge, the ultimate goals of both theology and philosophy are subordinate to the highest good of a beatific union with God. In relation to philosophy, the object of theology is to amplify the wisdom provided by philosophy by adding the decisive teleological element in regard to human meritorious agency. In Bacon’s view, theology, like moral philosophy, is a practical science, dealing with human salvation “in the faith of Christ.” Philosophy, on the other hand, operates within the limitations of natural reason, rather than “in the faith of Christ.” Although it  informs “our actions in this life and in the other life,” in itself it cannot promote full, future happiness. Philosophical contemplative practice cannot bring about happiness or salvation (MP I, §2, 3).

iii. Practical Sciences and Human Practice

The manner in which Bacon reflected on the concept of human “practice” in the beginning of the MP suggests that the concept “practical science” was very important for Bacon’s philosophy. The way in which Bacon used the term bears modern connotations insofar as for him it implied the notions of utility and power for humans—for example, to improve or to ameliorate human lives in view of diseases or the process of aging. As Bacon pointed out, “some sciences are active and operative […]. They are about artificial and natural works, and consider the truths of things and scientific works that relate to the speculative intellect” (MP I, §2, 3). Thus, in Bacon’s understanding, a practical science had secular relevance in that it has the capacity of explaining and producing things through speculative efforts. This idea of practical he associated especially with experimental science, as described in great detail in the sixth part of the Opus Maius. However, Bacon further qualified the notion of human practice by pointing towards the relevance it had for human life in the other world, namely life after death. In this sense, the term practical acquired a narrower meaning.

According to Bacon, the term practical refers to a kind of human practice that has a connection to humans’ highest end (finis hominis) and to becoming good, to their acquiring the virtues of justice or modesty. These “works” of humans constitute moral agency properly speaking and represent the works by virtue of which characters or souls are judged as good or evil. Those works are works of moral conduct (opera moris). They consist in the performance of what is considered good or evil and are directed by the practical intellect intending and striving for the good. Accordingly, a practical science, taken in the narrower sense of the term, is a science of human action from the point of view of the distinction between good and evil, virtuous and vicious, and happiness and misery in the next life. Thus, in a wider sense, the term practical refers to human works, and practical science refers to the sciences directing their effort towards works, activity, and production. Yet, as Bacon emphasized, taken in a narrower sense, as in the context of moral philosophy, practical refers strictly to works of moral conduct as related to the practical intellect and human will (MP I, § 3, 3).

iv. The Functional Division of Moral Philosophy

The overall goal of moral philosophy, according to Bacon, is practical and directed towards human moral agency. With regard to the general structure of moral philosophy (sensu stricto), Bacon distinguished between two branches, a speculative or theoretical branch (speculativa), and a practical branch (practica). The former deals with subjects in a speculative manner—concerning, originally, metaphysical truths that have moral implications relating to the existence of God or God’s unity and trinity, as well as laws and virtues.  The practical branch, on the other hand, seeks engagement in human affairs. Under this branch the moral philosopher is concerned with active moral work, namely with moral persuasion, be that of unbelievers or the morally “paralyzed,” as Bacon describes the Christian whose will is corrupt or whose nature is too irascible to be made continent easily (MP V, §§1-2, 247).

Bacon likened this “division of labor” between the speculative and the practical parts of moral philosophy to the art of medicine which, like moral philosophy and all the other sciences, has a speculative and a practical branch. For Bacon, the practical part of moral philosophy is related to the speculative in a similar manner as, in medicine. The practical part of medicine isconcerned with the active healing of the sick and the preservation of health,) and is related to the theoretical part, concerning which concerns what health is, which diseases and symptoms there are, or what their remedies are. The main difference between both parts consists in the kind of knowledge the theoretically and practically versed expert possesses. While the theorist’s knowledge is essentially book knowledge,  consisting of generalized facts and second-hand authority, the practitioner’s knowledge is skill-based, rooted in first-hand experience with particular cases.  These experiences produce knowledge that allows for practical, read, operational, application to “induce humans to moral action.” According to Bacon, both the speculative and practical branches of moral philosophy have as common subject matters those subjects that are practical (operabilia) and are the highest truths about God and worship, eternal life, laws of justice and peace, and the virtues. The practice of moral philosophy, in Bacon’s understanding, can be likened to a kind of therapy, a spiritual-psychological healing, in which the patient (the human soul) is aided in the preservation of spiritual health and healed in case of spiritual disease (sin) (MP V, §§4-11, 248f). With regard to the division of moral philosophy, one can say that Bacon’s overall motto followed the famous Aristotelian principle from the second book of the Nicomachean Ethics, according to which the end of examining questions of virtue and happiness is not pursued for its own sake but rather in order “to become good.”

Bacon subsequently divided each of the two branches of moral philosophy into three sub-branches. The three parts of the speculative branch comprise the first three parts of the Moralis Philosophia. The first part presents a kind of “metaphysical groundwork or morals,” listing morally relevant metaphysical principles, like the existence of God, from which Bacon argued that it is possible to “unfold” (explicare) or expound any implied normative moral content. The second part of the speculative branch of moral philosophy deals with morality insofar as it pertains to the relations between the individuals and their fellow beings; this part, however, remains very brief, consisting mostly of quotations from Avicenna’s Metaphysics, outlining a structure of social life. Lastly, in the third part Bacon dealt with the topic of virtues and vices, predominantly by quoting from and recounting the moral works of the ancient Roman Stoic Seneca and also including some Cicero. Bacon had a special appreciation for Seneca. He considered Seneca’s moral teaching on virtues and vices as superior to the teaching of Christian thinkers (MP III.5, §1, 132). Bacon’s own account of the virtues and vices was influenced by both Aristotle’s and Stoic views on virtue. He adopted the Aristotelian doctrine of virtues of character being a mean and combined it with the Stoic doctrine of affects.  Accordingly, Bacon greatly emphasized tranquility. Without tranquility of mind, one could not tolerate adversities with ease or attain happiness.  Bacon also devoted particular attention to the vice of wrath. It has been argued that this part of Moralis Philosophia was composed as a moral handbook for the Prince and Prelate, advising the Pope about the existence and nature of Seneca’s Dialogues, which had been unknown north of the Alps until 1266 (Hackett, 1997, 407). This circumstance again illustrates the practical trajectory of Bacon’s philosophy, where “practical” is to be understood both in the sense of utility and of moral persuasiveness.

The “therapeutic” or practical task of moral philosophy, on the other hand, is contained in parts four to six of the Moralis Philosophia. All of these parts share the goal of helping to “induce humans to moral action,” that is, to persuade people of the morals contained in the works of secular philosophers, mainly Aristotle and Seneca and in the works of the Christian tradition. Bacon divided the three sub-branches of philosophy in accordance with their three distinct goals: (1) faith (MP part four), (2) moral practice (MP part five), and (3) forensic judgment (MP part six). Parts four to six of the Moralis Philosophia were “practical” in the sense that in each case, the “patient” or addressee is to be persuaded of either (1) the credibility of the right, Christian law (lex christiana), (2) the love and fulfillment of the law once she believed it, or (3) the “right” side in a complex legal case. Thus moral philosophy in its three practical sub-branches deals, according to Bacon, with different kinds of “patients”—Christians as well as Infidels. It employs different practical methods, including rhetorical and poetical arguments, in order to prove the validity of the religion and persuade people of it.

b. Moral Philosophy in the Service of Human Moral Agency

Bacon intended moral reflection to serve the salvific interests of humankind. He conceived of it, as we have seen, as “practical” in a double sense. On one hand, moral philosophy is human moral practice dealt with from a speculative point of view, consisting in the contemplation and proof or moral truths and ultimately directed towards practical guidance. On the other hand, moral philosophy is practical in that it involves the active effort to induce people to act morally (opus morale) by employing rhetorical and poetical arguments. The addressees of moral persuasion are, for Bacon, non-Christians and those Christians suffering from mental insanity or those who are morally “paralyzed” because of a corrupt will. In either of those cases, Bacon’s eye was directed towards human happiness and the religious, social, and personal implications of human moral agency for attaining that happiness. Because Bacon understood human practice to be establishing a relation to God through worship, to others in society, and to the individual self, being good for Bacon means to act virtuously in all of these relations. The purpose and utility of the practical branch of moral philosophy consists in producing the corresponding attitudes towards God, one’s neighbor, and oneself through the use of rhetorical and poetical arguments. Hence, moral persuasion was divided according to what pertains to the moral practice of faith (credendum), action (operandum), and correct judgment (recte iudicandum), and in this consists its service to humankind (MP V.2, §8, 251).

i. The Conversion of Non-Christians

The fourth part of Moralis Philosophia, which deals with the conversion of non-Christians, has a close connection to the fourth part of Opus Maius, on mathematics.  Bacon relied on the astrological theories he previously outlined in his mathematical reflections in Opus Maiusto create an account of the different religious sects (sectae) in Moralis Philosophia.. The systematic background for applying mathematics to religious matters was based on Bacon’s theory of science, according to which all sciences are related on a deeper genealogical level insofar as they all have divine origin and thus share the goal of serving or facilitating humanity’s pursuit of the highest good. Furthermore, according to Bacon, the speculative sciences, directed at contemplating truths, are subordinate to the practical sciences, which aim at the good. The good as an end of action is superior to truth as the end of speculation. Bacon defined this hierarchical relationship in terms of utility (MP V.2, §5, 251).

For Bacon, the mathematical sciences, of which astronomy-astrology is one, are useful in secular as well as divine matters. For theology, for example, Bacon briefly describes seven areas for the application of mathematics, including the location of hell and paradise (geography) or the course of human history since creation (chronology) (OM IV, 175ff). With regard to astronomy in general, it had been a widely circulated idea among medieval thinkers that astronomy is of immediate relevance to the human situation—and thus to moral philosophy—because, as was generally accepted at that time, the motions and natures of celestial bodies by means of rays affected sublunar processes and bodies. According to Bacon, judicial astronomy (astrology) in particular is useful. With respect to the present, judicial astronomy indicated that and what kind of peculiar moral influence each planet has on terrestrial animate and inanimate bodies. He believed this knowledge was useful for the work of moral persuasion (OM IV, vol. 1, 253-269). Thus moral and sociological issues such as temperament or character, forms of social organization and kinds of rulership, were held by Bacon to be dependent on astronomical constellations. For example, the constellations of Jupiter and Mars had religious significance in that they pointed to the supremacy of Christian faith or the coming of the Antichrist. Bacon not only believed individuals to be affected by constellations or climate, but whole communities as well. Thus the true astronomer can make conjectures based on manners and customs, which in turn are dependent on temperament and climate. Bacon believed this was why moral philosophy should consider astronomy-astrology in its work of converting infidels.

In accordance with astronomical-astrological findings, Bacon stated in his MP that there are six main sects, or social constitutions (lex), among which he listed Sarracens, Tartars, Pagans, Idolaters, Jews, and Christians (MP IV, §4, 189). With regard to the practical task of moral philosophy, Bacon considered its first goal to be the conversion of these sects, the “bending of the souls” of non-Christians so that they would receive and believe the truths of Christianity. Bacon held that the means by which they should be persuaded of the truth of Christianity were those common to all people. Rather than appeal to Christian authorities, the arguments employed should appeal to natural reason. Bacon recommended this conversion through language, essentially rhetoric, as being worth more than any war or “conversion through the sword” (OM III, vol. 2, 120-122).

ii. Moral Works and Eloquence

From Bacon’s point of view, the human need of moral persuasion was evident not only from contact of Christians with non-Christians, but also in the corrupt state of society. Bacon believed societal corruption was a reflection of curricular deficiencies, the deficiency being that they were taught grammar and formal logic rather than rhetoric and poetics. Bacon acknowledged that moral works—consisting of the acquisition of virtuous character traits, willing compliance with civil laws, and religious worship—were very difficult to achieve.  Indeed, he considered them much more difficult than the grasp of scientific subjects (MP V.3, §2, 254). The two reasons for human obtuseness in relation to moral works are, first, that moral works in themselves have a higher degree of difficulty than the scientific empirical subjects because of their being insensible, that is, intelligible only. Secondly, and more importantly, human will is corrupt and does not enjoy the execution of such works. Human will is drawn to sensible and temporal pleasures more than to eternal and insensible pleasures. Our will (affectus), Bacon added, resembles a paralytic who cannot perceive the delicious food placed in front of him. Failure to act morally is thus a failure of intention rather than cognitive inability. Since virtue and happiness are more important than individual scientific advancement and since some people must be persuaded of moral action, Bacon assigned the task of moral persuasion to the practical branch of moral philosophy.

For effective moral persuasion, Bacon identified a kind of “speech capable of swaying the human mind,” a way of speaking to people that takes into account basic facts of human psychology. Because moral agency depends on factors such as desire, will, motivation, and prudence—which are all associated with the practical intellect—the arguments employed in moral persuasion must be capable of appealing to the practical intellect and strong enough to remedy against “moral paralysis.” The arguments not only had to be taught but had to captivate listeners’ attention and arouse in them love for the good (MP V.2, §1, 250). In the process of identifying the adequate means for moral persuasion, Bacon excluded the two traditional, scientific forms of argument: dialectical and demonstrative arguments. Despite acceding to the view that only demonstrative arguments move the intellect towards knowledge of truths, Bacon held that the fact of being moved by means of argument towards knowing the truth about a subject is not sufficient for inducing humans to love the good and to act in accordance with it. For Bacon, arousing a love for the good that would result in action requires a kind of truth-bearing argument that appeals to the practical intellect. Human emotions and desires must participate rather than the speculative intellect, which is limited only to grasping truths and not involved in moral practice. The proper argument in the context of human moral and civil affairs engendered action. Thus, according to Bacon, moral persuasion was inseparable from the principles of eloquence through which a hearer was rendered docile, benevolent, and attentive (MP V.2, §8, 251). By means of pleasing words, a hearer’s soul can be carried away and swayed towards the good. These “pleasing words” encompass, for example, rhetoric and poetics as found in Horace. In matters pertaining to justice, the virtues, happiness, and faith, in which the appeal to emotions, desires, and hope is so decisive, Bacon believed that rhetoric and poetics are much more appropriate than demonstrations or dialectical arguments. For these reasons, as Bacon pointed out to the Pope, the disappearance of rhetoric and poetics from the curricula and the inability of students to compose such arguments posed a problem to society as a whole (OM I, vol. III, 33).

iii. Rhetoric and Poetics as Branches of Moral Philosophy

In identifying rhetorical and poetical arguments as the proper instruments for moral persuasion, Bacon did not work in vacuo but was inspired by Greek and Arabic sources as well by Augustine’s De Doctrina Christiana and connected with this by the practice of preaching and Scriptural hermeneutics.

For Bacon, Aristotle was the undisputed master of rhetoric and poetics. He explicitly credited Aristotle’s brief remarks in the Nichomachean Ethics (1094b, 19-27), stating that the moral philosopher should use rhetoric rather than geometric proof. In the same breath, however, he lamented that current knowledge of both Aristotle’s Rhetoric and Poetics was lacking. The first complete translation of the Poetics was prepared in the 1280s by William Moerbecke. Without direct knowledge of Aristotle’s Poetics, Bacon had to rely on Averroes’ Commentary on the Poetics.

By comparison, Bacon regarded the Ciceronian Rhetoric (De Inventione and the pseudo-Ciceronian Rhetorica ad Herenium) as deficient in practical matters because it was restricted to cases of forensic oratory (MP, V.2, §7, 251). Apart from Aristotle and Augustine, another important reference for Bacon that demonstrated the connection between rhetoric and ethical and civil concerns was the Arabic tradition of writings, including Avicenna’s Logic, Algazel’s Treatise on Logic, and especially al-Farabi’s De Scientiis, chapter five (De Scientia Civili et Scientia Legis et Scientia Elocutionis) (CM, 16f; Rosier-Catach, 1998).  Bacon’s presentation and commendation of rhetoric and poetics can be regarded as an important historical contribution. Bacon not only criticized their omission from university curricula but also defended them against the charges of sophistry. Instead of counting rhetoric and poetics as part of the Trivium, he situated their use and utility within the context of moral philosophy for the purpose of moral persuasion. In a truly original manner, Bacon combined two distinct spheres of discourse, namely the artistic milieu represented by the Arabic tradition with the theological tradition represented in Augustine.  He also sowed the seeds for a significant step in the history of rhetoric and poetics, which consisted of acknowledging that while the principles of teaching how to compose rhetorical arguments are situated within logic, the particular use of rhetoric is a function of moral philosophy (rhetorica docens and utens) (OT, ch. lxxv, 308). In subsequent 13th century discussion, Giles of Rome further developed this potential of Aristotelian rhetoric in relation to ethical matters in his Commentary on the Rhetoric (1280s).

As far as the particulars of Bacon’s conception of rhetoric are concerned, he proposed a division of rhetoric corresponding to the threefold division of the practical branch of moral philosophy into faith, action, and correct judgment. For each kind of persuasion, there is a corresponding rhetorical technique (triplex flexus) (MP V.2, §7, 251). In the case of faith and the true religion, the adequate kind of persuasion involves assent and proof. While in cases of correct judgment, the kind of rhetoric needed is forensic oratory, which is based on Cicero’s rhetoric. These two parts Bacon regarded as “rhetoric absolutely speaking.”  Yet “swaying” people toward moral action that avoids evil and pursues the good requires stronger remedies. The kind of argument to be used, Bacon said, is properly called “poetic argument.” Thus poetics, according to Bacon, represents the third kind of rhetorical argument and thereby forms an integral part of moral philosophy (MP V.3, §6f., 254f). However, as Bacon pointed out, not all poetry is commendable. There are poets, like Ovidius, whose use of poetically skillful speech incite frivolity rather than virtue, and who, in a certain sense, misuse eloquence by reducing it to delectation. In comparison, the duty of a rhetorician is not to only please but to teach and to sway. The criterion according to which one can distinguish between the good and the shady poets is whether the respective poet only amuses or whether his poetry goes beyond amusement to sway people to good rather than to frivolous action. Poetry’s truthfulness and commendability consist in its practical usefulness.

All three kinds of rhetoric, as Bacon presented them, appeal to the practical intellect and are grounded in the idea that through “powerful speech” a speaker is able to make contact with a listener on some emotional level. The difference between the first two kinds of rhetoric, forensic rhetoric and rhetoric used in situations of religious persuasion, and the third kind, moral persuasion that engendered action, is one of style. Bacon distinguished between three styles: humble, moderate, and grand style. He placed most emphasis on the grand style and ascribed it to poetics because poetics involves “speaking of great and magnificent things.” By using the grand style, poetical argument moves the listener affectively and effectively to moral action (MP V.3, §11f, 256). For efficiency’s sake, Bacon insisted that grandiloquence must dominate in poetics. He also advocated mixing the styles, since moral persuasion also entails moral education and a variety of styles aid in not letting tediousness slip in. Bacon explained that the grand style involved an analogical (similitudo) use of language, illustrating it by giving examples. A knowledge of the properties of things, like light for example, broadens the orator’s semantic range of words and augments the moral message conveyed through argument. A sinner who after penance reverts to sin, as Bacon borrowed from the New Testament, is like “a dog which returns to his own vomit.” The veracity of such kinds of arguments, is not grounded in the properties of things: a person is obviously not a dog. Rather, the statements made in analogical arguments are true by way of similitude, comparison, and analogy and true for the purpose of persuasion (MP V.3, §16f, 257). In suggesting this approach in using language for moral persuasion, Bacon relied on principles of Scriptural hermeneutics. An accurate interpretation of the spiritual meaning of Scripture presupposes an accurate understanding of the literal text, which, in turn, presupposes an understanding of the natural world. In other words, knowledge of nature is subordinate to and useful in theology as well as in moral philosophy. In addition to using the grand style, Bacon suggested including into the repertoire of moral persuasion not only linguistic means of “moving the ears” but sensitivity to the nature and situation of the respective audience. Rhetoricians should be mindful of “movement of the mind and appropriate bodily gesture” (MP V.3, §20, 258). Thus practical moral discourse is capable of effectively touching human sentiment. Bacon’s reflections took into account the different dimensions of practical moral discourse, ranging from rhythm and intonation over content to the body language of the speaker.

6. Conclusion

Many of Roger Bacon’s works still require critical editions and systematic and historical examination, throwing a wrench into any attempt at a final conclusion about his accomplishments in philosophy. Perhaps because of this circumstance, perhaps because of the brilliance of some of his educational ideas, or perhaps because of his strategic scientific vision, which always aimed at the improvement of human life, his scientific legacy continues to draw the attention of intellectual historians—even if Bacon did not appeal to his own contemporaries.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Bibliographies

  • Alessio, Franco, “Un secolo di studi su Ruggero Bacone (1848-1957),” Revista critica de storia della filosofia 14 (1959), 81-102.
  • Little, Arthur G., “Roger Bacon’s Works with reference to The Manuscripts and Printed Editions,” in Little, A.G., Roger Bacon: Essays Contributed by Various Writers on the Occasion of the Commemoration of the Seventh Centenary of His Birth (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1914), 373-426.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah and Maloney, Thomas S., “A Roger Bacon Bibliography (1957-1985),” New Scholasticism 61 (1987), 184-207.
  • Maloney, Thomas S., “A Roger Bacon Bibliography (1985-1995),” in Roger Bacon and the Sciences. Commemorative Essays (Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters, vol. 57), ed. Jeremiah Hackett (Leiden: Brill, 1997), 395-403.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah, “The Published Works of Roger Bacon,” Vivarium 35,2 (1997), 315-320. Contains also an updated list of manuscripts.

b. Primary Sources

Below is a list of Bacon’s major works in chronological order with English translations of the titles. For a complete list of Bacon’s published works, consult Jeremiah Hackett’s bibliography.

i. 1240s–1250s

  • Questiones supra undecimum Prime philosophie Aristotelis (Metaphysica XII), ed Robert Steele (with Ferdinand Marie Delorme), Fasc. 7, 1926, in Opera hactenus inedita Rogeri Baconi, 16 Fascicules, ed. Robert Steele (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1905/1909-1941). [Questions on the Eleventh Book of Aristotle’s First Philosophy] (Cited hereafter by Fasc. Number)
  • Questiones supra libros quatuor Physicorum Aristotelis, ed. Ferdinand Marie Delorme (with Robert Steele), Fasc. 8, 1928. [Questions on the Four Books of Aristotle’s Physics]
  • Questiones supra libros Prime philosophie Aristotelis (Metaphysica I, II, V-X), ed. Robert Steele (with Ferdinand Marie Delorme), Fasc. 10, 1930. [Questions on Aristotle’s First Philosophy]
  • Questiones altere supra libros Prime philosophie Aristotelis (Metaphysica I-IV), ed Robert Steele (with Ferdinand Marie Delorme), Fasc. 11, 1932. [Alternate questions on Aristotle’s First Philosophy]
  • Questiones supra librum De causis, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 12, 1935. [Questions on The Book of Causes]
  • Questiones supra libros octo Physicorum Aristotelis, ed. Ferdinand Marie Delorme (with Robert Steele), Fasc. 13, 1935. [Questions on the Eight Books of Aristotle’s Physics]
  • Liber de sensu et sensato and Summa de Sophismatibus and Distinctionibus, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 14, 1937. [On the Book on Sense and What is Sensed and Summary of Sophisms and Distinctions]
  • Summa Grammatica, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 15, 1940. [Summary of Grammar]
  • Summulae dialectices. I: De termino. II: De enuntiatione. III: De argumentatione, ed. Alain de Libera, in Archives d’Histoire Doctrinale et Littéraire du Moyen-Âge 53 (1986), 139-289 (I-II); 54 (1987), 171-278 (III). [Summary of Dialectics]

ii. 1250s–1268

  • De multiplicatione specierum and De speculis comburentibus, in David C. Lindberg, Roger Bacon’s Philosophy of Nature: A Critical Edition, with English Translation, Introduction and Notes, of De multiplicatione specierum and De speculis comburentibus(Oxford: Clarendon Press 1983). [On the Multiplication of Species and On Burning Mirrors]
  • The ‘Opus maius’ of Roger Bacon, 3 vols., ed. John Henry Bridges (Oxford, 1900). Reprint: Frankfurt: Minerva, 1964. [Major Work]
  • Opus maius, part three: K.M. Fredborg, Lauge Nielsen, and Jan Pinborg (eds.), “An Unedited Part of Roger Bacon’s ‘Opus maiusDe signis,’” Traditio 34 (1978), 75-136. [On Signs, fragment of Opus maius, part three]
  • Opus maius, part five: David C. Lindberg, Roger Bacon and the Origins of Perspectiva in the Middle Ages: A Critical Edition and English Translation of Bacon’s Perspectiva with Introduction and Notes (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1996).
  • Opus maius, part seven: Rogeri Baconis Moralis Philosophia, ed. Eugenio Massa (Padua/Zurich: Thesaurus mundi, 1953). [Moral philosophy, critical edition with Latin introduction]
  • Opus minus, ed. John Sherren Brewer, in Fr. Rogeri Bacon Opera quaedam hactenus inedita, ed. John Sherren Brewer (London: Longman, Green, Longman & Roberts, 1859). Reprint: Nendeln/Lichtenstein: Kraus, 1965, 313-389. [Minor Work]
  • Opus tertium, ed. J.S. Brewer, in Fr. Rogeri Bacon Opera quaedam hactenus inedita, ed. J. S. Brewer (London: Longman, Green, Longman & Roberts, 1859). Reprint: Nendeln/Lichtenstein: Kraus, 1965, 3-310. [Third Work]
  • Part of the Opus tertium of Roger Bacon, including a Fragment Now Printed for the First Time, ed. Arthur George Little (Aberdeen: Aberdeen University Press, 1912). Reprint, Farnborough, U.K.: Gregg Press, 1966.
  • Opus maius, Opus minus, Opus tertium (Introduction): Epistola ad Clementem IV papam, in Franics Aidan Gasquet (Cardinal), “An Unpublished Fragment of a Work by Roger Bacon,” English Historical Review 12 (1894), 495-517. [Letter to Pope Clement IV]

iii. 1268–1292

  • Liber primus communium naturalium, parts 1 and 2, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 2, 1905. [First Book on What is Common to Natural Things]
  • Liber primus communium naturalium, parts 3 and 4, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 3, 1911. [First Book on What is Common to Natural Things]
  • Liber secundus communium naturalium (De celestibus), ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 4, 1913. [Second Book on What is Common to Natural Things]
  • Compendium studii philosophiae, in Fr. Rogeri Bacon Opera quaedam hactenus inedita, ed. J. S. Brewer (London: Longman, Green, Longman & Roberts, 1859). Reprint: Nendeln/Lichtenstein: Kraus, 1965, 393-519. [Summary of the Study of Philosophy]
  • Epistola fratris Rogerii Baconis de Secretis Operibus Artis et Naturae, et de Nullitate Magiae, in Fr. Rogeri Bacon Opera quaedam hactenus inedita, ed. J. S. Brewer (London: Longman, Green, Longman & Roberts, 1859). Reprint: Nendeln/Lichtenstein: Kraus, 1965, 523-551. [Letter of Brother Roger on the Secret Works of Art and Nature, and on the Uselessness of Magic]
  • Communia Mathematica, parts 1 and 2, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 16, 1940. [On What is Common to Mathematical Things]
  • Geometria Speculativa, ed. A. George Molland, in Vestigia mathematica. Studies in Medieval and Early Modern Mathematics in Honour of H.L.L. Busard (Amsterdam: Rodopi, 1993), 265-303. (An edition with English translation of the continuation of theCommunia Mathematica not printed in the Steele-edition) [Theoretical Geometry]
  • Secretum secretorum cum Glossis et Notulis, ed. Robert Steele, Fasc. 5, 1920. [The Book of the Secret of Secrets with Glosses and Notes (of Roger Bacon)]
  • De erroribus medicorum, ed. A.G. Little & E. Withington, Fasc. 9, 1928, 150-171.
  • Antidotarius, ed. A.G. Little & E. Withington, Fasc. 9, 1928, 103-119.
  • Grammatica graeca and Grammatica hebraica (The Greek Grammar of Roger Bacon and a Fragment of His Hebrew Grammar), ed. Edmund Nolan and S.A. Hirsch (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1902). (Exact dating of the two grammars not determined)
  • Compendium studii theologiae, Edition and Translation with Introduction and Notes by Thomas S. Maloney (Studien und Texte zur Geistesgeschichte des Mittelalters, 20), (Leiden: Brill, 1988). [Summary of the Study of Theology]

c. Secondary Sources

  • Antolic, Pia, “’Experientia est universalis acceptio singularium:’ Die Rezeption der Zweiten Analytiken im Kommentar des Roger Bacon zu Buch I der Metaphysik,” in Knowledge and Science. Problems of Epistemology in Medieval Philosophy, eds. Matthias Lutz-Bachmann, Alexander Fidora, and Pia Antolic (Berlin: Akademie Verlag, 2004), 213-237.
  • Antolic, Pia,  Roger Bacon: ‘Opus maius.’ Eine moralphilosophische Auswahl (Freiburg: Herder, 2008). (German translation of selected passages from Bacon’s Moralis philosophia with introduction)
  • Bérubé, Camille, De la Philosophie à la Sagesse chez Saint Bonaventure et Roger Bacon (Rome: Istituto storico dei Cappuccini, 1976).
  • Crowley, Theodore, Roger Bacon: The Problem of the Soul in his Philosophical Commentaries (Dublin: Frederick Press, 1950).
  • De Libera, Alain, “Roger Bacon et le Probleme de l’Appelatio Univoca,” in in English Logic and Semantics. From the End of the Twelfth Century to the Time of Ockham and Burleigh, eds. H.A.G. Braakhuis, C.H. Kneepkens, L.M. de Rijk (Nijmegen: Ingenium Publishers, 1981), 193-234.
  • De Libera, Alain,  “De la logique à la grammaire: Remarques sur la théorie de la determination chez Roger Bacon et Lambert d’Auxerre (Lambert de Lagny),” in De grammatica. A Tribute to Jan Pinborg, eds. G. Bursill-Hall, S. Ebbesen, and K. Koerner (Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Company, 1990), 209-226.
  • De Libera, Alain,  “Roger Bacon et la reference vide. Sur quelques antecedents médiévaux du paradoxe de Meinong,” in Lectionem varietates: Homages á Paul Vignaux, eds. J. Jolivet, Z. Kaluza, and A. De Libera (Paris: J. Vrin, 1991), 85-120.
  • De Libera, Alain,  “Roger Bacon et la Logique,” in Roger Bacon and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays, ed. Jeremiah Hackett (Leiden: Brill, 1997), 103-132.
  • Del Punta, F., Donati, S., Trifogli, C., “Commentaries on Aristotle’s Physics in Britain, ca. 1250-1270,” in Aristotle in Britain in the Middle Ages, ed. John Marenbon (Turnhout: Brepols, 1996), 265-83.
  • Easton, Stewart C., Roger Bacon and His Search for a Universal Science: A Reconsideration of the Life and Work of Roger Bacon in the Light of His Own Stated Purpose (New York: Columbia University Press, 1952).
  • Fisher, N. W. and Unguru, Sabetei, “Experimental Science and Mathematics in Roger Bacon’s Thought,” Traditio 27 (1971), 353-378.
  • Fredborg, Karin Margareta, “Roger Bacon on ‘Impositio vocis ad significandum,’” in English Logic and Semantics. From the End of the Twelfth Century to the Time of Ockham and Burleigh, eds. H.A.G. Braakhuis, C.H. Kneepkens, L.M. de Rijk (Nijmegen: Ingenium Publishers, 1981), 167-191.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah, “Philosophy and Theology in Roger Bacon’s ‘Opus maius,’” in Philosophy and the God of Abraham. Essays in Memory of James A. Weisheipl OP, ed. Raymond James Long (Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies, 1991), 55-69.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Roger Bacon,” in Medieval Philosophers, ed. Jeremiah Hackett (Detroit/London: Gale Research Inc., 1992) 90-102.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Scientia experimentalis: From Grosseteste to Roger Bacon,” in Robert Grosseteste: New Perspectives on his Thought and Scholarship, ed. James McEvoy (Turnhout: Brepols, 1995), 89-120.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah, , ed., Roger Bacon and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays (Leiden: Brill, 1997).
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Roger Bacon: His Life, Career and Works,” in Roger Bacon and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays, ed. Jeremiah Hackett (Leiden: Brill, 1997), 9-23. (1997a)
  • Hackett, Jeremiah, Roger Bacon on Scientia Experimentalis,“ in Roger Bacon and the Sciences: Commemorative Essays, ed. Jeremiah Hackett (Leiden: Brill, 1997), 277-315. (1997b)
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  ed, Roger Bacon and Aristotelianism, Vivarium 35, 2 (1997).
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Robert Grosseteste and Roger Bacon on the Posterior Analytics,” in Knowledge and Science. Problems of Epistemology in Medieval Philosophy, eds. Matthias Lutz-Bachmann, Alexander Fidora, and Pia Antolic (Berlin: Akademie Verlag, 2004), 161-212.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Roger Bacon and the Reception of Aristotle in the Thirteenth Century: An Introduction to his Criticism of Averroes,” in Albertus Magnus and the Beginnings of the Medieval Reception of Aristotle in the Latin West, eds. Ludger Honnefelder, et al. (Münster: Aschendorff Verlag, 2005), 219-248.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Mirrors of Princes, Errors of Philosophers: Roger Bacon and Giles of Rome (Aegidius Romanus) on the Education of the Government (the Prince),” in Ireland, England and the Continent in the Middle Ages and Beyond: Essays in Memory of a Turbulent Friar, F.X. Martin, OSA, eds. Howard B. Clarke and J.R.S. Phillips (Dublin: University College Dublin Press, 2006), 105-127.
  • Hackett, Jeremiah,  “Experience and Demonstration in Roger Bacon: A Critical Review of some Modern Interpretations,” in Experience and Demonstration: The Sciences of Nature in the 13th and 14th Centuries, eds. Alexander Fidora, et al. (Berlin: Akademie Verlag, 2006), 41-58.
  • Hedwig, Klaus, “Roger Bacon: Scientia experimentalis,” ed. Theo Kobush, Philosophen des Mittelalters (Darmstadt: Primus, 2000), 140-51.
  • Johnson, Timothy J., “Back to Bacon: Dieter Hattrup and Bonaventure’s Authorship of the De Reductione,” Franciscan Studies 67 (2009), 132-147.
  • King, Peter, “Two Conceptions of Experience,” Medieval Philosophy and Theology 11 (2003), 203-226.
  • Lindberg, David C., “Roger Bacon’s Theory of the Rainbow: Progress or Regress,” Isis 57 (1966), 235-49.
  • Lindberg, David C.,  “Lines of Influence in Thirteenth Century Optics: Bacon, Witelo, and Pecham,” Speculum 46 (1971), 66-83.
  • Lindberg, David C.,  “Science as Handmaiden. Roger Bacon and the Patristic Tradition,” Isis 78 (1987), 518–536.
  • Little, Arthur G., Roger Bacon: Essays Contributed by Various Writers on the Occasion of the Commemoration of the Seventh Centenary of His Birth (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1914). Reprint New York 1972.
  • Maloney, Thomas S., “Roger Bacon on the Significatum of Words,” in Archéologie du Signe (Papers in Medieval Studies, 3), ed. Lucie Brind’Amour and Eugene Vance (Toronto: Pontifical Institute of Medieval Studies, 1983), 187-211. (1983a)
  • Maloney, Thomas S.,  “The Semiotics of Roger Bacon,” Medieval Studies 45 (1983), 120-154. (1983b)
  • Maloney, Thomas S.,  “Roger Bacon on Equivocation,” Vivarium 22 (1984), 85-112.
  • Maloney, Thomas S.,  “Is the De doctrina Christiana the Source for Bacon’s Semiotics,” in Reading and Wisdom: The De doctrina Christiana of Augustine in the Middle Ages, ed. Edward D. English (Notre Dame and London: University of Notre Dame Press, 1995), 126-42.
  • Maloney, Thomas S.,  “The Extreme Realism of Roger Bacon,” Review of Metaphysics 38 (1985), 807-837.
  • Mensching, Günter, Roger Bacon (Zugänge zum Denken des Mittelalters, vol. 4 (Münster: Aschendorff 2009).
  • Molland, A. George, “Roger Bacon as Magician,” Traditio 50 (1974), 445-460.
  • Molland, A. George,  “Medieval Ideas of Scientific Progress,” Journal of the History of Ideas 39 (1978), 567–571.
  • Molland, A. George,  “Roger Bacon and the Hermetic Tradition in Medieval Science,” Vivarium 31 (1983), 140-160.
  • Molland, A. George,  “Roger Bacon’s De laudibus mathematicae: a preliminary study,” in E. Sylla & M. McVaugh, eds., Texts and Contexts in Ancient and Medieval Science: Studies on the Occasion of John E. Murdoch’s Seventieth Birthday (Leiden: Brill,1996), 68-83.
  • Molland, A. George,  “Roger Bacon’s Appropriation of Past Mathematics,” in Tradition, Transmission, Transformation. Proceedings of Two Conferences on Pre-modern Science held at the University of Oklahoma, eds. F.J. Ragep, S.P. Ragep, and S. Livesey (Leiden: Brill, 1996), 347-65.
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Author Information

Pia Antolic-Piper
Email: pia_antolic@hotmail.com
James Madison University
U. S. A.

Émile Durkheim (1858—1917)

DurkheimÉmile Durkheim was a French sociologist who rose to prominence in the late 19th and early 20th centuries. Along with Karl Marx and Max Weber, he is credited as being one of the principal founders of modern sociology. Chief among his claims is that society is a sui generis reality, or a reality unique to itself and irreducible to its composing parts. It is created when individual consciences interact and fuse together to create a synthetic reality that is completely new and greater than the sum of its parts. This reality can only be understood in sociological terms, and cannot be reduced to biological or psychological explanations. The fact that social life has this quality would form the foundation of another of Durkheim’s claims, that human societies could be studied scientifically. For this purpose he developed a new methodology, which focuses on what Durkheim calls “social facts,” or elements of collective life that exist independently of and are able to exert an influence on the individual. Using this method, he published influential works on a number of topics. He is most well known as the author of On the Division of Social Labor, The Rules of Sociological Method, Suicide, and The Elementary Forms of Religious Life. However, Durkheim also published a voluminous number of articles and reviews, and has had several of his lecture courses published posthumously.

When Durkheim began writing, sociology was not recognized as an independent field of study. As part of the campaign to change this he went to great lengths to separate sociology from all other disciplines, especially philosophy. In consequence, while Durkheim’s influence in the social sciences has been extensive, his relationship with philosophy remains ambiguous. Nevertheless, Durkheim maintained that sociology and philosophy are in many ways complementary, going so far as to say that sociology has an advantage over philosophy, since his sociological method provides the means to study philosophical questions empirically, rather than metaphysically or theoretically. As a result, Durkheim often used sociology to approach topics that have traditionally been reserved for philosophical investigation.

For the purposes of this article, Durkheim’s strictly sociological thought will be set aside to allow his contributions to philosophy to take prominence. These fall largely in the realms of the philosophy of religion, social theory, the philosophy of social science, hermeneutics, the philosophy of language, morality, metaethics, political theory, and epistemology. Durkheim’s deconstruction of the self, as well as his analysis of the crisis brought on by modernity and his projections about the future of Western civilization, also deserve significant consideration.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
    1. Life
    2. Intellectual Development and Influences
    3. Reception of Durkheim’s Thought
  2. The Sociological Method: Society and the Study of Social Facts
    1. Durkheim’s Social Realism
  3. Durkheim’s Sociology of Knowledge
    1. Représentations Collectives
    2. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Language
    3. The Categories
    4. The Classification of Knowledge
    5. Cultural Relativism versus Scientific Truth
    6. Conclusion
  4. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Religion
  5. Durkheim on Morality
  6. Social Change and Modernity in the West
    1. Causes of Social Change
    2. The Division of Labor and the Emergence of Modernity in Europe
    3. The Death of the Gods
    4. The Cult of the Individual: Durkheim and Politics
  7. The Individual and Society
  8. References and Further Reading
    1. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in French
    2. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in English
    3. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

a. Life

David Émile Durkheim was born in April 1858 in Épinal, located in the Lorraine region of France. His family was devoutly Jewish, and his father, grandfather, and great grandfather were all rabbis. Durkheim, however, broke with tradition and went to the École normale supérieure in 1879, where he studied philosophy. He graduated in 1882 and began teaching the subject in France. In 1887 he was appointed to teach Social Sciences and Pedagogy at the University of Bordeaux, allowing him to teach the first ever official sociology courses in France. Also in 1887, Durkheim married Louise Dreyfus, with whom he would eventually have two children. During his time at Bordeaux, Durkheim had great success, publishing his doctoral thesis On the Division of Social Labor (1893, Division), The Rules of Sociological Method (1895, Rules), and Suicide: A Study in Sociology (1897, Suicide). In 1896 he established the prestigious Année sociologique, further cementing sociology’s place in the academic world.

In 1902, Durkheim was finally given a promotion in the form of the chair of the Science of Education at the Sorbonne. In 1906 he became a full professor and in 1913, his position was changed to formally include sociology. Henceforth he was chair of the Science of Education and Sociology. Here he gave lectures on a number of subjects and published a number of important essays as well as his final, and most important, major work The Elementary Forms of Religious Life (1912, Forms). The outbreak of World War I would prove to have disastrous consequences for Durkheim. The war took many of his most promising pupils and in 1915 his son, André, also died in combat. From this Durkheim would never recover and in November 1917 he died of a stroke, leaving his last great work, La Morale (Morality), with only a preliminary introduction.

During his lifetime, Durkheim was politically engaged, yet kept these engagements rather discrete. He defended Alfred Dreyfus during the Dreyfus affair and was a founding member of the Human Rights League. Durkheim was familiar with Karl Marx’s ideas. Yet, Durkheim was very critical of Marx’s work, which he saw as unscientific and dogmatic, as well as of Marxism, which he saw as needlessly conflictual, reactionary, and violent. Nevertheless, he supported a number of socialist reforms, and had a number of important socialist friends, but never committed himself to a political party and did not make political issues a primary concern. Despite his muted political engagement, Durkheim was an ardent patriot of France. He hoped to use his sociology as a way to help a French society suffering under the strains of modernity, and during World War I he took up a position writing anti-German propaganda pamphlets, which in part use his sociological theories to help explain the fervent nationalism found in Germany.

b. Intellectual Development and Influences

Durkheim was not the first thinker to attempt to make sociology a science. Auguste Comte, who wished to extend the scientific method to the social sciences, and Herbert Spencer, who developed an evolutionary utilitarian approach that he applied to different areas in the social sciences, made notable attempts and their work had a formative influence on Durkheim. In particular, Durkheim appropriated elements of Comte’s positivism as well as elements of his scientific approach to studying societies. Durkheim’s analysis of the ways in which different parts of society operate to create a functioning whole, as well as his use of the organic analogy, was in many ways inspired by Spencer’s own brand of functionalist analysis. However, Durkheim was critical of these attempts at sociology and felt that neither had sufficiently divorced their analyses from metaphysical assumptions. These were to be found particularly in what Durkheim considered Comte and Spencer’s unilinear models of social development, which were based on a priori laws of social evolution. While Durkheim incorporated elements of evolutionary theory into his own, he did so in a critical way, and was not interested in developing a grand theory of society as much as developing a perspective and a method that could be applied in diverse ways. The sociological method that Durkheim devised, thus, sought to be free of the metaphysical positivism of Comte and Spencer and differed greatly from Comte’s mere extension of the scientific method of the natural sciences to society.

Several of Durkheim’s teachers at the École normale supérieure would also have an important impact on his thinking. With Emile Boutroux, Durkheim read Comte and got the idea that sociology could have its own unique subject matter that was not reducible to any other field of study. Gabriel Monod and Numa Denis Fustel de Coulanges, both historians, introduced Durkheim to systematic empirical and comparative methods that could be applied to history and the social sciences. Charles Renouvier, a neo-Kantian philosopher, also had a large impact on Durkheim. Renouvier was an adamant rationalist and likely played a fundamental role in shaping Durkheim’s interpretation of Kant, specifically Durkheim’s understanding of the categories, an understanding that some observers have called into question. Renouvier was also preoccupied with a number of ideas that would appear in Durkheim’s thinking, including the scientific study of morality or social cohesion and the relation of the individual to society.

Between 1885 and 1886, Durkheim spent an academic year visiting universities in Germany. What Durkheim found there impressed him deeply. He encountered German scholars such as Adolf Wagner, Gustav Schmoller, Rudolph von Jhering, Albert Schäffle, and Wilhelm Wundt who were working on scientific approaches to the study of ethics. Importantly these scholars were relating morality to other social institutions such as economics or the law, and in the process were emphasizing the social nature of morality. Arguably the most important of these thinkers for Durkheim was Wundt, who rejected methodological individualism and argued that morality was a sui generis social phenomenon that could not be reduced to individuals acting in isolation. Taken together, these thinkers laid the foundations for Durkheim’s social realism and provided a powerful critique to utilitarian conceptions of morality, epitomized by Spencer, which viewed the origin of morality within the rational, self-interested calculations of the individual.

Throughout Durkheim’s life, other notable thinkers would have a prominent impact on him. Early in his career Durkheim wrote dissertations about Jean-Jacques Rousseau and Montesquieu, both of whom he cited as precursors to sociology. John Stuart Mill’s writings on logic influenced Durkheim’s reflections on the sociological method. In 1895 Durkheim’s thinking about society changed dramatically after he read William Robertson Smith’s Lectures on the Religion of the Semites. It is generally recognized that around this period in Durkheim’s life he changed the themes and approaches in his work. Before this time, as in Division, Durkheim focused on how the material and morphological elements of a society affected it, whereas afterwards he began to concentrate on the ideational elements of society, with an increasing focus on représentations collectives, morality, religion, and social norms and values. Other philosophers are also prominent in Durkheim’s discussions. The most important of these, arguably, is Immanuel Kant, whose moral and epistemological theories were of great influence. However Plato, William James, and René Descartes, among others, are all present in Durkheim’s work and influenced him in substantial ways.

c. Reception of Durkheim’s Thought

Durkheim remains a fundamental and prominent figure for sociology and social theory in general. Yet, in comparison with Marx and Weber, the influence of Durkheim’s thought has been somewhat muted, especially with regards to philosophy. This can be partly explained by the fact that the Durkheimian school of thought was greatly reduced when many of his most promising students were killed in WWI, that Durkheim went to such great lengths to divorce sociology from philosophy, or by the fact that his thought has been, and continues to be, simplified, misunderstood, or ignored.

Nevertheless, his ideas had, and continue to have, a strong impact in the social sciences, especially in sociology and anthropology. Members of his research group, such as Marcel Mauss, Maurice Halbwachs, Robert Herz, Paul Fauconnet, Célestin Bouglé, and Lucien Lévy-Bruhl, and later thinkers, such as Talcott Parsons, Alfred Radcliffe-Brown, Robert Nisbet, and Claude Levi-Strauss, were all strongly influenced by him. Philosophers such as Henri Bergeson and Emmanuel Levinas acknowledge the influence of Durkheim’s ideas, and his work is present in the linguistic theories of Ferdinand de Saussure. In addition, Durkheim’s ideas are latent in the structuralist thought that emerged in post WWII France, for example in Alain Badiou, Louis Althusser, and Michel Foucault, as well as in the work of other post-war thinkers such as Jacques Lacan and Maurice Merleau-Ponty. His thought is also a precursor to many later developments in philosophy, including John Rawls’ concept of political liberalism and John Searle’s discussion of social institutions. These thinkers, however, never discuss Durkheim at length, or acknowledge any intellectual debt to him.

More recently, social theorists such as Pierre Bourdieu, Robert Bellah, and Steven Lukes, philosophers such as Charles Taylor and Hans Joas, and psychologists such as Jonathan Haidt have been influenced by Durkheim’s thinking. Notably Randall Collins has developed Durkheim’s analysis of ritual into a microsociology and a theory of conflict while Jeffrey Alexander and Philip Smith have formulated a research program in cultural sociology called the Strong Program that is influenced by Durkheim’s late works. Also, Durkheim’s concept of sui generis is analogous to the concept of emergence that arose in the philosophy of mind and the philosophy of social science in the 1960s. Authors working in these fields have begun recognizing Durkheim’s relevance to these discussions.

2. The Sociological Method: Society and the Study of Social Facts

According to Durkheim, all elements of society, including morality and religion, are part of the natural world and can be studied scientifically. In particular, Durkheim sees his sociology as the science of institutions, which refer to collective ways of thinking, feeling, and acting. A fundamental element of this science is the sociological method, which Durkheim formulated specifically for this purpose.

The foundational claim for Durkheim’s sociology, and what is to make up the subject matter for sociology, is the existence of what Durkheim calls social facts. A social fact, as defined in Rules, is “a category of facts which present very special characteristics: they consist of manners of acting, thinking, and feeling external to the individual, which are invested with a coercive power by virtue of which they exercise control over him” (Durkheim; 1982: 52). According to Durkheim, social facts have an objective reality that sociologists can study in a way similar to how other scientists, such as physicists, study the physical world. An important corollary to the above definition is that social facts are also internal to individuals, and it is only through individuals that social facts are able to exist. In this sense, externality means interior to individuals other than the individual subject. This leads to the seemingly paradoxical statement that social facts are both external and internal to the individual, a claim that has frequently been misunderstood and left Durkheim’s work open to criticism.

In order to fully grasp how social facts are created and operate, it must be understood that for Durkheim, a society is not merely a group of individuals living in one particular geographical location. Rather, a society is an ensemble of ideas, beliefs, and sentiments of all sorts that are realized through individuals; it indicates a reality that is produced when individuals interact with one another, resulting in the fusion of individual consciences. This fusion of individual consciences is a sui generis reality. This means that the social fact, much as water is the product of the combination of hydrogen and oxygen atoms, is a wholly new entity with distinct properties, irreducible to its composing parts, and unable to be understood by any means other than those proper to it. In other words, society is greater than the sum of its parts; it supercedes in complexity, depth, and richness, the existence of any one particular individual. This psychic reality is sometimes (although especially in Division) referred to by Durkheim with the term conscience collective, which can alternately be translated into English as collective conscience or collective consciousness. What is more, society and social phenomena can only be explained in sociological terms, as the fusion of individual consciences that, once created, follows its own laws. Society cannot be explained, for example, in biological or psychological terms. Social facts are key, since they are what constitute and express the psychic reality that is society. Through them individuals acquire particular traits, such as a language, a monetary system, values, religious beliefs, tendencies for suicide, or technologies, that they would never have had living in total isolation.

Durkheim identifies different kinds of social facts with constraint remaining a key feature of each. For example, social facts include a society’s legal code, religious beliefs, concept of beauty, monetary system, ways of dressing, or its language. In these cases it is easy to see how society imposes itself onto the individual from the outside through the establishment of social norms and values to which conformity is either expected or encouraged. Currents of opinion, or social phenomena that express themselves through individual cases, are also social facts. Examples include rates of marriage, birth, or suicide. In these cases, the operation of society on the individual is not so obvious. Nevertheless, these phenomena can be studied with the use of statistics, which accumulate individual cases into an aggregate and express a certain state of the collective mind. There are also social facts of a morphological, or structural, order, including the demographic and material conditions of life such as the number, nature, and relation of the composing parts of a society, their geographical distribution, their means of communication and so forth. While perhaps not as evident, these types of social facts are also influenced by collective ways of thinking, acting, or feeling and have the same characteristics of externality and constraint as the other types.

Durkheim thus identifies a broad range of social facts that correspond roughly with his intellectual development: in his early work he focuses on social morphology, he then wrote a book on suicide, while his late work concentrates on social norms and values seen especially in morality and religion. As Durkheim’s interests shifted, his notion of coercion also changed, as did his use of the word ‘constraint’. In his early work constraint has more of a repressive or obligatory nature, whereas in his later works he highlights the attracting or devotional aspects of social facts, or how individuals are drawn voluntarily to particular symbols, norms, or beliefs. In the latter case society still ‘constrains’ the thoughts and behavior of the individual, but in a radically different way. Important to point out also is that social facts operate at varying degrees of formality and complexity. Thus, while Durkheim’s language at times points to a homogenous or monolithic understanding of society, the social processes he describes should be understood as taking place with differing degrees of formality and complexity on many different levels of social interaction, and the method he provides can and should be used to study this diversity of social phenomena.

Durkheim provides a set of rules for studying social facts. While he lists a number of rules, the most fundamental come from Chapter 2 of Rules. The first and most important rule is to treat social facts as things. What Durkheim means by this is that social facts have an existence independent of the knowing subject and that they impose themselves on the observer. Social facts can be recognized by the sign that they resist the action of individual will upon them; as products of the collectivity, changing social facts require laborious effort. The next rule for studying social facts is that the sociologist must clearly delimit and define the group of phenomena being researched. This structures the research and provides the object of study a condition of verifiability. The sociologist must also strive to be as objective towards the facts they are working on as possible and remove any subjective bias or attachment to what they are investigating. Similarly, the sociologist must systematically discard any and all preconceptions and closely examine the facts before saying anything about them.

Durkheim applies these rules to empirical evidence he draws primarily from statistics, ethnography, and history. Durkheim treats this data in a rational way, which is to say that he applies the law of causality to it. At this, Durkheim introduces an important rationalist component to his sociological method, namely the idea that by using his rules human behavior can be explained through observable cause and effect relationships. Accordingly, he often uses a comparative-historical approach, which he sees as the core of the sociological method, to eliminate extraneous causes and find commonalities between different societies and their social facts. In so doing, he strives to find general laws that are universally applicable. Durkheim also argues that social facts can only be understood in relation to other social facts. As an example, he explains suicide rates not in reference to psychological factors, but rather to different social institutions and the way they integrate and regulate individuals within a group. In his work Durkheim also follows the historical development of political, educational, religious, economic, and moral institutions, particularly those of Western society, and makes a strict difference between historical analysis and sociology: whereas the historical method strives only to describe what happened in the past, sociology strives to explain the past. In other words, sociology searches for the causes and functions of social facts as they change over time.

a. Durkheim’s Social Realism

An important, and often misunderstood, element of Durkheim’s sociological method is to be found in what can be termed Durkheim’s social realism, or the idea that society is an objectively real entity that exists independently and autonomously of any particular individual, a view that is epitomized by his prescription to treat social facts as things. Within this realist position there are two important claims. First, Durkheim makes an ontological claim concerning the sui generis reality of social facts. Second, Durkheim makes an epistemological and methodological claim, arguing that social facts should be treated as real objects, existing external to the researcher’s mind, that can be determined by their ability to coerce behavior. Hence, Durkheim is arguing that social facts have particular properties of being and that they can be discovered and analyzed when the sociologist treats them in the proper, scientific way.

These elements of Durkheim’s sociology have led to some confusion. Some critics claim that Durkheim is guilty of saying that social facts exist independent and outside of all individuals, which leads them to think that Durkheim hypostatizes some sort of metaphysical “group mind.” Other critics argue that Durkheim is guilty of an ontologism or a realism in which he considers social facts to be material properties of social life.

Durkheim strongly refutes such accusations. In response to the first critique, it must be remembered that social facts are both exterior and interior to individuals, with externality in this case meaning interior to individuals other than the individual subject. As Durkheim argues, social facts exist in a special substratum of the individual mind. His position then ultimately is that while the social fact is unmistakably a sui generis product of social interaction, it is produced and resides exclusively in this special substratum of the individual mind. To say that social facts exist independent of all individuals is an absurd position that Durkheim does not advocate. Only on a methodological level, in order to study social facts from the outside as they present themselves to individuals, does the sociologist abstract social facts from the individual consciences in which they are present. In response to the second critique, Durkheim maintains that social facts, as products of the psyche, are wholly ideational and do not have a material substratum. They can only be observed through the more or less systematized phenomenal reality (to be analyzed as empirical data) that expresses them. By stating the reality of the ideational realm of social facts in this way, treating them as observable things of the natural world while maintaining they are ideal, Durkheim’s social realism can be seen as an attempt to bridge diverging schools of philosophical thought, such as realism and nominalism, or empiricism and idealism.

3. Durkheim’s Sociology of Knowledge

Durkheim was one of the first thinkers in the Western tradition to examine how an individual’s social milieu affects the way that individual perceives the world. His most definitive statement on the subject can be found in Forms, a book dedicated not only to studying religion, but also to understanding how logical thought arises out of society. Other works, such as Pragmatism and Sociology, a posthumous lecture series given late in his life, elaborate his views. His sociology of knowledge argues that many, if not all, facets of an individual’s thought and conception of the world are influenced by society. Not only are our common beliefs, ideas, and language determined by our social milieu, but even the concepts and categories necessary for logical thought, such as time, space, causality, and number, have their source in society. This logical structure helps to order and interpret the world, ensuring that individuals have a more or less homogenous understanding of the world and how it operates, without which human society would not be possible. To begin to understand Durkheim’s analysis, a fundamental concept of his sociology of knowledge, représentations collectives, needs to be discussed.

a. Représentations Collectives

According to Durkheim, no knowledge of the world is possible without humanity in some way representing it. Furthermore, Durkheim rejects the idea of the Ding an sich, or the transcendent thing in itself. This means that the world exists only as far as it is represented, and that all knowledge of the world necessarily refers back to how it is represented. Accordingly, the central part of Durkheim’s theory of knowledge is his concept of représentations collectives (this term could be translated into English as collective representations, although there is no English equivalent to Durkheim’s use of the French term représentation, which in his work can mean both a mental representation or copy of something or an idea about something). Représentations collectives are the body of representations a society uses to represent to itself things in reality, as those things relate to and affect society. It is important to note that while représentations collectives refer to things in reality, they are not simple images that reflect reality as it is projected onto the intellect from the outside. Rather they are the result of an interaction between the external world and society; in being represented by society, things are infused with elements of a society’s collective experience, providing those things with a meaning and value. Représentations collectives are thus the repositories and transmitters of collective experience and thereby embody and express the reality of a society’s collective existence. Représentations collectives can take many forms, including group symbols, language, and conceptual thought. Considering the central importance of représentations collectives to collective life, it is no surprise that Durkheim dedicated so much time to their study later in his career.

b. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Language

Durkheim’s analysis of language in many ways illustrates not only what he means by the term représentations collectives, but also how he sees society operating on a fundamental level. As Durkheim explains, words, or concepts, are unlike individual sensory representations, which are in a perpetual flux and unable to provide a stable and consistent form to thought. Concepts are impersonal, stand outside of time and becoming (le devenir), and the thought they engender is fixed and resists change. Consequently, language is also the realm through which the idea of truth is able to come into being, since through language individuals are able to conceive of a world of stable ideas that are common to different intelligences. Thus, language conforms to the two criteria for truth that Durkheim lays out, impersonality and stability. These two criteria are also precisely what allow for inter-subjective communication. Language is, therefore, obviously a sui generis product of social interaction; it is the product of the fusion of individual consciences, with the result being completely new and irreducible to the parts that make it up and with the result residing in the minds of individuals as a product of collective action. As such, language does not bear the imprint of any mind in particular, and is instead developed by society, that unique intelligence where all of the others come to meet and interact, contributing their ideas and sentiments to the social nexus. Words are merely the way in which society, in its totality, represents to itself objects of experience. In this way, language is also infused with the authority of society. With this, Durkheim makes a reference to Plato, saying that when confronted with this system of concepts, the individual mind is in the same situation as the nous of Plato before the world of ideas. The individual is thereby compelled to assimilate the concepts and appropriate them as their own, if only so as to be able to communicate with other individuals.

Language, as a set of représentations collectives, also has a unique quality in that it plays an active role in structuring an individual’s perception of reality. As Durkheim argues, objects of experience do not exist independently of the society that perceives and represents them. They exist only through the relationship they have with society, a relationship that can reveal very different aspects about reality depending on the society. This is because contained within language is all of the collective knowledge and experience that a group has accrued over the centuries and that informs a group’s beliefs and values. Through language society is able to pass on to an individual a body of collective knowledge that is infinitely rich and greatly exceeds the limits of individual experience. To think conceptually, thus, does not simply mean to see reality in a general way, or ‘as it is,’ it is to project a light onto reality, a light that penetrates, illuminates, and transforms reality. The way in which an individual, literally, sees the world, and the knowledge an individual comes to have about existence, therefore, is highly informed by the language that individual speaks.

c. The Categories

Language is not the only facet of logical thought that society engenders; society also plays a large role in creating the categories of thought, such as time, space, number, causality, personality and so forth. In formulating his theory, Durkheim is especially critical of rationalists, such as Kant, who believe that the categories of human thought are universal, independent of environmental factors, and located within the mind a priori. The categories, such as time and space, are not vague and indeterminate, as Kant suggests. Rather, they have a definite form and specific qualities (such as minutes, weeks, months for time, or north, south, inches, kilometers for space). The characteristics of the categories, furthermore, vary from culture to culture, sometimes greatly, leading Durkheim to believe that they are of a social origin. Durkheim’s rejection of the rationalists, however, does not lead him to the opposing theoretical framework, that of the empiricists. Durkheim is also critical of this school of thought, which argues that an individual’s experience of the world gives rise to the categories. Durkheim argues that the categories share the same properties as concepts. Categories, like concepts, have the qualities of stability and impersonality, both of which are necessary conditions for the mutual understanding of two minds. Like concepts, then, categories have a necessarily social function and are the product of social interaction. Individuals could therefore never create the categories on their own. Durkheim believes that it is possible to overcome the opposition between rationalism and empiricism by accounting for reason without ignoring the world of observable empirical data. In order to do so, Durkheim treats the categories as représentations collectives, and studies them as such.

As Durkheim argues, the categories are the natural, sui generis result of the co-existence and interaction of individuals within a social framework. As représentations collectives created by society, the categories exist independently of the individual and impose themselves onto the individual’s mind, which would have no capacity for categorical thought otherwise. What is more, not only does society institute the categories in this way, but different aspects of the social being serve as the content of the categories. For example, the rhythm of social life serves as the base for the category of time, the spatial arrangement of the group serves as a base for the category of space, the social grouping of society (for example in clans or phratries) serves as a base for the category of class (as in the classification of items), and collective force is at the origin of the concept of an efficacious force, which was essential to the very first formulations of the category of causality. Another category of utmost importance is the category of totality, the notion of everything, which originates from the concept of the social group in total. The categories are not, of course, used only to relate to society. Rather, they extend and apply to the entire universe, helping individuals to explain rationally the world around them. As a result, the ways in which individuals understand the world through the categories can vary in important ways.

This element of Durkheim’s theory has a significant flaw, however. As Steven Lukes has pointed out, Durkheim does not distinguish between the faculties of categorical thinking, such as the faculty of temporality, and the content of these faculties, such as dividing time into set units of measurement. Instead, Durkheim views both the capacity and the content of categorical thought as stamped onto the individual mind by society at the same time. As such, Durkheim’s theory fails to account for the inherent abilities of categorical or logical thought. There may be different classifications within a society, for example, but in order for an individual to recognize these classifications in the first place, they must have prior possession of the ability to recognize classifications. Despite this flaw, an important element of Durkheim’s theory, the idea that the content of the categories is modeled on the organization of society and social life, has proven to be challenging and influential to later thinkers.

d. The Classification of Knowledge

Another vital role that society plays in the construction of human knowledge is the fact that it actively organizes objects of experience into a coherent classificatory system that encompasses the entire universe. With these classificatory systems it becomes possible to attach things one to another and to establish relations between them. This allows us to see things as functions of each other, as if they were following an interior law that was founded in their nature and provides order to an otherwise chaotic world. What is more, Durkheim argues that it was through religion that the very first cosmologies, or classificatory systems of the universe, came into being, in the form of religious myth. Religion was thus the first place where humans could attempt to rationally explain and understand the world around them. As a result, Durkheim argues that the evolution of logic is strongly linked to the evolution of religion (though both ultimately depend upon social conditions). This leads to the claim that religion is at the origin of much, if not all, of human knowledge. This argument has a far reach, affecting even the way in which modern science views itself. Following Durkheim, while modern science might claim to have no kinship with religion and in fact claim to be opposed to religion, it is in effect through religion that the conceptual and logical thought necessary for scientific thinking originated and was first elaborated. This component of Durkheim’s sociology of knowledge has been highly provocative and influential both in sociology and beyond.

e. Cultural Relativism versus Scientific Truth

With such a theory of knowledge, Durkheim reveals himself to be a cultural relativist, arguing that each culture has a network of self-referential logic and concepts that creates truths that are legitimate and, while not necessarily grounded in the reality of the physical world, are grounded within the reality of their respective social framework. Truths of this nature Durkheim calls mythological truths. In opposition to this relativistic view of truth, however, Durkheim also defends scientific rationalism and the idea that there exist scientific truths that are not dependent on cultural context and that express reality “as it is.” These scientific truths, or scientific représentations, are subjected to stringent verification and methodological control, and while they express these truths through inadequate symbols and in an approximated way, they are more perfect and more reliable than other représentations collectives. Despite the fact that they are of a fundamentally different nature (expressing reality as it is and not the reality of society), scientific représentations operate in the same way and are just as instrumental to society as other représentations collectives. Scientific truths deal with the same subject matter as mythological truths (nature, man, society), and like other représentations collectives they serve to reinforce and unify the collective conscience around one idea. Scientific truths are also représentations to which society has added the knowledge it has accumulated historically through collaborative effort. Scientific représentations reflect collective experience and express the relationship a society has with the world around it. Thus, while, there are objective truths about the world to be discovered, it would be mistaken to think that reality exists independently, or is logically antecedent, of it being represented through society, since it is only through collective effort that these scientific truths are discovered, and thus come to being. Scientific truths, while of a special nature, are also in an important way bound by the limits of society.

Yet one might wonder how Durkheim can claim that both sets of truths are true or in some way reflect reality. As W.S.F. Pickering has noted, this issue is resolved when one understands that Durkheim is a multi-realist, meaning reality is complex and operates on multiple levels. Hence Durkheim is able to maintain that mythological truths are true to the extent that a group holds them to be true, while also claiming that scientific truths reflect the true nature of reality.

f. Conclusion

In the end, Durkheim strives to account for a total sociology of knowledge. Society creates for itself, through its représentations collectives, a vast network of language and logical thought that is instrumental in allowing its individuals to understand and think the world. And, since the world exists only as far as it is thought, and since the world is totally thought only by society, the world takes its shape in society. In other words, society establishes, from the outset, the limits of possibility for rationality, linguistic expression, and knowledge in general.

4. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Religion

During Durkheim’s life, his thinking about religion changed in important ways. Early in his life, as in Division, he argued that human societies could exist on a secular basis without religion. But as time went on he saw religion as a more and more fundamental element of social life. By the time he wrote Forms, Durkheim saw religion as a part of the human condition, and while the content of religion might be different from society to society over time, religion will, in some form or another, always be a part of social life. Durkheim also argues that religion is the most fundamental social institution, with almost all other social institutions, at some point in human history, being born from it. For these reasons he gave special analysis to this phenomenon, providing a philosophy of religion that is perhaps as provocative as it is rich with insights.

According to Durkheim, religion is the product of human activity, not divine intervention. He thus treats religion as a sui generis social fact and analyzes it sociologically. Durkheim elaborates his theory of religion at length in his most important work, Forms. In this book Durkheim, uses the ethnographic data that was available at the time to focus his analysis on the most primitive religion that, at the time, was known, the totemic religion of Australian aborigines. This was done for methodological purposes, since Durkheim wished to study the simplest form of religion possible, in which the essential elements of religious life would be easier to ascertain. In a certain sense, then, Durkheim is investigating the old question, albeit in a new way, of the origin of religion. It is important to note, however, that Durkheim is not searching for an absolute origin, or the radical instant where religion first came into being. Such an investigation would be impossible and prone to speculation. In this metaphysical sense of origin, religion, like every social institution, begins nowhere. Rather, as Durkheim says, he is investigating the social forces and causes that are always already present in a social milieu and that lead to the emergence of religious life and thought at different points in time, under different conditions.

Durkheim’s analysis is not without its detractors, who criticize among other things his methodology, his interpretation of ethnographic data, or his undermining of traditional religion. Nevertheless, his assertion that religion has an essentially social foundation, as well as other elements of his theory, have been reaffirmed and re-appropriated over the years by a number of different thinkers.

It is important to look at the starting point of Durkheim’s analysis, his definition of religion: “A religion is a unified system of beliefs and practices relative to sacred things, that is to say, things set apart and forbidden–beliefs and practices which unite in one single moral community called a Church, all those who adhere to them” (Durkheim; 1995: 44). There are, thus, three fundamental elements to every religion: sacred objects, a set of beliefs and practices, and the existence of a moral community. Of the three, perhaps the most important would be the notion of the sacred, which is the point around which any religious system revolves. It is that which inspires great respect and admiration on the part of society and what is set apart and keeps believers at a distance. Durkheim contrasts the sacred with the notion of profane, or that which desecrates the sacred and from which the sacred must be protected, making the opposition between sacred and profane a central element of Durkheim’s theory. With this definition Durkheim also puts an emphasis on the social element of religion. This is important because he spends a great deal of time in Forms arguing against theorists like Herbert Spencer, Edward Tylor, or James Frazer who locate the origin of religion in psychological phenomena such as dreams (the animistic view of Spencer) or natural phenomena, such as storms (the naturalistic view of the latter two). Durkheim argues that such an interpretation of phenomena is socially learned, and could only be the effect of an already established religion, not its cause. With this said, it is now time to examine how Durkheim believes a religion originates and operates.

According to Durkheim, a religion comes into being and is legitimated through moments of what he calls “collective effervescence.” Collective effervescence refers to moments in societal life when the group of individuals that makes up a society comes together in order to perform a religious ritual. During these moments, the group comes together and communicates in the same thought and participates in the same action, which serves to unify a group of individuals. When individuals come into close contact with one another and when they are assembled in such a fashion, a certain “electricity” is created and released, leading participants to a high degree of collective emotional excitement or delirium. This impersonal, extra-individual force, which is a core element of religion, transports the individuals into a new, ideal realm, lifts them up outside of themselves, and makes them feel as if they are in contact with an extraordinary energy.

The next step in the genesis of religion is the projecting of this collective energy onto an external symbol. As Durkheim argues, society can only become conscious of these forces circulating in the social world by representing them somehow. The power of religion must therefore be objectified, or somehow made visible, and the object onto which this force is projected becomes sacred. This sacred object receives the collective force and is thereby infused with the power of the community. It is in this way that a society gains a tangible idea, or representation, of itself. When discussing these matters, Durkheim is careful to use the word “sacred object” to describe what is traditionally understood in the West as a god. This is because sacred objects can be very diverse and do not necessarily refer to supernatural deities. For example, God is a sacred object for Christian societies, Thor was a sacred object for Viking society, but the four noble truths are also sacred objects for Buddhists, and, as we will see, the individual person has become a sacred object for modern, Western society. Physical objects, such as rocks, feathers, totem polls, crosses, and so forth, can also become infused with the force of the collectivity, thereby becoming sacred and serving as a physical reminder of society’s presence. Such views on religion allow Durkheim to make the radical claim that a society’s sacred object is nothing but the collective forces of the group transfigured. Religion is society worshipping itself, and through religion, individuals represent to themselves society and their relationship to it.

With this, Durkheim lays bare the inner workings of a society’s symbolic network. With Durkheim’s rejection of the thing in itself, the meaning and value of an object are not intrinsic to it, but are to be found in that object’s relationship to society. Said otherwise, an object’s status is determined by the meaning that society attributes to it, or by its status as a représentation collective. Importantly, this analysis goes beyond what is strictly considered the religious realm, since all socially derived meaning operates in the same way. For example, a stamp, a flag, or the sport of football are by themselves just a piece of paper, a piece of cloth, or a group of padded men chasing a leather ball; they all have no value in themselves and derive their value from the sui generis collective forces they represent and embody. The more important a society determines an object to be, the more a group infuses an object with prestige, the more valuable it will be in the eyes of an individual.

If these moments of collective effervescence are the origin of religious feelings, religious rituals must be repeated in order to reaffirm the collective unity of a society, otherwise its existence is at risk. Durkheim remarks that if the societal forces central to the religious life of a society are not re-animated, they will be forgotten, leaving individuals with no knowledge of the ties that exist between them and no concept of the society to which they belong. This is why religious ritual is necessary for the continued existence of a society; religion cannot exist through belief alone-it periodically needs the reality of the force behind the belief to be regenerated. This takes place through various religious rituals, in which collective beliefs are reaffirmed and the individual expresses their solidarity with the sacred object of society, or with society itself. The form the specific ritual takes can vary greatly, from funerals to rain dances to patriotic national holidays, but its goal is always the same. Through these rituals, society maintains its existence and integrates individuals into the social fold, exerting pressure on them to act and think alike. While Durkheim’s analysis is of explicitly religious contexts, it is important to note that the ritual interaction processes he describes take place in different and less formal contexts as well. Ritual processes can be considered a part of daily life and are instrumental in regulating group solidarities and interpersonal relationships in different social institutions and at different levels of formality.

Of great significance to Durkheim’s theory is his insistence on the reality of these religious phenomena. As he argues, the social forces that animate a society’s religious life are real, and are really felt by the participants. While it is a mistake for an individual to believe that this power emanates directly from the sacred object, or is somehow intrinsic to the sacred object, behind the symbol manifesting the force is a living and concrete reality. Consequently, all religions are true, at least symbolically, for they express a power that does exist, the power of society. Religion, religious belief, and the religious experience cannot, therefore, be dismissed as mere fantasies or illusions.

5. Durkheim on Morality

Durkheim’s moral philosophy was unfortunately denied its culmination by his untimely death in 1917. His writings on the subject, therefore, lack the consistency he would have liked to give them. Nevertheless, he did publish several important articles, most notably The Determination of Moral Facts (1906), and gave lectures on the subject, including the posthumously published Moral Education, from which his views on morality can be deciphered.

Durkheim’s moral theory is unique in that he rejects theorists who rely on a priori moral concepts or abstract logical reasoning to construct ethical systems. Rather, Durkheim treats moral phenomena as conditioned both socially and historically. Each society creates over time its own set of moral rules and truths, which can vary dramatically from one society to the next, with each society creating for itself moral principles that are more or less adequate to its existential needs. When analyzing moral phenomena, the moral philosopher must take into consideration the socio-historical context of the moral system they are operating in and make moral prescriptions accordingly, or risk doing great harm to that society. However, that there exists no universal or transcendent morality for humanity in no way abnegates the validity of any moral system and does not open the door to moral nihilism. On the contrary, moral rules are rooted in the sui generis reality of society that the individual cannot deny; morality is a social fact and should be studied as such. This approach to morality would form the basis of what Durkheim considers a physique des moeurs, or a physics of morality, a new, empirical, rational science of morality. Yet, what exactly does Durkheim understand morality to be? And how does it operate in a society?

While Durkheim’s understanding of morality can at times be vague and lead to several interpretations, he most often understands morality as a system of rules and maxims that prescribes to individuals’ ways of behaving in different situations. Contained within this moral system is a set of moral values, beliefs, and truths that provide a framework for the rules. Morality is also a wholly social phenomenon, with morality not existing outside of the limits of society. As Durkheim claims, morality begins only when an individual pertains to a group.

Moral rules have several unique characteristics that separate them from other rules that might be found in society. These special features lie in morality’s obligatory nature and in its desirability. According to Durkheim, at the heart of morality is a central moral authority that commands to its adherents its moral precepts. Through this central authority the individual feels an external constraint to conform to a society’s moral code. Obligation is thus a fundamental element of morality. This aspect of morality corresponds closely to the Kantian notion of duty, whose influence Durkheim openly acknowledges. However, Durkheim was critical of the Kantian notion of duty, since he felt that the repressive notion of duty was lacking a positive counterweight. For Durkheim, such a counterweight is found in the desirability of morality, which is equally important and necessary for the existence of morality. What Durkheim means with the desirability of morality is that the individual views the authority dictating to them their obligations as a higher power that is worthy of their respect and devotion. When an individual performs their duty, they feel as if they are working towards some sort of higher end, which Durkheim equates to the good (le bien). As a result, the individual willingly accepts the obligatory nature of moral rules and views them beneficially.

Within this dual movement of obligation-desire, Durkheim views to a large extent the influence of religion. According to Durkheim morality and religion are intimately linked, and goes so far as to say that the moral life and the religion of a society are intimately intertwined. Wherever one finds a religion, one will find with it an accompanying moral doctrine and moral ideals that are commanded to believers. Moral authority is, thus, born out of religious life and draws its authority from the power of religion, which, as seen in the section above, is merely society’s collective force transfigured and made visible. Religious imagery therefore takes on a moral tone and can be an important physical source of moral authority in a society. It is not surprising to Durkheim then that religious imagery inspires the same emotions of fear, obedience, and respect that an individual feels in the face of moral imperatives. In this way, moral authority is constituted by a force that is greater than the individual, outside of the individual, but also a force that penetrates the individual and shapes their personality.

Importantly, this aspect of Durkheim’s work establishes a theory of legitimate authority that is very different from Max Weber’s famous tripartite classification of legal-rational, traditional, and charismatic authority. Whereas a common critique of Weber is that his theory is overly operational and fails to account for the normative dimension of authority, the legitimation of authority for Durkheim is moral, meaning it is explicitly tied to a set of values and a notion of good and bad. This point is important also because a key part of morality according to Durkheim is the notion of sanction. Society sanctions individuals according to the moral rules and norms it establishes. Sanctions have a disciplinary effect and can be both positive, as in a reward for good behavior, and negative, as in sending a criminal to prison for breaking the law. Because moral rules are tied to a legitimate authority, individuals consider both the rules and the sanctions legitimate.

Yet, one is inclined to ask, is the individual free to critique moral rules? Can morality not be changed? Is there any space for individual autonomy in this matter? According to Durkheim, moral rules do not need to be blindly followed by individuals. If the individual finds reason to object, critique, or rebel against the moral principles of society, not only is this possible, but it is perhaps even beneficial to society. For example, it is possible that changes take place within a society that can either cause a moral principle to be forgotten, or produce a schism between a traditional moral system and new moral sentiments that have not yet been recognized by the collective conscience. When this happens, an individual is correct to show the relevance of the forgotten moral principle or to illuminate what these new moral sentiments are exactly (as an example of the latter case Durkheim points to Socrates). For these purposes, the physique des moeurs can be very helpful. Thus, an individual is able to experiment with different moral claims, but only granted that these moral claims reflect that actual moral state, or states, of society (the individual is of course free to completely reject society, but this would only confirm the existence of the moral rules being rejected and potentially cause harm to the individual). This last caveat demonstrates that even when the individual acts in an autonomous way, they are, morally speaking, still bound by the limits of society.

Finally, it is also worth mentioning here that although Durkheim does not discuss the issue at length, his analysis of morality lends itself to a theory of conflict in which competing groups maintain different concepts of good and allegiance to different moral authorities. Different authors working in the Durkheimian tradition have developed his work in precisely this direction.

6. Social Change and Modernity in the West

One of the most prominent and problematic interpretations of Durkheim’s thought is the misconception that he does not have a theory of social change. On the contrary, social change is one of Durkheim’s primary focuses. Indeed, throughout his work he explores Europe’s difficult transition from a medieval society to a modern one. Thus, Durkheim’s structural analyses of social institutions are complemented in important ways by analyses of the dynamic nature of these phenomena.

a. Causes of Social Change

Durkheim elaborates much of his theory of social change in Division, although he does return to the topic in other works such as Rules. Essentially Durkheim argues that social change is spurred above all by changes in the ways that people interact with each other, which in turn depend upon the demographic and material conditions of a society. The two main factors affecting social interaction are increases in population density and advances in technology, most notably in the fields of communication and transportation. This is because population growth and advances in technology increase social connectivity, leading to interactions that differ in quantity, intimacy, frequency, type, and content. Cities, the locus of social change, also emerge and grow as a result of changes in population and technology. The rate at which individuals come into contact and interact with one another in a meaningful way is what Durkheim calls moral or dynamic density.

The most important change to take place as a result of increased moral density occurs on a structural level and is what Durkheim calls the division of labor. At their beginning, societies are characterized by what Durkheim calls mechanical solidarity. In mechanical solidarity, groups are small, individuals in the group resemble each other, and their individual conscience is more or less synonymous with and dependent on the collective conscience. Individuals belong to the group and the individual and individuality as we understand them do not exist. As the moral density increases, this changes. Appealing to Darwin’s evolutionary theory that the more alike two organisms are the greater the combat for the resources will be, Durkheim argues that with an increase in moral density comes greater competition for fewer resources. In order to mitigate the competition and make social life harmonious, individuals in a society will specialize their tasks and pursue different means to make a living. The more a society grows in moral density, the more the labor of a society will divide and the more specialized the tasks of its individuals will become. This leads to what Durkheim calls organic solidarity, or solidarity based not upon individual resemblances, but upon the functional interdependence of society’s individual parts, much the way the organs of a body are interdependent.

It should be noted that the terms mechanical and organic solidarity are features of Durkheim’s early work only, and soon after the publication of Division he abandoned them. In his later work he continues examining how societies change as a result of an increase in dynamic density, yet he understands solidarity in more symbolic and religious terms, with periods of great ritual and collective effervescence, such as the Renaissance, the Reformation, or the French Revolution, playing an integral role in social change. Concerning the specific impacts of the increase of dynamic density and the division of labor in society, Durkheim concentrates his analysis on Europe.

b. The Division of Labor and the Emergence of Modernity in Europe

The industrialization and urbanization of Western Europe had great effects on society in a number of different ways. One of the most important effects was the rise of individualism and the importance of the individual within Western society, which took place on different levels. With the division of labor, there was a specialization of tasks, which gave the individual more freedom to develop their work. As a result, individual autonomy increased, since the rest of society was less and less capable of telling the individual how to do the work. At the same time city life was characterized by fewer and weaker intimate relationships and greater anonymity, which granted greater personal freedoms. As a result, the individual felt in a real way less acted upon by society and there were fewer and fewer collective experiences shared by all members of the group. These changes in society had the effect of individuating the population and creating differences between individuals. Christian moral doctrine, which places emphasis on individual spirituality, also had a role in shaping these changes and influencing Western individualism. The creation of the individual in these ways is perhaps the defining characteristic of modernity.

It is worth noting here Durkheim’s opposition to social contract theorists and utilitarians, like Spencer, who argue that society begins when individuals come together to form groups. In many ways his book Division is a refutation of this theory and strives to show that collective life is not born from the individual, but, rather, that the individual is born out of collective life.

The increase in dynamic density and the division of labor also had major impacts on economic, social, and political institutions. In medieval society, there were well-defined social institutions in the realms of religion, politics, and education that were each distinct from one another. The organization of the economic sector was especially important, with guilds developing into strong, independent institutions that were at the heart of social life. These institutions regulated prices and production and maintained good relations between members of the same craft. These institutions and structures of society ensured that individuals were integrated into the social fold properly, promoting social solidarity. In the 18th and 19th centuries, however, a large growth in population was coupled with a large demographic shift, which was aided by technological innovation (such as the railroad, the steamship, and various manufacturing techniques). Without the previous restrictions on mobility or production capabilities, cities grew greatly in size, production of goods centralized, and the economic and social equilibrium that existed in the medieval period was ruptured. The ever-greater mobility of goods and people extended the reach of economic, political, and social institutions. As a result the guild system disappeared and regional trading interdependence gave way to international interdependence. Large-scale institutions in politics, education, shipping, manufacturing, arts, banking and so forth that were free from regional limitations developed in cities and extended their influence to greater portions of society.

In essence, Durkheim is describing the birth of the modern industrial state. The concentration of the population and the centralization of the means of production created an enormous shift in the way of life for large parts of European society. It also changed the way that people related to one another. The way of life that corresponded to medieval society no longer corresponded to the way of life in the modern industrial world. It was impossible for new generations to live in the same ways as their predecessors and European society witnessed a weakening of all its previous traditions, particularly its religious traditions.

c. The Death of the Gods

In 1912, Durkheim wrote: “the former gods are growing old or dying, and others have not been born” (Durkheim; 1995: 429). This quote points to an incredibly important but often overlooked part of Durkheim’s work, namely his declaration of the death of the gods and what this means for the future of Western civilization. Durkheim’s declaration, however, should not be confused with Friedrich Nietzsche’s famous “death of God.” While Durkheim was familiar with some of Nietzsche’s work and favorable points of comparison between the two could be made on the subject, Durkheim does not appear to have been influenced by Nietzsche in this respect. Rather, Durkheim’s declaration of the death of the gods is closely linked to his analysis of the social disintegration of European society brought about by modernity, a subject that he comes back to throughout the entirety of his career, from Division to Forms. Yet how is one to understand this statement? What does this mean for European society?

There are two parts to Durkheim’s declaration that need to be de-compacted. On the one hand the old gods are dead. Because of the massive transformations taking place, European society became profoundly destructured. The institutions animating medieval life disappeared. As a result, individuals were having a hard time finding meaningful attachments to social groups and society as a whole lost its former unity and cohesiveness. Not only this, but the transformations that led to modernity also rendered former beliefs and practices irrelevant. The big things of the past, the political, economic, social, and especially religious institutions, no longer inspired the enthusiasm they once did. With former ways of life no longer relevant and society no longer cohesive, the collective force so vital for the life of a society was no longer generated. This would have an important impact on the religion of medieval society, Christianity. Because society no longer had the means to create the collective force that exists behind God, belief in God weakened substantially. Christian society was no longer sufficiently present to the individual for faith in God to be maintained; the individual no longer felt, literally, the presence of God in their lives. With the lack of faith in God also came a rejection of other elements of Christian doctrine, such as Christian morality and Christian metaphysics, which were beginning to be replaced respectively by modern notions of justice and modern science. In sum, the social milieu that supported Christianity disappeared, leaving Christian faith, values, and thinking without any social foundations to give them life.

That Christianity faded away in European society is not a problem in itself, for it merely reflects a natural course of development a society may take. The problem arises when taking into consideration the second element to Durkheim’s phrase: no new gods have been created to replace the old ones. For Durkheim, the changes in European society were taking place too quickly and no new institutions had been able to form in the absence of the old ones. European society had not yet been able to create a religion to replace Christianity. Instead what Durkheim saw in Europe was a society in a state of disaggregation characterized by a lack of cohesion, unity, and solidarity. Individuals in such a society have no bonds between them and interact in a way similar to molecules of water, without any central force that is able to organize them and give them shape. European society had become nothing but a pile of sand that the slightest wind would succeed at dispersing. In other words, European society was no longer a society in Durkheim’s sense of the word, and as such was open to a number of further problems.

To begin, such a society is incapable of generating social forces that act on the individual. It is unable to create an authority that exerts pressure on individuals to act and think in a similar manner. Without these forces acting on the individual from the outside, individuals are dispersed from their commitment to society and left to their own. Duties are no longer accepted carte blanche and moral rules no longer seem binding. As such, individuals increasingly are detached from group obligation and act out of self-interest. These are the two conditions that Durkheim believes characterize the moral situation of modern European society: rampant individualism and weak morality. Durkheim’s term for this “froid moral” in which morality breaks down is anomie, a state of deregulation, in which the traditional rules have lost their authority.

A second problem stemming from the fact that society is no longer present to individuals is a higher suicide rate, specifically with two types of suicide that Durkheim identifies in Suicide. The first is egoistic suicide, in which an individual no longer see a purpose to life and sees life as meaningless. These feelings arise because the bonds integrating the individual to society have weakened or been broken. This problem involves society because society is an important source of meaning and direction for individuals, giving them goals to pursue and norms to guide them. The second type of suicide is anomic suicide, which involves what Durkheim calls a “mal d’infini.” Normally society, with the help of its moral code, plays an important part in defining what are legitimate aspirations in life, as concerns wealth, material goods, or any other type of pleasure. Without limits set on these desires, the passions are unregulated, and the individual’s expectations do not correspond with reality. Consequently the individual is perpetually unhappy. Both types of suicide result from a weakness of social solidarity and an inability for society to adequately integrate its individuals.

A final consequence is that society has no central measure for truth and no authoritative way of organizing or understanding the world. In such a state, there arises the potential for conflict between individuals or groups who have different ways of understanding the world. Such a conflict could be seen in the 19th and early 20th centuries between Christian religious doctrine and modern science, a conflict that Durkheim’s own sociology took part in and one that continues today.

Essentially, Durkheim’s analysis of the death of the gods concentrates on the underlying disorganization of European society that led to the demise not only of Christianity, but of a number of other economic, political, and social institutions as well. This same underlying disorganization was preventing European society from generating the collective force necessary for the creation of new institutions and a new sacred object. The death of the gods is a symptom of a sickened society, one that has lost its internal structure and descended into an-archy, or a society with no authority and no definitive principles, moral or otherwise, to build itself on. In spite of such a glum analysis, Durkheim did have hope for the future. Out of the chaos he saw the emergence of a new religion that would guide the West, what he termed “the cult of the individual.”

d. The Cult of the Individual: Durkheim and Politics

According to the later Durkheim, religion is part of the human condition and as long as humans are grouped in collective life they will inevitably form a religion of some sort. Europe could thus be characterized as in a state of transition; out of the ashes of Christianity, a new religion would eventually emerge. This new religion would form around the sacred object of the human person as it is represented in the individual, the only element common to all in a society that is becoming more and more diverse and individualized. Appropriately, Durkheim calls this new religion the ‘cult of the individual.’ But how does this religion begin? What is its conception of individual? And what kind of society/religion does the cult of the individual create?

The cult of the individual begins, like all religions according to Durkheim, with collective effervescence, the first moments of which can be found in the democratic revolutions taking place in Europe and elsewhere at the end of the 18th and during the 19th centuries. Durkheim identifies the French Revolution as an example of such a release of collective energy. The concept of individual that these democratic revolutions were embracing follows strongly the line of thinking established during the Enlightenment; it is based on a general idea of human dignity and does not lead to a narcissistic, egotistical worship of the self. As Durkheim argues, the individualism of the cult of the individual is that of Kant and Rousseau; it is what the Déclaration des droits de l’homme et du citoyen (Declaration of the Rights of Man and of the Citizen), the document produced by revolutionaries during the French Revolution, attempted to codify more or less successfully. The cult of the individual thus presupposes an autonomous individual endowed with rationality, born both free and equal to all other individuals in these respects. Belief in this abstract conception of individual creates the ideal around which the cult revolves, and influences both the society’s morality and its notion of truth.

With this sacred object at its core, the cult of the individual also contains moral ideals to pursue. These moral ideals that define society include the ideals of equality, freedom, and justice. The specific moral code that translates these ideals is built around the inalienable rights of the individual; any disenfranchisement of an individual’s human rights or any violation of an individual’s human dignity is considered sacrilege and is a moral offence of the highest order. With society becoming more diverse, the respect, tolerance, and promotion of individual differences become important social virtues. It is by protecting the rights of the individual in this way, somewhat paradoxically, that society is best preserved. Modern democracy, which encodes, institutionalizes, and protects the rights of the individual, is the form of government whereby Western societies best express their collective belief in the dignity of the individual.

Rationality is also of primary importance to this religion. The cult of the individual has as a first dogma the autonomy of reason and as a first right free inquiry. Authority can and must be rationally grounded in order for the critically rational individual to have respect for social institutions. In line with the importance of rationality, modern science provides the cosmology for the cult of the individual. Scientific truths have come to be accepted by society as a whole and Durkheim even says that modern society has faith in science in a way similar to how past societies had faith in Christianity cosmology; despite that most individuals do not participate in or fully understand the scientific experiments taking place, the general population trusts scientific findings and accepts them as true. Modern science has an advantage, however, in that, unlike other religious cosmologies, it avoids dogmatizing about reality and permits individuals to challenge scientific theories through rational inquiry, fitting with the doctrine of the cult of the individual perfectly.

However, with the large growth in population and the individualization of society, it becomes very easy for society to lose hold of individuals or for the state to become out of touch with the population it serves. What is more, if society becomes too atomized the state risks becoming domineering. As a way of preventing the creation of a wholly individualistic society, Durkheim advocates the existence of intermediary groups, such as religious institutions, labor unions, families, regional groupings, and different types of other civil society groups. These groups would serve a double purpose. On the one hand they would be intimate enough to provide sufficient social bonds for the individual, which would serve to integrate the individual into the society and develop their moral conscience. On the other hand, they would represent the demands of individuals to the government and check state power, thereby ensuring that the state does not become domineering. At the same time, Durkheim understands that these secondary groups run the risk of dominating the individual and cutting them off from the wider society. In such a situation society would risk fragmenting into distinct groupings, leading to social conflict. Hence, Durkheim also recognizes the need for the state to exercise its authority over secondary groups as a way of liberating the individual and having them participate in the higher society and moral order that the state represents. Ultimately this dialectic between the state and the secondary group ensures the proper functioning of a democratic society, namely by ensuring that individuals are properly socialized and that neither the state nor the secondary groups become repressive towards the individual.

The way in which each country implements the cult of the individual ultimately depends on that country’s history and culture, indicating that different varieties of the cult of the individual are possible. Through this new religion of the cult of the individual, to which he gave his full support, Durkheim predicted that European society would once again find the unity and cohesion it was lacking; once again it would have a sacred object. The extent to which Durkheim’s predictions have come true can be debated, although several developments since his death point to the validity of his thought. For example, in 1948 the United Nations passed the Universal Declaration of Human Rights. This document could be regarded as one of the central holy texts of the cult of the individual, helping frame contemporary international moral discourse. What is more, Durkheim’s discussion of the cult of the individual pre-dates those that arose in the 1980s with regards to communitarianism and liberalism. In particular, there are strong parallels between the rationally grounded society Durkheim describes, which unites different secondary groups around individual democratic rights, values, and procedures, and John Rawls’ notion of political liberalism or Jürgen Habermas’ notion of constitutional patriotism. In these ways, Durkheim’s work makes important and enduring contributions to political theory and political sociology.

7. The Individual and Society

Durkheim is one of the first thinkers in the Western tradition, along with other 19th century thinkers such as Friedrich Nietzsche, Charles Peirce, and Karl Marx, to reject the Cartesian model of the self, which stipulates a transcendental, purely rational ego existing wholly independent of outside influence. In opposition to the Cartesian model, Durkheim views the self as integrated in a web of social, and thus historical, relations that greatly influence their actions, interpretations of the world, and even their abilities for logical thought. What is more, social forces can be assimilated by the individual to the point where they operate on an automatic, instinctual level, in which the individual is unaware of the effect society has on their tastes, moral inclinations, or even their perception of reality. Social forces thus comprise an unconscious “substructure” of the mind, in which they have to varying degrees been incorporated by the individual. In consequence, if an individual wants to know themselves, they must understand the society of which they are a part, and how this society has a direct impact on their existence. In fact, in a complete reversal of Descartes, Durkheim, following the sociological method, advocates that in order to understand one’s self, the individual must avoid introspection and look outside of themselves, at the social forces that determine their personality. In these ways, Durkheim anticipated by at least fifty years the post-modern deconstruction of the self as a socio-historically determined entity.

Partly because of this conception of the individual, and partly because of his methodology and theoretical stances, Durkheim has been routinely criticized on several points. Critics argue that he is a deterministic thinker and that his view of society is so constraining towards the individual that it erases any possibility for individual autonomy and freedom. Others argue that his sociology is too holistic and that it leaves no place for the individual or for subjective interpretations of social phenomena. Critics have gone so far as to accuse Durkheim of being anti-individual due in part to his consistent claims that the individual is derived from society.

Such critics, however, misconstrue a number of elements of Durkheim’s thought. To begin, one should recall that social facts, while sui generis products of society, exist only as far as individuals incorporate them. On this point Durkheim makes clear on several occasions that individuals incorporate and appropriate elements of society, such as religious beliefs, morality, or language, in their own manner. While it is true that représentations collectives, for example, are the work of the collectivity and express collective thought through the individual, when the individual assimilates them they are refracted and colored by the individual’s personal experiences, thereby differentiating them. Thus, each individual expresses society in their own way. It should also be remembered that social facts are the result of a fusion of individual minds. As such there is a delicate interplay between the individual and society whereby the individual not only maintains their individuality, but is also able to enrich the field of social forces by contributing to it their own personal thoughts and feelings.

In another sense, critics claiming that Durkheim is anti-individual overlook his analysis of modern society. As discussed above, according to Durkheim’s theory of the division of labor, as societies develop, they cultivate differences between individuals by necessity. This grants individuals an increasing amount of freedom to develop their personality. At least in Western society, the development of and respect for individualism has grown to such an extent that it has become the object of a cult; the individual is a sacred object and the protection of individual liberties and human dignity has been codified into moral principles. Granted that this individualism is itself a product of collective life, modern society, if anything, encourages individual autonomy, diversity, and freedom of thought as shared social norms.

As a whole, there is no antagonism between the individual and society in Durkheim’s sociology. In fact, Durkheim argues that to adhere to a group is the only thing that makes an individual human, since everything that we attribute as being special to humanity (language, the ability for rational thought, the ability for moral action, and so forth) is a product of social life. Far from being anti-individual, Durkheim never lost sight of the individual, and the relation of the individual to society is a guiding question throughout his work. Rather than showing that individuals are wholly subservient to society for all aspects of their existence, Durkheim’s analyses demonstrate that in order to understand the individual, it is necessary to situate them within the network of social relations that informs and influences their life. This is exactly what Durkheim’s sociology does, and its strength lies precisely in its illumination and deconstruction of those elements of society that have the greatest bearing on and realize themselves through the individual.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in French

  • “La Science positive de la morale en Allemagne.” Revue philosophique 24: 33-58, 113-42, 275-84, 1887.
    • Review of ideas of German moralists Wagner, Schmoller, Schaeffle, Ihering, Wundt, and Post.
  • De la division du travail social: étude sur l’organisation des sociétés supérieures. Paris: Alcan, 1893.
  • Les Règles de la méthode sociologique. Paris: Alcan, 1895.
  • Le Suicide, Paris: Alcan, 1897.
  • “L’Individualism et les intellectuels.” Revue bleue, 4e série 10: 7-13, 1898.
    • In many ways, Durkheim’s most definitive statement on the cult of the individual.
  • Les formes élémentaires de la vie religieuse. 5ème edition, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 2005 (1912).
  • “Le Dualisme de la nature humaine et ses conditions sociales.” Scientia 15: 206-21, 1914.
    • An article examining Durkheim’s thoughts on the social/religious origin of the mind-body split and its implications for human civilization.
  • L’Allemagne au-dessus de tout: la mentalité allemande et la guerre. Paris: Colin, 1915.
    • Propaganda pamphlet examining German nationalism during WWI.
  • Sociologie et philosophie. Préface de Célestin Bouglé. Paris: Alcan, 1924.
    • Contains three important articles: “Représentations individuelles et représentations collectives” (1898), “La Détermination du fait moral” (1906), and “Jugements de valeur et jugements de réalité” (1911).
  • L’Éducation morale. Présentation de Paul Fauconnet. Paris: Alcan, 1925.
    • A lecture course Durkheim regularly gave on the subject of morality and how it could be instilled in individuals through various disciplinary mechanisms.
  • Le Socialisme. éd. avec introduction de M. Mauss, Paris: Alcan, 1928.
    • A text examining the history of socialist ideas and the socialist movement, including Karl Marx and St. Simon.
  • Leçons de sociologie: physique des moeurs et du droit. Istanbul: L’Université d’Istanbul. “Publications de l’Université Faculté de Droit,” no. 3; et Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1950.
    • A key text for understanding Durkheim’s political thought concerning the role of the state in civil society.
  • Pragmatisme et sociologie. Paris: Vrin, 1955.
    • A lecture course given by Durkheim examining and critiquing Pragmatist views on truth and defending his sociological explanation of truth.

b. Selection of Durkheim’s Works in English

  • The Division of Labor in Society. Translated by W.D. Halls. New York: The Free Press, 1984.
  • The Rules of Sociological Method and Selected Texts on Sociology and Its Method. Translated by W. D. Halls, Steven Lukes, ed. New York: The Free Press, 1982.
  • Suicide: A Study in Sociology. Translated by John A. Spaulding and George Simpson. Glencoe, Illinois: The Free Press of Glencoe, 1951.
  • The Elementary Forms of the Religious Life. Translated by Karen Fields. New York: Free Press, 1995.
  • “Germany Above All”: German Mentality and the War. Paris: Colin, 1915.
    • Propaganda pamphlet examining German nationalism during WWI.
  • Sociology and Philosophy. Translated by D. F. Pocock. London: Cohen and West, 1953.
    • Contains three important articles: “Individual and Collective Representations” (1898), “The Determination of Moral Facts” (1906), and “Value Judgments and Judgments of Reality” (1911).
  • Professional Ethics and Civic Morals. Translated by Cornelia Brookfield. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1957.
    • Translation of Leçons de sociologie. A key text for understanding Durkheim’s political thought concerning the role of the state in civil society.
  • Socialism and Saint-Simon. Translated by C. Sattler. Yellow Springs, Ohio: Antioch Press, 1958.
    • A text examining the history of socialist ideas and the socialist movement, including Karl Marx and St. Simon.
  • “The Dualism of Human Nature and Its Social Conditions.” in Émile Durkheim, 1858-1917: A Collection of Essays, with Translations and a Bibliography, edited by Kurt Wolff. Translated by Charles Blend. Columbus, Ohio: Ohio State University Press, 1960.
    • An article examining Durkheim’s thoughts on the social/religious origin of the mind-body split and its implications for human civilization.
  • Moral Education: A Study in the Theory and Application of the Sociology of Education. Translated by Everett K. Wilson and Herman Schnurer. New York: Free Press of Glencoe, 1961.
    • A lecture course Durkheim regularly gave on the subject of morality and how it could be instilled in individuals through various disciplinary mechanisms.
  • “Individualism and the Intellectuals.” in Émile Durkheim on Morality and Society, edited by Robert Bellah. Translated by Mark Traugott. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1973.
    • In many ways, Durkheim’s most definitive statement on the cult of the individual.
  • Pragmatism and Sociology. Translated by J.C. Whitehouse. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
    • A lecture course given by Durkheim examining and critiquing Pragmatist views on truth and defending his sociological explanation of truth.

c. Secondary Sources

  • Alexander, Jeffrey. Theoretical Logic in Sociology Vol. 2, The Antinomies of Classical Thought: Marx and Durkheim. Berkley: University of California Press, 1982.
    • Contains an analysis and synopsis of Durkheim’s thought as it developed over his life.
  • Alexander, Jeffrey. ed. Durkheimian Sociology: Cultural Studies. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
    • Collection of essays examining Durkheim’s late work and its relevance to cultural sociology.
  • Alexander, Jeffrey and Philip Smith. eds. The Cambridge Companion to Durkheim. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • Contains a collection of essays analyzing Durkheim’s life and work.
  • Allen, N.J., W.S.F. Pickering, and W. Watts Miller. eds. On Durkheim’s Elementary Forms of Religion Life. London: Routledge, 1998.
    • Collection of essays on Durkheim’s most important work on religion and logical thought.
  • Aron, Raymond. Les étapes de la pensée sociologique. Paris: Gallimard, 1976.
    • A critical look at the founders of sociological thought, including Montesquieu, Comte, Marx, Tocqueville, Durkheim, Pareto and Weber.
  • Bellah, Robert. “Introduction.” in Emile Durkheim on Morality and Society. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1973.
    • Excellent introduction to Durkheim’s thought with a collection of important texts.
  • Besnard, Phillippe. ed. The Sociological Domain: The Durkheimians and the Founding of French Sociology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1983.
    • A collection of essays that examines the foundation of the Durkheimian school of sociology in France at the beginning of the 20th century.
  • Bourdieu, Pierre and Jean-Claude Passeron. “Sociologie et philosophie en France depuis 1945: mort et resurrection de la philosophie sans sujet.” trans. “Sociology and Philosophy in France since 1945: Death and Resurrection of a Philosophy without Subject,” in Social Research, vol. 34, no. 1, 1967, p. 162-212.
    • A long essay examining the reception, or rather the rejection and ignorance, of Durkheim’s oeuvre in the post WWII period in France.
  • Cladis, Mark. A Communitarian Defense of Liberalism: Emile Durkheim and Contemporary Social Theory. Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1992.
    • Reappraisal of Durkheim’s social and political thought in dialogue with contemporary philosophical debates.
  • Collins, Randall. Interaction Ritual Chains. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2004.
    • An important development and expansion of Durkheim’s work on ritual, involving insight from the microsociology of Erving Goffman. This book shows how Durkheim’s work can be applied in microsociology and conflict sociology.
  • Cotterrell, Roger. Émile Durkheim: Law in a Moral Domain. Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1999.
    • A detailed look at Durkheim’s theories of law and how they intersect with morality.
  • Fournier, Marcel. Emile Durkheim 1858-1917. Paris: Fayard, 2007.
    • The definitive French language study of Durkheim’s life and work.
  • Gane, Mike. On Durkheim’s Rules of Sociological Method. New York: Routledge, 1988.
    • A thorough discussion of Durkheim’s sociological method.
  • Jones, Robert Allen. Emile Durkheim: An introduction to four major works. Beverly Hills CA: Sage Publications, 1986.
    • An introduction to Durkheim’s four most important works.
  • Jones, Robert Allen. The Development of Durkheim’s Social Realism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
    • An exploration of the early influences of Durkheim’s that which led to his social realism.
  • Karsenti, Bruno. La société en personnes. Études durkheimiennes, Economica, 2006.
    • Examines the legacy of Durkheim’s sociology for both philosophy and sociology. Guide to understanding Durkheim’s thought.
  • Lehmann, Jennifer. Deconstructing Durkheim: A Post-Post Structuralist Critique. New York: Routledge, 1993.
    • A reappraisal of Durkheim’s work from a philosophical perspective.
  • Lukes, Steven. Émile Durkheim: His life and work. Middlesex: Penguin Books, 1973.
    • The definitive English language study of Durkheim’s life and work.
  • Lukes, Steven. “Introduction.” in The Rules of Sociological Method and Selected Texts on Sociology and Its Method, by Émile Durkheim, translated by W. D. Halls, edited and with a new introduction by Steven Lukes. New York: The Free Press, 2014.
    • Contains an important introductory essay analyzing Durkheim’s methodology. Is a positive reassessment of Durkheim’s sociological method.
  • Nielsen, Donald. Three Faces of God: Society, Religion, and the Categories of Totality in the Philosophy of Emile Durkheim. Albany: SUNY Press, 1998.
    • Examination of Durkheim’s sociology in a philosophical context, comparing it to Spinoza, Kant, Aristotle, Bacon, and Renouvier.
  • Paoletti, Giovanni. Durkheim et la philosophie: Représentation, réalité et lien social. Paris: Classiques Garnier, 2012.
    • A detailed discussion of various aspects of Durkheim’s work, including his analysis of morality, epistemology, and the self, as it relates to philosophical discussions.
  • Pickering, William S. F. Durkheim’s Sociology of Religion. London: Routledge, 1984.
    • In-depth study of Durkheim’s theory of religion.
  • Pickering, William S. F. ed. Durkheim and Representations. London: Routledge, 2000.
    • On Durkheim’s theory of knowledge and representation and its relationship to Kant and Renouvier.
  • Rawls, Anne Warfield. Epistemology and Practice: Durkheim’s Elementary Forms of Religious Life. Cambridge UK: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
    • An analysis of Durkheim’s sociology of knowledge as elaborated in Forms.
  • Rosati, Massimo. Ritual and the Sacred: A Neo-Durkheimian Analysis of Politics, Religion and the Self. London: Routledge, 2009.
    • An analysis of contemporary politics and society from a Durkheimian perspective. Contains discussion on how Durkheim relates to contemporary political theory.
  • Schmaus, Warren. Durkheim’s Philosophy of Science and the Sociology of Knowledge: Creating an Intellectual Niche. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1994.
    • A look at Durkheim’s sociology of knowledge.
  • Schmaus, Warren. Rethinking Durkheim and his Tradition. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007.
    • An important reassessment of the work of Emile Durkheim within the context of the 19th century French philosophical tradition, looking specifically at the French tradition’s reading of Kant’s categories and its influence on Durkheim.
  • Smith, Philip. Durkheim and After: The Durkheimian Tradition 1893-2020. Cambridge UK: Polity Press, 2020.
    • A thorough investigation of the Durkheimian tradition and legacy, analyzing Durkheim’s work and seeing how Durkheim has been received across the social sciences and philosophy up to the present day.
  • Stedman-Jones, Susan. Durkheim Reconsidered. Cambridge: Polity Press, 2001.
    • Important volume that re-examines Durkheim’s status in the philosophical world and clears up a number of misconceptions about his thought.
  • Tiryakian, Edward. Sociologism and Existentialism. Englewood Cliffs NJ: Prentice Hall, 1962.
    • Original and ground-breaking comparison between Durkheim’s sociology and the thought of existential thinkers such as Kierkegaard, Sartre, Nietzsche, Heidegger, Jaspers, and more. The main point of comparison between the two schools of thought is the relationship of the individual to society.
  • Tiryakian, Edward. For Durkheim (Rethinking Classical Sociology). Farnham, England: Ashgate, 2009.
    • Collection of essays by Edward Tiryakian indicating the relevance of Durkheim’s thought to today’s modern world.
  • Thompson, Kenneth. Emile Durkheim. London: Routledge, 1982.
    • Excellent introduction to Durkheim’s work.
  • Turner, Stephen. ed. Emile Durkheim: Sociologist and Moralist. New York: Rutledge, 1993.
    • A collection of essays from top Durkheim scholars examining different elements of his social theory in connection with his moral theory.
  • Valade, Bernard. ed. Durkheim. L’Institution de la Sociologie. Paris, Presses Universitaires de France, 2008.
    • Collection of essays discussing and re-examining the project and institution of Durkheim’s sociology.
  • Watts-Miller, W. Durkheim, Morals, and Modernity. London: Routledge, 1996.
    • Examination of Durkheim’s moral theory and its application to modern society.

 

Author Information

Paul Carls
Email: paul.carls@umontreal.ca
University of Montreal
Canada

Moral Relativism

Moral relativism is the view that moral judgments are true or false only relative to some particular standpoint (for instance, that of a culture or a historical period) and that no standpoint is uniquely privileged over all others.  It has often been associated with other claims about morality: notably, the thesis that different cultures often exhibit radically different moral values; the denial that there are universal moral values shared by every human society; and the insistence that we should refrain from passing moral judgments on beliefs and practices characteristic of cultures other than our own.

Relativistic views of morality first found expression in 5th century B.C.E. Greece, but they remained largely dormant until the 19th and 20th centuries.  During this time, a  number of factors converged to make moral relativism appear plausible.  These included a new appreciation of cultural diversity prompted by anthropological discoveries; the declining importance of religion in modernized societies; an increasingly critical attitude toward colonialism and its assumption of moral superiority over the colonized societies; and growing skepticism toward any form of moral objectivism, given the difficulty of proving value judgments the way one proves factual claims.

For some, moral relativism, which relativizes the truth of moral claims, follows logically from a broader cognitive relativism that relativizes truth in general.  Many moral relativists, however, take the fact-value distinction to be fundamental.  A common, albeit negative, reason for embracing moral relativism is simply the perceived untenability of moral objectivism: every attempt to establish a single, objectively valid and universally binding set of moral principles runs up against formidable objections.  A more positive argument sometimes advanced in defense of moral relativism is that it promotes tolerance since it encourages us to understand other cultures on their own terms.

Critics claim that relativists typically exaggerate the degree of diversity among cultures since superficial differences often mask underlying shared agreements.  In fact, some say that  there is a core set of universal values that any human culture must endorse if it is to flourish.  Moral relativists are also accused of inconsistently claiming that there are no universal moral norms while appealing to a principle of tolerance as a universal norm.  In the eyes of many critics, though, the most serious objection to moral relativism is that it implies the pernicious consequence that “anything goes”: slavery is just according to the norms of a slave society; sexist practices are right according to the values of a sexist culture. Without some sort of non-relative standard to appeal to, the critics argue, we have no basis for critical moral appraisals of our own culture’s conventions, or for judging one society to be better than another.  Naturally, most moral relativists typically reject the assumption that such judgments require a non-relativistic foundation.

Table of Contents

  1. Historical Background
    1. Ancient Greece
    2. Modern Times
  2. Clarifying What Moral Relativism Is (and Is Not)
    1. Descriptive Relativism
    2. Cultural Relativism
    3. Ethical Non-Realism
    4. Ethical Non-Cognitivism
    5. Meta-Ethical Relativism
    6. Normative Relativism
    7. Moral Relativism
  3. Arguments for Moral Relativism
    1. The Argument from Cultural Diversity
    2. The Untenability of Moral Objectivism
    3. The Argument from Cognitive Relativism
    4. Moral Relativism Promotes Tolerance
  4. Objections to Moral Relativism
    1. Relativists Exaggerate Cultural Diversity
    2. Relativism Ignores Diversity Within a Culture
    3. Relativism Implies that Obvious Moral Wrongs are Acceptable
    4. Relativism Undermines the Possibility of a Society Being Self-Critical
    5. Relativism is Pragmatically Self-Refuting
    6. Relativism Rests on an Incoherent Notion of Truth
    7. The Relativist Position on Tolerance is Problematic
  5. Conclusion
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Historical Background

a. Ancient Greece

In the view of most people throughout history, moral questions have objectively correct answers.  There are obvious moral truths just as there are obvious facts about the world.  Cowardice is a bad quality.  A man should not have sex with his mother.  Heroes deserve respect.  Such statements would be viewed as obviously and objectively true, no more open to dispute than the claim that seawater is salty.

This assumption was first challenged in fifth century B.C.E. Greece. The idea was that moral beliefs and practices are bound up with customs and conventions, and these vary greatly between societies.  The historian Herodotus tells the story of how the Persian king Darius asked some Greeks at his court if there was any price for which they would be willing to eat their dead father’s bodies the way the Callatiae did.  The Greeks said nothing could induce them to do this.  Darius then asked some Callatiae who were present if they would ever consider burning their fathers’ bodies, as was the custom among Greeks.  The Callatiae were horrified at the suggestion.  Herodotus sees this story as vindicating the poet Pindar’s dictum that “custom is lord of all”; people’s beliefs and practices are shaped by custom, and they typically assume that their own ways are the best.

Herodotus’ anecdote is not an isolated moment of reflection on cultural diversity and the conventional basis for morality.  The sophists—notably Protagoras, Gorgias, and some of their followers—were also associated with relativistic thinking.  As itinerant intellectuals and teachers, the sophists were cosmopolitan, impressed by and prompted to reflect upon the diversity in religions, political systems, laws, manners, and tastes they encountered in different societies.  Protagoras, who famously asserted that “man is the measure of all things,” seems to have embraced a wholesale relativism that extended to truth of any kind, but this view was uncommon.  More popular and influential was the contrast that many drew between nomos (law, custom) and physis (nature, natural order).  In Plato’sGorgias, for instance, Callicles, a student of Gorgias, argues that human laws and conventional notions about justice are at odds with what is right according to nature (which is that the strong should dominate the weak).  This view is not truly relativism, since it asserts a certain conception of justice as objectively correct, but Callicles’ stress on the merely conventional status of ordinary morality points the way towards relativism.

More radical is the position advanced by the sophist Thrasymachus in Book One of Plato’s Republic when he claims that “justice is nothing but the advantage of the stronger.” According to one interpretation, Thrasymachus is arguing that nothing is objectively right or wrong; moral language is simply a tool used by the powerful to justify the moral and legal systems that serve their interests. This view echoes the one expressed by the Athenians in Thucydides’ “Melian Dialogue” when they dismiss the Melian’s complaint that Athenian policy toward them is unjust.  So, relativistic thinking seems to have been in the air at the time.  Strictly speaking, it is a form of moral nihilism rather than moral relativism, but in rejecting the whole idea of objective moral truth it clears the ground for relativism.

Even though moral relativism makes its first appearance in ancient times, it hardly flourished.  Plato vigorously defended the idea of an objective moral order linked to a transcendent reality while Aristotle sought to ground morality on objective facts about human nature and well-being.  A few centuries later, Sextus Empiricus appears to have embraced a form of moral relativism, partly on the basis of the diversity of laws and conventions, and partly as a consequence of his Pyrrhonian skepticism that sought to eschew dogmatism. In his Outlines of Pyrrhonism, Sextus catalogues the tremendous diversity to be found between cultures in the laws and customs relating to such things as dress, diet, treatment of the dead, and sexual relations, and concludes: “seeing so great a diversity of practices, the skeptic suspends judgment as to the natural existence of anything good or bad, or generally to be done” (Sextus, Outlines of Pyrrhonism, 1, 14).  But Hellenistic skepticism gave way to philosophy informed by Christianity, and moral relativism effectively became dormant and remained so throughout the period of Christian hegemony in Europe. According to the monotheistic religions, God’s will represents an objective moral touchstone.  Scriptural precepts such as “Thou shalt not kill” constitute absolute, universally binding, moral truths.  Relativism thus ceased to be an option until the advent of modernity.

b. Modern Times

 

Many scholars see the first reappearance of a relativistic outlook in the writings of Montaigne, which, not coincidentally, came on the heels of the publication of Sextus’ writings in the 1560s.  In “On Custom,” Montaigne compiles his own list of radically diverse mores to be found in different societies, and asserts that “the laws of conscience which we say are born of Nature are born of custom.” (Montaigne, p. 83).  In his famous essay “On Cannibals,” written around 1578, Montaigne describes the lives of so-called barbarians in the new world, noting their bravery in battle, the natural simplicity of their morals, and their uncomplicated social structure.  “All this is not too bad,” he says, “but what’s the use?  They don’t wear breeches.”  The thrust of the essay is thus to criticize the ethnocentrism of the “civilized” Europeans who naively think themselves morally superior to such people.  Furthermore, Montaigne advances as a general thesis that “each man calls barbarism whatever is not his own practice; for indeed it seems we have no other test of truth and reason than the example and pattern of the opinions and customs of the country we live in” (Montaigne, p. 152).

In the centuries following, further trends in modern philosophy helped prepare the way for moral relativism by chipping away at people’s faith in the objectivity of ethics.  In the 17th century, Hobbes argued for a social contract view of morality that sees moral rules, like laws, as something human beings agree upon in order to make social living possible. An implication of this view is that moral tenets are not right or wrong according to whether they correspond to some transcendent blueprint; rather, they should be appraised pragmatically according to how well they serve their purpose.

Hume, like Montaigne, was heavily influenced by ancient skepticism, and this colors his view of morality.  His argument, that prescriptions saying how we should act cannot be logically derived from factual claims about the way things are, raised doubts about the possibility of proving the correctness of any particular moral point of view.  So, too, did his insistence that morality is based ultimately on feelings rather than on reason. Hume was not a relativist, but his arguments helped support elements of relativism.  With the remarkable progress of science in the 19th and 20th centuries, the fact-value distinction became entrenched in mainstream philosophy and social science.  Science came to be seen as offering value-neutral descriptions of an independently existing reality; moral claims, by contrast, came to be viewed by many as mere expressions of emotional attitudes.  This view of morality suggests that all moral outlooks are on the same logical plane, with none capable of being proved correct or superior to all the rest.

There are relativistic tendencies in Marx’s critique of bourgeois morality as an ideology expressing certain class interests.  According to one interpretation, Marx holds that there is no objectively true moral system, only interest-serving ideologies that use moral language.  But Marx wrote little about ethics, so it is hard to pin down his philosophical views about the nature of morality and the status of moral claims.

Nietzsche, on the other hand, wrote extensively and influentially about morality.  Scholars disagree about whether he should be classified as a relativist, but his thought certainly has a pronounced relativistic thrust.  His famous pronouncement that “God is dead” implies, among other things, that the idea of a transcendent or objective justification for moral claims—whether it be God, Platonic Forms, or Reason—is no longer credible.  And he explicitly embraces a form of perspectivism according to which “there are no moral phenomena, only moral interpretations of phenomena” (Beyond Good and Evil, 108).   It is true that Nietzsche likes to rank moralities according to whether they are expressions of strength or weakness, health or sickness; but he does not insist that the criteria of rank he favors constitute an objectively privileged vantage point from which different moralities can be appraised.

These philosophical ideas prepared the ground for moral relativism mainly by raising doubts about the possibility of demonstrating that any particular moral code is objectively correct.  But anthropological research in the 19th and 20th centuries also encouraged relativism.  Indeed, many of its leading contemporary champions from Franz Boas to Clifford Gertz have been anthropologists.

One of the first to argue at length for moral relativism was William Sumner. In his major work, Folkways, published in 1906, Sumner argues that notions about what is right and wrong are bound up with a society’s mores and are shaped by its customs, practices, and institutions.  To those living within that society, the concept of moral rightness can only mean conformity to the local mores.  Sumner acknowledges that if members of a culture generalize its mores into abstract principles, they will probably regard these as correct in an absolute sense. This may even be psychologically unavoidable.  But it is not philosophically legitimate; the mores themselves cannot be an object of moral appraisal since there is no higher tribunal to which appeals can be made.

The work of Franz Boas was also tremendously influential.  Boas viewed cultural relativism—a commitment to understanding a society in its own terms—as methodologically essential to scientific anthropology.  From an objective, scientific standpoint one may not pass moral judgment on the beliefs and practices that inhere within a culture, although one may objectively assess the extent to which they help that society achieve its overarching goals.  Many of Boas’ students helped disseminate this approach, and some, such as Melville Herskovits and Ruth Benedict, made more explicit its implications with respect to ethics, arguing that a relativistic outlook can help combat prejudice and promote tolerance.

The debate over moral relativism in modern times has thus not been an abstract discussion of interest only to professional philosophers.  It is thought to have implications for the social sciences, for international relations, and for relations between communities within a society.  In 1947, the American Anthropological Association submitted a statement to the UN Commission on Human Rights criticizing what some viewed as an attempt by the West to impose its particular values on other societies in the name of universal rights.  The statement declared that:

Standards and values are relative to the culture from which they derive so that any attempt to formulate postulates that grow out of the beliefs or moral codes of one culture must to that extent detract from the applicability of any Declaration of Human Rights to mankind as a whole (American Anthropologist, Vol. 49, No. 4, p. 542).

It went on to assert that “man is free only when he lives as his society defines freedom” (ibid. p. 543).  Needless to say, the statement caused some controversy since many members of the AAA did not agree with the position it laid out.

More recently, discussions of relativism have been at the center of debates about how societies with large immigrant populations should deal with the problem of multiculturalism.  To what extent should the practices of minorities be accepted, even if they seem to conflict with the values of the majority culture? In France, a law was passed in 2011 banning face veils that some Muslim women view as required by Islam.  Those supporting the ban appeal to values they consider universal such as sexual equality and freedom of expression (which the face veil is said to violate since it inhibits expressive interaction).  But critics of the policy see it as expressing a kind of cultural intolerance, just the sort of thing that relativism claims to counter.

2. Clarifying What Moral Relativism Is (and Is Not)

Defining moral relativism is difficult because different writers use the term in slightly different ways; in particular, friends and foes of relativism often diverge considerably in their characterization of it.  Therefore, it is important to first distinguish between some of the positions that have been identified or closely associated with moral relativism before setting out a definition that captures the main idea its adherents seek to put forward.

a. Descriptive Relativism

Descriptive relativism is a thesis about cultural diversity.  It holds that, as a matter of fact, moral beliefs and practices vary between cultures (and sometimes between groups within a single society).  For instance, some societies condemn homosexuality, others accept it; in some cultures a student who corrects a teacher would be thought disrespectful; elsewhere such behavior might be encouraged.

Descriptive relativism is put forward as an empirical claim based on evidence provided by anthropological research; hence it is most strongly associated with the work of anthropologists such as William Sumner, Ruth Benedict and Meville Herskovits.  There is a spectrum of possible versions of this thesis.  In its strongest, most controversial form, it denies that there are any moral universals—norms or values that every human culture endorses.  This extreme view is rarely, if ever, defended, since it seems reasonable to suppose that the affirmation of certain values—for instance, a concern for the wellbeing of the young– is necessary for any society to survive.  But Benedict seems to approach it when she writes of the three societies she describes in Patterns of Culture that “[t]hey are oriented as wholes in different directions….traveling along different roads in pursuit of different ends and these ends and these means in one society cannot be judged in terms of those of another society, because essentially they are incommensurable” (Patterns of Culture, p. 206).  In its weakest, least controversial form, descriptive relativism merely denies that all cultures share the same moral outlook.  A well-known version of this has been defended by David Wong, who describes his position as “pluralistic relativism.”

The somewhat simple form of descriptive relativism, which takes any differences between the moral beliefs or practices of two cultures as evidence of a difference in moral outlooks, has been heavily criticized both by social scientists such as Solomon Asch and by philosophers such as Michele Moody-Adams.  One objection is that it is difficult to establish the relativist’s claims about moral diversity in an evaluatively neutral way; for the empirical researcher who asserts that a particular moral belief is representative of a culture will have to grant the opinions of some members of that culture authoritative status while ignoring or glossing over internal conflicts and ongoing cultural changes. Another objection is that many apparent moral differences between cultures are not really fundamental disagreements about questions of value—that is, disagreements that would persist even if both parties were in full agreement about all the pertinent facts.   For instance, the taboo against homosexuality in some cultures may rest on the belief that homosexuality is a sin against God that will result in the sinner suffering eternal damnation.  The point of conflict between these cultures and those that tolerate homosexuality may thus be viewed as being, fundamentally, not about the intrinsic rightness or wrongness of homosexuality but the different factual beliefs they hold concerning the consequences of homosexuality.

In light of such difficulties, contemporary defenders of descriptive relativism usually prefer a fairly modest, tempered version of the doctrine.  Wong, for instance, holds that human nature and the human condition set limits to how much moral systems could diverge while still counting as true moralities; but he argues that the experience of “moral ambivalence”—which occurs when one disagrees with another person’s moral views yet recognizes that their position is reasonable—is nevertheless common and usually arises when the parties put shared values in a different order of priority.

b. Cultural Relativism

 

Cultural relativism asserts that the beliefs and practices of human beings are best understood by grasping them in relation to the cultural context in which they occur.  It was originally put forward as, and remains today, a basic methodological principle of modern anthropology.  It was championed by anthropologists like Sumner and Boas who saw it as an antidote of the unconscious ethnocentrism that may lead social scientists to misunderstand the phenomena they are observing.  For instance, ritualistic infliction of pain may look, on the surface, like a punishment aimed at deterring others from wrongdoing; but it may in fact be viewed by those involved in the practice as serving a quite different function, such as purging the community of an impurity.

Ironically, an extension of this argument in favor of the view that what appears on the surface to be similar acts can have different “situational meanings” has been used as an objection to descriptive relativism.  Thus, Gestalt psychologist Karl Duncker, argued that the action by an Eskimo of killing his aged parent, where this is socially sanctioned as a way to spare their suffering, is not the same act as the killing of a parent in a society where such an action would generally be condemned as murder.  Since the meaning of each act differs, we should not infer that the values of the two societies are necessarily in conflict.

The term cultural relativism is sometimes also used to denote the corollary methodological principle that social scientists, if they wish their work to have scientific status, should describe and analyze what goes on in the cultures they are studying, carefully eschewing any normative appraisal of what they observe.

c. Ethical Non-Realism

Ethical non-realism is the view that there is no objective moral order that makes our moral beliefs true or false and our actions right or wrong.  The term “objective” employed here is notoriously difficult to explicate; it means something like “independent of human desires, perceptions, beliefs and practices” (although the meaning of the term “independent” is equally hard to pin down).  According to an ethical realist, a sentence like “slavery is wrong” is true or false regardless of the speaker’s state of mind or the norms prevailing in his or her community.  This is the view held by most philosophers in the Western canon from Plato and Aristotle to Kant, Mill, and G. E. Moore.  It continues to be widely held, and leading contemporary defenders of ethical realism include Thomas Nagel, John McDowell, and Richard Boyd.

Ethical non-realists obviously reject ethical realism, but not all for the same reasons; consequently there are several types of ethical non-realism.  The most head-on rejection of ethical realism is perhaps the sort of moral error theory defended by J. L. Mackie.  He argues that all moral claims are, strictly speaking, false since they posit properties (for example, goodness, wrongness, fairness) that are “ontologically queer” in being quite unlike any of the properties of things that we can perceive by normal empirical means.  In the absence of any special faculty for detecting such properties, and therefore of any real evidence for their existence, we should conclude that they don’t exist; hence all statements that assert or presuppose that they exist are false.

A skeptical attitude toward moral realism can be more tentative than this.  Hume is often interpreted as a moral skeptic who denies the possibility of proving by reason or by empirical evidence the truth of moral statements since our moral views rest entirely on our feelings.  More recently, Michael Ruse, has defended an updated version of Hume, arguing that we are conditioned by evolution to hold fast to certain moral beliefs, regardless of the evidence for or against them; consequently, we should not view such beliefs as rationally justified.  And Walter Sinnott-Armstrong has shown how difficult it is to refute moral skepticism, especially the sort of non-dogmatic Pyrrhonian skepticism which holds that one may be justified within a restricted context in affirming a certain moral belief—for instance, in court it is wrong to lie as opposed to telling the truth—yet not be able to justify the claim that lying, or even perjury, is wrong in some absolute, objective sense.

Ethical non-realism is typically presupposed by moral relativists, but it is not the whole of moral relativism.  Clearly, no one who believes in the absolute authority of divine law or the intrinsic value of a rational will would be likely to embrace relativism.  But merely denying that morality has an objective foundation of this sort does not make one a relativist; for moral relativism also asserts that moral claims may be true or false relative to some particular standpoint such as that of a specific culture or historical period.

d. Ethical Non-Cognitivism

Ethical non-cognitivism is the view that moral judgments are neither true nor false since they are not “truth-apt,” meaning they are not the kind of utterances that can have a truth-value. In this respect they are like questions or commands rather than like indicative sentences such as “Grass is green.” The most common kinds of ethical non-cognitivism in the twentieth century are forms of expressivism which view moral statements as expressions of evaluative attitudes.  An especially influential version of this view, first put forward by Ogden and Richards, and later elaborated upon by A.J. Ayer and C.L. Stevenson, is emotivism. According to emotivism, moral judgments express the speaker’s feelings towards the thing being judged. So, saying “Nelson Mandela is a good man” expresses approval of Mandela; it is like saying “Hurrah for Mandela!”  Other forms of ethical non-cognitivism have built on this idea.  Prescriptivism, for instance, the view developed by R. M. Hare, acknowledges that moral statements can express emotional attitudes but sees their primary function as that of prescribing how people should behave.  Thus, “stealing is wrong” is a way of saying “Don’t steal!” More recent versions of expressivism however, such as Simon Blackburn’s “quasi-realism,” hold that while moral claims are not, strictly speaking, true or false, we are justified in treating them as if they are, both in our ethical reasoning and in our practice.

Most forms of ethical non-cognitivism, like moral relativism, have been fueled by acceptance of a fact-value gap. But unlike ethical non-cognitivism, moral relativism does not deny that moral claims can be true; it only denies that they can be made true by some objective, trans-cultural moral order.  It allows them to be true in the humbler, relativistic sense of being rationally acceptable from a particular cultural vantage point.

e. Meta-Ethical Relativism

Meta-ethical relativism holds that moral judgments are not true or false in any absolute sense, but only relative to particular standpoints.  This idea is essential to just about any version of moral relativism.  Relativizing truth to standpoints is a way of answering in advance the objection that relativism implies that the same sentence can be both true and false.  The relativity clause means that the same sentence—say, “slavery is unjust”—can be both true and false, but not in exactly the same sense, since the term “unjust” contains an implicit reference to some particular normative framework.  The situation is analogous to that in which one person says “It is raining” and another person says “It is not raining.”  If they are standing together at the same place and at the same time, they cannot both be right.  But if they are speaking at different times or from different locations (standpoints) this is possible.

Saying that the truth of a moral claim is relative to some standpoint should not be confused with the idea that it is relative to the situation in which it is made.  Only the most extreme rigorists would deny that in assessing a moral judgment we should take the particular circumstances into account.  Most people would agree that lying in court to avoid a fine is wrong, while lying to a madman to protect his intended victim is justified. The particular circumstances surrounding the action alter its character and hence our appraisal of it.

Some meta-ethical relativists focus more on the justification of moral judgments rather than on their truth.  Gilbert Harman, for instance, argues that when we say someone ought to do something, we imply that she has a “motivating reason”—that is, certain desires and intentions–to perform the act in question.  But whether or not the person has these desires and intentions, and hence feels obliged to perform the action, is largely determined by the prevailing norms of the community to which she belongs.  Feelings of moral obligation provide a justification for particular beliefs and practices; but these only arise through agents being embedded in particular social groups whose moral outlook they share.

Most moral relativists endorse some version of meta-ethical relativism.  But meta-ethical relativism is not quite fully-fledged moral relativism; for one could consistently affirm it and still insist that one particular standpoint was demonstrably superior to all others. It is the denial of this possibility that gives moral relativism a more radical edge and is responsible for much of the criticism it attracts.

f. Normative Relativism

Normative relativism is the view that it is wrong to judge or interfere with the moral beliefs and practices of cultures that operate with a different moral framework to one’s own, that what goes on in a society should only be judged by the norms of that society.  It is a prescriptive position adopted initially by many anthropologists reacting against the ethnocentrism characteristic of the colonial era.  Melvelle Herskovits, for instance, affirms that “… in practice, the philosophy of relativism is a philosophy of tolerance” (Cultural Relativism, p. 31).  Similar claims can be found in the writings of Ruth Benedict and Edvard Westermarck.

Because it is prescriptive, many would say that what is being described here is not really a form of relativism but is, rather, a position entailed by moral relativism.  The motive behind it is to avoid arrogance and promote tolerance.  But normative relativists can also argue that judging other cultures is misguided since there are no trans-cultural criteria to which one can refer in order to justify one’s judgment.  Whether or not meta-ethical relativism entails normative relativism is a major bone of contention.  Bernard Williams disparages with the label “vulgar relativism” the sort of thinking that simplistically infers tolerance from relativity.  Geoffrey Harrison argues that while moral relativism, properly understood, is essentially a meta-ethical position about morality, the claim that we should be tolerant is one made from within a particular moral point of view; the latter does not follow the former, therefore, since they belong to different levels of discourse.  And David Wong, while defending both meta-ethical and normative relativism, agrees that the former does not, by itself, entail the latter, some sort of independent principle of liberal political theory being also needed to support a non-interventionist position.

g. Moral Relativism

Moral relativism has been identified with all the above positions; and no formula can capture all the ways the term is used by both its advocates and its critics.  But it is possible to articulate a position that most who call themselves moral relativists would endorse.

1.  Moral judgments are true or false and actions are right or wrong only relative to some particular standpoint (usually the moral framework of a specific community).

2.  No standpoint can be proved objectively superior to any other.

According to this view, “slavery is unjust” is true relative to the moral framework of most 21st century Norwegians, but it is false relative to the moral perspective of most white Americans in South Carolina in the 18th century.  Regarding the second clause in the definition, moral philosophers from the time of Plato have sought to demonstrate the objective correctness (and hence the superiority) of a given moral outlook by showing how it conforms to God’s will, or corresponds to a metaphysical moral order, or is entailed by dictates of Reason, or accords with basic intuitions, or best meets the needs of human nature.  According to the moral relativist, all such attempts fail, for they all rest on premises that belong to the standpoint being defended and need not be accepted by people who do not share that point of view.

Thus, a critic of slavery could no doubt prove the truth of what she says to anyone who accepts her basic premises—for example, that all races are equally human, and that all human beings should enjoy the same basic rights.  But the argument will not convince someone who denies these premises.  To them, such a “proof” of slavery’s wrongness will appear question begging, and they can reject it without being inconsistent or irrational.

The fact that one moral outlook cannot be conclusively proved superior to another does not mean, however, that it cannot be judged superior; nor does it imply that one cannot give reasons for preferring it. Gilbert Harman, for instance, holds that he can consistently affirm basic tenets of liberal morality while recognizing that his reasons for doing so may not be “motivating reasons” to someone belonging to a different moral culture, and so will have no persuasive power.  A moderate moral relativist like David Wong argues that some moralities are better than others on the grounds that they better serve the needs and purposes that people in all cultures share.  But within the parameters imposed by the common human condition, significant variation in moral outlook is possible.  For instance, between the individualistic ways of thinking that are characteristic of the modern West and the community-centered outlooks more typical of Asia—to take an example Wong considers in depth—one can express a preference, but one cannot justify it by appealing to neutral criteria of superiority. Thomas Scanlon, an even milder kind of relativist, also defends the idea that one can view another society’s moral norms as worthy of respect while still having cogent reasons for preferring one’s own.

Moral relativists typically relativize the truth of moral judgments to cultures, which may encompass an entire society or historical period (China, Victorian England) but can also designate a subculture within a society (the Pennsylvania Amish, urban street gangs).  In principle, the standpoint in question could be narrowed to that of a single individual, in which case, the relativism becomes a form of moral subjectivism.  But this is not a widely held position since it seems to reduce to the idea that whatever an individual believes to be right is right, and that would seem to undermine the whole idea of morality.

3. Arguments for Moral Relativism

The main arguments for moral relativism are not necessarily all compatible.  For instance, some relativists presuppose that value judgments are fundamentally different from factual judgments (which can be objectively true), while others see the truth of both kinds of judgment as irreducibly relative to some conceptual or cultural framework.  The arguments given here thus represent different routes by which one may arrive at a relativistic view of morality.

a. The Argument from Cultural Diversity

Textbooks often suggest that relativists argue from the plain fact that different cultures have different moral belief systems to a relativistic view of morality; but this is an oversimplification. The path seems to be more along the following lines.  Awareness of the existence of diverse moralities (a) casts doubt on the idea that there is a single true morality, and (b) encourages the idea that the morality of one’s own culture has no special status but is just one moral system among many.

The fact of diversity—if it is a fact, which some question (see section 4a below)—does not logically entail moral relativism.  It does not even entail that objectivism is false.  After all, there are diverse views on how human beings came to exist, but that does not imply that there is no single, objectively correct account.  Nor can moral relativism really claim to explain the diversity of moral systems, although this claim is sometimes made on its behalf.  For how can the mere absence of something—in this case, an objective and universally binding moral code—explain the phenomenon in question?  The suggestion seems to rest on the premise that if there were an objective moral truth, there would not be such moral diversity.  Presumably, the idea underlying this premise is that cultures would have by now converged on the objective moral truth.  But the absence of an objective truth does not explain this lack of convergence.  At most, it is merely a condition that makes diversity more likely.  Cultures have different sporting preferences: Brazilians love soccer; Pakistanis prefer cricket; Mongolians are passionate about horse racing.  But no one would suggest that these differences are explained by the absence of a single, objectively superior game that everyone should play.

To be sure, an objectivist has to explain why so many people seem to have failed to discover the one true moral code, while relativists are excused from this task.  But explanations referencing the usual suspects—ignorance, habit, tradition, unreason, fear, self-interest, and so on—are possible.

Thus, diversity by itself proves very little.  Relativists nevertheless see it as suggestive, often pointing to an analogy between moralities and religions.  The existence of many different religions does not prove that none of them can claim to be the one true religion.  But it obviously does raise the question of how the objective truth of any religion could possibly be demonstrated.  And in the case of moralities, too, the question arises: how is it possible to prove that one is superior to all the others?

b. The Untenability of Moral Objectivism

The untenability of moral objectivism is probably the most popular and persuasive justification for moral relativism–that it follows from the collapse of moral objectivism, or is at least the best alternative to objectivism. The argument obviously rests on the idea that moral objectivism has been discredited.  In its oldest and most widespread form, the idea that a moral code has objective validity rests on the belief that it has some sort of divine sanction.  With the decline in religious faith that is a hallmark of modernity, this foundation for morality was shaken.  Consequently, much moral philosophy from the 17th century onwards has been devoted to establishing an alternative, secular foundation, one that can claim universal validity without appealing to dubious metaphysical doctrines. This is what Alasdair MacIntyre has dubbed the “enlightenment project.”

But despite the efforts of Kant, Mill, and their successors, many remain skeptical about the possibility of proving the objective truth or the universal validity of moral claims.  The fact that the moral objectivists themselves cannot agree about which moral system is correct, or what its philosophical foundation should be, encourages this skepticism. But it also rests on forceful philosophical considerations.  Moral judgments, say the critics of objectivism, have an irreducible evaluative component.  They assert, assume, or imply that a state of affairs is good or bad, that an action is right or wrong, or that something is better than something else.  But if one accepts—as many do—that value judgments are logically distinct from factual statements and cannot be derived from them, then any attempt to justify a moral claim must rest on at least some value-laden premises. And these basic moral presuppositions will not be susceptible to proof at all.

For example, an argument to prove that a husband should not beat his wife will probably rest on the assumption that men and women should enjoy equal rights.  But how does one prove this to someone who categorically denies it?  How does one prove that the intrinsic value of happiness should be the foundation of our moral judgments to someone who thinks that family honor is the most important value of all?  Or how does one prove that individual rights are a primary good to someone whose theoretical bottom line is that individuals should be subservient to the state?

The increase in skepticism towards moral objectivism is one of the most significant shifts that has taken place in moral philosophy over the past two centuries.  This trend has been reinforced by the apparent contrast between natural science and moral discourse. Science is generally thought to describe an independently existing, objective reality; and scientists from all over the world largely accept the same methodology, data, theories and conclusions, except in the case of disputes at the cutting edge of research.  Ethics exhibits nothing like this degree of convergence. Gilbert Harman is one of the best-known defenders of moral relativism along these lines.  But other critics of objectivism, such as Alasdair MacIntrye and Richard Rorty, have carved out relativistic positions that don’t rest on acceptance of a sharp distinction between facts and values.

Moral relativism is not the only response to the perceived problems with moral objectivism.  As noted earlier, ethical non-realism, ethical non-cognitivism, emotivism, moral subjectivism, and moral skepticism are other possible responses, for the mere denial of objectivism, like the mere fact of cultural diversity, does not logically entail moral relativism.  It does, however, undoubtedly make people more receptive to a relativistic outlook.

c. The Argument from Cognitive Relativism

The majority of moral relativists do not embrace cognitive relativism, which offers a relativistic account of truth in general, not just the truth of moral judgments.  However, some do, and this is another path to moral relativism

One of the merits of this approach to moral relativism is that it can help to clarify fundamental questions about what is meant by talk about the relativity of moral claims.  What does it mean, after all, to say that moral norms are “relative to” some culture?  If we are merely saying that what people think about right and wrong is influenced by the cultural environment, then the claim seems banal.  If we are saying that moral beliefs and practices are causally determined by the surrounding culture, then unless one is a strict determinist, the thesis seems to be obviously false; for members raised in the same cultural community can adopt very different moral outlooks.  The philosophically interesting claim at the heart of most forms of moral relativism is that moral statements are true (or false) relative to some normative standpoint, usually one characteristic of some particular culture.  But what does “true relative to” mean, precisely?  From an objectivist or realist point of view, the phrase makes little sense since what determines the truth or falsity of a statement is whether or not it accords with objective reality.  The cognitive relativist, however, argues that this notion of truth is philosophically vacuous since it employs the notion of an independent, objective reality that lies beyond any possible experience.

Cognitive relativism holds that (a) the truth value of any judgment is relative to some particular standpoint (for example, a conceptual scheme or theoretical framework); and (b) no standpoint is metaphysically privileged over all others—there is no “God’s eye point of view” that yields the objective truth about reality.  Relativists of this sort are not so impressed by the fact-value distinction.  They do not view truth as a property that sentences possess in virtue of their correspondence to an independent reality.  Rather, they argue that we call a sentence “true” when it coheres with the rest of our beliefs, perceptions, values, and assumptions—in other words, when it is rationally acceptable or appears justified according to our general conceptual scheme.  On this view, “the earth moves around the sun” is false relative to a medieval conceptual scheme and is true relative to ours.  Similarly, “homosexuality is morally wrong” is true relative to the perspective of conservative Christians and false relative to that of twenty-first century liberals.  There is no essential difference between the two cases.  And in both cases, it is not possible to demonstrate logically the superiority of one standpoint over the other.

This is more or less the position defended by Richard Rorty, even though he rejects the relativist label.  Rorty likes to describe himself as following in the footsteps of William James and John Dewey, although his interpretation of his pragmatist predecessors is controversial.  According to him, the term “true” is an “empty compliment” we pay to statements that we consider sufficiently well supported by the network of other assumptions, beliefs, and experiences that surround them.

d. Moral Relativism Promotes Tolerance

The idea that moral relativism promotes tolerance is a normative argument.   The key idea is that moral relativism encourages a certain humility.  Becoming aware of the merely relative validity of one’s own moral norms makes one less likely to fall into arrogant ethnocentrism and less inclined to pass moral judgment on the beliefs and practices found in other cultures.  In effect, the argument is that moral relativism entails normative relativism (see above).  Ruth Benedict states the idea forcefully at the end of her influential work Patterns of Culture, when she expresses her hope that, on the basis of the sort of anthropological research she has described, “we shall arrive at a more realistic social faith, accepting as grounds of hope and as new bases for tolerance the coexisting and equally valid patterns of life which mankind has created for itself from the raw materials of existence” (Patterns of Culture, p. 257). Benedict, in fact, takes the argument a step further, arguing that the relativistic outlook she champions can be positively beneficial in helping to combat bigotry, racism, chauvinism and other forms of prejudice.

One reason for thinking that a relativistic view of morality might foster tolerance is that it will also incline us to be more self-critical.  Edvard Westermarck makes this connection in his 1932 work Ethical Relativity when he says, “Could it be brought home to people that there is no absolute standard in morality, they would perhaps be on the one hand more tolerant and on the other more critical in their judgments” (Ethical Relativity, p. 59).  As mentioned earlier, however, even some thinkers sympathetic to relativism, such as Harrison and Wong, are suspicious of the claim that moral relativism by itself necessarily entails a tolerant attitude toward alternative moralities. And critics of relativism, such as W.T. Stace and Karl Popper, argue that if relativism does indeed imply universal tolerance, that this constitutes an objection to it, since some things—like oppressively intolerant moral systems—should not be tolerated (see section 4g below).

4. Objections to Moral Relativism

a. Relativists Exaggerate Cultural Diversity

 

The objection that relativists exaggerate cultural diversity is directed against descriptive relativism more than against moral relativism as defined above; but it has figured importantly in many debates about relativism.  In its simplest form, the argument runs as follows.  Every human culture has some sort of moral code, and these overlap to a considerable extent.  There is a common core of shared values such as trustworthiness, friendship, and courage, along with certain prohibitions, such as those against murder or incest. Some version of the golden rule—treat others as you would have them treat you—is also encountered in almost every society. The existence of these universal values is easy to explain: they enable societies to flourish, and their absence would jeopardize a society’s chances of survival.

The claim that every society must share these basic commitments thus links up with findings in evolutionary ethics.  It is also supported, according to some, by the results of the “moral sense test,” a research project conducted by Harvard’s Primate and Cognitive Neuroscience Laboratory.  The project is an internet-based study of the moral intuitions of people from all over the world.  The responses are sufficiently uniform, according to the laboratory’s director, Mark Hauser, to support the idea that there is a “universally shared moral faculty” common to all human beings and rooted in our evolutionary heritage.  Such universalist claims are sometimes cited by those seeking to establish a generally agreed upon set of human rights or human capacities, a foundation for the work of organizations and bodies like the United Nations.

The argument that relativists exaggerate the diversity among moral systems is also advanced in a subtler form, an early version of which can be found in the Dialogue that Hume appended to his Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals.  What appear to be striking differences in moral outlook turn out, on closer examination, to be superficial disagreements masking underlying common values.  For example, some nomadic cultures have considered infanticide to be morally acceptable, while in other societies it is viewed as murder. But those carrying out infanticide may be motivated by the knowledge that they lack the resources to support the child.  Their action is thus prompted by a concern for the well being of the community, and perhaps, also, a desire that the child be spared avoidable suffering—values that would be recognized and approved by people in other societies where, since additional children would be less of a burden, infanticide is prohibited.  In this case, the apparent difference in values is explained by the different circumstances of the societies in question.

Other seeming differences may be explained by reference to the different factual beliefs that people hold. Take the issue of slavery.  Some societies have seen nothing wrong with slavery; others view it is a moral abomination.  This would seem to mark a basic and serious disparity in moral perspectives.  Yet both parties may subscribe to the principle that “all men are created equal.”  Their disagreement may be over whether or not the people being enslaved are fully human.  And defenders of slavery in the United States did indeed used to argue that blacks were sub-human and could therefore legitimately be treated like animals rather than as human beings.

The critics of relativism thus argue that before declaring a moral difference between cultures to be fundamental we should look carefully to see whether the difference does not, at bottom, arise out of disparate living conditions or rest on conflicting factual beliefs.

The question of whether or not there are universal values has been at the center of many of the debates about moral relativism.  But the expression “universal values” is ambiguous, and how it is understood affects the kind of relativism that it calls into question.

(i) “Universal values” can mean moral values or norms to which every culture, as a matter of fact, is committed.  If there are universal values in this sense, then it is an objection to a strong version of descriptive relativism which sees cultural diversity as sufficiently radical to preclude any common ground that all cultures share.  It is worth noting that descriptive relativism would also become false in the event of humanity eventually converging on a single moral outlook or of a catastrophe that wiped out all cultures except one.  But neither scenario would falsify moral relativism as defined above, since it is not an empirical theory about anyone’s actual beliefs or practices; it is, rather, a view about the status of moral judgments and the limitations on how they can be supported.

(ii) “Universal values” can mean moral values or norms that everyone ought to affirm.  This is a normative universalism.  It is likely that most who hold this view see these universal values as constitutive of an objectively correct moral point of view. Understood in this way, the position is incompatible with relativism.  But the view that there are, as a matter of fact, universally shared values does not entail this normative universalism.  After all, every society might agree that homosexuality is wicked or that men should have dominion over women.  It would not follow that everyone should embrace these values.

b. Relativism Ignores Diversity Within a Culture

 

When relativists say that the truth of moral claims and the rightness of actions is relative to the norms and values of the culture in which they occur, they seem to assume that members of that culture will generally agree about the moral framework which they supposedly share.  This may sometimes be the case; but such homogeneous and relatively static cultures are increasingly uncommon.  Today, many cultures contain sub-communities that disagree sharply on matters such as abortion, capital punishment, euthanasia, polygamy, women’s rights, gay rights, drug use, or the treatment of animals.  Given that this is so, which set of norms and values are we supposed to refer to when judging a belief or practice?  If the relevant norms are those of the sub-culture to which the person making the claim belongs, then the relativist position seems in danger of spiraling down toward subjectivism, since there can be many sub-cultures, and some of them can be quite small.

From the other direction comes the objection that relativists tend to ignore the extent to which cultures overlap and influence one another.  These criticisms are related, as both accuse relativists of presupposing an oversimplified and outdated view of what a culture is.  This charge seems to have some purchase on the sort of relativism that treats the validity of moral claims as relative to specific identifiable cultures.  It seems less damaging, though, to the kind of relativism that relates moral claims to general normative standpoints without requiring that these be identified with actual communities.

c. Relativism Implies that Obvious Moral Wrongs are Acceptable

 

 

The most serious objection to moral relativism is that relativism implies that obvious moral wrongs are acceptable.  The objection is that if we say beliefs and actions are right or wrong only relative to a specific moral standpoint, it then becomes possible to justify almost anything.  We are forced to abandon the idea that some actions are just plain wrong. Nor can we justify the idea that some forms of life are obviously and uncontroversially better than others, even though almost everyone believes this.  According to the relativists, say the critics, the beliefs of slave-owners and Nazis should be deemed true and their practices right relative to their conceptual-moral frameworks; and it is not possible for anyone to prove that their views are false or morally misguided, or that there are better points of view.  To many, this is a reductio ad absurdum of moral relativism.

This line of attack appears compelling against normative relativism, the view that what goes on within a society should only be judged by the prevailing norms of that society.  If that is one’s position, then one must hold that in a culture where, say, adulterers are stoned to death, this practice is morally right, since it is justified according to the only norms that matter— those of the society in question.  The argument is less persuasive, however, against the position identified as “moral relativism” in section 2 above, since this version of relativism allows the beliefs and practices within a culture to be judged according to norms external to that culture.  With this view, stoning adulterers is right relative to some moral standpoints (for instance, that of ancient Israel) and wrong according to others (for instance, that of modern liberalism).  So relativists who happen to be liberal-minded denizens of the modern world are still free to judge what goes on elsewhere by their own moral norms.  What makes their position relativistic is their denial that there is any neutral, transcultural court of appeal to provide an objective justification for preferring one standpoint over another.

To many critics, however, this denial is precisely what renders relativism unacceptable.  In their view, both versions of relativism put all moralities on the same plane and make one’s choice between them arbitrary.  In responding to this criticism, moral relativists would seem to have three options.

(i) Assert that all moralities are indeed on the same plane and we have no reasons for favoring some over others.  However, virtually no one takes this position since it amounts to a form of moral nihilism.

(ii) Argue that the beliefs and practices of a culture should be appraised according to how well they enable that culture to realize the goals it sets for itself.  This allows for an assessment that avoids judging according to an external standard.  True, the general criterion of efficiency or success being used here could be called transcultural; but the relativist can plausibly argue that the criterion is one that every culture would accept; for to reject it would amount to saying that one did not care whether one’s society flourished or failed.

However, for the relativists, this line of defense only sets the problem back a step.  The critic will next pose the question: Regarding the goals societies set for themselves, do we have any reason for preferring some goals over others?  Suppose a society’s overarching goals include realizing racial purity or achieving world domination.  If relativists allow for no way of appraising such goals, insisting that any preferences we express are arbitrary, then, the critics will say, their position is once more shown to be beyond the pale of common sense.

(iii) A third option for relativists is to embrace what might be called (following Richard Rorty) an “ethnocentric” position.  Relativists of this stripe continue to insist that all moralities are in the same boat insofar as none can be conclusively proved in some absolute sense to be true or false, right or wrong, or better than any other available moral outlook.  But, they argue, it does not follow from this that relativists cannot consistently prefer some moralities over others, nor that they cannot offer reasons for their preference.  They simply admit that when they appraise moralities, they do so according to norms and values constitutive of their particular moral standpoint, one that they probably share with most other members of their cultural community.   Thus, a relativist might condemn laws prohibiting homosexuality in the name of such values as happiness, freedom, and equality.  But she does not claim that she can prove that this normative standpoint is objectively superior to that of the culture outlawing homosexuality.  Possibly those she is criticizing might share her values, in which case they may be open to persuasion.  But they might have different basic values; for instance, they may favor executing homosexuals in order to realize a certain vision of moral purity.  In that case, the standoff seems to be at the level of fundamental values.  And when that is the case, the relativist may accept that she cannot demonstrate the objective superiority of her views in a non question-begging way—that is, without making assumptions that those she is trying to persuade will reject.

To the critic, moral relativism implies that one moral view is just as good or as bad as any other, and to take this line is to countenance immorality.  But the difference between Western academics who are moral relativists and their fellow academics who criticize them is clearly not a deep difference in moral values.  They all are likely to praise democracy and condemn discrimination.  The difference is, rather, at the meta-ethical level in their view of the status of moral judgments and the kind of justification they allow.  The critics believe some sort of objective bulwark is needed to prevent the slide toward an “anything goes” form of moral nihilism.  The relativists see this anxiety as mistaken since what it asks for is both impossible and unnecessary. In their view, an “ethnocentric” justification of one’s views is the only kind available, and it is enough.

d. Relativism Undermines the Possibility of a Society Being Self-Critical

If the rightness or wrongness of actions, practices, or institutions can only be judged by reference to the norms of the culture in which they are found, then how can members of that society criticize those norms on moral grounds?  And how can they argue that the prevailing norms should be changed?   If, for instance, a society has a caste system under which one caste enjoys great privileges while another caste is allowed to do only menial work, then this system will necessarily appear just according to its own norms. So there will be nothing to criticize.

One apparent way for the relativist to avoid this objection is to point out that most societies are imperfect even by their own lights; what actually happens usually falls short of the ideals espoused.  For instance, an official commitment to equality is belied by discriminatory laws. Thus, a society can be self-critical by noticing gaps between its practices and its ideals.  This is a weak response, however, since the sort of self-criticism it allows is quite limited.  Often, the most important kind of self-criticism involves a demand that the ideals themselves be changed, as, for instance, when the American and French revolutions articulated new egalitarian values.  Can moral relativism make sense of a society’s own members rejecting the prevailing norms?

The answer is that it all depends on the precise sort of moral relativism being espoused.  If the particular standpoint, by reference to which moral claims are appraised, has to be that constituted by the prevailing norms in a society, then it is hard to see how those norms themselves can be criticized.  But if the relativist only insists that moral claims are true or false relative to some particular standpoint, then this does not follow.  In that case, the prevailing moral norms can be judged wrong from an alternative point of view, which may be the one the relativist favors.  For instance, the current treatment of animals on American factory farms could be criticized by an American relativist who adopts the standpoint of a utilitarian committed to the minimization of unnecessary suffering.

Closely related to the argument concerning a society’s capacity for self-criticism is the objection that moral relativism implies there is no such thing as moral progress.  A society may change its norms by, say, ending systematic discrimination against certain groups, or becoming less indifferent to the suffering of animals.  But if there is no neutral point of view from which such changes can be appraised, how can one argue that they constitute progress?  Indeed, from the point of view of the old norms, any changes must appear suspect, since the old norms dictate what is right.

Like the previous objection, this argument has the form of a reductio ad absurdum.  Almost everyone believes that moral progress can and does occur within a society.  The abolition of slavery is a paradigm of such progress.  So, any theory implying that such changes do not constitute progress must be false.  By the same token, moral relativism can also be criticized for not allowing the possibility of moral decline, which also presumably occurs at times.

One response a relativist could offer to this objection is simply to embrace the conclusion and insist that moral progress is a chimera; but this undeniably goes against what most people view as ethical common sense. The more common and more plausible response, therefore, is, once again, for the relativist to take the “ethnocentric” line.  On this view, moral progress is possible, but not relative to objective, trans-cultural criteria.  It can only be gauged by reference to some particular moral standpoint that cannot be conclusively proved superior to other points of view.  Thus, relativists, like everyone else, will view the abolition of slavery as progress because they affirm values such as freedom, equality, and individual happiness. They simply deny that it represents progress in some more objective sense—from “the God’s eye point of view,” so to speak.

e. Relativism is Pragmatically Self-Refuting

A standard objection to cognitive relativism, which is sometimes advanced against moral relativism, is that it is pragmatically self-refuting.  The basic idea behind it is that moral relativists, whatever their official meta-ethical position, cannot avoid being implicitly committed to certain fundamental norms and values, and they presuppose this commitment in the very act of arguing for moral relativism. So, the content of the theory is at odds with the practice of affirming or defending it.  Jürgen Habermas develops this line of argument by claiming that anyone participating in rational discourse reveals, through that very act, a commitment to certain values that belong to a normative notion of rationality: for instance, values such as sincerity or open-mindedness.

Relativists, however, are likely to be skeptical about the universality of these alleged implicit commitments.  To them, the concept of rationality in question is characteristic of a particular time and place.  To be sure, they may, as modern Western liberals, embrace values such as sincerity or open-mindedness.  But they can still plausibly deny that they have an objective duty to do so, or that such values are necessarily embedded in all acts of communication and must therefore be viewed as universal.

f. Relativism Rests on an Incoherent Notion of Truth

What does it mean for a moral belief to be true relative to a particular culture?  If it merely means that most members of that culture hold that belief, then it is a somewhat grandiose and misleading way of stating a simple fact.  Presumably, therefore, relativists mean something more by it. In addition, they cannot be simply making the banal point that someone belonging to that culture who rejects the belief in question is in the minority, or is perceived to be mistaken by the majority.  The relativist thesis seems to be that in some sense the truth (or falsity) of a person’s moral beliefs is either determined by or constituted by their coherence (or lack of coherence) with the prevailing moral outlook in that person’s community.  This raises a number of awkward issues.  It seems to imply, for instance, that the majority can never be wrong on moral matters.  And a corollary of that is that within a given community, dissidents must always be wrong.  These ideas go against our normal ways of thinking.

A further problem for the relativist thesis is that it seems not to take into account exactly how the prevailing moral norms in a society were established.  If they gained ascendancy over time, shaped by collective experience, then one could perhaps view them as the outcome of an implicit social contract, and in that sense to have some claim to rationality.  But what if they were initially imposed on a society forcibly by conquerors or dictatorial rulers?  Does that make a difference?   It certainly sounds odd to say that a moral statement that once was false can be made true by the establishment of a new religious or political order and the consolidation of its ideas.

Moral relativists are thus under some pressure to explain why they go beyond simple factual statements about what the majority in a society believes, insisting on advancing a philosophical claim about the truth of moral statements.  This is one reason some would give for viewing moral relativism as an instance of a more general relativism that sees the truth of any statement as a function of its coherence with a broader theoretical framework.  Relativists who base their position on a sharp distinction between facts and values must work with two distinct notions of truth: factual claims are made true by correspondence to reality; moral claims are made true by cohering with or being entailed by the surrounding conceptual scheme.  Those who see truth of any kind as ultimately a matter of inter-subjective agreement may be better positioned to avoid this problem.

g. The Relativist Position on Tolerance is Problematic

A good deal of the debate surrounding moral relativism has focused on its claim to exemplify and foster tolerance.  There are at least three lines of criticism against this claim.

(i) Tolerance is not the same as respect.

Showing genuine respect for a culture means taking its beliefs seriously, and that means viewing them as candidates for critical appraisal.  The relativist eschews any evaluation of other cultures’ norms in the name of tolerance; however, this attitude is actually patronizing.  It suggests that the beliefs could not withstand critical scrutiny, or perhaps that they are just not worth appraising.

(ii) Moral relativists inconsistently posit a principle of tolerance as a universal obligation.

Relativists say we should be tolerant of beliefs and practices found in other cultures.  This is a normative claim.  If it applies to everyone, then it is a trans-cultural moral principle, in which case relativism is false.  If, on the other hand, relativism is true, then this principle of tolerance does not express a trans-cultural obligation binding on everyone; it merely expresses the values associated with a particular moral standpoint.

Tolerance is, of course, a central value espoused by modern liberal societies.  But according to the relativist’s own position, members of other societies where tolerance is not viewed so positively have no reason to accept the idea that one ought to be tolerant.  So for other societies, the fact that relativism promotes tolerance is not a point in its favor, and relativists have no business preaching tolerance to them.

It would not be self-contradictory for moral relativists to hold that all moral principles have only a relative validity except for the principle of tolerance, which enjoys a unique status.  But the resulting position would be peculiar.  The relativistic viewpoint would be significantly modified and some account would be owed of why the principle of tolerance alone has universal validity.  For this reason, a more common relativistic response to the criticism is along the lines suggested by David Wong.  Relativists can simply accept that the obligation to be tolerant has only relative validity or scope. It applies to those whose general moral standpoint affirms or entails tolerance as a value; and only these people are likely to be swayed by the argument that relativism promotes tolerance.

(iii) The relativist’s advocacy of tolerance is morally misguided since not everything should be tolerated.

This is, in effect, another version of the charge that moral relativism entails an “anything goes” attitude that countenances obvious wrongs in other societies such as religious persecution or sexual discrimination.  It even requires us to be tolerant of intolerance, at least if it occurs in another culture.

Clearly, this is a problem for anyone, relativist or not, who elevates the principle that we should be tolerant to an absolute, exceptionless rule.  But for relativists who do not do this, the problem will seem less pressing.  Tolerance, they will argue, is one of the values constitutive of their standpoint—a standpoint they share with most other people in modern liberal societies.  From this standpoint, intolerance can and will be criticized, as will other policies and practices, wherever they occur, that seem to cause unhappiness or unnecessarily limit people’s prospects.  The relativistic stance is useful, however, in helping to make us less arrogant about the correctness of our own norms, more sensitive to cultural contexts when looking at how others live, and a little less eager in our willingness to criticize what goes on in other cultures.

The more difficult, practical question concerns not whether we should ever criticize the beliefs and practices found in other cultures, but whether we are ever justified in trying to impose our values on them through diplomatic pressure, economic sanctions, boycotts, or military force.  This question has arisen in relation to such practices as satee in India, persecution of religious or ethnic minorities, female circumcision, and legalized violence against women.  But it is not a problem that only moral relativists have to confront.

5. Conclusion

Over the years moral relativism has attracted a great deal of criticism, and not just from professional philosophers. One reason for this, of course, is that it is widely perceived to be a way of thinking that is on the rise.  Indeed, by the end of the twentieth century it had become a commonplace among teachers of moral philosophy in the US that the default view of morality held by the majority of college students was some form of moral relativism. Another reason for so much trenchant criticism is that a relativistic view of morality is thought by many to have pernicious consequences. For example, in September 2011, Pope Benedict XVI blamed it for the riots that had taken place in Britain a few weeks earlier, arguing that “[w]hen policies do not presume or promote objective values, the resulting moral relativism … tends instead to produce frustration, despair, selfishness and a disregard for the life and liberty of others” (National Catholic Reporter, Sept. 12, 2011).

However, the attitude labeled “moral relativism” by the pope and others who worry about the moral health of contemporary society is not a well defined or rigorously defended philosophical position. It typically amounts to little more than a skepticism about objective moral truth, often expressed as the idea that beliefs and actions are not right or wrong per se, only right or wrong for someone. Philosophers like Gilbert Harman, David Wong, and Richard Rorty who defend forms of moral relativism seek to articulate and defend philosophically sophisticated alternatives to objectivism.  As they see it, they are not countenancing immorality, injustice, or moral nihilism; rather, they are trying to say something about the nature of moral claims and the justifications given for them.  The main problem they face is to show how the denial of objective moral truth need not entail a subjectivism that drains the rationality out of moral discourse.   Their critics, on the other hand, face the possibly even more challenging task of justifying the claim that there is such a thing as objective moral truth.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Benedict, Ruth.  Patterns of Culture.  New York: Penguin, 1946.
    • Studies three societies to show how beliefs and practices must be understood in the context of the culture in which they occur and its dominant values.
  • Carson, Thomas.  The Status of Morality.  Dordrecht: Reidel, 1984.
    • A sophisticated defense of a version of moral relativism based on an analysis of how, and in what sense, moral judgments can be said to be true or false.
  • Duncker, Karl.  “Ethical Relativity? An Inquiry into the Psychology of Ethics.”  Mind, 48 (1939), pp. 39-57.
  • Habermas, Jürgen. Moral Consciousness and Communicative Action.  Translated by Christian Lenhardt and Shierry Weber Nicholsen.  Cambridge, Mass.: M.I.T. Press, 1990.
    • Argues that in every human society there are certain common norms and values presupposed by social interaction.
  • Harmen, Gilbert.  The Nature of Morality: An Introduction to Ethics.  New York: Oxford University Press, 1977.
    • Presents a version of moral relativism based on an analysis of what it means for someone to have a reason to do something.
  • Harré, Rom, and Krausz, Michael.  Varieties of Relativism. Oxford: Blackwell, 1996.
    • Catalogues the different types of relativism, including moral relativism, along with the main arguments for and against each type.
  • Harrison, Geoffrey.  “Relativism and Tolerance.”  Ethics 86 (2), (1976).pp. 122-135.
  • Herskovits, Melville.  Cultural Relativism: Perspectives in Cultural Pluralism.  New York:  Random House, 1972.
  • Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning the Principles of Morals. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1983. (First published in 1751.)
  • Krausz, Michael, and Meiland, Jack W. (eds.). Relativism: Cognitive and Moral. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1982.
    • Anthology of important articles on both kinds of relativism.
  • Krausz, Michael(ed.).  Relativism: Interpretation and Confrontation.  Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1989.
    • Extensive collection of articles; somewhat wider in scope than the Krausz-Meiland anthology.
  • Ladd, John(ed.). Ethical Relativism.  Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 1973.
    • Anthology that focuses on the contribution of anthropology to the moral relativism debate.
  • Levi, Neil.  Moral Relativism: A Short Introduction. Oxford: Oneworld, 2002.
    • A very clear study, fairly sympathetic to relativism, which analyzes and appraises many of the central arguments for and against.
  • Lukes, Steven. Moral Relativism. New York: Picador, 2008.
    • A concise introduction that focuses on debates within the social sciences about culture and diversity.
  • Mackie, J. L.  Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. London: Penguin, 1991.
  • Montaigne, Michel de.  “On Custom” and “On Cannibals,” in The Complete Essays of Montaigne, trans. Donald M. Frame.  Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1958. (First published in 1580.)
  • Moody-Adams, Michele.  Fieldwork in Familiar Places.  Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 1997.
  • Moser, Paul K., and Carson, Thomas L.(eds.). Moral Relativism: A Reader. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
    • Extensive anthology of excerpts from classic texts and contemporary articles by leading participants in the debate about moral relativism.  Includes an extensive bibliography.
  • Nietzsche, Friedrich. Beyond Good and Evil.  Translated by Walter Kaufmann.  New York: Random House, 1966.
  • Nietzsche, Friedrich. On the Genealogy of Morals.  Translated by Walter Kaufmann and R. J. Hollingdale.  New York: Vintage Books, 1968.
    • Contains Nietzsche’s famous distinction between master and slave morality, which arguably constitutes a version of moral relativism.
  • Rorty, Richard. Contingency, irony, and solidarity.  Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
    • Supports a version of moral relativism that sees no essential difference between factual claims and normative claims.
  • Ruse, Michael.  Taking Darwin Seriously. Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books, 1998.
  • Sinnott-Armstrong, Walter.  Moral Skepticism. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2006.
  • Sumner, William Graham.  Folkways.  Boston: Ginn and Company, 1906.
    • Classic early version of moral relativism by an anthropologist.
  • Westermarck, Edvard. Ethical Relativity. New York: Littlefield, Adams & Company, 1932.
  • Wong, David B. Natural Moralities: A Defense of Pluralistic Relativism. New York: Oxford University Press, 2006.
    • Argues for a sophisticated form of moral relativism within limits imposed by human nature and the human condition.

 

Author Information

Emrys Westacott
Email: Westacott@alfred.edu
Alfred University
U. S. A.

Samuel Alexander (1859—1938)

Samuel AlexanderSamuel Alexander is best known for his role in British Emergentism, an early twentieth century movement which uses the notion of emergence to explain the relationship between mind and body. Alexander argues that mind emerges from body, in the sense that mind is dependent upon brain but not reducible to it. Alexander is also variously associated with both of the major competing ideologies of his time: realism and idealism. Because Alexander rejected idealism in favour of realism about the external world, he is sometimes associated with the Cambridge realists Bertrand Russell and G. E. Moore. But, Alexander spent his early career at Oxford – one of the focal points of British idealism – where he worked with many of the British idealists, including F. H. Bradley. Alexander’s mature metaphysical system bears deep affinities to absolute idealism, and draws on ideas from Spinoza and Hegel. Consequently, Alexander is also sometimes associated with British idealism or British Hegelianism.

Alexander’s magnum opus is Space, Time, and Deity (1920), a two volume work in which he develops an original and systematic metaphysics. Alexander is a super-substantivalist because he holds that matter is identical to spacetime. Alexander argues that space and time are the fundamental entities of the universe, and from spacetime emerges all other existents: matter emerges from spacetime, life emerges from matter, mind emerges from life, and deity emerges from mind. In his day, Alexander’s work was generally well received, and it was the subject of many studies. However, Alexander is little known in the 21st century, and his work is neglected.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Biography and Influence
  3. Early Thought and Writings
    1. Hegel and British Hegelianism
    2. Realism and Naturalism
  4. Space, Time and Deity
    1. Overview
    2. The Fundamentality of Spacetime
    3. Qualities and Categories
    4. Emergence and Spacetime
  5. Alexander and Spinoza
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Introduction

Samuel Alexander is best known for his role in British Emergentism, an early twentieth century movement which developed the notion of ‘emergence’ to explain how novel properties might emerge from underlying substrata, such as consciousness emerging from brain. Alexander is also variously associated with both of the competing philosophical ideologies of his period: British Hegelianism (sometimes known as British idealism) and British new realism (the movement that later became known as analytic philosophy).

However, in his lifetime, Alexander was well known in British philosophy for his metaphysics, particularly his highly original metaphysical system which takes spacetime to be the ontological foundation of the universe. In his magnum opus Space, Time and Deity Alexander argues that all other existents – including matter, minds and deity – emerge from spacetime in an ontological hierarchy. In addition to endorsing this early expression of ‘super-substantivalism’ (the thesis that spacetime is identical to matter) Alexander was one of the first philosophers to investigate the consequences of understanding space and time as combined into the four-dimensional manifold spacetime.

2. Biography and Influence

Alexander was born on 6 January 1859 in Sydney, Australia, the fourth child of saddler Samuel Alexander and his wife Eliza Sloman. Alexander’s father died of consumption shortly before his birth. Alexander spent his youth being educated at private schools before entering the University of Melbourne, where he gained many distinctions. In 1877 Alexander sailed to England – without having finished his Australian degree – with a view to obtaining a scholarship at the University of Oxford. Luckily, Alexander did indeed obtain a scholarship at Balliol College, and he remained at Oxford for many years. Balliol College was the home of a significant number of British Hegelians: Benjamin Jowett, T. H. Green, R. L. Nettleship and A. C. Bradley. As an undergraduate, Alexander fell under this Hegelian influence in a variety of ways, as evidenced by the early work published during his subsequent eleven year fellowship at Lincoln College (see section 2.1).

In 1893 Alexander accepted a professorship at the University of Manchester, where he taught for over thirty years and became very involved in the life of the city; for example, he strongly supported the women’s suffrage movement. In 1902 his entire family – his mother, an aunt, two brothers and a sister – emigrated from Australia to live with him. The change was apparently a great success. Alexander was appointed President of the Aristotelian Society from 1908-1911 (and again later, from 1936-1937). In 1913 he was made a fellow of the British Academy. Alexander seems to have led a happy academic career. In a speech given after his academic retirement, Alexander said: ‘I owe to the University the long thirty-one years that I was proud and happy to be a professor here, during which I tried to do my part’. For further personal autobiographical information, see John Laird’s memoir of Alexander, included in Alexander’s (1939) Philosophical and Literary Pieces. Laird was Alexander’s friend and literary executer.

In 1915 Alexander was appointed as the Gifford lecturer at the University of Glasgow. He delivered his Gifford lectures in the war years of 1917 and 1918, and these were subsequently published, under the same name, in two volumes as Space, Time, and Deity (1920). The delay between the lectures and the publication is due to the fact that Alexander found their production difficult; Laird writes that Alexander ‘was overwhelmed by a sense of his littleness in comparison with the task to which he was tied’ – the books are ‘metaphysical in the grand manner’. Nonetheless, the books were eventually published, and contain the culmination of Alexander’s work on super-substantivalism and emergence. For the most part the books were well received; Laird describes how his reviewers were in general ‘profoundly and gratefully impressed – if they were seldom convinced’. In his critical two-part book review, C. D. Broad describes how few of the Gifford lectures have been so eagerly waited as Alexander’s, and that his ingenious and original system did not disappoint.  Aside from a few short pieces that supplement these books – such as Alexander’s reply to Broad’s review in “Some Explanations” (1921) and his gloss of Spinoza’s ontology in Spinoza and Time (1921) – Alexander preferred to let the books stand alone. Alexander took real pride in the similarities between his system and that of Spinoza, despite his acknowledgement that his gloss of Spinoza’s system takes Spinoza’s work to an end that Spinoza himself would not have entertained. Laird reports that Alexander would have been very happy to have a reference to Spinoza – Erravit cum Spinoza – engraved on his funeral urn. In his late years, Alexander moved his focus from metaphysics to literary theory and aesthetics, as evidenced by his last book Beauty and other Forms of Value (1933).

Alexander died in Manchester, on 13 September 1938. In the decades following his death several studies explored his work from various vantage points. These include John McCarthy’s Naturalism of Samuel Alexander (1948), Alfred Stiernotte’s God and Space-Time (1954), Betram Brettschneider’s The Philosophy of Samuel Alexander (1964) and Michael Weinstein’s Unity and Variety in the Philosophy of Samuel Alexander (1984). Since then, interest in Alexander’s philosophy has waned.

Some commentators understand Alexander as a new realist, whilst others argue that he is substantially Hegelian. For example, McCarthy (1948) praises Alexander for his naturalism and his realism. In contrast, Brettschneider (1964) accuses Alexander of slipping absolute idealism in by the back door, on the grounds that his metaphysics involves many notions utilised by the idealists, such as coherence and concrete universals: Alexander ‘acts like Bradley and thinks like Bradley, but refuses to acknowledge the prepotency of the idealistic metaphysics in his Space-Time universe’. Alexander is genuinely a product of his generation in that he is caught in between the outgoing tide of Hegelianism and the incoming tide of new realism.

3. Early Thought and Writings

a. Hegel and British Hegelianism

The influence of British Hegelianism can be seen in Alexander’s earliest publications. One of his first published papers, “Hegel’s Conception of Nature” (1886), explores how Hegel’s understanding of nature and organism relates to contemporary science, especially the theory of evolution. In the paper Alexander interprets Hegel’s conception of space to mean that space, not matter, comes first in the logical order of nature. He adds that, for Hegel, ‘Space and Time together… involve each other and combine to produce Motion, the soul of the world, which precipitates matter in its process’ (Alexander, 1886, 503). Whether or not Alexander’s interpretation of Hegel’s conception of space is correct, this piece is important because the interpretation prefigures Alexander’s own later view that spacetime is ontologically fundamental and produces matter through a dynamical process. In other words, Alexander develops and expands a view that he takes to have much in common with Hegel.

Alexander’s first published book, Moral Order and Progress (1889), is evidence not just of Hegel’s influence on his work but also that of some of Britain’s most prominent neo-Hegelians. The book is an expansion of an essay written in 1887, for which Alexander was awarded the Green Moral Philosophy Prize. In the book’s preface, Alexander explains that he is proud to have his work connected – however indirectly – with that of T. H. Green. The book is dedicated to his former tutor, A. C. Bradley, and Alexander describes how D.G. Ritchie read the proofs, R. L. Nettleship and J. S. Haldane gave advice and F. H. Bradley – the brother of Alexander’s former tutor – went through the original essay. Alexander remained in contact with both A. C. Bradley and F. H. Bradley throughout his life. This first book attempts to show that there is at least a partial convergence between idealist ethics – of the kind advanced by Green – and evolutionary ethics. Alexander argues that both kinds of ethics recognises that there is a proportion, or relationship, between the individual and his society which is best expressed organically. Hegelian ideas permeated Alexander’s philosophy throughout his life.

b. Realism and Naturalism

 

In 1903 came the dual attacks on idealism from the British ‘new realists’ Russell and Moore: Russell’s Principles of Mathematics (1903) attacks the idealistic monistic doctrine of internal relations, while Moore’s “Refutation of Idealism” (1903) attacks (at least one version of) idealism. Alexander joined the rejection of idealism in print not least with his “Ptolemaic and Copernican views of the place of mind in the universe” (1909) where he compares idealism’s claim that mind is the centre of the universe to Ptolemaic geocentricism, and argues in favour of a realist revolution analogous to Copernican heliocentricism. Alexander describes idealism as the doctrine that in some sense the world is the contents of our consciousness, that things are dependent on the mind not only for being known but for their existence. Alexander rejects idealism on the grounds that it does not fit with experience. He argues that the simplest kind of apprehension of external things, such as the perception of a house or tree, contains in relation to one another two separate things – the tree and the act of perception – such that the tree is not yourself, nor dependent on yourself. Having rejected the Ptolemaic view which places mind at the centre of the universe, he argues in favour of the Copernican view, which holds that minds are merely special parts of a much larger universe.

Alexander expands on his rejection of idealism in a number of further pieces, the most important of which is “The Basis of Realism” (1914). The basic message remains the same – the experience of the relation of knower to known declares that the mind and its object are two separate existences connected together by the relation of togetherness or compresence – and this is not an argument but rather a fact of experience. However, this paper is particularly important because in it Alexander’s rejection of idealism comes paired with his acceptance of realism, the starting point of which is defined as the claim that the empirical characters of various kinds of existences is the subject-matter of the special sciences. Alexander considers himself a naturalist as well as a realist, in the sense that the physical aspect of things is pervasive.

“The Basis of Realism” is one paper of a cluster that Alexander published in a short period – others include “The Method of Metaphysics; and the Categories” (1912) and “On Relations, and in Particular the Cognitive Relation” (1912) – that explore the ideas which later appear in his magnum opus. Two of the ideas explored here are of particular importance. The first is Alexander’s repeated assertion of the reality of space and time. ‘Space and Time are, for idealism, appearances and in some respects the lowest degree of reality… But for realism the question arises whether these may not be at the foundation of all reality, and whether it may not be they which hold the world together’. This comment is interesting because although many of the British idealists – most famously, F. H. Bradley and J. M. E. McTaggart – did deny the reality of space and time, Alexander himself interpreted the idealist Hegel as placing them foremost in his ontology. The second is the idea that reality is organised into a hierarchy of layers, each of which emerges from the one before. Alexander argues that mind, or consciousness, is a new quality of existence, and that which has mind is a new kind of creature, existing at a higher level than physical or even living things.

4. Space, Time and Deity

a. Overview

In Space, Time, and Deity Alexander creates a metaphysical system with spacetime at its foundation, and deity as its culmination. He took the role of spacetime to be central. ‘It is not, I believe, too much to say that all the vital problems of philosophy depend for their solution on the solution of the problem what Space and Time are’. Alexander’s method is unusual for a philosopher in that he does not proceed by argument so much as by description: rather than arguing for his system, he simply points out how intuitive it is and how well it fits the facts of our experience. (In fact, Alexander goes so far as to claim that he dislikes argument.)

Alexander’s system can be seen to proceed via three main steps. Firstly, he describes how spacetime is real, and argues that it is identical to matter. Secondly, he describes how the nature of spacetime gives rise to two kinds of characters: qualities and categories. Lastly, he describes how mind emerges from matter and applies this idea to the universe as a whole to produce a hierarchy of existence in which each layer emerges from the next: spacetime leads to matter, matter leads to mind, mind leads to deity. The following sections will examine each step in turn.

b. The Fundamentality of Spacetime

Alexander’s arguments regarding the fundamentality of spacetime can be found in the first volume of Space, Time & Deity. Alexander begins by arguing that spacetime is real. His central argument for this claim is based on the Platonic claim that we can apprehend, or intuit, space and time directly. Alexander argues that while intuition is different from reason, the value of intuition should not be depreciated. The idea is that, whilst we cannot perceive space or time through our senses, we intuit their existence via their contents.

Having established the reality of space and time, Alexander goes on to investigate their nature. The nature of space has long been a topic of philosophical enquiry, and from the seventeenth century there has been debate as to whether space is best described by relationism or substantivalism. Relationism holds that space is not an entity or substance of any kind – it would not be included in any list of the universe’s ingredients – it merely comprises the network of spatial relations that hold among material objects. In contrast, substantivalism holds that space is an entity or substance of some kind. Although historically this debate concerned space rather than spacetime, by the early twentieth century – motivated by the work of physicists such as Minkowski and Einstein, and philosophers such as Bergson – the debate was extended to apply to time as well as space. As Alexander puts it, the early twentieth century began to ‘Take Time Seriously’. In his discussion, Alexander takes himself to be choosing between relationism and substantivalism. He argues that while relationism is a legitimate view, it does not represent our direct, intuitional apprehension or experience of space or time. Having rejected relationism, Alexander turns to substantivalism.

The substantivalist can take one of two stances on the status of material (or immaterial) objects. Dualistic substantivalism holds that space and material objects coexist as distinct kinds of substances. Super-substantivalism holds that space is the only kind of substance, and matter is identical to it. Alexander assumes that, given the nature of spacetime as he understands it, super-substantivalism follows automatically. This is because, for Alexander, it is the very nature of spacetime to give rise to material objects. This is because spacetime is identified with ‘Motion’, and it is Motion which produces material objects. This identification is one of Alexander’s most fundamental claims, and unfortunately it is also one of the most obscure.

The identification has its roots in the fact that Alexander conceives of space and time not as independent substances but rather as interdependent ones. He gives us two arguments for this. Firstly, there is the argument from physics: physicists such as Minkowski and Einstein claim that space and time should now be considered as the four dimensional manifold spacetime. Secondly, there is Alexander’s difficult (and heavily criticised – see Broad) a priori argument. Essentially, Alexander argues that it is space which lends time continuity and variety: if time existed independently of space, time would consist of perishing instants, which would lack continuity and succession. Similarly, Alexander argues that it is time which gives space distinct parts: without time, space would consist of a sheer homogeneous blank without distinct parts. It is this second argument which leads Alexander to claim that time is the source of movement, and hence the source of motion. As time moves through space, it produces matter – variegated, continuous complexes of spacetime – in its process. ‘Space-Time is a system of motions, and we might call Space-Time by the name of Motion’.

Later in his system, Alexander describes how there is a ‘nisus’ in spacetime – a striving force – which carries its creatures upwards through the various levels of existence to the highest level of deity. Both spacetime and the nisus are creative: time introduces a restlessness into space that culminates in motion, and the nisus drives spacetime to produce ever newer forms of existence. It is not entirely clear what the relationship between spacetime and the nisus is supposed to be; there are two possible readings of Alexander on this issue. On the first reading, the nisus is the motion of spacetime. On the second reading, the nisus is an extra ingredient added to spacetime, which acts as a kind of organisational principle on the complexes of motion that emerge from spacetime. For more on this, see Emmet (1950).

Alexander’s identification of spacetime with ‘a single vast entity Motion’, along with his introduction of a nisus, provides the foundation for his entire ontology, for it is the many individual motions within Motion that constitute all other existents, from material objects to minds. And this is why Alexander is a super-substantivalist, rather than a dualistic substantivalist: it is the very nature of spacetime to produce the motions that are all other existents, and as such there is no need to even consider postulating another substance (such as matter, or mind) distinct from spacetime to explain their existence.

c. Qualities and Categories

For Alexander, existing things are continuously connected groupings of motions, connected through spacetime. These things, or motions, have characters, some of which are variable and some of which are pervasive. For example, the character of an apple is always substantial but it changes from red to brown. Pervasive characters are ‘categories’, and they apply in some form to all existents, from material objects to minds. In contrast, variable characters are ‘qualities’ – such as colour, shape or consciousness – that existents can have or not have.

The categories include identity, substance, universality, order, diversity, magnitude and number. The fact that these categories apply to all things is no coincidence: the categories are the fundamental properties of spacetime. For example, the categories of identity, diversity and existence arise out of the intrinsic nature of spacetime ‘as a continuum of parts’ which are themselves spaces and times. All things that exist are subject to the category of existence because they occupy spacetime, and that is what it is to exist. Similarly, all things that exist are self-identical and diverse from all other things because, as we saw above, time gives space distinct parts and vice versa. Existence, identity and diversity are but a few of the categories – there are many more. Two categories deserve a special mention. The first is that of substance, which for Alexander is any ‘contour of space’. For Alexander, all existents are substances – even a simple motion in a straight line – for all existents are subject to the categories. The second is whole and parts. Just as time and space break up into wholes of parts, so individual wholes within spacetime break up into parts. Alexander concludes that everything exhibits categorical features.

d. Emergence and Spacetime

Emergence is the notion that novel properties ‘emerge’ out of more fundamental properties or entities. In contemporary philosophy of mind, the notion is sometimes used to explain how consciousness emerges from brain. In addition to Alexander, emergentism has its primary roots in the work of early twentieth century British philosophers C. Lloyd Morgan and C. D. Broad. Part of the motivation underlying emergentism in the philosophy of mind is the desire to naturalise the mind yet acknowledge its novel nature. Alexander’s emergentist conception of the mind directly informs his super-substantivalism.

Alexander explicitly acknowledges his intellectual debt to Morgan for his emergent understanding of mind, explaining that he has even chosen the term ‘emergent’ after the example of Morgan. Morgan explains that emergence can be used to explain the ‘genuinely new’ things that sometimes occur in the process of Darwinian evolution. Alexander adapts this account for his own ends, arguing that experience leads us to connect our mental processes with our body, to locate our mental processes in the same places and times as certain neural processes. Alexander explains the correlation between mind and brain in virtue of the fact ‘they are not two but one’: conscious processes are neural processes. The idea is that once neural processes reach a certain level of development, the quality of mentality or consciousness is achieved. This quality of mental process is ‘something new, a fresh creation’, that emerges out of matter. Alexander is careful to emphasise that, as on Morgan’s conception, his conception of mind and brain is not a parallelism of two distinct entities but instead a species of identity doctrine: the mental process and its neural process are one and the same existence, not two existences. O’Connor and Wong argue that Alexander’s characterisation of emergentism – which they paraphrase as the claim that ‘Emergent qualities are novel qualities that supervene on a distinctive kind of physico-chemical process’ – is very close in detail to a standard form of non-reductive physicalism in contemporary philosophy of mind, wherein mind is identical but not reducible to the brain (O’Connor & Wong, 2009, 8).

Alexander conceives of nature as layered into a hierarchy of existents, ascending in complexity. For Alexander, it is not just the case that mind emerges from matter, matter also emerges from spacetime. His system can be illustrated as follows:

Levels of being Structure Quality
Space and time Motion
Matter Individual complexes of motion Corporeality
Organisms Physio-chemical processes Life
Man Body Consciousness
God The whole world Deity

Alexander’s strategy to realise this hierarchy is simple. He takes the idea of emergence as it applies to the mind and brain, and applies it to space and time. Just as mind and body are ‘indissoluble and identical’, so are space and time. The only way in which the analogy fails to hold is that our minds are a new quality which emerge from our bodies, whereas time is not a new quality that emerges from space. ‘Space and Time only exists with the existence of the other, and their relation is such as we might imagine that of mind and brain to be if neuro-mental processes could subsist by themselves without their presuppositions in a larger vital and hence in a physic-chemical world of things’. In connection to this thesis, Alexander famously claims that ‘Time is the mind of Space’. This does not mean that time is conscious in any way, it merely means that time performs the same function for space as mind does for the body. This function is that time allows new qualities (such as colour or consciousness) to emerge because time is the source of motion, and it is individual motions which have qualities. The fundamental level of nature is spacetime or motion, from which proceeds the individual motions which take on the emergent qualities of matter, life and mind. An important difficulty concerning Alexander’s application of mind-body emergence to the universe as a whole is raised by Emmet (1950). Emmet points out that when giving a general worldview in terms of an analogy drawn from a special field – in this case the psycho-physical relation –  it is surely necessary that the initial relation from which the analogy is drawn should itself be clearly understood. This particular relation is not at all clear – the relation between the body and mind is one of the most difficult problems of philosophy – and as such Emmet worries that Alexander’s whole project is an attempt to explain an obscurity using a further obscurity.

Alexander’s emergentism explains how it is that spacetime gives rise to matter, mind and life. All that is left on his system is to explain how spacetime gives rise to deity. Alexander offers us a metaphysical definition of God, whereby God is that which possesses ‘deity or the divine quality’. He then sets out to show us that, whilst mind or consciousness is the highest quality that we know of in the universe, deity is even higher. The nisus in spacetime will not cease with mind, it will bring its creatures forward to some higher level of existence. Deity has not yet emerged in the universe – ‘deity is not actual but ideal’ – but, as Alexander paraphrases Leibniz, the world is big with it. Alexander is careful to point out that this ideal emergent deity is distinct from spacetime itself, arguing that while spacetime can be intuited it cannot be worshiped. Alexander’s notion of deity is somewhat obscure. For example, it is not clear whether deity should emerge from one particular human consciousness, or from many.

5. Alexander and Spinoza

Whilst producing the metaphysical system expressed in Space, Time and Deity, Alexander was apparently unaware of the similarities between his system and that of Spinoza. His inspirations  were Plato and Kant, and Alexander only belatedly realised the import of Spinoza’s doctrines. However, once Alexander realised the resemblance, he took it very seriously, citing Hegel’s saying ‘that to be a philosopher a man must first be a Spinozaist’. Alexander produced two pieces exploring the connections between his system and that of Spinoza – Spinoza and Time (1921a) and “Lessons from Spinoza” (1928) – and he goes so far as to express his system as a ‘gloss’ of Spinoza. Alexander was impressed not just by Spinoza’s metaphysics but also by the way that Spinoza combined naturalism with a profound sense of religion and value. This is, of course, exactly the combination that Alexander had tried to produce himself.

In describing Alexander’s gloss of Spinoza, we will focus on Alexander’s interpretation of Spinoza (for alternative interpretations, see the main IEP article “Spinoza”). As described above (section 3.2) the seventeenth century philosophers took space seriously but they neglected time; Alexander aims to reinvent Spinoza’s system in light of his contemporary resolve to take time seriously. Alexander sets out to investigate the difference it would make to Spinoza’s philosophy if we were to assign to time a position not allowed to it by Spinoza himself, but suggested by the difficulties – and even obscurities – in it. Alexander understands Spinoza the following way. Spinoza holds that just one substance exists, which does not depend on anything else for its existence or explanation: everything that exists in nature is in God and are modifications of him. God can be apprehended through two attributes, thought and extension, which are but two forms of one and the same reality. Already the similarities between Alexander and Spinoza’s systems are emerging: both philosophers hold that there is one substance which is the ontological ground of the universe as a whole, and that this single substance is the ground of both matter and mind.

Alexander describes Spinoza’s conception of space and time as follows. Spinoza understands spatial extension as an attribute of God. When we speak of individual lengths or spaces we are confused – we are not dealing with reality, except of the imagination – because space (or extension) is really a partless God under a certain attribute. Individual spaces are contrasted with this divine attribute of space. Between God as perceived under the attribute of extension, and the finite extended modes which are spatial bodies, there are infinite modes – motion and rest – which ‘break the fall from Heaven to Earth’. It is these modes which break up the unity of God’s extension into a multiplicity, in the same way that time breaks up Alexander’s space into parts. Of course, Spinoza denies that God actually has parts, and Alexander argues that is one of the weaknesses of Spinoza’s system that the parts are submerged within the whole rather than conspiring in semi-independence towards it. This weakness aside, Alexander sets out to understand how the infinite modes break up the unity of God. He argues that Spinoza takes it as axiomatic that bodies are all either in motion or at rest –  in other words, bodies are complexes of motions – and that Spinoza believes this because extension expresses God’s essence, and as such is alive. Alexander finds this explanation for why bodies are axiomatically in motion or at rest unsatisfactory because life implies change, and change implies time, yet time is excluded from the nature of God who is merely timeless. As Alexander explains, Spinoza understands time very differently to space. For Spinoza, durations of time, even conceived of parts of an indefinite duration, are not real realities. Time (or duration) is not an attribute of God so individual times cannot be contrasted with it in the way that space as an attribute of God is contrasted with individual spaces.

Alexander aims to describe Spinoza’s system as it would be if Spinoza did accept time as an attribute of God, arguing that this would solve Spinoza’s unsatisfactory explanation of motion. In this ‘gloss’ of Spinoza, God’s extension should not be merely understood as spatial, but as spatio-temporal. In Alexander’s gloss, the ultimate reality is full of time, it is the theatre of constant change, such that reality is spacetime or motion itself. Alexander believes that this addition solves another problem in Spinoza, namely the apparent gulf between the divine substance and its modes: ‘there is now no ditch to jump between the ultimate ground of things and things in themselves; for things are… but complexes of motion and made of the stuff which the ultimate or a priori reality is’. Just as Alexander allows that individual existing things are not engulfed, but rather conserved, in his single substance, so Spinoza can allow the same. Just as spacetime is motion on Alexander’s system, and this creates novel substances such as matter and minds, so God is a ceaseless creator in Spinoza’s system.

A consequence of Alexander’s gloss is that the hierarchy of modes described in Spinoza’s system becomes a temporal, as well as a logical series. The highest level of this series that we are aware of is that of thinking things, which entails that thought is no longer an attribute of God but rather a quality of the highest level of existents. Time has displaced thought in Spinoza’s scheme. Furthermore, as the two attributes we have been discussing – space and time – can do everything that is needed to do on Spinoza’s scheme, there is no need to postulate any further attributes of God, known or otherwise. ‘Space and Time are seen to exhaust the attributes of reality’ (Alexander, 1921a). A further – and much more radical – consequence of Alexander’s gloss is that spacetime can no longer be identified with, or understood as an attribute, of God. This is because, as Alexander points out in his own system, spacetime cannot be an object of worship. In order to place deity within his gloss, Alexander looks to Spinoza’s conatus doctrine, according to which everything strives to persist in its being. Alexander argues that Spinoza understood the notion of conatus as a metaphysical conception, rather than a biological one, and consequently it is difficult to understand. This is because, for Alexander, the conatus doctrine is best illustrated in organic beings – where the plant or animal maintains its single individuality of being, abandoning it only to external violence or internal decay – although it can be found in inanimate stones or atoms as well: an atom persists in its being so far as the motions of its planetary system of electrons, moving round their central nucleus, are conserved. On Alexander’s gloss, the roots of the conatus doctrine are to be found in the restlessness of spacetime, which ‘falls of itself’ into the complexes of motion which are bodies; in turn these forms evolve into new orders of beings with new characters and their own conatus to persevere in their type. In accordance with his own system, Alexander gives this conatus a new name – ‘nisus’ – and it is this biological striving that we observe in organic bodies and atoms. This nisus also gives rise to a level of existence higher than minds, such that God becomes the world as a whole with a nisus towards deity.

In typically poetical style, Alexander describes the conclusion of his gloss of Spinoza as follows:

[If] the reality in its barest character is Space-Time, the face of the whole universe is the totality of all those configurations into which Space-Time falls through its inherent character of timefulness or restlessness… [the] stuff of reality is not stagnant, its soul’s wings are never furled, and in virtue of this unceasing movement it strikes out fresh complexes of movements, all created things (Alexander, 1921a).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Alexander, Samuel (1886) “Hegel’s Conception of Nature”. Mind Vol. 11, pp. 495-523.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1909)“Ptolemaic and Copernican views of the place of Mind in the Universe”. The Hibbert Journal Vol. VIII.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1912) “The Method of Metaphysics, and the Categories”. Mind Vol. 21, 1-20
  • Alexander, Samuel (1912) “On Relations; and in particular the Cognitive Relations”. Mind Vol. 21, 305-328.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1914)“The Basis of Realism”. Proceedings of the British Academy Vol. V, 279-314
  • Alexander, Samuel (1920i) Space, Time and Deity. Macmillan & Co Ltd: London.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1920ii) Space, Time and Deity. Macmillan & Co Ltd: London.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1921a) Spinoza and Time. Unwin Brothers, Ltd: GB.Alexander, Samuel (1921b) “Some Explanations”. Mind Vol. 30, pp. 409-428.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1928) “Lessons from Spinoza”. Chronicon Spinozanum Vol. 5, 14-29.
  • Alexander, Samuel (1939) Philosophical and Literary Pieces. Edited by John Laird. Macmillan & Co: Great Britain.
    • [Includes a memoir of Alexander by Laird]

b. Secondary Sources

  • Brettschneider, Betram (1964).The Philosophy of Samuel Alexander. Humanities Press: USA.
  • Broad, C. D. (1921). “Professor Alexander’s Gifford Lectures” [two parts] Mind Vol. 30.
    • [Critically discusses particular aspects of Alexander’s Space, Time & Deity, such as Alexander’s identification of spacetime and motion]
  • Emmet, Dorothy (1950). “Time is the mind of space”, Philosophy Vol. 25, pp. 225-234.
    • [Explains Alexander’s application of mind-body emergence to the universe as a whole]
  • Leighton, Joseph (1922). Man and the Cosmos. D. Appleton & Company: USA.
    • [Contains a limited summary of Alexander’s super-substantivalism]
  • McCarthy, John (1948). The Naturalism of Samuel Alexander. Macmillan & Co, Ltd: USA.
  • Murphy, Arthur E. (1927) “Alexander’s Metaphysic of Space-Time” [multiple parts]. The Monist, Vol, 38.
    • [Tackles particular issues in Space, Time & Deity such as Alexander’s theory of categories]
  • O’Connor, Timothy & Wong, Hung Yu (2009). “Emergent Properties” in Stanford Encyclopaedia of Philosophy.
    • [Discusses the history of British emergentism, including Alexander’s contribution]
  • Stiernotte, Alfred (1954). God and Space-Time. Philosophy Library: USA.
    • [Study of Alexander’s philosophy; contains detailed discussion of pantheism]
  • Thomas, Emily (2013). “Space, Time, and Samuel Alexander”. British Journal for the History of Philosophy 21: 549-569.
  • Weinstein, Michael (1984). Unity and Variety in the Philosophy of Samuel Alexander. Purdue University Press: USA.

 

Author Information

Emily Thomas
Email: aeet2@cam.ac.uk
Cambridge University
United Kingdom

Property

Concepts of property are used to describe the legal and ethical entitlements that particular people or groups have to use to manage particular resources. Beyond that most general definition of ‘property’ however, philosophical controversy reigns.

Political and legal philosophers disagree on what types of entitlements are essential elements of property, and on the shape and nature of the resultant property entitlements. Indeed, philosophers even disagree on whether it makes sense to talk, in abstraction from a specific legal context, of concepts of property at all. These theoretical controversies are mirrored in practice and law. Cases are determined and conflicts are resolved – or fomented, as the case may be – by the different ideas of property that claimants, judges, legislators and ordinary people recognise and deploy. These controversies are compounded when property concepts are used in application not only to the obvious cases of land and chattels (that is, movable items of property like chairs and cars), but to airspace, airwaves, inventions, information, corporate stock, reputations, fishing rights, brand names, labour, works of art and literature, and more.

Over the last century of political and legal thought, there have been two major – and very different –property-concepts: Bundle Theory and Full Liberal Ownership. Bundle Theory holds that property is a disparate ‘bundle’ of legal entitlements, or ‘sticks’ as they are metaphorically termed. What property a person holds in any given case is determined by the specific entitlements granted by the law to that person. According to Bundle Theory there is no prior idea of property that the law reflects, or that guides the adjudication of cases. The central reason supporting Bundle Theory is the dizzying diversity of property entitlements in law: applying to myriad sorts of resources, regulated in innumerable ways, subject to different sorts of taxation and differing across jurisdictions.

Other theorists, however, have argued that despite the complexity of certain cases of property in law, the idea of property carries genuine content across many contexts and jurisdictions – especially in application to land and chattels. Far from having no substance, the idea of Full Liberal Ownership gave property a detailed and comprehensive meaning: property includes the full gamut of rights to: (a) use the owned resource, (b) exclude others from entering it, and, (c)alienate it (that is, to sell it to someone else).

Yet if Bundle Theory can be faulted as being too nebulous to be correct, some property theorists have argued that Full Liberal Ownership falls into the opposite error, and is too simple and stringent to explain the lived detail of property entitlements. Rejecting both these theories, these theorists have developed diverging accounts of property, arguing that one feature or other – exclusion, use, power, immunity or remedy – is the essential hallmark of property.

This article surveys the major types of contemporary property theories, and the philosophical arguments offered in support of them. The nature of such property concepts carries consequences for the ethical justifications of various property regimes. Several of the more important consequences will be noted in this article, but not pursued in any detail.

Table of Contents

  1. Preliminaries
  2. Bundle Theory
  3. Full Liberal Ownership
  4. The General Idea of Private Property: The Integrated Theory
  5. Exclusion: Trespass-Based Theories
  6. Use: Harm-Based Theories
    1. Overlapping Property: Common and Resource Property Rights
  7. Power-Based Theories: The Question of Alienation
  8. Immunity-Based Theories
  9. Remedy-Based Theories
  10. Examples of Cross-Cutting Theories
    1. Radin and Property for Personhood
    2. Katz and Ownership as Agenda-Setting
  11. Socialist and Egalitarian Property
  12. References and Further Reading

1. Preliminaries

With his characteristic shrewdness, Nietzsche once observed that it is hard to define concepts that have a history. Whatever else may be said of it, property has a history; forms of private property in land date back at least ten millennia, and private property in chattels (movable objects of property like tools and clothes) was present in the Stone Age. With Nietzsche’s point in mind, then, three general remarks on property’s conceptual ambiguities are worth making.

First, the term ‘property’ may refer to the proprietorial entitlements of an owner (Bob has property in that car) or it may refer to the thing that is owned itself (That car is Bob’s property). Lawyers and philosophers tend to be wary of the latter use, primarily because it can distract attention from the significance of the entitlements involved. That is, if we speak about Bob’s car as being his property, then we might be inclined to think that property is all about Bob’s relation to his car, rather than being about the duties everyone owes Bob with respect to his car. If we say that Bob has property in his car, then it is a little clearer that property is about legal and ethical entitlements, and not merely about a physical thing.  That said however, using ‘property’ to refer only to entitlements and not to things carries the danger of forgetting that ordinary people and sometimes even lawmakers may be using the term in its second application (Wenar 1997). With this in mind, this article will use the term in both its meanings; context should at any point make clear which is intended.

Second, property comes in at least three different basic forms: private, collective and common. Private property grants entitlements to a resource to particular individuals, collective property vests them in the state, and common property enfranchises all members of a community. Most contemporary debate on the nature of property surrounds the concept of private property, and this will be the focus of the article. Reflecting this, the term ‘property’ typically will stand for private property, except in the specific sections dealing with common property and collective property (§ 6.1 and §11). Reference to one of these three types of property is often used to characterise types of economic and political regimes. For instance, liberalism may be characterised by private property, socialism by collective property, and certain forms of anarchism and communitarianism by the use of common property. However, it is important to be aware that such characterisations are made on the basis of the predominant form of property in the regime, as no regime relies exclusively on just one form of property. Certain resources seem to be more amenable to one type of property entitlement than another: air as common property, toothbrushes as private property, and artillery as collective property, for example.

Third, actual property entitlements – in law and custom alike – tend to be highly complex, so caution is advisable when philosophical (armchair) theories of property are used to characterise actual property entitlements. The effort to categorize and clarify can distort important features of property that lie within its complexities.

2. Bundle Theory

Bundle Theory is not so much a property-concept as it is the idea that ‘property’ is not really a proper concept at all. Bundle Theory states that there is no pre-existing, well-defined and integrated concept of property that guides – or should guide – our understanding of property-entitlements, or the creation or interpretation of property-entitlements in law. Instead, the law grants specific entitlements of people to things. The property that a person holds in any given instance is simply the sum total of the particular entitlements the law grants to her in that situation. These particular entitlements are metaphorically termed ‘sticks’, and the property that a person holds is thus the particular bundle of sticks the law grants to them in the given instance. Changes to law can alter property entitlements by adding or removing particular sticks from the bundle. Also, several people may have property-entitlements in one resource, as the sticks are spread amongst them, each person with his own bundle. In such cases, Bundle Theory says, it is meaningless to try to determine who the real owner is; each person simply has the entitlements the law grants to them.

There are three main arguments for Bundle Theory. The first argument is conceptual and dates back to Wesley Hohfeld’s path-breaking analysis of rights. Hohfeld (1913) argued that entitlements in law could be broken down into their constituent parts – the basic building-blocks of which more complex legal entitlements are constructed. He termed these basic entitlements ‘jural relations’. In all, Hohfeld described eight jural relations, four of which are important for our purposes here:

Liberty/Privilege: Person A has a liberty to do X with respect to another person B when A has no duty to B not to do X. For example, in an ordinary case Annie will have a liberty (with respect to some other beach-goer Bob) to swim at a public beach if she is not under any duty to Bob not to swim at the beach.

Claim-right: Person A has a claim on another person B to do X when B is under a duty owed to A to perform X. For instance, Annie has a claim-right that Bob not hit her – a claim that correlates with Bob’s duty to refrain from hitting Annie.

Power: Person A has a power over person B with respect to X when A can alter B’s liberties and claim-rights with respect to X. For instance, when Annie alters Bob’s liberties by waiving her claim-right that he not kiss her, she exercises her power to dissolve Bob’s prior duty and so to grant him a liberty. Promising, waiving and selling are all examples of using powers because they all involve the agent in question altering in some way the duties of other people.

Immunity: Person A has an immunity against a person B with respect to X if B cannot alter A’s claims or liberties with respect to X. For instance, if Annie has an immunity against Bob with respect to her freedom of association, then Bob cannot impose new duties on her to refrain from associating (with Charles, say).

Powers and immunities are sometimes called ‘second-order’ jural relations, because they modify or protect first-order jural relations like liberties and claims-rights. For example, when Annie waives (that is, gives up or relinquishes) Bob’s duties not to kiss her, she uses a second-order jural relation (a power) to create in Bob a first-order jural relation (a liberty). As Hohfeld argued, any given right may be broken down into these common denominators – these liberties, claims, immunities and powers. In particular, upon analysis, property may be so divided. Property usually contains some liberties (e.g. to use and possess), some claim-rights (e.g. that others not trespass), some immunities (e.g. that others cannot simply dissolve their duties not to trespass) and some powers (e.g. to sell the owned object). Hohfeld’s analysis demonstrated that property was not as simple an idea as it might first appear. Contrary to popular opinion, property was not a relationship with a thing, but a myriad of jural relations with an indefinite number of other people with respect to a thing. It was not itself a simple entitlement, but rather a consolidated entitlement made up of more simple constituents.

Hohfeld’s analysis did not require adopting the Bundle Theory thesis that there was no integrity or determinate content to the concept of property. One could, as many have since done, hold that property was a specific group of certain sorts of Hohfeldian jural relations. However, Hohfeld’s system laid the conceptual groundwork for Bundle Theory’s stance. Once property could be conceptually dissected into its constituent parts, the door was open for the disintegration of the concept itself. The positive reason for performing such disintegration was supplied by the second argument for Bundle Theory: the complexity of actual proprietorial entitlements in law.

At least by the arrival of the twentieth century, if not much earlier, property entitlements had become enormously complex. Property entitlements were applied to myriad different entities: to airspace, airwaves, inventions, information, fugacious resources (flowing resources like water and oil), riparian land (land bordering rivers), fisheries, wild animals, broadcast rights, mining rights, brand names, labour, works of art and literature, corporate stock, options, reputations, and so on and on. It was difficult to believe that the same cluster of Hohfeldian jural relations were enjoyed by holders of property over all these diverse resources. Furthermore, all of these sorts of property were subject to a wide variety of regulation and taxation measures, all of which might change from country to country, if not state to state. Worse still, many types of property had multiple persons with separate proprietorial entitlements in them; trusts, easements, and common property entitlements all allowed many people to have property in the one resource. While there may have been sense in using a determinate, integrated idea of property in the eighteenth century, it was argued, such a simplistic notion was outmoded (Grey 1980). Faced with the breathtaking variety of existing proprietorial entitlements, the sensible response was to abandon talk of ‘property’ altogether and refer directly to the specific Hohfeldian jural relations – the particular bundle of sticks – held by a given person in a given instance.

The third argument for Bundle Theory’s proposed disintegration of property is an explicitly normative one: that is, it derives from political and ethical theory. Those advocating an integrated idea of property tended to be drawn toward a very strong notion of property: Full Liberal Ownership (see §3 below). This concept of property appeared to leave precious little space for taxation or rates, and so seemed to present a potentially powerful obstacle to the usual schemes for funding basic state institutions, developing public goods, or alleviating poverty. Similarly, Full Liberal Ownership conflicted with state regulation of property, and so opposed environmental limitations on the use of land. With such concerns in mind, some property theorists concluded that any defensible proprietorial entitlements must be fashioned in accord with social justice and environmental commitments, rather than determined by a prior declaration of the essential nature of property (Singer 2000; Freyfogle 2003). Property entitlements are a product of policy and legislation, it was argued, not a conceptual or normative force guiding it. If this is right, then Bundle Theory is a more accurate depiction of the proper nature of property.

For conceptual, descriptive and normative reasons, then, Bundle Theory aimed to disintegrate the concept of property. In its thinking, the state should decide which entitlements to confer on an individual in any given case; that bundle of sticks thereafter constitutes the property that individual holds. There is no prior concept of property determining its bounds.

3. Full Liberal Ownership

If Bundle Theorists had expected the idea of property to fall into disuse however, they were mistaken; the idea of property continued to be invoked in lay, legal and theoretical discourse. Indeed, ordinary people seemed to be able to use their rough-and-ready ideas of property to workably navigate their way through the complex legal world around them. With such considerations as these in mind, philosophers and legal commentators increasingly began to question Bundle Theory’s disintegration of the concept. While the complexity and flexibility of property in some exotic applications could not be questioned, in other more familiar applications it appeared to have an adequate consistency. This was particularly true with respect to chattels like umbrellas, toothbrushes and cars. Far from having no content, it was observed, property entitlements to such objects displayed a profound homogeneity across jurisdictions and political regimes.

Emerging out of this literature, but with countless historical forebears, was a comprehensive concept of property: Full Liberal Ownership. The ringing tones of legal theorist William Blackstone in his 1776 Commentaries on the Laws of England are often used to encapsulate Full Liberal Ownership. In the opening lines of the second book Blackstone declares property to be:

that sole and despotic dominion which one man claims and exercises over the external things of the world, in total exclusion of the right of any other individual in the universe.

Less poetically, but rather more informatively, in 1961 the legal scholar A. M. Honoré set down what he viewed as the eleven ‘standard incidents’ of ownership:

  1. The right to possess: to have exclusive physical control of a thing;
  2. The right to use: to have an exclusive and open-ended capacity to personally use the thing;
  3. The right to manage: to be able to decide who is allowed to use the thing and how they may do so;
  4. The right to the income: to the fruits, rents and profits arising from one’s possession, use and management of the thing;
  5. The right to the capital: to consume, waste or destroy the thing, or parts of it;
  6. The right to security: to have immunity from others being able to take ownership of (expropriating) the thing;
  7. The incident of transmissibility: to transfer the entitlements of ownership to another person (that is, to alienate or sell the thing);
  8. The incident of absence of term: to be entitled to the endurance of the entitlement over time;
  9. The prohibition on harmful use: requiring that the thing may not be used in ways that cause harm to others;
  10. Liability to execution: allowing that the ownership of the thing may be dissolved or transferred in case of debt or insolvency; and,
  11. Residuary character: ensuring that after everyone else’s entitlements to the thing finish (when a lease runs out, for example), the ownership returns to vest in the owner.

With one modification, this list conveys the now popular idea of Full Liberal Ownership. The modification is the rejection by later property theorists of Incident Nine, the prohibition on harmful use. While it is of course agreed that an owner may not use her property in ways that harm others, most theorists see this constraint as a reflection of a prior and ongoing duty all people have not to harm others, and so as not a feature of property per se.

Honoré’s comprehensive listing of these incidents does not in itself confute Bundle Theory. Indeed, as it turned out, Honoré’s list proved a helpful resource for Bundle Theorists; it usefully described the types of sticks that may or may not be present in a proprietor’s bundle. A proprietor may have the incident of income, but not the incident of management, for example, or vice versa. Yet two points can be made about Honoré’s list that do challenge Bundle Theory.

The first point is conceptual: while modifications in many cases may occur, Honoré’s list showed it was possible for there to be a ‘standard case’ of property. His list of incidents was not asserted to be a strict definition of property, demarcating its necessary-and-sufficient conditions. Rather, it outlined the basic features of the concept of property in a manner evocative of Wittgenstein’s idea of ‘family resemblance’. Even if Bundle Theory was right that there was no strict essence of property, the concept nevertheless displayed an array of central characteristics by which it could be recognized and utilized. Furthermore, with this standard set down, other more esoteric types of property could be modeled upon it by analogy.

The second point is the actual existence, in law and custom, of the full complement of Honoré’s property-incidents, in chattels at least, in many places across the globe. As Honoré argued with respect to umbrellas; and others did similarly with respect to automobiles and other moveables, property in such items very often amounts to Full Liberal Ownership. In application to chattels at least, there is – contrary to the claims of Bundle Theory – a striking consistency in the meaning of property.

Even with these two points acknowledged, however, Full Liberal Ownership has seemed to many theorists an overly comprehensive account of private property. While it may be difficult to deny the consistency in proprietorial entitlements over chattels, the problem cases put forward by Bundle Theory remain. Indeed, recent work on common property rights (such as the shared right to hunt a local wood, or fish a local stream) has expanded the array of property cases that struggle to fit the individualist Full Liberal Ownership mould. Likewise, the tension between the requirements of Full Liberal Ownership and political commitments to social justice and environmental sustainability are as relevant as ever. Indeed, the oft-cited declaration of Blackstone above – when set in the context of his famous Commentaries themselves – draws our attention to both the intuitive appeal of Full Liberal Ownership and its surprisingly limited application in the real world in the face of environmental problems and issues of social justice. For as any reader of the Commentaries quickly discovers, Blackstone’s book on property teems with all manner of exotic and overlapping proprietorial rights – in fishing, hunting, travel, foraging, pasturing, recreation and digging for turf or peat. Full Liberal Ownership hardly makes an appearance in the Commentaries even as an ideal type. In the last analysis, then, Full Liberal Ownership seems to be honored more in the breach than in the observance.

Much of the recent work in property theory can be seen as an attempt to navigate between the two poles of Full Liberal Ownership and Bundle Theory, aiming to provide an account that preserves the conceptual integrity of the former while allowing some of the descriptive and normative flexibility of the latter.

There are a variety of theoretical options open to the property theorist attempting such navigation. They may adopt a broader concept of property and then envisage Full Liberal Ownership as one conceptualization (that is, specification) of that larger idea (Waldron 1985). They may adopt a continuum concept of property, where ownership sits as the limit case at the very top of a spectrum of property entitlements, with lesser entitlements located further down the spectrum (Harris 1996). Or they may advance additional concepts of property that sit alongside ownership and aim to cover the cases it is perceived to miss (Breakey 2011). Perhaps the commonest response, however, is simply to relax a strict necessary-and-sufficient-conditions reading of Honoré’s incidents, and consider the usual elements located within the general idea of property.

4. The General Idea of Private Property: The Integrated Theory

Taking a broader perspective than Honoré, many contemporary property theorists accept a three-part approach to property. The general idea of private property, it is held, consists of the following three elements:

Exclusion: others may not enter or use the resource;

Use: the owner is free to use and consume the resource;

Management and Alienation: the owner is free to manage, sell, gift, bequeath or abandon the resource.

On this account, property owners are expected to have some level of each of these three types of entitlements. Full Liberal Ownership will emerge as the limit case of private property, arising when a property-holder has the maximum possible entitlement on the three dimensions of exclusion, use and alienation. Lesser types of property are still possible, provided they contain some threshold amount of these three elements.

This view is thus less absolutist and less comprehensive than Full Liberal Ownership; private property may be regulated or taxed, yet it still displays the signature properties of exclusion, use and alienability—it remains property. Equally though, this concept of property – Integrated Theory, as some have called it – departs from Bundle Theory by viewing property as a consolidated concept (Mossoff 2003). Whether we express property’s entitlements under the three categories of exclusion, use and alienation, or through Hohfeld’s jural relations or Honoré’s incidents, the thought is that its components integrate together to create a united sum that is larger than its parts. Contrary to the claims of Bundle Theory, it is argued, property is a larger, organic whole; the elements of property are not easily detached one from another, and a legal regime cannot simply pick and choose from them at will. Use, exclusion and alienation fit together like three pieces of a puzzle.

In what ways does Integrated Theory hold the elements of property to be conceptually linked? Expressing these conceptual links in terms of Honoré’s incidents, it seems reasonable to think that use includes and requires possession, and that management includes both of these. After all, one cannot manage a property without being able to use it, and one cannot use it without being able to enter it or hold it. Furthermore, income in the form of fruits, rents and profits seems to be a natural result of a property-holder gaining the benefits of possession, use and management respectively (Attas 2007). Likewise, immunities from expropriation are linked to all these incidents. One can’t manage or gain income from a resource if others can simply dissolve all one’s entitlements to it and use it for free.

As such, it is no easy matter for a property bundle on the one hand to include management and on the other to exclude income or immunity. The point may be argued similarly with respect to Hohfeld’s jural relations. While it is, strictly speaking, conceptually possible to distinguish between claim-rights against other’s trespass, liberties of use, and powers of management, it seems fair to say that such relations nevertheless sit very naturally alongside one another. It is difficult to understand what the point would be of having just one of these entitlements without having one or both of the others (Merrill 1998). (This inter-linkage explains, after all, why Hohfeld’s analysis was so groundbreaking, and why law students often struggle to grasp it: ordinary language naturally bunches together the elements that Hohfeld carefully distinguished.) As such, the disintegrated notion of property conjured up by Bundle Theory appears misleading. Analogizing to physics, while it might be true that atoms are made up of protons, neutrons and electrons, this does not mean that it is advisable to try splitting them into these component parts, or that it is possible to reconfigure them in any given alternative arrangement.

Even if it is accepted that there are deep conceptual and practical ties between the elements of property, however, the question may still arise: Which, if any, of the three elements above is the quintessential mark – the essential feature – of property? As the next several sections explain, many property theorists have departed from the Integrated Theory in holding that the essence of property is one or other of the three elements of exclusion, use and alienability – and some property theorists have looked even further afield. The question is not merely a theoretical one. The law often needs to determine whether a given regulation is or is not a violation of the property right – whether it is, for instance, a taking in respect of the Fifth Amendment of the United States Constitution. For such purposes, the question of the essence of property is pivotal. Is it found within exclusion, use, powers of alienation, or some further element?

5. Exclusion: Trespass-Based Theories

As Blackstone’s talk of ‘total exclusion’ suggests, perhaps the most intuitive answer to the question of property’s essence is the right to exclude.

Without question, the notion of exclusion captures an important aspect of most property entitlements: namely, the privileged relationship that one person has (or sometimes a group of people have) to a resource, as compared to other non-property-holders. It is not only the case that the property-holder can prohibit others from engaging with the owned resource, but also that the property-holder is themselves entitled to engage with that resource without requiring the say-so of any other person. The idea of one person excluding others helpfully captures this one-rule-for-me/one-rule-for-everyone-else feature of property entitlements.

Even so, it is important to clarify what is meant by the ‘right to exclude’. In the context of property theory, ‘exclude’ is ambiguous. In the literature it is possible to find the idea of exclusion being applied willy-nilly to very different entities—to resources, activities, values, interests and even to the property right itself (Merrill 1998). Predictably, the term shifts somewhat in meaning in each of these different applications, at times meaning little more than ‘prohibit’, while at others meaning protection from harm, or protection from interference, or protection from trespass or loss in value. These are all distinct notions, and many of them are applicable not only to property rights, but also to many ordinary rights that are not usually spoken of in either proprietorial or exclusionary terms. (Many rights protect a person from harm, for example, but that does not make them property rights.) In shifting from one use of ‘exclude’ to another, it is possible to create a misleading impression that property-entitlements are more consistent across contexts than in fact they are.

The plainest meaning of a ‘right to exclude’, and the one adopted by most Exclusion Theorists, refers to the physical crossing by a person of a physical boundary – it refers, that is, to the idea of trespass. On this footing, it is the essence of property to have a right to exclude others from entering one’s land or possessing one’s chattels – or, to put the point more precisely and technically, it is the essence of property to have a Hohfeldian claim-right constituted by others’ duties to exclude themselves from the resource (Penner 1997). Put more simply, property implies that there is a boundary around the border of the owned entity that non-owners may not cross without the consent of the property-holder.

This does not mean non-owners cannot use or impact upon the resource if they are able to do so without actually entering or possessing it. For instance, the duty to exclude oneself from a garden does not mean that one cannot enjoy looking upon it on one’s way to work. Nor does it mean that one cannot pick up some tips for one’s own gardening endeavours from appreciation of its arrangement. In this respect Exclusion Theory’s focus on physical border-crossing parallels closely the way property-cases are often decided in law. As Lord Camden put it in the eighteenth century, ‘the eye cannot by the laws of England be guilty of a trespass’; that is, one can trespass with one’s feet or with one’s hands, but not merely by looking and listening. Equally however, the focus on border-crossing allows the possibility that a person can impact negatively on another’s property provided one does not enter onto it. For instance, Annie’s pumping out the groundwater on her property may cause Bob’s land to collapse, but Annie has not breached any duty to exclude herself from physically entering Bob’s property. The law on such questions tends to be more equivocal—in some jurisdictions it will determine that Annie’s action violated Bob’s property-right, but in other jurisdictions it will not. Even still, it is unquestionably true that harms which involve physical trespass are treated in law very differently, and usually more harshly, than harms which do not. As such, Exclusion Theory rightly directs attention to property’s allocation of specific resources to specific individuals, and the usefulness of physical encroachment as a trigger for legal action.

Several critiques may be made of Exclusion Theory. On a theoretical and normative level, some have argued that the focus on exclusion deflects attention from the way exclusion integrates with the more fundamental idea of use (Mossoff 2003). In a sense, Exclusion Theory can be thought of as a theory of non-ownership: it focuses on what property means for those who do not have it, rather than for those who do (Katz 2008). Equally though, a defender of the theory may argue that Exclusion Theory rightly places attention on the element of property that most cries out for justification—its imposition of constraining duties on everyone but the property-holder. In this respect, it is arguable that Exclusion Theory helpfully expresses a widespread and important moral norm of inviolability – the idea that some things are off-limits to people (Balgandesh 2008).

On a descriptive level, the question may be raised whether the right to exclude accurately captures the idea of property at work in applications outside the simple cases of land and chattels. This is particularly true with respect to property over intangibles, including intellectual property rights like copyright and patent, which grant entitlements over created artistic works and inventions. In such cases, Exclusion Theory’s usual reliance on the natural boundaries of the thing (the physical borders of the chattel or the land) and the notion of physical crossing apply less straightforwardly, and much controversy surrounds whether the theory manages to account for these sorts of intellectual properties. Even in application to real property, however, there are entitlements that Exclusion Theory can struggle to explain. For instance, exclusion does not seem to be a primary element of property in cases where multiple persons have overlapping properties in the one resource. Plainly, none of them can exclude each other, yet they all seem to have property.

6. Use: Harm-Based Theories

Rather than focusing on exclusion, attention may be directed at property’s capacity to protect particular uses of, and activities performed upon, a given resource. On this perspective – which might be termed Harm Theory – the essence of a property-right in some resource is not to prohibit others from trespassing across the resource’s boundaries, but instead to prohibit others from harming certain of the property-holder’s uses of the resource. These protected uses may in some cases be very specific, as occurs with fishing rights or mining rights. Or the protected uses may include a wide cluster of activities—for instance as may be gathered under the idea of protecting an owner’s quiet enjoyment of his land. The ancient property law of sic utere tuo (use your own so as to do no harm to others) may be invoked here: rather than Annie simply respecting the boundaries of Bob’s land by not crossing them, she is required to ensure that her use of her property does not harm Bob’s use of his (Freyfogle 2003). Rather than trespass, the focus shifts to notions of harm, nuisance, interference and worsening. To be sure, these concepts will often overlap with trespass, but they are not identical. There are many cases where protection of an activity from harm or interference will not require – or will require more than – rules against crossing a physical boundary.

In this respect, Harm Theory differs on practical matters from Exclusion Theory in two sets of cases. First, it will not consider boundary-crossing to be a necessary violation of the property right. The question, rather, will be whether the boundary crossing was in some sense harmful to the property-holder, given the use or set of uses to which that property holder is putting the property. If the boundary-crossing was not detrimental to the property-holder’s project, then there is ‘no-harm, no-foul’. In this first case, the duties imposed by Harm Theory are less extensive than Exclusion Theory, as some cases of boundary-crossing will not be violations of the right. Second, however, the Harm Approach will protect the earmarked uses even from the harmful actions of others who do not cross the property-boundary. As such, Annie pumping out groundwater that causes Bob’s property to collapse, or Annie building structures that block sunlight from Bob’s solar array, or Annie blocking access-ways to Bob’s property, or Annie flooding Bob’s property by damming the creek on Annie’s property, may all be violations of Bob’s property rights. In this second set of cases, the duties imposed by Harm Theory are more extensive than those created by Exclusion Theory, as they reach out to affect others operating outside the property’s borders.

Descriptively, Harm Theory can account for the many cases of apparent trespass – boundary-crossing even against the explicit will of the property-holder – that are not held to be legal violations of the property right because they were not deemed to be harmful to the property-holder’s activities (Katz 2008). In response however, the Exclusion Theorist can marshal example cases in law where trespass was prioritized over harm, and it is not easy to perceive a clear victor in this debate. However, the Harm Theorist does have one, perhaps not-so-minor, area where their account is clearly descriptively superior; this is in respect of overlapping property rights.

a. Overlapping Property: Common and Resource Property Rights

Rights to a common resource – where everyone in a given community can use the resource – come in a variety of different forms. Two are worth considering here. First, there are open access regimes, where all persons can access the resource and either: a) there are no constraints on what they may do on or with that resource, or, b) there are constraints, but these constraints allow space for people to worsen the resource in respect of the uses they and others put the resource to. Fisheries are often examples of open access regimes; everyone in the community may have the right to access and to fish in the local lake, but their unrestrained fishing ultimately impacts detrimentally on the capacity of the lake to provide fish. As Garret Hardin famously showed in The Tragedy of the Commons, in such a situation rational agents may be expected to exploit the resource to the detriment of everyone (Hardin 1968).

In at least some cases, however, communities are able to develop constraints on each person’s uses of the resource so as to ensure the resource sustains its capacity for the specified uses over long periods of time (Ostrom 1990). Sometimes these systems may be quite simple, such as the rules that determine how parks, beaches and wildlife-reserves operate, allowing all citizens access and enjoyment without destroying the resource for others. When a common resource factors in production, however, a heavier toll is taken on the resource, and more sophisticated systems are usually required to ensure its sustainability. For instance, a community may adopt a ‘wintering rule’ with respect to pasturing their cows on a commons, such that no member can pasture more cows during the summer than they can feed off their own supplies through the winter. By capping herd-numbers in this way, the commons can be protected from over-exploitation. These sort of constraints may be thought of as protecting certain uses from the harmful acts of others, and so as a species of harm-based property entitlements. One recent account of such entitlements understands common property as ‘property-protected activities’ occurring on specific tethered resources. Such property-protection includes four types of property incidents: (i) the entitlement of the property-holder to access the resource, (ii) the entitlement to use the resource for the specific activity in question (e.g. fishing, foraging), (iii) the ownership of the fruits or profits of that activity, and (iv) the claim-rights over other users that they do not worsen (harm) the resource in respect of the specific property-protected activity (Breakey 2011).

Such harm-based accounts also aim to explain the many cases of multiple property entitlements in a single resource where such overlapping entitlements are not spread across the entire community. For example, one family in a community may have foraging rights for fruit in a local common, several families may have hunting rights, and everyone in the community may have the right to gather firewood. So long as there are effective constraints on each activity ensuring that it does not harm the others, the regime is not one of open-access, but a species of property. Again, Harm Theory can make sense of these properties by focusing not on trespass over physical boundaries (as Exclusion Theory does) but rather on the ongoing protection of certain specific uses of the tethered resource.

Normatively, one of the advantages of Harm Theory is that it tightly links the concept of property to some of the more popular ethical justifications for property rights. For instance, if property is intended to be justified because it allows people to do things—to perform ongoing productive or preserving projects over time, and to more generally reap the consequences of their actions, then one might think that the primary focus should be on protecting those projects from harm. As such, protecting people’s labour (with John Locke) or their expectations about the fruits of their labour (with Jeremy Bentham) brings harm, and not exclusion, to the foreground.

Inevitably however, Harm Theory invites its own particular critiques. First, the legal protection of some uses and not others makes Harm Theories of property explicitly political in a way that Exclusion Theory for the most part avoids. On the Harm Theory, property is not neutral among the different acts property-holders might want to perform, but necessarily selects amongst them. Exclusion Theory, on the other hand, merely sets up boundaries and lets owners decide what to do within them. Second, this privileging of use threatens to derail the idea (and enormous practical utility, in terms of information costs) of property as an integrated concept consistent across contexts; a ‘bundle of uses’ may be little improvement on a ‘bundle of entitlements’ (Merrill and Smith 2001). Third, and perhaps most seriously, the fixed and specific uses (or sets of uses) that property-holders are entitled to engage in seems to depart from a very basic and intuitive thought about private property, which is that it is for the owner to decide what will happen on their property, and that their choices on this matter are to some extent genuinely open-ended. Harm Theory delimits which acts will be property-protected, and so constrains – in some cases very considerably – a property-holder’s capacity to determine what will happen on the property. As such, it may be that Harm Theory can only augment, but cannot hope to replace, rival theories of property like Exclusion Theory.

Ultimately it may be that property should be best understood as a mix of the Exclusion and Harm Theories, whereby both trespass and harm should be factored into our larger concept of property. One obvious reason for adopting this sort of mixed theory is that protecting against trespass often will be the most effective way of protecting against harm; it is far easier to detect trespassers than harmers (Ellickson 1993). This mixed view is also reflected in much legal case-law, where notions of trespass and boundary (from Exclusion Theory) interweave amongst notions of nuisance, quiet enjoyment and do-no-harm (from Harm Theory). If this combination of the two theories is correct, however, this would be an important conceptual result, because it introduces a tension into the very heart of property (Singer 2000; Freyfogle 2003). It means that in at least some cases we cannot know a priori (that is, simply from application of the concept of property) whether a property-holder or a non-property holder is entitled to perform a particular act until we settle the question of what uses are being protected from harm, what happens when two protected uses clash, and whether harm will trump trespass in this particular case.

7. Power-Based Theories: The Question of Alienation

The two theories just covered – Exclusion and Harm – share a common focus on what are called ‘first-order Hohfeldian jural relations’ (see §2 above). In particular, their dispute surrounds which types of claim-rights are held by property-owners, where the choice is between claim-rights prohibiting others from trespassing, or claim-rights prohibiting others from harming. But it is arguable that this dispute misplaces altogether the unique nature of property in terms of its second-order Hohfeldian jural relations, especially ‘powers’ (the capacity to alter others’ claim-rights with respect to the owned resource).

It has long been held by political philosophers of very different stripes that it is the quintessential mark of property that it can be traded in a marketplace. Courts of law have made similar judgments, recognizing an entitlement as property once it is established that the entitlement is tradable. Such rights of trade – as well as associated powers of waiver, management and abandonment – are second-order Hohfeldian powers, allowing an owner to alter the normative standing of others with respect to the resource. On the Power Theory, as it might be termed, to know whether a particular right is property, the decisive question to ask is whether it can be traded for money; Annie’s property essentially involves Annie having the power to altogether transfer (alienate) her rights over the resource to Bob, so that Bob becomes the property-holder, and Annie loses her property-rights with respect to that resource. Moreover, Annie can perform this alienation on condition of a like alienation by Bob, such that they trade property, or exchange property for money. On this view, an item of property is necessarily tradable, and so necessarily a commodity. As such, if a society has property rights then it necessarily has to some extent a market economy (at least with respect to those objects over which property is held).

While many theorists and laypeople view the relationship between property and commodity as simply intuitive, others mount arguments aiming to tie the two together theoretically. For instance, it may be argued that accounts of property need to pay heed to the fact that Bob’s duties with respect to Annie’s property are owed to Annie and not to society at large, and that allowing Annie to alienate those duties as she sees fit is a necessary implication of the fact that the duties are owed to her (Dorfman 2010). This line of thought on property rights may be bolstered by appeal to the ‘will/choice theory of rights,’ which holds that it is of the essence of rights more generally to be waivable and transferable (Steiner 1994). If the power to make choices over the duties others owe to us is an essential feature of rights in general, then it is plausible to think that it will also be a feature of property rights more particularly.

Against this proposed assimilation of property with commodity, however, many property theorists have argued that the essence of property need not include full powers of alienation and that there are attractive, integrated concepts of property without this element. Examples of property concepts explicitly avoiding alienation include the idea of personal property—familiar from both socialist theory and practice. Personal property may be characterized as property that cannot be sold, but which can be licensed out (Radin 1982). Other subtle variations are possible, allowing some forms of alienation and waiver, but not others. For instance, it has been argued that the concept of property necessarily allows for bequeathal and gift but does not necessarily include the power of sale. On this view, a property-holder can always give away her property or leave it to her children; to sell the property, however, requires the additional concept of contract (Penner 1997). Another variation holds that the concept of property includes the capacity for certain types of trade, but not the entitlement to receive income from managing the property (Christman 1991). A further variation again – one common in both law and custom – is the ‘classic usufruct’, where the property is held until the death of the property-holder, but cannot be transferred during their lifetime (Ellickson 1993).

One challenge arising for such accounts is that it is hard to draw a conceptual line in the sand between the types of Hohfeldian powers a property-holder does and does not have. Almost everyone will agree, for instance, that property-rights include the power of waiver – that is, that Annie is able to consent to Bob entering her land by waiving Bob’s duties of non-trespass. But it can be difficult to see how Annie can have a power of waiver without thereby having the power to manage; the capacity to consent to another person’s entry onto the property under stipulated conditions effectively allows the property-holder to manage what happens on the property. But from there, it is difficult to see how Annie can have the power of management without also having rights to income, as she can make one of the stipulated conditions for Bob’s entry onto the property that she receives some of what Bob produces. Similarly, it can be difficult to draw a strong distinction between Annie being able to give away her property at her discretion, and her being able to transfer it for money.

To be sure, this difficulty in specifying exactly which Hohfeldian powers of transfer are essential incidents of property is not impossible to overcome—and certainly neither law nor custom has any problem allowing some powers of transfer and prohibiting others (Ellickson 1993). But the existence of the difficulty does suggest that all these powers sit on a continuum, and that when crafting an integrated, coherent property-concept, the absence of a clear distinction between these powers at any given point has led different theorists to draw the line in quite different – and sometimes enormously subtle – places. Perhaps all this difficulty implies is that when seeking integrated property concepts, the conceptual linkages between Honoré’s incidents and between Hohfeld’s jural relations mean that such categories should not be relied upon to provide the desired boundaries. With this in mind, §10 below describes two theories of property that cut across the dimensions described by Honoré’s and Hohfeld’s systems. Alternatively, another response is to make property’s powers a continuum concept. An example of this idea is J. W. Harris’ theory of property (Harris 1996). For Harris, property has two necessary elements: trespassory rules (familiar from the Exclusion Theory described above in §5) and the ownership spectrum. The ownership spectrum is a continuum ranging from personal use-privileges to control-powers allowing management and – at the very top of the spectrum – full alienation. Harris is then able to specify distinct types of property – half property, mere-property, and full-blooded ownership – as residing at distinct points on this ownership spectrum.

8. Immunity-Based Theories

An additional type of second-order Hohfelidan jural relation is implicated in property. Rather than focusing concern on how Annie can alter others’ duties with respect to the property (the question of powers), attention may be turned to the manner in which Annie is protected from having her standing with respect to the property altered by others (the question of immunity).

Some degree of immunity is an essential element of property. If Annie has an entitlement to a resource that can be dissolved merely by Bob’s say-so, then it seems fair to say that Annie does not have property in that resource, but only some lesser entitlement. More specifically, if Annie holds property over Blackacre, then her neighbor Bob cannot, without Annie’s consent, transfer the ownership of Blackacre to himself; Bob cannot expropriate Blackacre. As such, some degree of immunity from the non-consensual dissolution of a property-holder’s entitlements over her owned resource appears to be a necessary condition of property.

Interestingly, the seventeenth century political philosopher John Locke took seriously the possibility that an immunity from expropriation was a sufficient condition for property. He thought that any entitlement that could not be removed by others counted as property, defining property as ‘that without a man’s own consent it cannot be taken from him.’ Such a position accounts for the very wide concept of property that Locke used at various points throughout his famous Two Treatises on Government. Since many ordinary rights (such as to free speech and bodily security) are immunized from others’ dissolution, advancing such an immunity as a sufficient condition of property means that property encompasses all natural or human rights. This perhaps seems to a modern eye to explode rather than inform the concept of property.

Even making an immunity from expropriation only a necessary condition of property is controversial however, as it seems to imply that much (perhaps all) takings or taxation by the government necessarily impinges on property. Clearly, there are significant consequences at stake here for distributive justice, as taxation in market economies is the primary source of funds for state welfare, education and healthcare. For this reason, various attempts have been made to define integrated property concepts so as to leave space for taxation. For instance, one approach grants immunity against expropriation so long as the property-holder is engaging purely with their own property, but weakens that immunity when the property-holder starts to derive market income through management or sale of the property (Christman 1991). Such an approach ties the question of immunity to the question of transfer and alienation discussed in the previous section (§7). Against such attempts, it has been argued that all concepts of property allowing the possibility of non-consensual expropriation necessarily have a strained sense about them, as they artificially try to make the concept of property compatible with its own extinction (Attas 2007). On this view, while various regulations of property may be consistent with the idea of property, expropriation itself cannot be a part of the concept. If we are committed to taxation, it is argued, property’s essential tie to immunity from expropriation means we must entirely forgo property as an organizing idea for our economic and political systems.

9. Remedy-Based Theories

Previous sections have located the essence of property in first-order Hohfeldian claim-rights (claim-rights prohibiting exclusion and harm) and second-order Hohfeldian jural relations (powers of transfer and immunity from expropriation). But there is one further dimension on which property may be characterized: remedies—the question of what is done when the rules of property are broken.

An influential theory developed by legal scholars Calabresi and Melamed distinguishes property-rules from liability-rules and inalienability-rules (Calabresi and Melamed 1972). Property-rules are those entitlements that may only be removed with the consent of the rights-holder; the rights-holder gets to name the conditions under which they consent to extinguish the entitlements that would otherwise apply. Liability-rules, on the other hand, allow entitlements to be removed by a party so long as that party pays a specific cost. This cost is objectively determined by the state, and not by the subjective choice of the entitlement-holder. Inalienability-rules prevent entitlements being removed or transferred at all; if an entitlement is inalienable then even the right-holder herself cannot waive or alienate the entitlement. Different rules can apply to the same resource in different contexts. For instance, a person’s home is usually protected by property-rules with respect to other citizens (who, if they want to buy, must meet the owner’s asking price) but is only protected by liability-rules with respect to the state (as the state can use its powers of eminent domain to remove the entitlements in return for an objectively determined payment to the homeowner). Calabresi and Melamed’s distinction has relevance to the issues of immunities and powers discussed in the last two sections (§7-8). With respect to powers it implies that entitlements protected by inalienability-rules are not property, and thus that property implies alienability; and that entitlements protected only by a liability-rule are not property. With respect to immunities, the use of property-rules rather than liability-rules implies that property includes an immunity from forced transfer (by ordinary citizens, at least) through payment of an objectively determined sum.

Additionally though, Calabresi and Melamed’s analysis applies to remedies: the question of what happens when the initial rules (whatever they are) are broken. Imagine Bob illicitly breaches Annie’s property rights in X by taking X. However, upon being caught Bob gets to keep X, and only has to pay Annie a (non-punitive) objectively determined estimation of the cost of X. While the letter of the law may say that Bob has a duty to exclude himself from taking Annie’s property, in reality Bob can take what he wants from Annie and then simply pay the cost for that item as determined by the state. In such a case it may be doubted whether Annie really has a property right at all. Similarly, if Bob is found to be engaged in an ongoing breach of Annie’s property rights, it may seem obvious that a court will order Bob to stop his ongoing violation (this is called ordering  an injunction or injunctive relief), rather than merely imposing an objectively-determined cost of damages upon Bob and letting him continue the violation. But appearances can be deceiving. If Bob accidentally built his house on some of Annie’s land, the court may award damages to Annie but not force Bob to remove his transgressing building—and there are other cases where property-violations are not automatically granted injunctive relief (Balgandesh 2008). Ultimately, then, while there is clearly some conceptual relationship between property rights and the types of remedies that are to be applied if and when those rights are violated, precisely what that relationship amounts to is controversial. Perhaps the most that can be said with confidence is that property remedies, reflective of the fact that property’s duties are owed to the property-holder, must be a part of private law as well as public law, and so must in principle allow owners to seek damages over violations of their property rights, as well as allowing the state to perform criminal sanctions on the person who violated those rights (Dorfman 2010).

10. Examples of Cross-Cutting Theories

The foregoing five sections have described theories focusing in turn on one particular dimension of property: claim-rights, powers, immunities or remedies. It may be, however, that the best theory of property will be one that cuts across these dimensions and carries implications for all of them. Two examples of such cross-cutting theories follow.

a. Radin and Property for Personhood

In her influential 1982 article Property and Personhood Margaret Radin does not aim to provide a general theory of property, but seeks instead to explore one specific type of property relationship: the personality theory of property. This theory describes the specific cases where property comes to be, in a deep philosophical sense, a part of the person who owns it. Arising through the significance of things in constituting our memories, our actions, our individuality and our continuing plans and expectations, this type of deep attachment between person and thing (consider wedding rings and other items with sentimental value) gives rise to a theory of property-for-personhood with implications for each of the dimensions listed above.

In terms of claim-rights, the inviolability and sanctity of property-for-personhood implies the centrality of rights of exclusion from the object itself. It is important that nameless others do not access and use the personal object, rather than merely prohibiting their harming it in some fashion. Turning to powers, as part of the owner’s person, personal property is not a commodity; it is precisely the definition of personal property that it is not freely exchangeable for functional equivalents or for its market price. While this does not automatically mean alienation should be legally prohibited for such items (an object can shift over time from one category to another, so implementing such a rule would be difficult), it is at least clear that powers of alienation are not an essential part of the entitlements of property-for-personhood. In terms of immunities and remedies, property-for-personhood warrants the stronger protection of Calabresi and Melamed’s property-rule rather than the lesser protection afforded by a mere liability-rule. Other citizens – and perhaps even the state – should not be able to expropriate parts of a property-holder’s very person. Reflective of this, courts would be expected to utilize injunctive relief (that is, they would order the defendant cease the violating behaviour) as remedies in the case of a continuing violation of property-for-personhood, rather than merely awarding damages. In this way, the implications of a specific concept of property can be traced as they cut across the several dimensions described above.

b. Katz and Ownership as Agenda-Setting

Recently, Larissa Katz has advanced an agenda-setting theory of property in land, whereby the property-owner has the supreme power to set the agenda for the property (Katz 2008). This theory can be viewed as a sophisticated combination of a Harm Theory and a Power Theory. The theory says that a property owner can exclusively choose what particular type of act they will perform on the property – for instance, they may adopt residential, agricultural, or various sorts of industrial uses of their land. This is no mere liberty of action however—with the performance of these different activities, the owner sets the agenda for the property, shaping the duties of others with respect to that property. Non-owners have different clusters of duties imposed upon them depending upon the activity that has been undertaken by the owner; they must accord their behaviour, vis-à-vis the resource, with the agenda that has been set. As such, the agenda-setting capacity is a Hohfeldian power that alters the duties of non-owners with respect to the resource. Once the agenda is set through the owner’s chosen activities, the ensuing entitlements are thereafter modeled by the Harm Theory; others may be allowed to cross the boundaries of the property in a variety of contexts, but in doing so they must ensure their actions do not impact upon the specific activity that the owner is performing. The agenda, but not the thing, shapes the duties of others, and harm, but not exclusion, is prioritized.

11. Socialist and Egalitarian Property

Much of the foregoing has considered different theories of private property—with the exception being the universal endowments of common property discussed in §6.1. But it may be enquired what sort of property concepts arise from socialist theory and practice. Naturally, there are many different answers to this question, particularly if its scope is expanded to include, say, contemporary theories of market socialism (which aim to assimilate socialist theories of justice with elements of market-based economies), the types of property relationships that were expected to emerge during the transition from capitalism to socialism, and the various types of property existing in law and de facto in particular socialist regimes throughout recent history. In the main, however, two answers predominate.

At least since the beginning of the twentieth century, socialism has been identified with the public ownership of the means of production. This directly implies the collective ownership of those assets playing a role in production. Equally though, it leaves room for each person to hold property – even private property – in particular resources, provided these entitlements do not allow for private production to occur. With this restriction in mind, concepts of private property available for use in socialist regimes will exclude market transfers, with the intention of facilitating the elements of property that allow personal use, and prohibiting those that allow control over other persons. Individual citizens thus will be entitled to personal property (§7) and to property-for-personhood as Radin defined that term (§10.1), and they may also have common property in certain public amenities.

As well as the non-productive property entitlements of individual persons, the defining feature of a socialist economy is that productive resources are collectively owned. There are three features of such ownership. First, the group as a whole, or some subset understood to be representative of that whole, determines the use to which a resource will be put and manages the resource. Second, decisions on how the resource will be used are made through reference to the collective interest; the property is to be managed in order to produce what the collective requires. Third, the property’s management must also instantiate the proper empowerment of those citizens who labour upon it; workers must not be alienated from their labour even for the sake of public benefit elsewhere.

Naturally, this general characterization may be filled out in very different ways, depending upon who represents the collective, how centralized their decision-making is, how the collective’s interests are defined, what counts as proper empowerment, how the relationship between collective and personal property is managed, and so on (Kulikov 1988). Cooperative property and to an extent some of the property systems of communes may be understood as collective property writ on a smaller scale—being held by small communities and working groups rather than entire nation-states. More decentralized socialist regimes have made extensive use of this form of productive arrangement.

There is one further property-concept worth noting here: joint ownership. A resource is jointly-owned when each member of a community has a veto-right over what may be done or produced on the resource; no production is allowed without the prior agreement of every member. This concept of property is rarely found in law or custom. Its most common use is as a theoretical device for modeling an initial normative relation between people and land (Cohen 1995). In this way joint ownership sets down an imagined initial situation where no productive action can occur without the agreement of every joint owner. This standpoint then serves as a conceptual point of departure from which further contracting can occur. There are good reasons for thinking that the property-entitlements arising from such contracting will be highly egalitarian, as the veto-power joint ownership gives each member of the society will allow them to bargain for a share of whatever is produced.

12. References and Further Reading

Bundle Theory and the Disintegration of Property

  • Hohfeld, W. “Fundamental Legal Conceptions as Applied in Judicial Reasoning.” Yale Law Journal 23 (1913): 16-59; (Contined in YLJ 26, 1917: 710-69.)
    • Landmark pair of articles analysing rights (including property rights) into constituent parts.
  • Cohen, Felix. “Transcendental Nonsense and the Functional Approach.” Columbia Law Review 35.6 (1935): 809-49.
    • Advocates a scientific and functional approach to law; argues the concept of property (among others) to be an unwanted supernatural entity.
  • Grey, Thomas. “The Disintegration of Property.” Property: Nomos XXII. Eds. Pennock, J. Roland and J. W. Chapman. New York: New York University Press, 1980. 69-86.
    • Influential argument against integrated concepts of property.
  • Merrill, Thomas, and Henry Smith. “What Happened to Property in Law and Economics?” Yale Law Journal 111 (2001): 357-98.
    • Illustrates why Coase-inspired property theorists gravitated toward the Bundle (and also use/harm) approach; argues this approach obscures crucial features of property.

Full Liberal Ownership

  • Honoré, A. “Ownership.” Oxford Essays in Jurisprudence. Ed. Guest, A. London: Oxford University Press, 1961. 107-47.
    • Seminal article listing eleven incidents of Full Liberal Ownership (often used as a comprehensive list of the potential sticks in property’s bundle).
  • Epstein, Richard. Takings: Private Property and the Power of Eminent Domain. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1985.
    • Influential libertarian reading of the US Takings Clause through the Hohfeldian lens; argues the dissolution of any incident of property is a taking of property.

Integrated Theory

  • Mossoff, Adam. “What Is Property?” Arizona Law Review 45 (2003): 371-443.
    • Sustained argument for Integrated Theory, including its historical pedigree from the early modern period in Grotius and Locke.

Exclusion Theories

  • Balgandesh, Shyamkrishna. “Demystifying the Right to Exclude: Of Property, Inviolability and Automatic Injunctions.” Harvard Journal of Law and Public Policy 31 (2008): 593-661.
    • Argues that property is based on a principle of inviolability, and so constituted by claim-rights that others exclude themselves. Argues against remedy-based property theories like Calabresi and Melamed’s.
  • Merrill, Thomas. “Property and the Right to Exclude.” Nebraska Law Review 77 (1998): 730-55.
    • Argues the essence of property is the right to exclude, from which the other aspects of property can be derived.
  • Penner, J. The Idea of Property in Law. Oxford: Clarendon, 1997.
    • Classic statement of exclusion theory; property includes powers of abandonment and gift, but not alienation, which requires the addition of the concept of contract in law.

Harm-Based Theories, including Common Property

  • Ostrom, Elinor. Governing the Commons: The Evolution of Institutions for Collective Action. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1990.
    • Influential study of common property, describing its diversity, nature, history and variable capacity to resist tragedy.
  • Breakey, Hugh. “Two Concepts of Property: Ownership of Things and Property in Activities.” The Philosophical Forum 42.3 (2011): 239-65.
    • Argues that a (Harm-based) concept of property-protected activities solves problem cases (common property, resource property, property in labour, etc.) encountered by Exclusion Theory.
  • Hardin, Garrett. “The Tragedy of the Commons.” Science 162 (1968): 1243-48.
    • Landmark article describing how rational actors degrade common (read open-access) resources.

Environmental and Community-Based Conceptions of Property

  • Freyfogle, Eric. The Land We Share. London: Shearwater Books, 2003.
    • Describes the fluidty and diversity of property-entitlements through US history, and their responsiveness to community and ecological needs; emphasizes internal tensions within property entitlements.
  • Singer, Joseph. Entitlement. London: Yale University Press, 2000.
    • Argues control over a property should be delineated by individuals’ protected interests in that property, rather than by abstract notions of ownership; marshals an array of tensions within ownership.

Power-Based Theory

  • Dorfman, Avihay. “Private Ownership.” Legal Theory 16 (2010): 1-35.
    • Identifies property with the capacity to alter others’ normative standing with respect to the resource. Links this feature with property’s status in private law.
  • Christman, John. “Self-Ownership, Equality, and the Structure of Property Rights.” Political Theory 19.1 (1991): 28-46.
    • Distinguishes property’s ‘use’ rights (including alienation) from its ‘control’ rights (especially income), and argues for the ethical priority of the former.
  • Steiner, Hillel. An Essay on Rights. Oxford: Blackwell, 1994.
    • Links Will/Choice theory of rights to property entitlements in developing a left-libertarian position.

Immunity-Based Theory

  • Attas, Daniel. “Fragmenting Property.” Law and Philosophy 25.1 (2007): 119-49.
    • Describes structural relations between Honore’s property-incidents; argues immunity from expropriation is a necessary incident of property.

Remedy-Based Theory

  • Calabresi, G., and D. Melamed. “Property Rule, Liability Rules and Inalienability: One View of the Cathedral.” Harvard Law Review 85 (1972): 1089-1128.
    • Focusing on remedies and immunities, distinguishes property-rules, inalienability-rules and liability-rules.

Cross-Cutting Theories

  • Katz, Larissa. “Exclusion and Exclusivity in Property Law.” University of Toronto Law Journal 58.3 (2008): 275-315.
    • ‘Agenda-setting’ theory of property: property’s duties are not set by exclusion from the resource, but rather shaped to conform with the agenda the owner has set for the resource.
  • Radin, Margaret. “Property and Personhood.” Stanford Law Review 34 (1982): 957-1015.
    • Definitive account of the personhood theory of property; investigates the special case where property forms part of the person of the property-holder.

Socialist Property

  • Kulikov, V. V. “The Structure and Forms of Socialist Property.” Problems of Economics 31.1 (1988): 14-29.
    • Details the two major forms of property applicable to socialist regimes (collective and personal property) and their inter-relation. Considers the use of personal private production in Soviet socialism.
  • Cohen, Gerald. Self-Ownership, Freedom and Equality. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1995.
    • Searching investigation of normative implications of different property regimes. Chapter  4 describes ‘Joint Ownership’.

General Literature

  • Ellickson, Robert. “Property in Land.” Yale Law Journal 102 (1993): 1315-400.
    • Detailed analysis of the complexities of property in land, combining historical cases and rational-actor theory, and considering private, common, and communal property-arrangements.
  • Wenar, Leif. “The Concept of Property and the Takings Clause.” Columbia Law Review 97 (1997): 1923-46.
    • Argues, with special reference to the US takings clause, that property should be viewed as the thing that is the object of (Hohfeldian) property rights.
  • Harris, James. Property and Justice. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
    • Property based on twin notions of trespassory rules and the ‘ownership spectrum’, a continuum ranging from mere use-privileges through to control-powers and alienation.
  • Waldron, Jeremy. “What Is Private Property?” Oxford Journal of Legal Studies 5 (1985): 313-49.
    • Sustained argument against property skepticism; private property is a broad concept (that resources are allocated to particular individuals, who determine their use) of which particular conceptions are possible. Considers common and collective property.
  • Locke, John. Two Treatises of Government. New York: Hafner, 1947 (1689).
    • Perhaps the most influential treatise on property ever penned, though subject to divergent interpretations. As well as the famous Chapter Five of the Second Treatise, see First Treatise sections 39-41, 86-92 and Second Treatise sections 135-40, 159, 172-74.
  • Macpherson, C. B., ed. Property: Mainstream and Critical Positions. Toronto: University of Toronto, 1978.
    • Useful anthology of major property theorists throughout history, and more recent critical arguments.

 

Author Information

Hugh Breakey
Email: h.breakey@griffith.edu.au
Griffith University
Australia

Consciousness

Explaining the nature of consciousness is one of the most important and perplexing areas of philosophy, but the concept is notoriously ambiguous. The abstract noun “consciousness” is not frequently used by itself in the contemporary literature, but is originally derived from the Latin con (with) and scire (to know). Perhaps the most commonly used contemporary notion of a conscious mental state is captured by Thomas Nagel’s famous “what it is like” sense (Nagel 1974). When I am in a conscious mental state, there is something it is like for me to be in that state from the subjective or first-person point of view. But how are we to understand this? For instance, how is the conscious mental state related to the body? Can consciousness be explained in terms of brain activity? What makes a mental state be a conscious mental state? The problem of consciousness is arguably the most central issue in current philosophy of mind and is also importantly related to major traditional topics in metaphysics, such as the possibility of immortality and the belief in free will. This article focuses on Western theories and conceptions of consciousness, especially as found in contemporary analytic philosophy of mind.

The two broad, traditional and competing theories of mind are dualism and materialism (or physicalism). While there are many versions of each, the former generally holds that the conscious mind or a conscious mental state is non-physical in some sense, whereas the latter holds that, to put it crudely, the mind is the brain, or is caused by neural activity. It is against this general backdrop that many answers to the above questions are formulated and developed. There are also many familiar objections to both materialism and dualism. For example, it is often said that materialism cannot truly explain just how or why some brain states are conscious, and that there is an important “explanatory gap” between mind and matter. On the other hand, dualism faces the problem of explaining how a non-physical substance or mental state can causally interact with the physical body.

Some philosophers attempt to explain consciousness directly in neurophysiological or physical terms, while others offer cognitive theories of consciousness whereby conscious mental states are reduced to some kind of representational relation between mental states and the world. There are a number of such representational theories of consciousness currently on the market, including higher-order theories which hold that what makes a mental state conscious is that the subject is aware of it in some sense. The relationship between consciousness and science is also central in much current theorizing on this topic: How does the brain “bind together” various sensory inputs to produce a unified subjective experience? What are the neural correlates of consciousness? What can be learned from abnormal psychology which might help us to understand normal consciousness? To what extent are animal minds different from human minds? Could an appropriately programmed machine be conscious?

Table of Contents

  1. Terminological Matters: Various Concepts of Consciousness
  2. Some History on the Topic
  3. The Metaphysics of Consciousness: Materialism vs. Dualism
    1. Dualism: General Support and Related Issues
      1. Substance Dualism and Objections
      2. Other Forms of Dualism
    2. Materialism: General Support
      1. Objection 1: The Explanatory Gap and The Hard Problem
      2. Objection 2: The Knowledge Argument
      3. Objection 3: Mysterianism
      4. Objection 4: Zombies
      5. Varieties of Materialism
  4. Specific Theories of Consciousness
    1. Neural Theories
    2. Representational Theories of Consciousness
      1. First-Order Representationalism
      2. Higher-Order Representationalism
      3. Hybrid Representational Accounts
    3. Other Cognitive Theories
    4. Quantum Approaches
  5. Consciousness and Science: Key Issues
    1. The Unity of Consciousness/The Binding Problem
    2. The Neural Correlates of Consciousness (NCCs)
    3. Philosophical Psychopathology
  6. Animal and Machine Consciousness
  7. References and Further Reading

1. Terminological Matters: Various Concepts of Consciousness

The concept of consciousness is notoriously ambiguous. It is important first to make several distinctions and to define related terms. The abstract noun “consciousness” is not often used in the contemporary literature, though it should be noted that it is originally derived from the Latin con (with) and scire (to know). Thus, “consciousness” has etymological ties to one’s ability to know and perceive, and should not be confused with conscience, which has the much more specific moral connotation of knowing when one has done or is doing something wrong. Through consciousness, one can have knowledge of the external world or one’s own mental states. The primary contemporary interest lies more in the use of the expressions “x is conscious” or “x is conscious of y.” Under the former category, perhaps most important is the distinction between state and creature consciousness (Rosenthal 1993a). We sometimes speak of an individual mental state, such as a pain or perception, as conscious. On the other hand, we also often speak of organisms or creatures as conscious, such as when we say “human beings are conscious” or “dogs are conscious.” Creature consciousness is also simply meant to refer to the fact that an organism is awake, as opposed to sleeping or in a coma. However, some kind of state consciousness is often implied by creature consciousness, that is, the organism is having conscious mental states. Due to the lack of a direct object in the expression “x is conscious,” this is usually referred to as intransitive consciousness, in contrast to transitive consciousness where the locution “x is conscious of y” is used (Rosenthal 1993a, 1997). Most contemporary theories of consciousness are aimed at explaining state consciousness; that is, explaining what makes a mental state a conscious mental state.

It might seem that “conscious” is synonymous with, say, “awareness” or “experience” or “attention.” However, it is crucial to recognize that this is not generally accepted today. For example, though perhaps somewhat atypical, one might hold that there are even unconscious experiences, depending of course on how the term “experience” is defined (Carruthers 2000). More common is the belief that we can be aware of external objects in some unconscious sense, for example, during cases of subliminal perception. The expression “conscious awareness” does not therefore seem to be redundant. Finally, it is not clear that consciousness ought to be restricted to attention. It seems plausible to suppose that one is conscious (in some sense) of objects in one’s peripheral visual field even though one is only attending to some narrow (focal) set of objects within that visual field.

Perhaps the most fundamental and commonly used notion of “conscious” is captured by Thomas Nagel’s famous “what it is like” sense (Nagel 1974). When I am in a conscious mental state, there is “something it is like” for me to be in that state from the subjective or first-person point of view. When I am, for example, smelling a rose or having a conscious visual experience, there is something it “seems” or “feels” like from my perspective. An organism, such as a bat, is conscious if it is able to experience the outer world through its (echo-locatory) senses. There is also something it is like to be a conscious creature whereas there is nothing it is like to be, for example, a table or tree. This is primarily the sense of “conscious state” that will be used throughout this entry. There are still, though, a cluster of expressions and terms related to Nagel’s sense, and some authors simply stipulate the way that they use such terms. For example, philosophers sometimes refer to conscious states as phenomenal or qualitative states. More technically, philosophers often view such states as having qualitative properties called “qualia” (prounced like “kwal’ ee uh”; the singular is quale). There is significant disagreement over the nature, and even the existence, of qualia, but they are perhaps most frequently understood as the felt properties or qualities of conscious states.

Ned Block (1995) makes an often cited distinction between phenomenal consciousness (or “phenomenality”) and access consciousness. The former is very much in line with the Nagelian notion described above. However, Block also defines the quite different notion of access consciousness in terms of a mental state’s relationship with other mental states; for example, a mental state’s “availability for use in reasoning and rationality guiding speech and action” (Block 1995: 227). This would, for example, count a visual perception as (access) conscious not because it has the “what it’s likeness” of phenomenal states, but rather because it carries visual information which is generally available for use by the organism, regardless of whether or not it has any qualitative properties. Access consciousness is therefore more of a functional notion; that is, concerned with what such states do. Although this concept of consciousness is certainly very important in cognitive science and philosophy of mind generally, not everyone agrees that access consciousness deserves to be called “consciousnesses” in any important sense. Block himself argues that neither sense of consciousness implies the other, while others urge that there is a more intimate connection between the two.

Finally, it is helpful to distinguish between consciousness and self-consciousness, which plausibly involves some kind of awareness or consciousness of one’s own mental states (instead of something out in the world). Self-consciousness arguably comes in degrees of sophistication ranging from minimal bodily self-awareness to the ability to reason and reflect on one’s own mental states, such as one’s beliefs and desires. Some important historical figures have even held that consciousness entails some form of self-consciousness (Kant 1781/1965, Sartre 1956), a view shared by some contemporary philosophers (Gennaro 1996a, Kriegel 2004).

2. Some History on the Topic

Interest in the nature of conscious experience has no doubt been around for as long as there have been reflective humans. It would be impossible here to survey the entire history, but a few highlights are in order. In the history of Western philosophy, which is the focus of this entry, important writings on human nature and the soul and mind go back to ancient philosophers, such as Plato. More sophisticated work on the nature of consciousness and perception can be found in the work of Plato’s most famous student Aristotle (see Caston 2002), and then throughout the later Medieval period. It is, however, with the work of René Descartes (1596-1650) and his successors in the early modern period of philosophy that consciousness and the relationship between the mind and body took center stage. As we shall see, Descartes argued that the mind is a non-physical substance distinct from the body. He also did not believe in the existence of unconscious mental states, a view certainly not widely held today. Descartes defined “thinking” very broadly to include virtually every kind of mental state and urged that consciousness is essential to thought. Our mental states are, according to Descartes, infallibly transparent to introspection. John Locke (1689/1975) held a similar position regarding the connection between mentality and consciousness, but was far less committed on the exact metaphysical nature of the mind.

Perhaps the most important philosopher of the period explicitly to endorse the existence of unconscious mental states was G.W. Leibniz (1686/1991, 1720/1925). Although Leibniz also believed in the immaterial nature of mental substances (which he called “monads”), he recognized the existence of what he called “petit perceptions,” which are basically unconscious perceptions. He also importantly distinguished between perception and apperception, roughly the difference between outer-directed consciousness and self-consciousness (see Gennaro 1999 for some discussion). The most important detailed theory of mind in the early modern period was developed by Immanuel Kant. His main work Critique of Pure Reason (1781/1965) is as equally dense as it is important, and cannot easily be summarized in this context. Although he owes a great debt to his immediate predecessors, Kant is arguably the most important philosopher since Plato and Aristotle and is highly relevant today. Kant basically thought that an adequate account of phenomenal consciousness involved far more than any of his predecessors had considered. There are important mental structures which are “presupposed” in conscious experience, and Kant presented an elaborate theory as to what those structures are, which, in turn, had other important implications. He, like Leibniz, also saw the need to postulate the existence of unconscious mental states and mechanisms in order to provide an adequate theory of mind (Kitcher 1990 and Brook 1994 are two excellent books on Kant’s theory of mind.).

Over the past one hundred years or so, however, research on consciousness has taken off in many important directions. In psychology, with the notable exception of the virtual banishment of consciousness by behaviorist psychologists (e.g., Skinner 1953), there were also those deeply interested in consciousness and various introspective (or “first-person”) methods of investigating the mind. The writings of such figures as Wilhelm Wundt (1897), William James (1890) and Alfred Titchener (1901) are good examples of this approach. Franz Brentano (1874/1973) also had a profound effect on some contemporary theories of consciousness. Similar introspectionist approaches were used by those in the so-called “phenomenological” tradition in philosophy, such as in the writings of Edmund Husserl(1913/1931, 1929/1960) and Martin Heidegger (1927/1962). The work of Sigmund Freud was very important, at minimum, in bringing about the near universal acceptance of the existence of unconscious mental states and processes.

It must, however, be kept in mind that none of the above had very much scientific knowledge about the detailed workings of the brain.  The relatively recent development of neurophysiology is, in part, also responsible for the unprecedented interdisciplinary research interest in consciousness, particularly since the 1980s.  There are now several important journals devoted entirely to the study of consciousness: Consciousness and Cognition, Journal of Consciousness Studies, and Psyche.  There are also major annual conferences sponsored by world wide professional organizations, such as the Association for the Scientific Study of Consciousness, and an entire book series called “Advances in Consciousness Research” published by John Benjamins.  (For a small sample of introductory texts and important anthologies, see Kim 1996, Gennaro 1996b, Block et. al. 1997, Seager 1999, Chalmers 2002, Baars et. al. 2003, Blackmore 2004, Campbell 2005, Velmans and Schneider 2007, Zelazo et al. 2007, Revonsuo 2010.)

3. The Metaphysics of Consciousness: Materialism vs. Dualism

Metaphysics is the branch of philosophy concerned with the ultimate nature of reality. There are two broad traditional and competing metaphysical views concerning the nature of the mind and conscious mental states: dualism and materialism. While there are many versions of each, the former generally holds that the conscious mind or a conscious mental state is non-physical in some sense. On the other hand, materialists hold that the mind is the brain, or, more accurately, that conscious mental activity is identical with neural activity. It is important to recognize that by non-physical, dualists do not merely mean “not visible to the naked eye.” Many physical things fit this description, such as the atoms which make up the air in a typical room. For something to be non-physical, it must literally be outside the realm of physics; that is, not in space at all and undetectable in principle by the instruments of physics. It is equally important to recognize that the category “physical” is broader than the category “material.” Materialists are called such because there is the tendency to view the brain, a material thing, as the most likely physical candidate to identify with the mind. However, something might be physical but not material in this sense, such as an electromagnetic or energy field. One might therefore instead be a “physicalist” in some broader sense and still not a dualist. Thus, to say that the mind is non-physical is to say something much stronger than that it is non-material. Dualists, then, tend to believe that conscious mental states or minds are radically different from anything in the physical world at all.

a. Dualism: General Support and Related Issues

There are a number of reasons why some version of dualism has been held throughout the centuries. For one thing, especially from the introspective or first-person perspective, our conscious mental states just do not seem like physical things or processes. That is, when we reflect on our conscious perceptions, pains, and desires, they do not seem to be physical in any sense. Consciousness seems to be a unique aspect of the world not to be understood in any physical way. Although materialists will urge that this completely ignores the more scientific third-person perspective on the nature of consciousness and mind, this idea continues to have force for many today. Indeed, it is arguably the crucial underlying intuition behind historically significant “conceivability arguments” against materialism and for dualism. Such arguments typically reason from the premise that one can conceive of one’s conscious states existing without one’s body or, conversely, that one can imagine one’s own physical duplicate without consciousness at all (see section 3b.iv). The metaphysical conclusion ultimately drawn is that consciousness cannot be identical with anything physical, partly because there is no essential conceptual connection between the mental and the physical. Arguments such as these go back to Descartes and continue to be used today in various ways (Kripke 1972, Chalmers 1996), but it is highly controversial as to whether they succeed in showing that materialism is false. Materialists have replied in various ways to such arguments and the relevant literature has grown dramatically in recent years.

Historically, there is also the clear link between dualism and a belief in immortality, and hence a more theistic perspective than one tends to find among materialists. Indeed, belief in dualism is often explicitly theologically motivated. If the conscious mind is not physical, it seems more plausible to believe in the possibility of life after bodily death. On the other hand, if conscious mental activity is identical with brain activity, then it would seem that when all brain activity ceases, so do all conscious experiences and thus no immortality. After all, what do many people believe continues after bodily death? Presumably, one’s own conscious thoughts, memories, experiences, beliefs, and so on. There is perhaps a similar historical connection to a belief in free will, which is of course a major topic in its own right. For our purposes, it suffices to say that, on some definitions of what it is to act freely, such ability seems almost “supernatural” in the sense that one’s conscious decisions can alter the otherwise deterministic sequence of events in nature. To put it another way: If we are entirely physical beings as the materialist holds, then mustn’t all of the brain activity and behavior in question be determined by the laws of nature? Although materialism may not logically rule out immortality or free will, materialists will likely often reply that such traditional, perhaps even outdated or pre-scientific beliefs simply ought to be rejected to the extent that they conflict with materialism. After all, if the weight of the evidence points toward materialism and away from dualism, then so much the worse for those related views.

One might wonder “even if the mind is physical, what about the soul?” Maybe it’s the soul, not the mind, which is non-physical as one might be told in many religious traditions. While it is true that the term “soul” (or “spirit”) is often used instead of “mind” in such religious contexts, the problem is that it is unclear just how the soul is supposed to differ from the mind. The terms are often even used interchangeably in many historical texts and by many philosophers because it is unclear what else the soul could be other than “the mental substance.” It is difficult to describe the soul in any way that doesn’t make it sound like what we mean by the mind. After all, that’s what many believe goes on after bodily death; namely, conscious mental activity. Granted that the term “soul” carries a more theological connotation, but it doesn’t follow that the words “soul” and “mind” refer to entirely different things. Somewhat related to the issue of immortality, the existence of near death experiences is also used as some evidence for dualism and immortality. Such patients experience a peaceful moving toward a light through a tunnel like structure, or are able to see doctors working on their bodies while hovering over them in an emergency room (sometimes akin to what is called an “out of body experience”). In response, materialists will point out that such experiences can be artificially induced in various experimental situations, and that starving the brain of oxygen is known to cause hallucinations.

Various paranormal and psychic phenomena, such as clairvoyance, faith healing, and mind-reading, are sometimes also cited as evidence for dualism. However, materialists (and even many dualists) will first likely wish to be skeptical of the alleged phenomena themselves for numerous reasons. There are many modern day charlatans who should make us seriously question whether there really are such phenomena or mental abilities in the first place. Second, it is not quite clear just how dualism follows from such phenomena even if they are genuine. A materialist, or physicalist at least, might insist that though such phenomena are puzzling and perhaps currently difficult to explain in physical terms, they are nonetheless ultimately physical in nature; for example, having to do with very unusual transfers of energy in the physical world. The dualist advantage is perhaps not as obvious as one might think, and we need not jump to supernatural conclusions so quickly.

i. Substance Dualism and Objections

Interactionist Dualism or simply “interactionism” is the most common form of “substance dualism” and its name derives from the widely accepted fact that mental states and bodily states causally interact with each other. For example, my desire to drink something cold causes my body to move to the refrigerator and get something to drink and, conversely, kicking me in the shin will cause me to feel a pain and get angry. Due to Descartes’ influence, it is also sometimes referred to as “Cartesian dualism.” Knowing nothing about just where such causal interaction could take place, Descartes speculated that it was through the pineal gland, a now almost humorous conjecture. But a modern day interactionist would certainly wish to treat various areas of the brain as the location of such interactions.

Three serious objections are briefly worth noting here. The first is simply the issue of just how does or could such radically different substances causally interact. How something non-physical causally interacts with something physical, such as the brain? No such explanation is forthcoming or is perhaps even possible, according to materialists. Moreover, if causation involves a transfer of energy from cause to effect, then how is that possible if the mind is really non-physical? Gilbert Ryle (1949) mockingly calls the Cartesian view about the nature of mind, a belief in the “ghost in the machine.” Secondly, assuming that some such energy transfer makes any sense at all, it is also then often alleged that interactionism is inconsistent with the scientifically well-established Conservation of Energy principle, which says that the total amount of energy in the universe, or any controlled part of it, remains constant. So any loss of energy in the cause must be passed along as a corresponding gain of energy in the effect, as in standard billiard ball examples. But if interactionism is true, then when mental events cause physical events, energy would literally come into the physical word. On the other hand, when bodily events cause mental events, energy would literally go out of the physical world. At the least, there is a very peculiar and unique notion of energy involved, unless one wished, even more radically, to deny the conservation principle itself. Third, some materialists might also use the well-known fact that brain damage (even to very specific areas of the brain) causes mental defects as a serious objection to interactionism (and thus as support for materialism). This has of course been known for many centuries, but the level of detailed knowledge has increased dramatically in recent years. Now a dualist might reply that such phenomena do not absolutely refute her metaphysical position since it could be replied that damage to the brain simply causes corresponding damage to the mind. However, this raises a host of other questions: Why not opt for the simpler explanation, i.e., that brain damage causes mental damage because mental processes simply are brain processes? If the non-physical mind is damaged when brain damage occurs, how does that leave one’s mind according to the dualist’s conception of an afterlife? Will the severe amnesic at the end of life on Earth retain such a deficit in the afterlife? If proper mental functioning still depends on proper brain functioning, then is dualism really in no better position to offer hope for immortality?

It should be noted that there is also another less popular form of substance dualism called parallelism, which denies the causal interaction between the non-physical mental and physical bodily realms. It seems fair to say that it encounters even more serious objections than interactionism.

ii. Other Forms of Dualism

While a detailed survey of all varieties of dualism is beyond the scope of this entry, it is at least important to note here that the main and most popular form of dualism today is called property dualism. Substance dualism has largely fallen out of favor at least in most philosophical circles, though there are important exceptions (e.g., Swinburne 1986, Foster 1996) and it often continues to be tied to various theological positions. Property dualism, on the other hand, is a more modest version of dualism and it holds that there are mental properties (that is, characteristics or aspects of things) that are neither identical with nor reducible to physical properties. There are actually several different kinds of property dualism, but what they have in common is the idea that conscious properties, such as the color qualia involved in a conscious experience of a visual perception, cannot be explained in purely physical terms and, thus, are not themselves to be identified with any brain state or process.

Two other views worth mentioning are epiphenomenalism and panpsychism. The latter is the somewhat eccentric view that all things in physical reality, even down to micro-particles, have some mental properties. All substances have a mental aspect, though it is not always clear exactly how to characterize or test such a claim. Epiphenomenalism holds that mental events are caused by brain events but those mental events are mere “epiphenomena” which do not, in turn, cause anything physical at all, despite appearances to the contrary (for a recent defense, see Robinson 2004).

Finally, although not a form of dualism, idealism holds that there are only immaterial mental substances, a view more common in the Eastern tradition. The most prominent Western proponent of idealism was 18th century empiricist George Berkeley. The idealist agrees with the substance dualist, however, that minds are non-physical, but then denies the existence of mind-independent physical substances altogether. Such a view faces a number of serious objections, and it also requires a belief in the existence of God.

b. Materialism: General Support

Some form of materialism is probably much more widely held today than in centuries past. No doubt part of the reason for this has to do with the explosion in scientific knowledge about the workings of the brain and its intimate connection with consciousness, including the close connection between brain damage and various states of consciousness. Brain death is now the main criterion for when someone dies. Stimulation to specific areas of the brain results in modality specific conscious experiences. Indeed, materialism often seems to be a working assumption in neurophysiology. Imagine saying to a neuroscientist “you are not really studying the conscious mind itself” when she is examining the workings of the brain during an fMRI. The idea is that science is showing us that conscious mental states, such as visual perceptions, are simply identical with certain neuro-chemical brain processes; much like the science of chemistry taught us that water just is H2O.

There are also theoretical factors on the side of materialism, such as adherence to the so-called “principle of simplicity” which says that if two theories can equally explain a given phenomenon, then we should accept the one which posits fewer objects or forces. In this case, even if dualism could equally explain consciousness (which would of course be disputed by materialists), materialism is clearly the simpler theory in so far as it does not posit any objects or processes over and above physical ones. Materialists will wonder why there is a need to believe in the existence of such mysterious non-physical entities. Moreover, in the aftermath of the Darwinian revolution, it would seem that materialism is on even stronger ground provided that one accepts basic evolutionary theory and the notion that most animals are conscious. Given the similarities between the more primitive parts of the human brain and the brains of other animals, it seems most natural to conclude that, through evolution, increasing layers of brain areas correspond to increased mental abilities. For example, having a well developed prefrontal cortex allows humans to reason and plan in ways not available to dogs and cats. It also seems fairly uncontroversial to hold that we should be materialists about the minds of animals. If so, then it would be odd indeed to hold that non-physical conscious states suddenly appear on the scene with humans.

There are still, however, a number of much discussed and important objections to materialism, most of which question the notion that materialism can adequately explain conscious experience.

i. Objection 1: The Explanatory Gap and The Hard Problem

Joseph Levine (1983) coined the expression “the explanatory gap” to express a difficulty for any materialistic attempt to explain consciousness. Although not concerned to reject the metaphysics of materialism, Levine gives eloquent expression to the idea that there is a key gap in our ability to explain the connection between phenomenal properties and brain properties (see also Levine 1993, 2001). The basic problem is that it is, at least at present, very difficult for us to understand the relationship between brain properties and phenomenal properties in any explanatory satisfying way, especially given the fact that it seems possible for one to be present without the other. There is an odd kind of arbitrariness involved: Why or how does some particular brain process produce that particular taste or visual sensation? It is difficult to see any real explanatory connection between specific conscious states and brain states in a way that explains just how or why the former are identical with the latter. There is therefore an explanatory gap between the physical and mental. Levine argues that this difficulty in explaining consciousness is unique; that is, we do not have similar worries about other scientific identities, such as that “water is H2O” or that “heat is mean molecular kinetic energy.” There is “an important sense in which we can’t really understand how [materialism] could be true.” (2001: 68)

David Chalmers (1995) has articulated a similar worry by using the catchy phrase “the hard problem of consciousness,” which basically refers to the difficulty of explaining just how physical processes in the brain give rise to subjective conscious experiences. The “really hard problem is the problem of experience…How can we explain why there is something it is like to entertain a mental image, or to experience an emotion?” (1995: 201) Others have made similar points, as Chalmers acknowledges, but reference to the phrase “the hard problem” has now become commonplace in the literature. Unlike Levine, however, Chalmers is much more inclined to draw anti-materialist metaphysical conclusions from these and other considerations. Chalmers usefully distinguishes the hard problem of consciousness from what he calls the (relatively) “easy problems” of consciousness, such as the ability to discriminate and categorize stimuli, the ability of a cognitive system to access its own internal states, and the difference between wakefulness and sleep. The easy problems generally have more to do with the functions of consciousness, but Chalmers urges that solving them does not touch the hard problem of phenomenal consciousness. Most philosophers, according to Chalmers, are really only addressing the easy problems, perhaps merely with something like Block’s “access consciousness” in mind. Their theories ignore phenomenal consciousness.

There are many responses by materialists to the above charges, but it is worth emphasizing that Levine, at least, does not reject the metaphysics of materialism. Instead, he sees the “explanatory gap [as] primarily an epistemological problem” (2001: 10). That is, it is primarily a problem having to do with knowledge or understanding. This concession is still important at least to the extent that one is concerned with the larger related metaphysical issues discussed in section 3a, such as the possibility of immortality.

Perhaps most important for the materialist, however, is recognition of the fact that different concepts can pick out the same property or object in the world (Loar 1990, 1997). Out in the world there is only the one “stuff,” which we can conceptualize either as “water” or as “H2O.” The traditional distinction, made most notably by Gottlob Frege in the late 19th century, between “meaning” (or “sense”) and “reference” is also relevant here. Two or more concepts, which can have different meanings, can refer to the same property or object, much like “Venus” and “The Morning Star.” Materialists, then, explain that it is essential to distinguish between mental properties and our concepts of those properties. By analogy, there are so-called “phenomenal concepts” which uses a phenomenal or “first-person” property to refer to some conscious mental state, such as a sensation of red (Alter and Walter 2007). In contrast, we can also use various concepts couched in physical or neurophysiological terms to refer to that same mental state from the third-person point of view. There is thus but one conscious mental state which can be conceptualized in two different ways: either by employing first-person experiential phenomenal concepts or by employing third-person neurophysiological concepts. It may then just be a “brute fact” about the world that there are such identities and the appearance of arbitrariness between brain properties and mental properties is just that – an apparent problem leading many to wonder about the alleged explanatory gap. Qualia would then still be identical to physical properties. Moreover, this response provides a diagnosis for why there even seems to be such a gap; namely, that we use very different concepts to pick out the same property. Science will be able, in principle, to close the gap and solve the hard problem of consciousness in an analogous way that we now have a very good understanding for why “water is H2O” or “heat is mean molecular kinetic energy” that was lacking centuries ago. Maybe the hard problem isn’t so hard after all – it will just take some more time. After all, the science of chemistry didn’t develop overnight and we are relatively early in the history of neurophysiology and our understanding of phenomenal consciousness. (See Shear 1997 for many more specific responses to the hard problem, but also for Chalmers’ counter-replies.)

ii. Objection 2: The Knowledge Argument

There is a pair of very widely discussed, and arguably related, objections to materialism which come from the seminal writings of Thomas Nagel (1974) and Frank Jackson (1982, 1986). These arguments, especially Jackson’s, have come to be known as examples of the “knowledge argument” against materialism, due to their clear emphasis on the epistemological (that is, knowledge related) limitations of materialism. Like Levine, Nagel does not reject the metaphysics of materialism. Jackson had originally intended for his argument to yield a dualistic conclusion, but he no longer holds that view. The general pattern of each argument is to assume that all the physical facts are known about some conscious mind or conscious experience. Yet, the argument goes, not all is known about the mind or experience. It is then inferred that the missing knowledge is non-physical in some sense, which is surely an anti-materialist conclusion in some sense.

Nagel imagines a future where we know everything physical there is to know about some other conscious creature’s mind, such as a bat. However, it seems clear that we would still not know something crucial; namely, “what it is like to be a bat.” It will not do to imagine what it is like for us to be a bat. We would still not know what it is like to be a bat from the bat’s subjective or first-person point of view. The idea, then, is that if we accept the hypothesis that we know all of the physical facts about bat minds, and yet some knowledge about bat minds is left out, then materialism is inherently flawed when it comes to explaining consciousness. Even in an ideal future in which everything physical is known by us, something would still be left out. Jackson’s somewhat similar, but no less influential, argument begins by asking us to imagine a future where a person, Mary, is kept in a black and white room from birth during which time she becomes a brilliant neuroscientist and an expert on color perception. Mary never sees red for example, but she learns all of the physical facts and everything neurophysiologically about human color vision. Eventually she is released from the room and sees red for the first time. Jackson argues that it is clear that Mary comes to learn something new; namely, to use Nagel’s famous phrase, what it is like to experience red. This is a new piece of knowledge and hence she must have come to know some non-physical fact (since, by hypothesis, she already knew all of the physical facts). Thus, not all knowledge about the conscious mind is physical knowledge.

The influence and the quantity of work that these ideas have generated cannot be exaggerated. Numerous materialist responses to Nagel’s argument have been presented (such as Van Gulick 1985), and there is now a very useful anthology devoted entirely to Jackson’s knowledge argument (Ludlow et. al. 2004). Some materialists have wondered if we should concede up front that Mary wouldn’t be able to imagine the color red even before leaving the room, so that maybe she wouldn’t even be surprised upon seeing red for the first time. Various suspicions about the nature and effectiveness of such thought experiments also usually accompany this response. More commonly, however, materialists reply by arguing that Mary does not learn a new fact when seeing red for the first time, but rather learns the same fact in a different way. Recalling the distinction made in section 3b.i between concepts and objects or properties, the materialist will urge that there is only the one physical fact about color vision, but there are two ways to come to know it: either by employing neurophysiological concepts or by actually undergoing the relevant experience and so by employing phenomenal concepts. We might say that Mary, upon leaving the black and white room, becomes acquainted with the same neural property as before, but only now from the first-person point of view. The property itself isn’t new; only the perspective, or what philosophers sometimes call the “mode of presentation,” is different. In short, coming to learn or know something new does not entail learning some new fact about the world. Analogies are again given in other less controversial areas, for example, one can come to know about some historical fact or event by reading a (reliable) third-person historical account or by having observed that event oneself. But there is still only the one objective fact under two different descriptions. Finally, it is crucial to remember that, according to most, the metaphysics of materialism remains unaffected. Drawing a metaphysical conclusion from such purely epistemological premises is always a questionable practice. Nagel’s argument doesn’t show that bat mental states are not identical with bat brain states. Indeed, a materialist might even expect the conclusion that Nagel draws; after all, given that our brains are so different from bat brains, it almost seems natural for there to be certain aspects of bat experience that we could never fully comprehend. Only the bat actually undergoes the relevant brain processes. Similarly, Jackson’s argument doesn’t show that Mary’s color experience is distinct from her brain processes.

Despite the plethora of materialist responses, vigorous debate continues as there are those who still think that something profound must always be missing from any materialist attempt to explain consciousness; namely, that understanding subjective phenomenal consciousness is an inherently first-person activity which cannot be captured by any objective third-person scientific means, no matter how much scientific knowledge is accumulated. Some knowledge about consciousness is essentially limited to first-person knowledge. Such a sense, no doubt, continues to fuel the related anti-materialist intuitions raised in the previous section. Perhaps consciousness is simply a fundamental or irreducible part of nature in some sense (Chalmers 1996). (For more see Van Gulick 1993.)

iii. Objection 3: Mysterianism

Finally, some go so far as to argue that we are simply not capable of solving the problem of consciousness (McGinn 1989, 1991, 1995). In short, “mysterians” believe that the hard problem can never be solved because of human cognitive limitations; the explanatory gap can never be filled. Once again, however, McGinn does not reject the metaphysics of materialism, but rather argues that we are “cognitively closed” with respect to this problem much like a rat or dog is cognitively incapable of solving, or even understanding, calculus problems. More specifically, McGinn claims that we are cognitively closed as to how the brain produces conscious awareness. McGinn concedes that some brain property produces conscious experience, but we cannot understand how this is so or even know what that brain property is. Our concept forming mechanisms simply will not allow us to grasp the physical and causal basis of consciousness. We are not conceptually suited to be able to do so.

McGinn does not entirely rest his argument on past failed attempts at explaining consciousness in materialist terms; instead, he presents another argument for his admittedly pessimistic conclusion. McGinn observes that we do not have a mental faculty that can access both consciousness and the brain. We access consciousness through introspection or the first-person perspective, but our access to the brain is through the use of outer spatial senses (e.g., vision) or a more third-person perspective. Thus we have no way to access both the brain and consciousness together, and therefore any explanatory link between them is forever beyond our reach.

Materialist responses are numerous. First, one might wonder why we can’t combine the two perspectives within certain experimental contexts. Both first-person and third-person scientific data about the brain and consciousness can be acquired and used to solve the hard problem. Even if a single person cannot grasp consciousness from both perspectives at the same time, why can’t a plausible physicalist theory emerge from such a combined approach? Presumably, McGinn would say that we are not capable of putting such a theory together in any appropriate way. Second, despite McGinn’s protests to the contrary, many will view the problem of explaining consciousness as a merely temporary limit of our theorizing, and not something which is unsolvable in principle (Dennett 1991). Third, it may be that McGinn expects too much; namely, grasping some causal link between the brain and consciousness. After all, if conscious mental states are simply identical to brain states, then there may simply be a “brute fact” that really does not need any further explaining. Indeed, this is sometimes also said in response to the explanatory gap and the hard problem, as we saw earlier. It may even be that some form of dualism is presupposed in McGinn’s argument, to the extent that brain states are said to “cause” or “give rise to” consciousness, instead of using the language of identity. Fourth, McGinn’s analogy to lower animals and mathematics is not quite accurate. Rats, for example, have no concept whatsoever of calculus. It is not as if they can grasp it to some extent but just haven’t figured out the answer to some particular problem within mathematics. Rats are just completely oblivious to calculus problems. On the other hand, we humans obviously do have some grasp on consciousness and on the workings of the brain — just see the references at the end of this entry! It is not clear, then, why we should accept the extremely pessimistic and universally negative conclusion that we can never discover the answer to the problem of consciousness, or, more specifically, why we could never understand the link between consciousness and the brain.

iv. Objection 4: Zombies

Unlike many of the above objections to materialism, the appeal to the possibility of zombies is often taken as both a problem for materialism and as a more positive argument for some form of dualism, such as property dualism. The philosophical notion of a “zombie” basically refers to conceivable creatures which are physically indistinguishable from us but lack consciousness entirely (Chalmers 1996). It certainly seems logically possible for there to be such creatures: “the conceivability of zombies seems…obvious to me…While this possibility is probably empirically impossible, it certainly seems that a coherent situation is described; I can discern no contradiction in the description” (Chalmers 1996: 96). Philosophers often contrast what is logically possible (in the sense of “that which is not self-contradictory”) from what is empirically possible given the actual laws of nature. Thus, it is logically possible for me to jump fifty feet in the air, but not empirically possible. Philosophers often use the notion of “possible worlds,” i.e., different ways that the world might have been, in describing such non-actual situations or possibilities. The objection, then, typically proceeds from such a possibility to the conclusion that materialism is false because materialism would seem to rule out that possibility. It has been fairly widely accepted (since Kripke 1972) that all identity statements are necessarily true (that is, true in all possible worlds), and the same should therefore go for mind-brain identity claims. Since the possibility of zombies shows that it doesn’t, then we should conclude that materialism is false. (See Identity Theory.)

It is impossible to do justice to all of the subtleties here. The literature in response to zombie, and related “conceivability,” arguments is enormous (see, for example, Hill 1997, Hill and McLaughlin 1999, Papineau 1998, 2002, Balog 1999, Block and Stalnaker 1999, Loar 1999, Yablo 1999, Perry 2001, Botterell 2001, Kirk 2005). A few lines of reply are as follows: First, it is sometimes objected that the conceivability of something does not really entail its possibility. Perhaps we can also conceive of water not being H2O, since there seems to be no logical contradiction in doing so, but, according to received wisdom from Kripke, that is really impossible. Perhaps, then, some things just seem possible but really aren’t. Much of the debate centers on various alleged similarities or dissimilarities between the mind-brain and water-H2O cases (or other such scientific identities). Indeed, the entire issue of the exact relationship between “conceivability” and “possibility” is the subject of an important recently published anthology (Gendler and Hawthorne 2002). Second, even if zombies are conceivable in the sense of logically possible, how can we draw a substantial metaphysical conclusion about the actual world? There is often suspicion on the part of materialists about what, if anything, such philosophers’ “thought experiments” can teach us about the nature of our minds. It seems that one could take virtually any philosophical or scientific theory about almost anything, conceive that it is possibly false, and then conclude that it is actually false. Something, perhaps, is generally wrong with this way of reasoning. Third, as we saw earlier (3b.i), there may be a very good reason why such zombie scenarios seem possible; namely, that we do not (at least, not yet) see what the necessary connection is between neural events and conscious mental events. On the one side, we are dealing with scientific third-person concepts and, on the other, we are employing phenomenal concepts. We are, perhaps, simply currently not in a position to understand completely such a necessary connection.

Debate and discussion on all four objections remains very active.

v. Varieties of Materialism

Despite the apparent simplicity of materialism, say, in terms of the identity between mental states and neural states, the fact is that there are many different forms of materialism. While a detailed survey of all varieties is beyond the scope of this entry, it is at least important to acknowledge the commonly drawn distinction between two kinds of “identity theory”: token-token and type-type materialism. Type-type identity theory is the stronger thesis and says that mental properties, such as “having a desire to drink some water” or “being in pain,” are literally identical with a brain property of some kind. Such identities were originally meant to be understood as on a par with, for example, the scientific identity between “being water” and “being composed of H2O” (Place 1956, Smart 1959). However, this view historically came under serious assault due to the fact that it seems to rule out the so-called “multiple realizability” of conscious mental states. The idea is simply that it seems perfectly possible for there to be other conscious beings (e.g., aliens, radically different animals) who can have those same mental states but who also are radically different from us physiologically (Fodor 1974). It seems that commitment to type-type identity theory led to the undesirable result that only organisms with brains like ours can have conscious states. Somewhat more technically, most materialists wish to leave room for the possibility that mental properties can be “instantiated” in different kinds of organisms. (But for more recent defenses of type-type identity theory see Hill and McLaughlin 1999, Papineau 1994, 1995, 1998, Polger 2004.) As a consequence, a more modest “token-token” identity theory has become preferable to many materialists. This view simply holds that each particular conscious mental event in some organism is identical with some particular brain process or event in that organism. This seems to preserve much of what the materialist wants but yet allows for the multiple realizability of conscious states, because both the human and the alien can still have a conscious desire for something to drink while each mental event is identical with a (different) physical state in each organism.

Taking the notion of multiple realizability very seriously has also led many to embrace functionalism, which is the view that conscious mental states should really only be identified with the functional role they play within an organism. For example, conscious pains are defined more in terms of input and output, such as causing bodily damage and avoidance behavior, as well as in terms of their relationship to other mental states. It is normally viewed as a form of materialism since virtually all functionalists also believe, like the token-token theorist, that something physical ultimately realizes that functional state in the organism, but functionalism does not, by itself, entail that materialism is true. Critics of functionalism, however, have long argued that such purely functional accounts cannot adequately explain the essential “feel” of conscious states, or that it seems possible to have two functionally equivalent creatures, one of whom lacks qualia entirely (Block 1980a, 1980b, Chalmers 1996; see also Shoemaker 1975, 1981).

Some materialists even deny the very existence of mind and mental states altogether, at least in the sense that the very concept of consciousness is muddled (Wilkes 1984, 1988) or that the mentalistic notions found in folk psychology, such as desires and beliefs, will eventually be eliminated and replaced by physicalistic terms as neurophysiology matures into the future (Churchland 1983). This is meant as analogous to past similar eliminations based on deeper scientific understanding, for example, we no longer need to speak of “ether” or “phlogiston.” Other eliminativists, more modestly, argue that there is no such thing as qualia when they are defined in certain problematic ways (Dennett 1988).

Finally, it should also be noted that not all materialists believe that conscious mentality can be explained in terms of the physical, at least in the sense that the former cannot be “reduced” to the latter. Materialism is true as an ontological or metaphysical doctrine, but facts about the mind cannot be deduced from facts about the physical world (Boyd 1980, Van Gulick 1992). In some ways, this might be viewed as a relatively harmless variation on materialist themes, but others object to the very coherence of this form of materialism (Kim 1987, 1998). Indeed, the line between such “non-reductive materialism” and property dualism is not always so easy to draw; partly because the entire notion of “reduction” is ambiguous and a very complex topic in its own right. On a related front, some materialists are happy enough to talk about a somewhat weaker “supervenience” relation between mind and matter. Although “supervenience” is a highly technical notion with many variations, the idea is basically one of dependence (instead of identity); for example, that the mental depends on the physical in the sense that any mental change must be accompanied by some physical change (see Kim 1993).

4. Specific Theories of Consciousness

Most specific theories of consciousness tend to be reductionist in some sense. The classic notion at work is that consciousness or individual conscious mental states can be explained in terms of something else or in some other terms. This section will focus on several prominent contemporary reductionist theories. We should, however, distinguish between those who attempt such a reduction directly in physicalistic, such as neurophysiological, terms and those who do so in mentalistic terms, such as by using unconscious mental states or other cognitive notions.

a. Neural Theories

The more direct reductionist approach can be seen in various, more specific, neural theories of consciousness. Perhaps best known is the theory offered by Francis Crick and Christof Koch 1990 (see also Crick 1994, Koch 2004). The basic idea is that mental states become conscious when large numbers of neurons fire in synchrony and all have oscillations within the 35-75 hertz range (that is, 35-75 cycles per second). However, many philosophers and scientists have put forth other candidates for what, specifically, to identify in the brain with consciousness. This vast enterprise has come to be known as the search for the “neural correlates of consciousness” or NCCs (see section 5b below for more). The overall idea is to show how one or more specific kinds of neuro-chemical activity can underlie and explain conscious mental activity (Metzinger 2000). Of course, mere “correlation” is not enough for a fully adequate neural theory and explaining just what counts as a NCC turns out to be more difficult than one might think (Chalmers 2000). Even Crick and Koch have acknowledged that they, at best, provide a necessary condition for consciousness, and that such firing patters are not automatically sufficient for having conscious experience.

b. Representational Theories of Consciousness

Many current theories attempt to reduce consciousness in mentalistic terms. One broadly popular approach along these lines is to reduce consciousness to “mental representations” of some kind. The notion of a “representation” is of course very general and can be applied to photographs, signs, and various natural objects, such as the rings inside a tree. Much of what goes on in the brain, however, might also be understood in a representational way; for example, as mental events representing outer objects partly because they are caused by such objects in, say, cases of veridical visual perception. More specifically, philosophers will often call such representational mental states “intentional states” which have representational content; that is, mental states which are “about something” or “directed at something” as when one has a thought about the house or a perception of the tree. Although intentional states are sometimes contrasted with phenomenal states, such as pains and color experiences, it is clear that many conscious states have both phenomenal and intentional properties, such as visual perceptions. It should be noted that the relation between intentionalilty and consciousness is itself a major ongoing area of dispute with some arguing that genuine intentionality actually presupposes consciousness in some way (Searle 1992, Siewart 1998, Horgan and Tienson 2002) while most representationalists insist that intentionality is prior to consciousness (Gennaro 2012, chapter two).

The general view that we can explain conscious mental states in terms of representational or intentional states is called “representationalism.” Although not automatically reductionist in spirit, most versions of representationalism do indeed attempt such a reduction. Most representationalists, then, believe that there is room for a kind of “second-step” reduction to be filled in later by neuroscience. The other related motivation for representational theories of consciousness is that many believe that an account of representation or intentionality can more easily be given in naturalistic terms, such as causal theories whereby mental states are understood as representing outer objects in virtue of some reliable causal connection. The idea, then, is that if consciousness can be explained in representational terms and representation can be understood in purely physical terms, then there is the promise of a reductionist and naturalistic theory of consciousness. Most generally, however, we can say that a representationalist will typically hold that the phenomenal properties of experience (that is, the “qualia” or “what it is like of experience” or “phenomenal character”) can be explained in terms of the experiences’ representational properties. Alternatively, conscious mental states have no mental properties other than their representational properties. Two conscious states with all the same representational properties will not differ phenomenally. For example, when I look at the blue sky, what it is like for me to have a conscious experience of the sky is simply identical with my experience’s representation of the blue sky.

i. First-Order Representationalism

A First-order representational (FOR) theory of consciousness is a theory that attempts to explain conscious experience primarily in terms of world-directed (or first-order) intentional states. Probably the two most cited FOR theories of consciousness are those of Fred Dretske (1995) and Michael Tye (1995, 2000), though there are many others as well (e.g., Harman 1990, Kirk 1994, Byrne 2001, Thau 2002, Droege 2003). Tye’s theory is more fully worked out and so will be the focus of this section. Like other FOR theorists, Tye holds that the representational content of my conscious experience (that is, what my experience is about or directed at) is identical with the phenomenal properties of experience. Aside from reductionistic motivations, Tye and other FOR representationalists often use the somewhat technical notion of the “transparency of experience” as support for their view (Harman 1990). This is an argument based on the phenomenological first-person observation, which goes back to Moore (1903), that when one turns one’s attention away from, say, the blue sky and onto one’s experience itself, one is still only aware of the blueness of the sky. The experience itself is not blue; rather, one “sees right through” one’s experience to its representational properties, and there is nothing else to one’s experience over and above such properties.

Whatever the merits and exact nature of the argument from transparency (see Kind 2003), it is clear, of course, that not all mental representations are conscious, so the key question eventually becomes: What exactly distinguishes conscious from unconscious mental states (or representations)? What makes a mental state a conscious mental state? Here Tye defends what he calls “PANIC theory.” The acronym “PANIC” stands for poised, abstract, non-conceptual, intentional content. Without probing into every aspect of PANIC theory, Tye holds that at least some of the representational content in question is non-conceptual (N), which is to say that the subject can lack the concept for the properties represented by the experience in question, such as an experience of a certain shade of red that one has never seen before. Actually, the exact nature or even existence of non-conceptual content of experience is itself a highly debated and difficult issue in philosophy of mind (Gunther 2003).  Gennaro (2012), for example, defends conceptualism and connects it in various ways to the higher-order thought theory of consciousness (see section 4b.ii). Conscious states clearly must also have “intentional content” (IC) for any representationalist. Tye also asserts that such content is “abstract” (A) and not necessarily about particular concrete objects. This condition is needed to handle cases of hallucinations, where there are no concrete objects at all or cases where different objects look phenomenally alike. Perhaps most important for mental states to be conscious, however, is that such content must be “poised” (P), which is an importantly functional notion. The “key idea is that experiences and feelings…stand ready and available to make a direct impact on beliefs and/or desires. For example…feeling hungry… has an immediate cognitive effect, namely, the desire to eat….States with nonconceptual content that are not so poised lack phenomenal character [because]…they arise too early, as it were, in the information processing” (Tye 2000: 62).

One objection to Tye’s theory is that it does not really address the hard problem of phenomenal consciousness (see section 3b.i). This is partly because what really seems to be doing most of the work on Tye’s PANIC account is the very functional sounding “poised” notion, which is perhaps closer to Block’s access consciousness (see section 1) and is therefore not necessarily able to explain phenomenal consciousness (see Kriegel 2002). In short, it is difficult to see just how Tye’s PANIC account might not equally apply to unconscious representations and thus how it really explains phenomenal consciousness.

Other standard objections to Tye’s theory as well as to other FOR accounts include the concern that it does not cover all kinds of conscious states. Some conscious states seem not to be “about” anything, such as pains, anxiety, or after-images, and so would be non-representational conscious states. If so, then conscious experience cannot generally be explained in terms of representational properties (Block 1996). Tye responds that pains, itches, and the like do represent, in the sense that they represent parts of the body. And after-images, hallucinations, and the like either misrepresent (which is still a kind of representation) or the conscious subject still takes them to have representational properties from the first-person point of view. Indeed, Tye (2000) admirably goes to great lengths and argues convincingly in response to a whole host of alleged counter-examples to representationalism. Historically among them are various hypothetical cases of inverted qualia (see Shoemaker 1982), the mere possibility of which is sometimes taken as devastating to representationalism. These are cases where behaviorally indistinguishable individuals have inverted color perceptions of objects, such as person A visually experiences a lemon the way that person B experience a ripe tomato with respect to their color, and so on for all yellow and red objects. Isn’t it possible that there are two individuals whose color experiences are inverted with respect to the objects of perception? (For more on the importance of color in philosophy, see Hardin 1986.)

A somewhat different twist on the inverted spectrum is famously put forth in Block’s (1990) Inverted Earth case. On Inverted Earth every object has the complementary color to the one it has here, but we are asked to imagine that a person is equipped with color-inverting lenses and then sent to Inverted Earth completely ignorant of those facts. Since the color inversions cancel out, the phenomenal experiences remain the same, yet there certainly seem to be different representational properties of objects involved. The strategy on the part of critics, in short, is to think of counter-examples (either actual or hypothetical) whereby there is a difference between the phenomenal properties in experience and the relevant representational properties in the world. Such objections can, perhaps, be answered by Tye and others in various ways, but significant debate continues (Macpherson 2005). Intuitions also dramatically differ as to the very plausibility and value of such thought experiments. (For more, see Seager 1999, chapters 6 and 7. See also Chalmers 2004 for an excellent discussion of the dizzying array of possible representationalist positions.)

ii. Higher-Order Representationalism

As we have seen, one question that should be answered by any theory of consciousness is: What makes a mental state a conscious mental state? There is a long tradition that has attempted to understand consciousness in terms of some kind of higher-order awareness. For example, John Locke (1689/1975) once said that “consciousness is the perception of what passes in a man’s own mind.” This intuition has been revived by a number of philosophers (Rosenthal, 1986, 1993b, 1997, 2000, 2004, 2005; Gennaro 1996a, 2012; Armstrong, 1968, 1981; Lycan, 1996, 2001). In general, the idea is that what makes a mental state conscious is that it is the object of some kind of higher-order representation (HOR). A mental state M becomes conscious when there is a HOR of M. A HOR is a “meta-psychological” state, i.e., a mental state directed at another mental state. So, for example, my desire to write a good encyclopedia entry becomes conscious when I am (non-inferentially) “aware” of the desire. Intuitively, it seems that conscious states, as opposed to unconscious ones, are mental states that I am “aware of” in some sense. This is sometimes referred to as the Transitivity Principle. Any theory which attempts to explain consciousness in terms of higher-order states is known as a higher-order (HO) theory of consciousness. It is best initially to use the more neutral term “representation” because there are a number of different kinds of higher-order theory, depending upon how one characterizes the HOR in question. HO theories, thus, attempt to explain consciousness in mentalistic terms, that is, by reference to such notions as “thoughts” and “awareness.” Conscious mental states arise when two unconscious mental states are related in a certain specific way; namely, that one of them (the HOR) is directed at the other (M). HO theorists are united in the belief that their approach can better explain consciousness than any purely FOR theory, which has significant difficulty in explaining the difference between unconscious and conscious mental states.

There are various kinds of HO theory with the most common division between higher-order thought (HOT) theories and higher-order perception (HOP) theories. HOT theorists, such as David M. Rosenthal, think it is better to understand the HOR as a thought of some kind. HOTs are treated as cognitive states involving some kind of conceptual component. HOP theorists urge that the HOR is a perceptual or experiential state of some kind (Lycan 1996) which does not require the kind of conceptual content invoked by HOT theorists. Partly due to Kant (1781/1965), HOP theory is sometimes referred to as “inner sense theory” as a way of emphasizing its sensory or perceptual aspect. Although HOT and HOP theorists agree on the need for a HOR theory of consciousness, they do sometimes argue for the superiority of their respective positions (such as in Rosenthal 2004, Lycan 2004, and Gennaro 2012). Some philosophers, however, have argued that the difference between these theories is perhaps not as important or as clear as some think it is (Güzeldere 1995, Gennaro 1996a, Van Gulick 2000).

A common initial objection to HOR theories is that they are circular and lead to an infinite regress. It might seem that the HOT theory results in circularity by defining consciousness in terms of HOTs. It also might seem that an infinite regress results because a conscious mental state must be accompanied by a HOT, which, in turn, must be accompanied by another HOT ad infinitum. However, the standard reply is that when a conscious mental state is a first-order world-directed state the higher-order thought (HOT) is not itself conscious; otherwise, circularity and an infinite regress would follow. When the HOT is itself conscious, there is a yet higher-order (or third-order) thought directed at the second-order state. In this case, we have introspection which involves a conscious HOT directed at an inner mental state. When one introspects, one’s attention is directed back into one’s mind. For example, what makes my desire to write a good entry a conscious first-order desire is that there is a (non-conscious) HOT directed at the desire. In this case, my conscious focus is directed at the entry and my computer screen, so I am not consciously aware of having the HOT from the first-person point of view. When I introspect that desire, however, I then have a conscious HOT (accompanied by a yet higher, third-order, HOT) directed at the desire itself (see Rosenthal 1986).

Peter Carruthers (2000) has proposed another possibility within HO theory; namely, that it is better for various reasons to think of the HOTs as dispositional states instead of the standard view that the HOTs are actual, though he also understands his “dispositional HOT theory” to be a form of HOP theory (Carruthers 2004). The basic idea is that the conscious status of an experience is due to its availability to higher-order thought. So “conscious experience occurs when perceptual contents are fed into a special short-term buffer memory store, whose function is to make those contents available to cause HOTs about themselves.” (Carruthers 2000: 228). Some first-order perceptual contents are available to a higher-order “theory of mind mechanism,” which transforms those representational contents into conscious contents. Thus, no actual HOT occurs. Instead, according to Carruthers, some perceptual states acquire a dual intentional content; for example, a conscious experience of red not only has a first-order content of “red,” but also has the higher-order content “seems red” or “experience of red.” Carruthers also makes interesting use of so-called “consumer semantics” in order to fill out his theory of phenomenal consciousness. The content of a mental state depends, in part, on the powers of the organisms which “consume” that state, e.g., the kinds of inferences which the organism can make when it is in that state. Daniel Dennett (1991) is sometimes credited with an earlier version of a dispositional account (see Carruthers 2000, chapter ten). Carruthers’ dispositional theory is often criticized by those who, among other things, do not see how the mere disposition toward a mental state can render it conscious (Rosenthal 2004; see also Gennaro 2004, 2012; for more, see Consciousness, Higher Order Theories of.)

It is worth briefly noting a few typical objections to HO theories (many of which can be found in Byrne 1997): First, and perhaps most common, is that various animals (and even infants) are not likely to have to the conceptual sophistication required for HOTs, and so that would render animal (and infant) consciousness very unlikely (Dretske 1995, Seager 2004). Are cats and dogs capable of having complex higher-order thoughts such as “I am in mental state M”? Although most who bring forth this objection are not HO theorists, Peter Carruthers (1989) is one HO theorist who actually embraces the conclusion that (most) animals do not have phenomenal consciousness. Gennaro (1993, 1996) has replied to Carruthers on this point; for example, it is argued that the HOTs need not be as sophisticated as it might initially appear and there is ample comparative neurophysiological evidence supporting the conclusion that animals have conscious mental states. Most HO theorists do not wish to accept the absence of animal or infant consciousness as a consequence of holding the theory. The debate continues, however, in Carruthers (2000, 2005, 2008) and Gennaro (2004, 2009, 2012, chapters seven and eight).

A second objection has been referred to as the “problem of the rock” (Stubenberg 1998) and the “generality problem” (Van Gulick 2000, 2004), but it is originally due to Alvin Goldman (Goldman 1993). When I have a thought about a rock, it is certainly not true that the rock becomes conscious. So why should I suppose that a mental state becomes conscious when I think about it? This is puzzling to many and the objection forces HO theorists to explain just how adding the HO state changes an unconscious state into a conscious. There have been, however, a number of responses to this kind of objection (Rosenthal 1997, Lycan, 1996, Van Gulick 2000, 2004, Gennaro 2005, 2012, chapter four). A common theme is that there is a principled difference in the objects of the HO states in question. Rocks and the like are not mental states in the first place, and so HO theorists are first and foremost trying to explain how a mental state becomes conscious. The objects of the HO states must be “in the head.”

Third, the above leads somewhat naturally to an objection related to Chalmers’ hard problem (section 3b.i). It might be asked just how exactly any HO theory really explains the subjective or phenomenal aspect of conscious experience. How or why does a mental state come to have a first-person qualitative “what it is like” aspect by virtue of the presence of a HOR directed at it? It is probably fair to say that HO theorists have been slow to address this problem, though a number of overlapping responses have emerged (see also Gennaro 2005, 2012, chapter four, for more extensive treatment). Some argue that this objection misconstrues the main and more modest purpose of (at least, their) HO theories. The claim is that HO theories are theories of consciousness only in the sense that they are attempting to explain what differentiates conscious from unconscious states, i.e., in terms of a higher-order awareness of some kind. A full account of “qualitative properties” or “sensory qualities” (which can themselves be non-conscious) can be found elsewhere in their work, but is independent of their theory of consciousness (Rosenthal 1991, Lycan 1996, 2001). Thus, a full explanation of phenomenal consciousness does require more than a HO theory, but that is no objection to HO theories as such. Another response is that proponents of the hard problem unjustly raise the bar as to what would count as a viable explanation of consciousness so that any such reductivist attempt would inevitably fall short (Carruthers 2000, Gennaro 2012). Part of the problem, then, is a lack of clarity about what would even count as an explanation of consciousness (Van Gulick 1995; see also section 3b). Once this is clarified, however, the hard problem can indeed be solved. Moreover, anyone familiar with the literature knows that there are significant terminological difficulties in the use of various crucial terms which sometimes inhibits genuine progress (but see Byrne 2004 for some helpful clarification).

A fourth important objection to HO approaches is the question of how such theories can explain cases where the HO state might misrepresent the lower-order (LO) mental state (Byrne 1997, Neander 1998, Levine 2001, Block 2011). After all, if we have a representational relation between two states, it seems possible for misrepresentation or malfunction to occur. If it does, then what explanation can be offered by the HO theorist? If my LO state registers a red percept and my HO state registers a thought about something green due, say, to some neural misfiring, then what happens? It seems that problems loom for any answer given by a HO theorist and the cause of the problem has to do with the very nature of the HO theorist’s belief that there is a representational relation between the LO and HO states. For example, if the HO theorist takes the option that the resulting conscious experience is reddish, then it seems that the HO state plays no role in determining the qualitative character of the experience. On the other hand, if the resulting experience is greenish, then the LO state seems irrelevant.  Rosenthal and Weisberg hold that the HO state determines the qualitative properties even in cases when there is no LO state at all (Rosenthal 2005, 2011, Weisberg 2008, 2011a, 2011b).  Gennaro (2012) argues that no conscious experience results in such cases and wonders, for example, how a sole (unconscious) HOT can result in a conscious state at all.  He argues that there must be a match, complete or partial, between the LO and HO state in order for a conscious state to exist in the first place. This important objection forces HO theorists to be clearer about just how to view the relationship between the LO and HO states. Debate is ongoing and significant both on varieties of HO theory and in terms of the above objections (see Gennaro 2004a). There is also interdisciplinary interest in how various HO theories might be realized in the brain (Gennaro 2012, chapter nine).

iii. Hybrid Representational Accounts

A related and increasingly popular version of representational theory holds that the meta-psychological state in question should be understood as intrinsic to (or part of) an overall complex conscious state. This stands in contrast to the standard view that the HO state is extrinsic to (that is, entirely distinct from) its target mental state. The assumption, made by Rosenthal for example, about the extrinsic nature of the meta-thought has increasingly come under attack, and thus various hybrid representational theories can be found in the literature. One motivation for this movement is growing dissatisfaction with standard HO theory’s ability to handle some of the objections addressed in the previous section. Another reason is renewed interest in a view somewhat closer to the one held by Franz Brentano (1874/1973) and various other followers, normally associated with the phenomenological tradition (Husserl 1913/1931, 1929/1960; Sartre 1956; see also Smith 1986, 2004). To varying degrees, these views have in common the idea that conscious mental states, in some sense, represent themselves, which then still involves having a thought about a mental state, just not a distinct or separate state. Thus, when one has a conscious desire for a cold glass of water, one is also aware that one is in that very state. The conscious desire both represents the glass of water and itself. It is this “self-representing” which makes the state conscious.

These theories can go by various names, which sometimes seem in conflict, and have added significantly in recent years to the acronyms which abound in the literature. For example, Gennaro (1996a, 2002, 2004, 2006, 2012) has argued that, when one has a first-order conscious state, the HOT is better viewed as intrinsic to the target state, so that we have a complex conscious state with parts. Gennaro calls this the “wide intrinsicality view” (WIV) and he also argues that Jean-Paul Sartre’s theory of consciousness can be understood in this way (Gennaro 2002). Gennaro holds that conscious mental states should be understood (as Kant might have today) as global brain states which are combinations of passively received perceptual input and presupposed higher-order conceptual activity directed at that input. Higher-order concepts in the meta-psychological thoughts are presupposed in having first-order conscious states. Robert Van Gulick (2000, 2004, 2006) has also explored the alternative that the HO state is part of an overall global conscious state. He calls such states “HOGS” (Higher-Order Global States) whereby a lower-order unconscious state is “recruited” into a larger state, which becomes conscious partly due to the implicit self-awareness that one is in the lower-order state. Both Gennaro and Van Gulick have suggested that conscious states can be understood materialistically as global states of the brain, and it would be better to treat the first-order state as part of the larger complex brain state. This general approach is also forcefully advocated by Uriah Kriegel (Kriegel 2003a, 2003b, 2005, 2006, 2009) and is even the subject of an entire anthology debating its merits (Kriegel and Williford 2006). Kriegel has used several different names for his “neo-Brentanian theory,” such as the SOMT (Same-Order Monitoring Theory) and, more recently, the “self-representational theory of consciousness.” To be sure, the notion of a mental state representing itself or a mental state with one part representing another part is in need of further development and is perhaps somewhat mysterious. Nonetheless, there is agreement among these authors that conscious mental states are, in some important sense, reflexive or self-directed. And, once again, there is keen interest in developing this model in a way that coheres with the latest neurophysiological research on consciousness. A point of emphasis is on the concept of global meta-representation within a complex brain state, and attempts are underway to identify just how such an account can be realized in the brain.

It is worth mentioning that this idea was also briefly explored by Thomas Metzinger who focused on the fact that consciousness “is something that unifies or synthesizes experience” (Metzinger 1995: 454). Metzinger calls this the process of “higher-order binding” and thus uses the acronym HOB. Others who hold some form of the self-representational view include Kobes (1995), Caston (2002), Williford (2006), Brook and Raymont (2006), and even Carruthers’ (2000) theory can be viewed in this light since he contends that conscious states have two representational contents. Thomas Natsoulas also has a series of papers defending a similar view, beginning with Natsoulas 1996. Some authors (such as Gennaro 2012) view this hybrid position to be a modified version of HOT theory; indeed, Rosenthal (2004) has called it “intrinsic higher-order theory.” Van Gulick also clearly wishes to preserve the HO is his HOGS. Others, such as Kriegel, are not inclined to call their views “higher-order” at all and call it, for example, the “same-order monitoring” or “self-representational” theory of consciousness. To some extent, this is a terminological dispute, but, despite important similarities, there are also key subtle differences between these hybrid alternatives. Like HO theorists, however, those who advocate this general approach all take very seriously the notion that a conscious mental state M is a state that subject S is (non-inferentially) aware that S is in. By contrast, one is obviously not aware of one’s unconscious mental states. Thus, there are various attempts to make sense of and elaborate upon this key intuition in a way that is, as it were, “in-between” standard FO and HO theory. (See also Lurz 2003 and 2004 for yet another interesting hybrid account.)

c. Other Cognitive Theories

Aside from the explicitly representational approaches discussed above, there are also related attempts to explain consciousness in other cognitive terms. The two most prominent such theories are worth describing here:

Daniel Dennett (1991, 2005) has put forth what he calls the Multiple Drafts Model (MDM) of consciousness. Although similar in some ways to representationalism, Dennett is most concerned that materialists avoid falling prey to what he calls the “myth of the Cartesian theater,” the notion that there is some privileged place in the brain where everything comes together to produce conscious experience. Instead, the MDM holds that all kinds of mental activity occur in the brain by parallel processes of interpretation, all of which are under frequent revision. The MDM rejects the idea of some “self” as an inner observer; rather, the self is the product or construction of a narrative which emerges over time. Dennett is also well known for rejecting the very assumption that there is a clear line to be drawn between conscious and unconscious mental states in terms of the problematic notion of “qualia.” He influentially rejects strong emphasis on any phenomenological or first-person approach to investigating consciousness, advocating instead what he calls “heterophenomenology” according to which we should follow a more neutral path “leading from objective physical science and its insistence on the third person point of view, to a method of phenomenological description that can (in principle) do justice to the most private and ineffable subjective experiences.” (1991: 72)

Bernard Baars’ Global Workspace Theory (GWT) model of consciousness is probably the most influential theory proposed among psychologists (Baars 1988, 1997). The basic idea and metaphor is that we should think of the entire cognitive system as built on a “blackboard architecture” which is a kind of global workspace. According to GWT, unconscious processes and mental states compete for the spotlight of attention, from which information is “broadcast globally” throughout the system. Consciousness consists in such global broadcasting and is therefore also, according to Baars, an important functional and biological adaptation. We might say that consciousness is thus created by a kind of global access to select bits of information in the brain and nervous system. Despite Baars’ frequent use of “theater” and “spotlight” metaphors, he argues that his view does not entail the presence of the material Cartesian theater that Dennett is so concerned to avoid. It is, in any case, an empirical matter just how the brain performs the functions he describes, such as detecting mechanisms of attention.

Objections to these cognitive theories include the charge that they do not really address the hard problem of consciousness (as described in section 3b.i), but only the “easy” problems. Dennett is also often accused of explaining away consciousness rather than really explaining it. It is also interesting to think about Baars’ GWT in light of the Block’s distinction between access and phenomenal consciousness (see section 1). Does Baars’ theory only address access consciousness instead of the more difficult to explain phenomenal consciousness? (Two other psychological cognitive theories worth noting are the ones proposed by George Mandler 1975 and Tim Shallice 1988.)

d. Quantum Approaches

Finally, there are those who look deep beneath the neural level to the field of quantum mechanics, basically the study of sub-atomic particles, to find the key to unlocking the mysteries of consciousness. The bizarre world of quantum physics is quite different from the deterministic world of classical physics, and a major area of research in its own right. Such authors place the locus of consciousness at a very fundamental physical level. This somewhat radical, though exciting, option is explored most notably by physicist Roger Penrose (1989, 1994) and anesthesiologist Stuart Hameroff (1998). The basic idea is that consciousness arises through quantum effects which occur in subcellular neural structures known as microtubules, which are structural proteins in cell walls. There are also other quantum approaches which aim to explain the coherence of consciousness (Marshall and Zohar 1990) or use the “holistic” nature of quantum mechanics to explain consciousness (Silberstein 1998, 2001). It is difficult to assess these somewhat exotic approaches at present. Given the puzzling and often very counterintuitive nature of quantum physics, it is unclear whether such approaches will prove genuinely scientifically valuable methods in explaining consciousness. One concern is simply that these authors are trying to explain one puzzling phenomenon (consciousness) in terms of another mysterious natural phenomenon (quantum effects). Thus, the thinking seems to go, perhaps the two are essentially related somehow and other physicalistic accounts are looking in the wrong place, such as at the neuro-chemical level. Although many attempts to explain consciousness often rely of conjecture or speculation, quantum approaches may indeed lead the field along these lines. Of course, this doesn’t mean that some such theory isn’t correct. One exciting aspect of this approach is the resulting interdisciplinary interest it has generated among physicists and other scientists in the problem of consciousness.

5. Consciousness and Science: Key Issues

Over the past two decades there has been an explosion of interdisciplinary work in the science of consciousness. Some of the credit must go to the ground breaking 1986 book by Patricia Churchland entitled Neurophilosophy. In this section, three of the most important such areas are addressed.

a. The Unity of Consciousness/The Binding Problem

Conscious experience seems to be “unified” in an important sense; this crucial feature of consciousness played an important role in the philosophy of Kant who argued that unified conscious experience must be the product of the (presupposed) synthesizing work of the mind. Getting clear about exactly what is meant by the “unity of consciousness” and explaining how the brain achieves such unity has become a central topic in the study of consciousness. There are many different senses of “unity” (see Tye 2003; Bayne and Chalmers 2003, Dainton 2000, 2008, Bayne 2010), but perhaps most common is the notion that, from the first-person point of view, we experience the world in an integrated way and as a single phenomenal field of experience. (For an important anthology on the subject, see Cleeremans 2003.) However, when one looks at how the brain processes information, one only sees discrete regions of the cortex processing separate aspects of perceptual objects. Even different aspects of the same object, such as its color and shape, are processed in different parts of the brain. Given that there is no “Cartesian theater” in the brain where all this information comes together, the problem arises as to just how the resulting conscious experience is unified. What mechanisms allow us to experience the world in such a unified way? What happens when this unity breaks down, as in various pathological cases? The “problem of integrating the information processed by different regions of the brain is known as the binding problem” (Cleeremans 2003: 1). Thus, the so-called “binding problem” is inextricably linked to explaining the unity of consciousness. As was seen earlier with neural theories (section 4a) and as will be seen below on the neural correlates of consciousness (5b), some attempts to solve the binding problem have to do with trying to isolate the precise brain mechanisms responsible for consciousness. For example, Crick and Koch’s (1990) idea that synchronous neural firings are (at least) necessary for consciousness can also be viewed as an attempt to explain how disparate neural networks bind together separate pieces of information to produce unified subjective conscious experience. Perhaps the binding problem and the hard problem of consciousness (section 3b.i) are very closely connected. If the binding problem can be solved, then we arguably have identified the elusive neural correlate of consciousness and have, therefore, perhaps even solved the hard problem. In addition, perhaps the explanatory gap between third-person scientific knowledge and first-person unified conscious experience can also be bridged. Thus, this exciting area of inquiry is central to some of the deepest questions in the philosophical and scientific exploration of consciousness.

b. The Neural Correlates of Consciousness (NCCs)

As was seen earlier in discussing neural theories of consciousness (section 4a), the search for the so-called “neural correlates of consciousness” (NCCs) is a major preoccupation of philosophers and scientists alike (Metzinger 2000). Narrowing down the precise brain property responsible for consciousness is a different and far more difficult enterprise than merely holding a generic belief in some form of materialism. One leading candidate is offered by Francis Crick and Christof Koch 1990 (see also Crick 1994, Koch 2004). The basic idea is that mental states become conscious when large numbers of neurons all fire in synchrony with one another (oscillations within the 35-75 hertz range or 35-75 cycles per second). Currently, one method used is simply to study some aspect of neural functioning with sophisticated detecting equipments (such as MRIs and PET scans) and then correlate it with first-person reports of conscious experience. Another method is to study the difference in brain activity between those under anesthesia and those not under any such influence. A detailed survey would be impossible to give here, but a number of other candidates for the NCC have emerged over the past two decades, including reentrant cortical feedback loops in the neural circuitry throughout the brain (Edelman 1989, Edelman and Tononi 2000), NMDA-mediated transient neural assemblies (Flohr 1995), and emotive somatosensory haemostatic processes in the frontal lobe (Damasio 1999). To elaborate briefly on Flohr’s theory, the idea is that anesthetics destroy conscious mental activity because they interfere with the functioning of NMDA synapses between neurons, which are those that are dependent on N-methyl-D-aspartate receptors. These and other NCCs are explored at length in Metzinger (2000). Ongoing scientific investigation is significant and an important aspect of current scientific research in the field.

One problem with some of the above candidates is determining exactly how they are related to consciousness. For example, although a case can be made that some of them are necessary for conscious mentality, it is unclear that they are sufficient. That is, some of the above seem to occur unconsciously as well. And pinning down a narrow enough necessary condition is not as easy as it might seem. Another general worry is with the very use of the term “correlate.” As any philosopher, scientist, and even undergraduate student should know, saying that “A is correlated with B” is rather weak (though it is an important first step), especially if one wishes to establish the stronger identity claim between consciousness and neural activity. Even if such a correlation can be established, we cannot automatically conclude that there is an identity relation. Perhaps A causes B or B causes A, and that’s why we find the correlation. Even most dualists can accept such interpretations. Maybe there is some other neural process C which causes both A and B. “Correlation” is not even the same as “cause,” let alone enough to establish “identity.” Finally, some NCCs are not even necessarily put forth as candidates for all conscious states, but rather for certain specific kinds of consciousness (e.g., visual).

c. Philosophical Psychopathology

Philosophers have long been intrigued by disorders of the mind and consciousness. Part of the interest is presumably that if we can understand how consciousness goes wrong, then that can help us to theorize about the normal functioning mind. Going back at least as far as John Locke (1689/1975), there has been some discussion about the philosophical implications of multiple personality disorder (MPD) which is now called “dissociative identity disorder” (DID). Questions abound: Could there be two centers of consciousness in one body? What makes a person the same person over time? What makes a person a person at any given time? These questions are closely linked to the traditional philosophical problem of personal identity, which is also importantly related to some aspects of consciousness research. Much the same can be said for memory disorders, such as various forms of amnesia (see Gennaro 1996a, chapter 9). Does consciousness require some kind of autobiographical memory or psychological continuity? On a related front, there is significant interest in experimental results from patients who have undergone a commisurotomy, which is usually performed to relieve symptoms of severe epilepsy when all else fails. During this procedure, the nerve fibers connecting the two brain hemispheres are cut, resulting in so-called “split-brain” patients (Bayne 2010).

Philosophical interest is so high that there is now a book series called Philosophical Psychopathology published by MIT Press. Another rich source of information comes from the provocative and accessible writings of neurologists on a whole host of psychopathologies, most notably Oliver Sacks (starting with his 1987 book) and, more recently, V. S. Ramachandran (2004; see also Ramachandran and Blakeslee 1998). Another launching point came from the discovery of the phenomenon known as “blindsight” (Weiskrantz 1986), which is very frequently discussed in the philosophical literature regarding its implications for consciousness. Blindsight patients are blind in a well defined part of the visual field (due to cortical damage), but yet, when forced, can guess, with a higher than expected degree of accuracy, the location or orientation of an object in the blind field.

There is also philosophical interest in many other disorders, such as phantom limb pain (where one feels pain in a missing or amputated limb), various agnosias (such as visual agnosia where one is not capable of visually recognizing everyday objects), and anosognosia (which is denial of illness, such as when one claims that a paralyzed limb is still functioning, or when one denies that one is blind). These phenomena raise a number of important philosophical questions and have forced philosophers to rethink some very basic assumptions about the nature of mind and consciousness. Much has also recently been learned about autism and various forms of schizophrenia. A common view is that these disorders involve some kind of deficit in self-consciousness or in one’s ability to use certain self-concepts. (For a nice review article, see Graham 2002.) Synesthesia is also a fascinating abnormal phenomenon, although not really a “pathological” condition as such (Cytowic 2003). Those with synesthesia literally have taste sensations when seeing certain shapes or have color sensations when hearing certain sounds. It is thus an often bizarre mixing of incoming sensory input via different modalities.

One of the exciting results of this relatively new sub-field is the important interdisciplinary interest that it has generated among philosophers, psychologists, and scientists (such as in Graham 2010, Hirstein 2005, and Radden 2004).

6. Animal and Machine Consciousness

Two final areas of interest involve animal and machine consciousness. In the former case it is clear that we have come a long way from the Cartesian view that animals are mere “automata” and that they do not even have conscious experience (perhaps partly because they do not have immortal souls). In addition to the obviously significant behavioral similarities between humans and many animals, much more is known today about other physiological similarities, such as brain and DNA structures. To be sure, there are important differences as well and there are, no doubt, some genuinely difficult “grey areas” where one might have legitimate doubts about some animal or organism consciousness, such as small rodents, some birds and fish, and especially various insects. Nonetheless, it seems fair to say that most philosophers today readily accept the fact that a significant portion of the animal kingdom is capable of having conscious mental states, though there are still notable exceptions to that rule (Carruthers 2000, 2005). Of course, this is not to say that various animals can have all of the same kinds of sophisticated conscious states enjoyed by human beings, such as reflecting on philosophical and mathematical problems, enjoying artworks, thinking about the vast universe or the distant past, and so on. However, it still seems reasonable to believe that animals can have at least some conscious states from rudimentary pains to various perceptual states and perhaps even to some level of self-consciousness. A number of key areas are under continuing investigation. For example, to what extent can animals recognize themselves, such as in a mirror, in order to demonstrate some level of self-awareness? To what extent can animals deceive or empathize with other animals, either of which would indicate awareness of the minds of others? These and other important questions are at the center of much current theorizing about animal cognition. (See Keenan et. al. 2003 and Beckoff et. al. 2002.) In some ways, the problem of knowing about animal minds is an interesting sub-area of the traditional epistemological “problem of other minds”: How do we even know that other humans have conscious minds? What justifies such a belief?

The possibility of machine (or robot) consciousness has intrigued philosophers and non-philosophers alike for decades. Could a machine really think or be conscious? Could a robot really subjectively experience the smelling of a rose or the feeling of pain? One important early launching point was a well-known paper by the mathematician Alan Turing (1950) which proposed what has come to be known as the “Turing test” for machine intelligence and thought (and perhaps consciousness as well). The basic idea is that if a machine could fool an interrogator (who could not see the machine) into thinking that it was human, then we should say it thinks or, at least, has intelligence. However, Turing was probably overly optimistic about whether anything even today can pass the Turing Test, as most programs are specialized and have very narrow uses. One cannot ask the machine about virtually anything, as Turing had envisioned. Moreover, even if a machine or robot could pass the Turing Test, many remain very skeptical as to whether or not this demonstrates genuine machine thinking, let alone consciousness. For one thing, many philosophers would not take such purely behavioral (e.g., linguistic) evidence to support the conclusion that machines are capable of having phenomenal first person experiences. Merely using words like “red” doesn’t ensure that there is the corresponding sensation of red or real grasp of the meaning of “red.” Turing himself considered numerous objections and offered his own replies, many of which are still debated today.

Another much discussed argument is John Searle’s (1980) famous Chinese Room Argument, which has spawned an enormous amount of literature since its original publication (see also Searle 1984; Preston and Bishop 2002). Searle is concerned to reject what he calls “strong AI” which is the view that suitably programmed computers literally have a mind, that is, they really understand language and actually have other mental capacities similar to humans. This is contrasted with “weak AI” which is the view that computers are merely useful tools for studying the mind. The gist of Searle’s argument is that he imagines himself running a program for using Chinese and then shows that he does not understand Chinese; therefore, strong AI is false; that is, running the program does not result in any real understanding (or thought or consciousness, by implication). Searle supports his argument against strong AI by utilizing a thought experiment whereby he is in a room and follows English instructions for manipulating Chinese symbols in order to produce appropriate answers to questions in Chinese. Searle argues that, despite the appearance of understanding Chinese (say, from outside the room), he does not understand Chinese at all. He does not thereby know Chinese, but is merely manipulating symbols on the basis of syntax alone. Since this is what computers do, no computer, merely by following a program, genuinely understands anything. Searle replies to numerous possible criticisms in his original paper (which also comes with extensive peer commentary), but suffice it to say that not everyone is satisfied with his responses. For example, it might be argued that the entire room or “system” understands Chinese if we are forced to use Searle’s analogy and thought experiment. Each part of the room doesn’t understand Chinese (including Searle himself) but the entire system does, which includes the instructions and so on. Searle’s larger argument, however, is that one cannot get semantics (meaning) from syntax (formal symbol manipulation).

Despite heavy criticism of the argument, two central issues are raised by Searle which continue to be of deep interest. First, how and when does one distinguish mere “simulation” of some mental activity from genuine “duplication”? Searle’s view is that computers are, at best, merely simulating understanding and thought, not really duplicating it. Much like we might say that a computerized hurricane simulation does not duplicate a real hurricane, Searle insists the same goes for any alleged computer “mental” activity. We do after all distinguish between real diamonds or leather and mere simulations which are just not the real thing. Second, and perhaps even more important, when considering just why computers really can’t think or be conscious, Searle interestingly reverts back to a biologically based argument. In essence, he says that computers or robots are just not made of the right stuff with the right kind of “causal powers” to produce genuine thought or consciousness. After all, even a materialist does not have to allow that any kind of physical stuff can produce consciousness any more than any type of physical substance can, say, conduct electricity. Of course, this raises a whole host of other questions which go to the heart of the metaphysics of consciousness. To what extent must an organism or system be physiologically like us in order to be conscious? Why is having a certain biological or chemical make up necessary for consciousness? Why exactly couldn’t an appropriately built robot be capable of having conscious mental states? How could we even know either way? However one answers these questions, it seems that building a truly conscious Commander Data is, at best, still just science fiction.

In any case, the growing areas of cognitive science and artificial intelligence are major fields within philosophy of mind and can importantly bear on philosophical questions of consciousness. Much of current research focuses on how to program a computer to model the workings of the human brain, such as with so-called “neural (or connectionist) networks.”

7. References and Further Reading

 

  • Alter, T. and S.Walter, eds. Phenomenal Concepts and Phenomenal Knowledge: New Essays on Consciousness and Physicalism.  New York: Oxford University Press, 2007.
  • Armstrong, D. A Materialist Theory of Mind. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1968.
  • Armstrong, D. “What is Consciousness?” In The Nature of Mind. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1981.
  • Baars, B. A Cognitive Theory of Consciousness. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
  • Baars, B. In The Theater of Consciousness. New York: Oxford University Press, 1997.
  • Baars, B., Banks, W., and Newman, J. eds. Essential Sources in the Scientific Study of Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 2003.
  • Balog, K. “Conceivability, Possibility, and the Mind-Body Problem.” In Philosophical Review 108: 497-528, 1999.
  • Bayne, T. & Chalmers, D. “What is the Unity of Consciousness?” In Cleeremans, 2003.
  • Bayne, T. The Unity of Consciousness. New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.
  • Beckoff, M., Allen, C., and Burghardt, G. The Cognitive Animal: Empirical and Theoretical Perspectives on Animal Cognition. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 2002.
  • Blackmore, S. Consciousness: An Introduction. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2004.
  • Block, N. “Troubles with Functionalism.” In Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Volume 1, Ned Block, ed., Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1980a.
  • Block, N. “Are Absent Qualia Impossible?” Philosophical Review 89: 257-74, 1980b.
  • Block, N. “Inverted Earth.” In Philosophical Perspectives, 4, J. Tomberlin, ed., Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview Publishing Company, 1990.
  • Block, N. “On a Confusion about the Function of Consciousness.” In Behavioral and Brain Sciences 18: 227-47, 1995.
  • Block, N. “Mental Paint and Mental Latex.” In E. Villanueva, ed. Perception. Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview, 1996.
  • Block, N. “The higher order approach to consciousness is defunct.” Analysis 71: 419-431, 2011.
  • Block, N, Flanagan, O. & Guzeledere, G. eds. The Nature of Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1997.
  • Block, N. & Stalnaker, R. “Conceptual Analysis, Dualism, and the Explanatory Gap.” Philosophical Review 108: 1-46, 1999.
  • Botterell, A. “Conceiving what is not there.” In Journal of Consciousness Studies 8 (8): 21-42, 2001.
  • Boyd, R. “Materialism without Reductionism: What Physicalism does not entail.” In N. Block, ed. Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Vol.1. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1980.
  • Brentano, F. Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint. New York: Humanities, 1874/1973.
  • Brook, A. Kant and the Mind. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1994.
  • Brook, A. & Raymont, P. 2006. A Unified Theory of Consciousness. Forthcoming.
  • Byrne, A. “Some like it HOT: Consciousness and Higher-Order Thoughts.” In Philosophical Studies 86:103-29, 1997.
  • Byrne, A. “Intentionalism Defended.” In Philosophical Review 110: 199-240, 2001.
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Author Information

Rocco J. Gennaro
Email: rjgennaro@usi.edu
University of Southern Indiana
U. S. A.

John Stuart Mill: Ethics

picture of MillThe ethical theory of John Stuart Mill (1806-1873) is most extensively articulated in his classical text Utilitarianism (1861). Its goal is to justify the utilitarian principle as the foundation of morals. This principle says actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote overall human happiness. So, Mill focuses on consequences of actions and not on rights nor ethical sentiments.

This article primarily examines the central ideas of his text Utilitarianism, but the article’s last two sections are devoted to Mill’s views on the freedom of the will and the justification of punishment, which are found in System of Logic (1843) and Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy (1865), respectively.

Educated by his father James Mill who was a close friend to Jeremy Bentham, John Stuart Mill came in contact with utilitarian thought at a very early stage of his life. In his Autobiography he claims to have introduced the word “utilitarian” into the English language when he was sixteen. Mill remained a utilitarian throughout his life. Beginning in the 1830s he became increasingly critical of what he calls Bentham’s “theory of human nature”. The two articles “Remarks on Bentham’s Philosophy” (1833) and “Bentham” (1838) are his first important contributions to the development of utilitarian thought. Mill rejects Bentham’s view that humans are unrelentingly driven by narrow self-interest. He believed that a “desire of perfection” and sympathy for fellow human beings belong to human nature. One of the central tenets of Mill’s political outlook is that, not only the rules of society, but also people themselves are capable of improvement.

Table of Contents

  1. Introductory Remarks
  2. Mill’s Theory of Value and the Principle of Utility
  3. Morality as a System of Social Rules
  4. The Role of Moral Rules (Secondary Principles)
  5. Rule or Act Utilitarianism?
  6. Applying the Standard of Morality
  7. The Meaning of the First Formula
  8. Right in Proportion and Tendencies
  9. Utility and Justice
  10. The Proof of Utilitarianism
  11. Evaluating Consequences
  12. Freedom of Will
  13. Responsibility and Punishment
  14. References and Further Readings
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Introductory Remarks

Mill tells us in his Autobiography that the “little work with the name” Utilitarianism arose from unpublished material, the greater part of which he completed in the final years of his marriage to Harriet Taylor, that is, before 1858. For its publication he brought old manuscripts into form and added some new material.

The work first appeared in 1861 as a series of three articles for Fraser’s Magazine, a journal that, though directed at an educated audience, was by no means a philosophical organ. Mill planned from the beginning a separate book publication, which came to light in 1863. Even if the circumstances of the genesis of this work gesture to an occasional piece with a popular goal, on closer examination Utilitarianism turns out to be a carefully conceived work,  rich in thought. One must not forget that since his first reading of Bentham in the winter of 1821-22, the time to which Mill dates his conversion to utilitarianism, forty years had passed. Taken this way, Utilitarianism was anything but a philosophical accessory, and instead the programmatic text of a thinker who for decades had understood himself as a utilitarian and who was profoundly familiar with popular objections to the principle of utility in moral theory. Almost ten years earlier (1852) Mill had defended utilitarianism against the intuitionistic philosopher William Whewell (Whewell on Moral Philosophy).

The priority of the text was to popularize the fundamental thoughts of utilitarianism within influential circles. This goal explains the composition of the work. After some general introductory comments, the text defends utilitarianism from common criticisms (“What Utilitarianism Is”). After this Mill turns to the question concerning moral motivation (“Of the Ultimate Sanction of the Principle of Utility”). This is followed by the notorious proof of the principle of utility (“Of What Sort of Proof the Principle of Utility is Susceptible”) and the long concluding chapter on the relation of utility and justice (“On the Connection Between Justice and Utility”). The last chapter is often neglected – and wrongly so, for it contains a central statement of Mill’s understanding of morals; it creates the foundation for the philosopher’s theory of moral rights that plays a preeminent role in the context of his political thought.

According to his early essay “Bentham” (1838), all reasonable moral theories assume that “the morality of actions depends on the consequences which they tend to produce” (CW 10, 111); thus, the difference between moral theories lie on an axiological plane. His own theory of morality, writes Mill in Utilitarianism, is grounded in a particular “theory of life…–namely, that pleasure, and freedom from pain, are the only things desirable as ends.” (CW 10, 210) Such a theory of life is commonly called hedonistic, and it seems appropriate to say that Mill conceives his own position as hedonistic, even if he does never use the word “hedonism” or its cognates. What makes utilitarianism peculiar, according to Mill, is its hedonistic theory of the good (CW 10, 111). Utilitarians are, by definition, hedonists. For this reason, Mill sees no need to differentiate between the utilitarian and the hedonistic aspect of his moral theory.

Modern readers are often confused by the way in which Mill uses the term ‘utilitarianism’. Today we routinely differentiate between hedonism as a theory of the good and utilitarianism as a consequentialist theory of the right. Mill, however, considered both doctrines to be so closely intertwined that he used the term ‘utilitarianism’ to signify both theories. On the one hand, he says that the “utilitarian doctrine is, that happiness is desirable, and the only thing desirable, as an end.” (CW 10, 234) On the other hand, he defines utilitarianism as a moral theory according to which “actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness…” (CW 10, 210).

Utilitarians are, for him, consequentialists who believe that pleasure is the only intrinsic value.

Mill counts as one of the great classics of utilitarian thought; but this moral theory deviates from what many contemporary philosophers consider core features of utilitarianism. This explains why the question whether Mill is a utilitarian is more serious than it may appear on first inspection (see Coope 1998). One may respond that this problem results from an anachronistic understanding of utilitarianism, and that it disappears if one abstains from imputing modern philosophical concepts on a philosopher of the nineteenth century. However, this response would oversimplify matters. For it is not clear whether Mill’s value theory was indeed hedonistic (see Brink 1992). As mentioned before, Mill maintains that hedonism is the differentia specifica of utilitarianism; if he were not a hedonist, he would be no utilitarian by his own definition. In view of the fact that Mill’s value theory constitutes the center of his ethics (Donner 1991, 2009), the problem of determining its precise nature and adequate naming has attracted considerable attention over the last 150 years.

2. Mill’s Theory of Value and the Principle of Utility

Mill defines “utilitarianism” as the creed that considers a particular “theory of life” as the “foundation of morals” (CW 10, 210). His view of theory of life was monistic: There is one thing, and one thing only, that is intrinsically desirable, namely pleasure. In contrast to a form of hedonism that conceives pleasure as a homogeneous matter, Mill was convinced that some types of pleasure are more valuable than others in virtue of their inherent qualities. For this reason, his position is often called “qualitative hedonism”. Many philosophers hold that qualitative hedonism is no consistent position. Hedonism asserts that pleasure is the only intrinsic value. Under this assumption, the critics argue, there can be no evaluative basis for the distinction between higher and lower pleasures. Probably the first ones to raise this common objection were the British idealists F. H. Bradley (1876/1988) and T. H. Green (1883/2003).

Which inherent qualities make one kind of pleasure better than another, according to Mill? He declares that the more valuable pleasures are those which employ “higher faculties” (CW 10, 211). The list of such better enjoyments includes “the pleasures of intellect, of the feelings and imagination, and of the moral sentiments” (CW 10, 211). These enjoyments make use of highly developed capacities, like judgment and empathy. In one of his most famous sentences, Mill affirms that it “is better to be a human being dissatisfied than a pig satisfied; better to be Socrates dissatisfied than a fool satisfied” (CW 10, 212). This seems to be a surprising thing to say for a hedonist. However, Mill thought that we have a solid empirical basis for this view. According to him, the best obtainable evidence for value claims consists in what all or almost all people judge as valuable across a vast variety of cases and cultures. He makes the empirical assertion that all or almost all people prefer a “manner of existence” (CW 10, 211) that employs higher faculties to a manner of existence which does not. The fact that “all or almost all” who are acquainted with pleasures that employ higher faculties agree that they are preferable to the lower ones, is empirical evidence for the claim that they are indeed of higher value. Accordingly, the best human life (“manner of existence”) is one in which the higher faculties play an adequate part. This partly explains why he put such great emphasis on education.

3. Morality as a System of Social Rules

The fifth and final chapter of Utilitarianism is of unusual importance for Mill’s theory of moral obligation. Until the 1970s, the significance of the chapter had been largely overlooked. It then became one of the bridgeheads of a revisionist interpretation of Mill, which is associated with the work of David Lyons, John Skorupski and others.

Mill worked very hard to hammer the fifth chapter into shape and his success has great meaning for him. Towards the end of the book he maintains the “considerations which have now been adduced resolve, I conceive, the only real difficulty in the utilitarian theory of morals.” (CW 10, 259)

At the beginning of Utilitarianism, Mill postulates that moral judgments presume rules (CW 10, 206). In contrast to Kant who grounds his ethical theory on self-imposed rules, so-called maxims, Mill thinks that morality builds on social rules. But what makes social rules moral rules? Mill’s answer is based on a thesis about how competent speakers use the phrase “morally right” or “morally wrong”. He maintains that we name a type of action morally wrong if we think that it should be sanctioned either through formal punishment, public disapproval (external sanctions) or through a bad conscience (internal sanctions). This is the critical difference between “morality and simple expediency” (CW 10, 246). Wrong or inexpedient actions are those that we cannot recommend to a person, like harming oneself. But in contrast to immoral actions, inexpedient actions are not worthy of being sanctioned.

Mill differentiates various spheres of action. In his System of Logic he names morality, prudence and aesthetics as the three departments of the “Art of Life” (CW 8, 949). The principle of utility governs not only morality, but also prudence and taste (CW 8, 951). It is not a moral principle but a meta-principle of practical reason (Skorupski 1989, 310-313).

There is a field of action in which moral rules obtain, and a “person may rightfully be compelled to fulfill” them (CW 10, 246). But there are also fields of action, in which sanctions for wrong behavior would be inappropriate. One of them is the sphere of self-regarding acts with which Mill deals in On Liberty. In this private sphere we can act at our convenience and indulge in inexpedient and utterly useless behavior as long as we do not harm others.

It is fundamental to keep in mind that Mill looks into morality as a social practice and not as autonomous self-determination by reason, like Kant. For Kantians, moral deliberation determines those actions which we have the most reason to perform. Mill disagrees; for him, it makes sense to say that “A is the right thing to do for Jeremy, but Jeremy is not morally obliged to do A.”For instance, even if Jeremy is capable of writing a brilliant book that would improve the life of millions (and deteriorate none), he is not morally obliged to do so. According to Mill, our moral obligations result from the justified part of the moral code of our society; and the task of moral philosophy consists in bringing the moral code of a society in better accordance with the principle of utility.

4. The Role of Moral Rules (Secondary Principles)

In Utilitarianism, Mill designs the following model of moral deliberation. In the first step the actor should examine which of the rules (secondary principles) in the moral code of his or her society are pertinent in the given situation. If in a given situation moral rules (secondary principles) conflict, then (and only then) can the second step invoke the formula of utility (CW 10, 226) as a first principle. Pointedly one could say: the principle of utility is for Mill not a component of morality, but instead its basis. It serves the validation of rightness for our moral system and allows – as a meta-rule – the decision of conflicting norms. In the introductory chapter of Utilitarianism, Mill maintains that it would be “easy to show that whatever steadiness or consistency these moral beliefs have attained, has been mainly due to the tacit influence of a standard not recognized” (CW 10, 207), namely the principle of utility. The tacit influence of the principle of utility made sure that a considerable part of the moral code of our society is justified (promotes general well-being). But other parts are clearly unjustified. One case that worried Mill deeply was the role of women in Victorian Britain. In “The Subjection of Women” (1869) he criticizesthe “legal subordination of one sex to the other” (CW 21, 261) as incompatible with “all the principles involved in modern society” (CW 21, 280).

Moral rules are also critical for Mill because he takes human action in essence as to be guided by dispositions. A virtuous person has the disposition to follow moral rules. In his early essay “Remarks on Bentham’s Philosophy” (1833) he asserts that a “man is not really virtuous” (CW 10, 12), unless the mere thought of committing certain acts is so painful that he does not even consider the possibility that they may have good consequences. He repeats this point in his System of Logic (1843)and Utilitarianism:

[T]he mind is not in a right state, not in a state conformable to Utility, not in the state most conducive to the general happiness, unless it does love virtue in this manner – as a thing desirable in itself, even although, in the individual instance, it should not produce those other desirable consequences which it tends to produce, and on account of which it is held to be virtue. (CW 10, 235 and 8, 952).

It is one thing to say that it could have optimal consequences (and thus be objectively better) to break a moral rule in a concrete singular case. Another is the question as to whether it would facilitate happiness to educate humans such that they would have the disposition to maximize situational utility. Mill answers the latter in the negative. Again, the upshot is that education matters. Humans are guided by acquired dispositions. This makes moral degeneration, but also moral progress possible.

5. Rule or Act Utilitarianism?

There is considerable disagreement as to whether Mill should be read as a rule utilitarian or an (indirect) act utilitarian. Many philosophers look upon rule utilitarianism as an untenable position and favor an act utilitarian reading of Mill (Crisp 1997). Under the pressure of many contradicting passages, however, a straightforward act utilitarian interpretation is difficult to sustain. Recent studies emphasize Mill’s rule utilitarian leanings (Miller 2010, 2011) or find elements of both theories in Mill (West 2004).

In Utilitarianism he seems to give two different formulations of the utilitarian standard. The first points in an act utilitarian, the second in a rule utilitarian direction. Since act and rule utilitarianism are incompatible claims about what makes actions morally right, the formulations open up the fundamental question concerning what style of utilitarianism Mill wants to advocate and whether his moral theory forms a consistent whole. It is important to note that the distinction between rule and act utilitarianism had not yet been introduced in Mill’s days. Thus Mill is not to blame for failing to make explicit which of the two approaches he advocates.

In the first and more famous formulation of the utilitarian standard (First Formula) Mill states:

The creed which accepts as the foundation of morals, Utility, or the Greatest Happiness Principle, holds that actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness, wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness. By happiness is intended pleasure, and the absence of pain; by unhappiness, pain, and the privation of pleasure. To give a clear view of the moral standard set up by the theory, much more requires to be said (…). But these supplementary explanations do not affect the theory of life on which this theory of morality is grounded….” (CW, 210, emphasis mine)

Just a few pages later, following his presentation of qualitative hedonism, Mill gives his second formulation (Second Formula):

According to the Greatest Happiness Principle (…) the ultimate end (…) is an existence exempt as far as possible from pain, and as rich as possible in enjoyments, both in point of quantity and quality; (…). This, being, according to the utilitarian opinion, the end of human action, is necessarily also the standard of morality; which may accordingly be defined, the rules and precepts for human conduct, by the observance of which an existence such as has been described might be, to the greatest extent possible, secured to all mankind; and not to them only, but, so far as the nature of things admits, to the whole sentient creation. (CW, 214, emphasis mine)

The Second Formula relates the principle of utility to rules and precepts and not to actions. It seems to say that an act is correct when it corresponds to rules whose preservation increases the mass of happiness in the world. And this appears to be a rule-utilitarian conception.

In the light of these passages, it is not surprising that the question whether Mill is an act- or a rule-utilitarian has been intensely debated. In order to understand his position it is important to differentiate between two ways of defining act and rule utilitarianism. (i) One can conceive of them as competing theories about objective rightness. An action is objectively right if it is the thing which the agent has most reason to do. Act utilitarianism would say that an action is objectively right, if it actually promotes happiness. For rule utilitarianism, in contrast, an action would be objectively right, if it actually corresponds to rules that promote happiness.

(ii) One can also conceive of act- and rule utilitarianism as theories about moral obligation. Act utilitarianism requires us to aim for the maximization of happiness; rule utilitarianism, in contrast, requires us to observe rules that facilitate happiness. Understood as a theory about moral obligation, act utilitarianism postulates: Act in a way that promotes happiness the most. Rule utilitarianism claims, on the other hand: Follow a rule whose general observance promotes happiness the most.

Mill is in regard to (i) an act utilitarian and in regard to (ii) a rule utilitarian. This way the seeming contradiction between the First and the Second Formula can be resolved. The First Formula states what is right and what an agent has most reason to do. It points to the “foundation of morals”. In contrast, the Second Formula tells us what our moral obligations are. We are morally obliged to follow those social rules and precepts the observance of which promotes happiness in the greatest extent possible.

6. Applying the Standard of Morality

In “Whewell on Moral Philosophy” (1852), Mill rejects an objection raised by one of his most competent philosophical adversaries. Whewell claimed that utilitarianism permits murder and other crimes in particular circumstances and is therefore incompatible with our considered moral judgments. Mill’s discussion of Whewell’s criticism is exceedingly helpful in clarifying his ethical approach:

Take, for example, the case of murder. There are many persons to kill whom would be to remove men who are a cause of no good to any human being, of cruel physical and moral suffering to several, and whose whole influence tends to increase the mass of unhappiness and vice. Were such a man to be assassinated, the balance of traceable consequences would be greatly in favour of the act. (CW 10, 181)

Mill gives no concrete case. Since he wrote – together with his wife Harriet Taylor –a couple of articles on horrible cases of domestic violence in the early 1850s, he might have had the likes of Robert Curtis Bird in mind, a man who tortured his servant Mary Ann Parsons to death [see CW 25 (The Case of Mary Ann Parsons), 1151-1153].Does utilitarianism require us to kill such people who are the “cause of no good to any human being, of cruel physical and moral suffering to several”? Mill answers in the negative. His main point is that nobody’s life would be safe if people were allowed to kill others whom they believe to be a source of unhappiness (CW 10, 182). Thus, a general rule that would allow to “remove men who are a cause of no good” would be worse than a general rule that does not allow such acts. People should follow the rule not to kill other humans because the general observance of this rule tends to promote the happiness of all.

This argument can be interpreted in a rule utilitarian or an indirect act utilitarian fashion. Along indirect act utilitarian lines, one could maintain that we would be cognitively overwhelmed by the task of calculating the consequences of any action. We therefore need rules as touchstones that point us to the path of action which tends to promote the greatest general happiness. Mill compares, in a critical passage, the core principles of our established morality (which he also calls “secondary principles”) with the Nautical Almanack, a companion for navigating a voyage (CW 10, 225). Just as the Nautical Almanackis not first calculated at sea, but instead exists as already calculated, the agent must not in individual cases calculate the expected utility. In his moral deliberation the agent can appeal to secondary principles, such as the prohibition of homicide, as an approximate solution for the estimated problem.

Apparently, the act utilitarian interpretation finds further support in a letter Mill wrote to John Venn in 1872. He states:

I agree with you that the right way of testing actions by their consequences, is to test them by their natural consequences of the particular actions, and not by those which would follow if everyone did the same. But, for the most part, considerations of what would happen if everyone did the same, is the only means we have of discovering the tendency of the act in the particular case. (CW 17, 1881)

Mill argues that in many cases we can assess the actual, expected consequences of an action, only if we hypothetically consider that all would act in the same manner. This means we recognize that the consequences of this particular action would be damaging if everyone acted that way. A similar consideration is found in the Whewell essay. Here Mill argues: If a hundred breaches of rule (homicides, in this case) led to a particular harm (murderous chaos), then a single breach of rule is responsible for a hundredth of the harm. This hundredth of harm offsets the expected utility of this particular breach of rule (CW 10, 182). Mill believes that the breach of the rule is wrong because it is actually harmful. The argument is questionable because Mill overturns the presumption he introduces: that the actual consequences of the considered action would be beneficial. If the breach of the rule is actually harmful, then it is to be rejected in every conceivable version of utilitarianism. The result is trivial then and misses the criticism that act utilitarianism has counter-intuitive implications in particular circumstances.

There is one crucial difficulty with the interpretation of Mill as an indirect act utilitarian regarding moral obligation. If the function of rules was in fact only epistemic, as suggested by indirect act utilitarianism, one would expect that the principle of utility – when the epistemic conditions are satisfactory – can be and should be directly applied. But Mill is quite explicit here. The utilitarian principle should only be applied when moral rules conflict:“We must remember that only in these cases of conflict between secondary principles is it requisite that first principles should be appealed to.” (CW 10, 226). From an act utilitarian view regarding moral obligation, this is implausible. Why should one be morally obliged to follow a rule of which one positively knows that its observance in a particular case will not promote general utility?

Coming back to the example, it is important to remember that “the balance of traceable consequences would be greatly in favour of the act [of homicide].” (CW 10, 181) Thus, according to an act utilitarian approach regarding moral obligation it would be morally allowed, if not required, to kill the man.

As mentioned, Mill arrives at a different conclusion. His position can be best understood with recourse to the distinction between the theory of objective rightness and the theory of moral obligation introduced in the last section. Seen from the perspective of an all-knowing and impartial observer, it is – in regard to the given description – objectively right to perpetrate the homicide. However, moral laws, permissions, and prohibitions are not made for omniscient and impartial observers, but instead for cognitively limited and partial beings like humans whose actions are mainly guided by acquired dispositions. Their capacity to recognize what would be objectively right is imperfect; and their ability to motivate themselves to do the right thing is limited. As quoted before in his “Remarks on Bentham’s Philosophy” (1833),he states that some violations of the established moral code are simply unthinkable for the members of society: people recoil “from the very thought of committing” (CW 10, 12) particular acts. Because humans cannot reliably recognize objective rightness and, in critical cases, cannot bring themselves to act objectively right, they are not obliged to maximize happiness. For ought implies can. In regard to the given description, the fact that the assassination of a human would be objectively right does not imply that the assassination of this human would be morally imperative or allowed. In other words: Mill differentiates between the objectively right act and the morally right act. With this he can argue that the assassination would be forbidden (theory of moral obligation). To enact a forbidden action is morally wrong. As noted, Mill’s theory allows for the possibility that an action is objectively right, but morally wrong (prohibited). An action can be wrong (bearing unhappiness), but its enactment would be no less morally right (Lyons 1978/1994, 70).

Thus, Mill’s considered position should be interpreted in the following way: First, the objective rightness of an act depends upon actual consequences; second, in order to know what we are morally obliged to do we have to draw on justified rules of the established moral code.

7. The Meaning of the First Formula

What has been said about Mill’s conception of morality as a system of social rules is relevant for the interpretation of Mill’s First Formula of utilitarianism. The Formula says that actions are right “in proportion as they tend to promote happiness” and wrong “as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness” (CW 10, 210). Roughly said, actions are right insofar as they facilitate happiness, and wrong insofar as they result in suffering. Mill does not write “morally right” or “morally wrong”, but simply “right” and “wrong”. This is important. Mill emphasizes in many places that virtuous actions can exhibit a negative balance of happiness in a singular case. If the word “moral” occurred in the First Formula, then the noted virtuous actions would be, for Mill, morally wrong. But as we have seen, this is not his view. Virtuous actions are morally right, even if they are objectively wrong under particular circumstances.

Accordingly, the First Formula is not to be interpreted as drafting a moral duty. It is a general statement about what makes actions right (reasonable, expedient) or wrong. The First Formula gives a general characterization of practical reason. It says that the promotion of happiness makes an action objectively right (but not necessarily morally right); or, as Mill says in his System of Logic, “the promotion of happiness is the ultimate principle of Teleology” (CW 8, 951) An action is objectively right if it maximizes happiness; however, an action is morally right if it is in accordance with social rules which are protected by internal and external sanctions and which tend to promote general utility. Subsets of right ones are morally right actions; subsets of wrong actions are morally wrong.

Mill’s differentiation between a moral and a non-moral sphere of action is not far from our everyday understanding. We generally believe that not all actions must be judged in regard to a moral point of view. This does not exclude us from valuing actions, which are not in the moral realm, in regard to prudence. Less evident is how one should take Mill’s claim that the promotion of happiness can be understood as a general principle of rightness even with respect to artistic production. Many artists would presumably not be comfortable with the thesis that good art arises from the goal of facilitating the happiness of humankind. This however is not what Mill means. Apart from cases of conflict between secondary principles, the First Formula does not guide action. Just as Mill speaks in a moral context about how noble characters will not strive to maximize general happiness (CW 8, 952), he could argue in an aesthetic context that artists should work from a purely aesthetic point of view. The rules of artistic judgments, nonetheless, are justified through their contribution to the flourishing of human life.

To summarize the essential points: Mill can be characterized as an act utilitarian in regard to the theory of objective rightness, but as a rule utilitarian in regard to the theory of moral obligation. He defines morality as a system of rules that is protected by sanctions. The principle of utility is not a part of this system, but its fundamental justification (the “foundation of morality” (CW 10, 205)).

8. Right in Proportion and Tendencies

(i) For contemporary readers it is striking that Mill’s First Formula does not explicitly relate to maximization. Mill does not write, as one might expect, that only the action which leads to the best consequences is right. In other places in the text we hear of the “promotion” or “multiplication” of happiness, and not of the “maximization”. Alone does the “Greatest Happiness Principle” explicitly refer to maximization. The actual formula, in contrast, has to do with gradual differences (right in proportion). Actions which add to the sum of happiness in the world but fail to maximize happiness thus can be right, even if to a lesser degree.

This is confusing insofar as it would be unreasonable to prefer that which is worse to that which is better. For every good there is a better that one should reasonably choose until one succeeds to the best. If the First Formula expresses the ideal of practical reason, then one should expect that it requires maximization. Maybe Mill’s point is that the search for a global best option would exceed the cognitive capabilities of humans. He probably does not want to suggest that an agent should not choose the best local option. But the local best option must not represent the objective (global) best. This may be the reason why Mill does not refer to maximization in the formula of utility.

(ii) A further complication arises with the word “tend”. According to the formula of utility, actions are more or less correct insofar as they facilitate happiness (CW 10, 210). It is doubtlessly not the same to say that an action is right if it actually facilitates happiness, or to say that it is right if it tends to facilitate happiness. The model seems to be roughly this: At the neutral point of the preference scale, actions have the tendency – in regard to the status quo – to neither increase nor decrease the mass of utility in the world. All actions that tend to facilitate happiness are right, all actions that tend to be harmful are wrong, but all are not in the same measure. An action has a high positive value on the scale of preference, if its tendency to facilitate happiness is high. An action has highly negative value on the preference scale, if its tendency to evoke unhappiness is high. But what does the concept “tendency” mean precisely?

In everyday language, we often use the word “tend” in the sense of “will probably lead to”. That an action tends to produce a particular consequence means that this consequence has a high probability. Mill could have wanted to say that an action is right in proportion to the probability with which it promotes happiness. This makes sense when we compare options that produce the same amount of happiness. But what about cases in which two actions produce different amounts of pleasure? One plausible answer is that both dimensions must be regarded: the amount of happiness and the probability of its occurrence. Action A is better than action B, if the expected happinessfor Ais greater than the expected happiness for B. If one reads Mill this way, then “in proportion” relates to “promote” and to “tend”. The best action is one that maximizes the amount of expected happiness.

9. Utility and Justice

In the final chapter of Utilitarianism, Mill turns to the sentiment of justice. Actions that are perceived as unjust provoke outrage. The spontaneity of this feeling and its intensity makes it impossible for it to be ignored by the theory of morals. Mill considers two possible interpretations of the source of the sentiment of justice: first of all, that we are equipped with a sense of justice which is an independent source of moral judgment; second, that there is a general and independent principle of justice. Both interpretations are irreconcilable with Mill’s position, and thus it is no wonder that he takes this issue to be of exceptional importance. He names the integration of justice the only real difficulty for utilitarian theory (CW 10, 259).

Mill splits this problem of integration into three tasks: The first consists in explaining the intensity and spontaneity of the sentiment of justice. The second task is to make plausible that the various types of judgments about justice can be traced back to a systematic core; and the third task consists in showing that the principle of utility constructs this core.

In a nutshell, Mill explains the sentiment of justice as the sublimation of the impulse to take revenge for perceived mortifications of all kinds. Mill sees vengeance as “an animal desire” (CW 10, 250) that operates in the service of self-preservation. If it is known that one will not accept interventions in spheres of influence and interest, the probability of such interventions dwindles. The preparedness to take revenge tends to deter aggression in the first place. Thus, a reputation for vindictiveness – at first glance an irrational trait – arguably has survival value. This helps to explain why the sentiment is so widespread and vehement.

Our sentiment of justice, for Mill, is based on a refinement and sublimation of this animal desire. Humans are capable of empathizing such that the pleasure of others can instill one’s own pleasure, and the mere sight of suffering can cause own suffering. The hurting of another person or even an animal may therefore produce a very similar affect as the hurting of one’s own person. Mill considers the extension of the animal impulse of vengeance on those with whom we have sympathy as “natural” (CW 10, 248), because the social feelings are for him natural. This natural extension of the impulse of revenge with the help of the social feelings represents a step in the direction of cultivating and refining human motivation. People begin to feel outrage when the interests of the members of their tribe are being violated or when shared social rules are being disregarded.

Gradually, sympathy becomes more inclusive. Humans discover that co-operation with people outside the tribe is advantageous. The “human capacity of enlarged sympathy” follows suit (CW 10, 248).

As soon as humans begin to think about which parts of the moral code of a society are justified and which parts are not, they inevitably begin to consider consequences. This often occurs in non-systematic, prejudiced or distorted ways. Across historical periods of times, the correct ideas of intrinsic good and moral rightness will gradually gain more influence. Judgments about justice approximate progressively the requirements of utilitarianism: The rules upon which the judgments about justice rest will be assessed in light of their tendency to promote happiness. To summarize: Our sentiment of justice receives its intensity from the “animal desire to repel or retaliate a hurt or damage to oneself”, and its morality from the “human capacity of enlarged sympathy” and intelligent self-interest (CW 10, 250).

According to Mill, when we see a social practice or a type of action as unjust, we see that the moral rights of persons were harmed. The thought of moral rights is the systematic core of our judgments of justice. Rights breed perfect obligations, says Mill. Moral rights are concerned with the basic conditions of a good life. They protect an “extraordinarily important and impressive kind of utility.” (CW 10, 250-251). Mill subsumes this important and impressive kind of utility under the term security, “the most vital of all interests” (CW 10, 251). It comprises such things as protection from aggression or starvation, the possibility to shape one’s own life unmolested by others and enforcement of contracts. Thus, the requirements of justice “stand higher in the scale of social utility” (CW 259).To have a moral right means to have something that society is morally required to guard either through the compulsion of law, education or the pressure of public opinion (CW 10, 250). Because everyone has an interest in the security of these conditions, it is desirable that the members of society reciprocally guarantee each other “to join in making safe for us the very groundwork of our existence” (CW 10, 251).Insofar as moral rights secure the basis of our existence, they serve our natural interest in self-preservation – this is the reason why their harm calls forth such intense emotional reactions. The interplay of social feelings and moral education explains, in turn, why we are not only upset by injustices when we personally suffer, but also when the elemental rights of others are harmed. This motivates us to sanction the suffering of others as unjust. Moral rights thus form the “most sacred and binding part of all morality” (CW 10, 255). But they do not exhaust the moral realm. There are imperfect obligations which have no correlative right (CW 10, 247).

The thesis that moral rights form the systematic core of our judgments of justice is by no means unique to utilitarianism. Many people take it to be evident that individuals have absolute, inalienable rights; but they doubt that these rights can be grounded in the principle of utility. Intuitionists may claim that we recognize moral rights spontaneously, that we have intuitive knowledge of them. In order to reject such a view, Mill points out that our judgments of justice do not form a systematic order. If we had a sense of justice that would allow us to recognize what is just, similar to how touch reveals forms or sight reveals color, then we would expect that our corresponding judgments would exhibit a high degree of reliability, definitude and unanimity. But experience teaches us that our judgments regarding just punishments, just tax laws or just remuneration for waged labor are anything but unanimous. The intuitionists must therefore mobilize a first principle that is independent of experience and that secures the unity and consistency of our theory of justice. So far they have not succeeded. Mill sees no suggestion that is plausible or which has been met with general acceptance.

10. The Proof of Utilitarianism

What Mill names the “proof” of utilitarianism belongs presumably to the most frequently attacked text passages in the history of philosophy. Geoffrey Sayre-McCord once remarked that Mill seems to answer by example the question of how many serious mistakes a brilliant philosopher can make within a brief paragraph (Sayre-McCord 2001, 330). Meanwhile the secondary literature has made it clear that Mill’s proof contains no logical fallacies and is less foolish than often portrayed.

It is found in the fourth part, “Of What Sort of Proof the Principle of Utility is Susceptible”, of Utilitarianism. For the assessment of the proof two introductory comments are helpful. Already at the beginning of Utilitarianism, Mill points out that “questions of ultimate ends are not amenable to direct proof.” (CW 10, 207). Notwithstanding, it is possible to give reasons for theories about the good, and these considerations are “equivalent to proof” (CW 10, 208). These reasons are empirical and touch upon the careful observation of oneself and others. More cannot be done and should not be expected in a proof re ultimate ends.

A further introductory comment concerns the basis of observation through which Mill seeks to support utilitarianism. In moral philosophy the appeal to intuitions plays a prominent role. They are used to justify moral claims and to check the plausibility of moral theories. The task of thought-experiments in testing ethical theories is analogous to the observation of facts in testing empirical theories. This suggests that intuitions are the right observational basis for the justification of first moral principles. Mill, however, was a fervent critic of intuitionism throughout his philosophical work. In his Autobiography he calls intuitionism “the great intellectual support of false doctrines and bad institutions.” (CW 1, 232). Mill considered the idea that truths can be known a priori, independently of observation and experience, to be a stronghold of conservatism.

His argument against intuitionistic approaches to moral philosophy has two parts. The first part points out that intuitionists have not been able to bring our intuitive moral judgments into a system. There is neither a complete list of intuitive moral precepts nor a basic principle of morality which would found such a list(CW 10, 206).

The second part of the Millian argument consists in an explanation of this result: What some call moral intuition is actually the result of our education and present social discourse. Society inculcates us with our moral views, and we come to believe strongly in their unquestionable truth. There is no system, no basic principle in the moral views of the Victorian era though. In The Subjection of Women, Mill caustically criticizes the moral intuitions of his contemporaries regarding the role of women. He finds them incompatible with the basic principles of the modern world, such as equality and liberty. Because the first principle of morality is missing, intuitionist ethics is in many regards just a decoration of the moral prejudices with which one is brought up –“(…) not so much a guide as a consecration of men’s actual sentiments” (CW 10, 207).

What we need, Mill contends, is a basis of observation that verifies a first principle, a principle that is capable of bringing our practice of moral judgments into order. This elemental observational basis – and this is the core idea in Mill’s proof – is human aspiration.

His argument for the utilitarian principle – if not a deductive argument, an argument all the same – involves three steps. First, Mill argues that it is reasonable for humans to aspire to one’s own well-being; second, that it is reasonable to support the well-being of all persons (instead of only one’s own); and third, that well-being represents the only ultimate goal and the rightness of our actions is to be measured exclusively in regard to the balance of happiness to which they lead (CW 10, 234).

Let us turn to the first step of the argument. Upon an initial reading it seems in fact to have little success. Mill argues that one’s own well-being is worthy of striving for because each of us strives for his or her own well-being. Here he leans on a questionable analogy: “The only proof capable of being given that an object is visible, is that people actually see it. […] In like manner, I apprehend, the sole evidence it is possible to produce that anything is desirable, is that people do actually desire it.” (CW 10, 234).

Can a more evident logical fallacy be given than the claim that something is worthy of striving for because it is factually sought? But Mill in no way believes that the relation between desirable and desired is a matter of definition. He is not saying that desirable objects are by definition objects which people desire; he writes instead that what people desire is the only evidence for what is desirable. If we want to know what is ultimately desirable for humans, we have to acquire observational knowledge about what humans ultimately strive for.

Mill’s argument is simple: We know by observation that people desire their own happiness. With a conclusion that Mill calls “inductive”, and to which he ascribes a central role in regard to our acquisition of knowledge, we succeed to the general thesis that all humans finally aspire to their happiness. This inductive conclusion serves as evidence for the claim that one’s own happiness is not only desired, but desirable, worthy of aspiration. Mill thus supports the thesis that one’s own happiness is an ultimate good to oneself with the observation that every human ultimately strives for his or her own well-being.

On this basis, Mill concludes in the second step of his proof that the happiness of all is also a good: “…each person’s happiness is a good to that person, and the general happiness, therefore, a good to the aggregate of all persons.” (CW 10, 234).

The “therefore” in the cited sentence above has evoked many a raised eyebrows. Does Mill claim here that each person tries to promote the happiness of all? This seems to be patently wrong. In a famous letter to a Henry Jones, he clarifies that he did not mean that every person, in fact, strives for the general good. “I merely meant in this particular sentence to argue that since A’s happiness is a good, B’s a good, C’s a good, &c., the sum of all these goods must be a good.” (CW 16, 1414, Letter 1257).

Indeed, in the “particular sentence” he just concludes that general happiness is a “good to the aggregate of all persons.” Nonetheless, one may doubt that Mill adequately responds to Jones’ reservations. It is unclear what it means that general happiness is the good of the aggregate of all persons. Neither each person, nor the aggregate of all persons seem to strive for the happiness of all. But Mill’s point in the second step of the argument is arguably a more modest one.

He simply wanted to vindicate the claim that if each person’s happiness is a good to each person, then we are entitled to conclude that general happiness is also a good. As he says in the letter to Jones: “the sum of all these goods must be a good.” Similar to the first step of the argument we have here an epistemic relationship: The fact that each person is striving for his or her own happiness is evidence that happiness as such (regardless to whom) is valuable. If happiness as such is valuable, it is not unreasonable to promote the well-being of all sentient beings. With this, the second step of the argument is complete. The result may seem meager at first. That it is not unreasonable to promote the happiness of all appears to be no particularly controversial claim. On closer inspection, however, Mill’s conclusion is quite interesting since it imposes pressure on self-interest theories of practical rationality. The “notion that self-interest possesses a special, underived rationality (…) seems suddenly to require justification.” (Skorupski 1989, 311).What Mill fails to show is that each person has most reason to promote the general good. One should note, however, that the aim of the proof is not to answer the question why one should be moral. Mill does not want to demonstrate that we have reason to prefer general happiness to personal happiness.

Hedonism states not only that happiness is intrinsically good, but also that it is the only good and thus the only measure for our action. To show this, is the goal of the third step of the proof. Mill’s reflections in this step are based on psychological hedonism and the principle of association. According to Mill, humans cannot desire anything except that which is either aninstrument to or a component of happiness. He concedes that people seem to strive for every possible thing as ultimate ends. Philosophers may pursue knowledge as their ultimate goal; others value virtue, fame or wealth. Corresponding to his basic thesis that “the sole evidence it is possible to produce that anything is desirable, is that people do actually desire it” (CW 10, 234), Mill must consider the possibility that knowledge, fame or wealth have intrinsic value.

He blocks this inference with the thesis that humans do not “naturally and originally” (CW 10, 235) desire other goods than happiness. That knowledge, virtue, wealth or fame is seen as intrinsically valuable is due to the operation of the principle of association. In the course of our socialization, goods, like knowledge, virtue, wealth or fame acquire value by their association with pleasure. A philosopher came to experience knowledge as pleasurable, and this is why he desires it. Humans strive for virtue and other goods only if they are associated with the natural and original tendency to seek pleasure and avoid pain. Virtue, knowledge or wealth can thus become parts of happiness. At this point, Mill declares that the proof is completed.

11. Evaluating Consequences

According to Mill’s Second Formula of the utilitarian standard, a good human life must be rich in enjoyments, in both quantitative and qualitative respects. A manner of existence without access to the higher pleasures is not desirable: “It is better to be a human being dissatisfied than a pig satisfied; better to be Socrates dissatisfied than a fool satisfied.” (CW 10, 212).

The life of Socrates is better because no person who is familiar with higher pleasures will trade the joy of philosophizing against an even infinite amount of lower pleasures, Mill suggests. This does not amount to a modern version of Aristotle’s’ view that only a life completely devoted to theoretical activity is desirable. One must not forget that Mill is a hedonist after all. What kind of life is joyful and therefore good for a particular person depends upon many factors, such as tastes, talents and character. There are a great variety of lifestyles that are equally good. But Mill insists that a human life that is completely deprived of higher pleasures is not as good as it could be. It is not a desirable “mode of existence”, nothing a “competent judge” would choose.

Utilitarianism demands that we establish and observe a system of social, legal and moral rules that enables all mankind to have the best life possible, a life that is “as rich as possible in enjoyments, both in point of quantity and quality” (CW 10, 214). Mill’s statement that every human has an equal claim “to all the means of happiness” (CW 10, 258), belongs in this context. Society must make sure that the social-economic preconditions of a non-impoverished life prevail. In one text passage, Mill even includes the happiness of animals. Animals, too, should have the best possible life, “so far as the nature of things admits” (CW 10, 214).

The Second Formula maintains that a set of social rules A is better than the set B, if in A less humans suffer from an impoverished, unhappy life and more enjoy a fulfilled, rich life than in B.

More difficult is the question how to evaluate scenarios that involve unequal population sizes. With Mill there is no explicit unpacking of this problem; but his advocacy of the regulation of birth gives us at least an indication of the direction in which his considerations would go. Let us consider the following example: Which world would be better: world X in which 1000 humans have a fulfilled life and 100 a bad one, or world Y in which 10000 humans have a fulfilled life and 800 an impoverished one? The answer to this question depends on whether we focus on the minimizing the number of bad lives or on maximizing the number of good lives, and whether we measure this absolutely or relatively to the total population.

(i) One possible answer concerns the minimization of the number of bad lives. This can mean the absolute number of humans with joyless or impoverished lives. If one answers this way, then world X would be better than world Y because in this world the absolute number of humans with bad lives would be less. But it is also possible to think of the Second Formula as a statement about the relative number of humans with bad lives; in this case world Y would be preferable.

(ii) Another possible answer emphasizes the maximization of fulfilled lives. If one follows this interpretation, then world Y is better than world X because in this world absolute and relative measurements suggest that more humans have fulfilled lives.

Under the influence of Malthus, Mill insisted throughout his work that the problem of poverty is to be resolved only through a reduction of the population number – as noted, he encouraged the regulation of birth. This proposal is reconcilable with all three interpretations, but does not bear any relation to the question concerning which of the interpretations he could have preferred. One can speculate how Mill would answer, but there is not clear textual basis.

A further theme that Mill does not address concerns the problem of measurement and the interpersonal comparison of quantities of happiness. From an utilitarian point of view, other things being equal, it makes no moral difference whether A or B experiences an equal quantity of happiness (CW 10, 258). A quantity of happiness for A bears precisely as much value as a quantity of happiness for B. But this answers neither the question of measurement nor the question of the comparison of interpersonal utility. Can quantities of happiness be measured like temperatures? The philosopher and economist Francis Edgeworth spoke in his 1881 Mathematical Psychics of a fictitious instrument of measurement, a hedonimeter, with whose help the quantities of pleasure and pain could be determined with scientific accuracy.

Or do amounts of happiness have to be assessed approximately, such that Harriet Taylor for example can say that she is happier today than she was yesterday. Interpersonal comparisons of utility are confronted with the related question whether and under which conditions one can say that, for instance, Harriet Taylor and John Stuart Mill experience an equal amount of happiness.

Mill gave both themes little attention. But probably he was convinced that precise measurement and comparison of interpersonal utility would not be needed, maybe not even possible. One often does not need a thermometer to discern whether or not an object is warmer than another. Similarly, in many cases we do not need something like a hedonimeter to judge whether the condition of world A is better than that of world B. We need only a reasonable degree of experience and the capacity to empathize. Often, though, we may be unsure what to say. Which of two systems of income tax, for instance, promotes general happiness more? Mill’s position here seems to be that we have to decide questions like these by means of public debate and not by means of a hedonimeter.

Regarding moral rights, “the most sacred and binding part of all morality” (CW 10, 255), all competent judges seem to agree that they promote general happiness. Our capacity to estimate quantities and qualities of happiness is thus sufficiently good in order to conclude that a society that does protect “the most vital of all interests” (CW 10, 251) is better than a society that does not.

12. Freedom of Will

In various places of his work John Stuart Mill occupied himself with the question of the freedom of the human will. The respective chapter in the System ofLogic he later claimed was the best part of the entire book. Here Mill presents the solution to a problem with which he wrestled not only intellectually. In his Autobiography he calls it a “heavy burden” and reports: “I pondered painfully on the subject.” (CW 1, 177)

Freedom of the will is a traditional philosophical problem whose roots stretch back to antiquity. The problem results from the conflict of two positions: On the one hand, that all events – and thus also all actions – have causes from which they necessarily follow; on the other hand, that humans are free. Both claims cannot be reconciled, or so it seems, and this is the problem.

Mill is a determinist and assumes that human actions follow necessarilyfrom antecedent conditions and psychological laws. This apparently commits him to the claim that humans are not free; for if their actions occurred necessarily and inevitably, then they could not act otherwise. With perfect knowledge of antecedent conditions and psychological laws, we could predict human behavior with perfect accuracy.

But Mill is convinced that humans are free in a relevant sense. In modern terminology, this makes him a compatibilist, someone who believes in the reconcilability of determinism and free will. Part of his solution to the problem of compatibility is based on the discovery of a “misleading association”, which accompanies the word “necessity”. We have to differentiate between the following two statements: On the one hand, that actions occur necessarily; on the other hand, that they are predetermined and agents have no influence on them. Corresponding to this is the differentiation of the doctrine of necessity (determinism) and the doctrine of fatalism. Fatalism is indeed not compatible with human freedom, says Mill, but determinism is.

He grounds his thesis that determinism is reconcilable with a sense of human freedom, first, (i) with a repudiation of common misunderstandings regarding the content of determinism and, second, (ii) with a presentation of what he takes to be the appropriate concept of human freedom.

(i) With regard to human action, the “doctrine of necessity” claims that actions are determined by the external circumstances and the effective motives of the person at a given point in time. Causal necessity means that events are accompanied not only factually without exception by certain effects, but would also be under counter-factual circumstances. Given the preconditions and laws, it is necessary that a person acts in a certain way, and a well-informed observer would have predicted precisely this. As things were, this had to happen.

Fatalism advocates a completely different thesis. It claims that all essential events in life are fixed, regardless of antecedent conditions or psychological laws. Nothing could change their occurrence. If someone’s fate is to die on a particular day, there is no way of changing it. One finds this kind of fatalism in Sophocles “Oedipus”. Oedipus is destined to kill his father and marry his mother and his desperate attempts to avoid his foretold fate are in vain. The determinists of his day, Mill suggests, were “more or less obscurely” also fatalists – and he thought that this explains the predominance of the belief that human will can be free only if determinism is false.

(ii) Mill now turns to the question of whether determinism – correctly understood – is indeed incompatible with the doctrine of free will. His central idea is, firstly, that determinism in no way excludes the possibility that a person can influence his or her character; and secondly, that the ability to have influence on one’s own character is what we mean by free will.

(1) Actions are determined by one’s character and the prevailing external  circumstances. The character of a person is constituted by his or her motives, habits, convictions and so forth. All these are governed by psychological laws. A person’s character is not given at birth. It is being formed through education; the goals that we pursue, the motives and convictions that we have depend to a large degree on our socialization. But if it is possible to form someone’s character by means of education, then it is also possible to form one’s own character through self-education: “We are exactly as capable of making our own character, if we will, as others are of making it for us.”

If we have the wish to change ourselves, then we can. Experience teaches us that we are capable of having influence on our habits and attitudes. The desire to change oneself resides, for Mill, in the individual, thus in our selves. Discontent with oneself and one’s own life, or the admiration for another lifestyle may be reasons why one wants to change (CW 8, 841).

(2) The ability to influence the formation of one’s own character, for Mill, is the substance of the doctrine of free will: “(…) that what is really inspiring and ennobling in the doctrine of freewill, is the conviction that we have real power over the formation of our own character; that our will, by influencing some of our circumstances, can modify our future habits or capabilities of willing. All this was entirely consistent with the doctrine of circumstances, or rather, was that doctrine itself, properly understood.” (CW 1, 177). Nothing more is intended by the doctrine of free will: We are capable of acting in a way that corresponds to our own desires; and we are, if we want, capable of shaping our desires. More precisely said, Mill advocates the idea that we are in a measure free, insofar as we can become those who we want to be.

One may object here that Mill’s theory presumes the desire to change. But what about those who do not want to change? If one does not want to change, then one could not change. And with this, not all humans are free. But such an objection presumes that those who do not have the desire to change themselves are missing something (namely, the desire to change), and that, because of this lack, they are less free. But Mill contends that persons in certain ways “are their desires”. If someone is lacking the desire to change, he or she is no less free than a person who has this desire. It is not as if one were simply missing an entry upon a list of choices. The “I” does not choose between various desires and options; instead it is rather that “one’s self” is identified with one’s desires: “…it is obvious that ‘I’ am both parties in the contest; the conflict is between me and myself; between (for instance) me desiring a pleasure, and me dreading self-reproach. What causes Me, or, if you please, my Will, to be identified with one side rather than with the other, is that one of the Me’s represents a more permanent state of feelings than the other one does.” (CW 9, 452).

The thought that there is no “I” is also the reason why Mill rejects the idea that freedom presupposes the capacity to refrain from an act in a given situation (“I could have done otherwise”). Mill finds the idea utterly curious that someone’s will was only free if he could have acted differently. For what does it mean to say that “(o)ne could have acted differently?” Is it supposed to mean that one could have chosen what one did not want to choose (CW 9, 450)?According to Mill’s analysis, what we mean by the phrase (that we could have acted differently) is this: If the circumstances, or my character or my mood or my knowledge and so forth, would have been different, I would have acted differently. Without such variations, the thought that one could have acted differently seems strange to Mill:“I dispute therefore altogether that we are conscious of being able to act in opposition to the strongest present desire or aversion.” (CW 9, 453). Because a person cannot counteract an effective desire, he is necessarily determined by it – just as things are.

13. Responsibility and Punishment

Mill variously examines the thesis that punishment is only justified if the perpetrator could have acted differently. A contemporary of Mill’s, the social reformer Robert Owen, claimed that punishment of the breaking of social norms is unjustified, because the character of a person is the result of social influences. No one is the author of himself. Because actions follow from the character and one is not responsible for this, it is not just to punish people for the violation of norm which they could not help violating. It was not within their power to act differently. And it is unjust to punish someone for something, if he could not do anything to hinder its occurrence (CW 9, 453).

Mill responds to Owen’s criticism that persons could very well have influence on their characters, if they wanted. But does this satisfy us as a defence of punishment for the breaking of norms? It might be right that someone who does not want to change will not become depressed about his inability to change (CW 8, 841). Probably the thought will not even occur to him. But the point here is not whether one’s inability is a source of depression or not. The point is whether it is fair to punish people for actions which they could not control. If one lacks the respective desire, then one cannot change one’s character. It seems unfair to blame a person for her rotten character if there is no “I” that we can accuse of failing to have the desire to change.

Mill’s solution to this problem is somewhat surprising. We have to be clear as to what it means to say that a person “could not have acted differently”. Certainly, it does not mean that a person would have performed a particular act under all conceivable circumstances. This would be the case, if humans were programmed like robots to act in certain ways, regardless of the external conditions. In actual fact, one can in almost all cases imagine variations in circumstances that would effectively hold a person back from acting how he or she acted. Someone with criminal tendencies might not be able to keep himself from acting criminally, because he does not consider the possibility that he will be severely punished if caught. “If, on the contrary, the impression is strong in his mind that a heavy punishment will follow, he can, and in most cases does, help it.” (CW 9, 458)

It is the purpose of punishments to reduce anti-social behavior, in particular the violation of moral rights, “the most vital of all interests” (CW 10, 251). The justification of punishment consists in the fact that it serves this justified goal (CW 9, 459-460). If someone cannot be restrained from breaking the norm through the threat of punishment, then the threat of punishment was ineffective in regard to this individual. It was not enough – seen in the light of his character and his perception of the situation – to discourage him from violating the norm. But that the criminal inclinations of an individual is higher than average and that it had therefore needed a stronger incentive in order to bring him to respect the norm makes neither the punishment nor the threat of punishment unjust or illegitimate.

According to Mill, conceiving oneself as a morally responsible agent does not mean to see oneself as an “I” who could have acted differently. It means to consider oneself as member of a moral community entitled to sanction the violation of justified social norms. This idea of moral responsibility does not seem far-fetched. A person may well agree that it is appropriate to punish him for the violation of moral rights, even if he “could not have done otherwise” under the given circumstances.

14. References and Further Readings

a. Primary Sources

  • Mill, John Stuart, The Collected Works of John Stuart Mill. Gen. Ed. John M. Robson. 33 vols. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1963-91.
    • The standard scholarly edition including Mill’s published works, letters, and notes; cited in the text as CW volume, page.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Bain, Alexander, 1882, John Stuart Mill. A Criticism: With Personal Recollections, London: Longmans, Green, and Co.
  • Berger, Fred R., 1984, Happiness, Justice, and Freedom: The Moral and Political Philosophy of John Stuart Mill, Berkeley & Los Angeles: U. of California Press.
  • Bradley, Francis H., 1876/1988, Ethical Studies, reprint of the second edition, Oxford: OUP.
  • Brink, David, 1992, “Mill’s Deliberative Utilitarianism”, in: Philosophy & Public Affairs 21, pp. 67-103.
  • Brown, D. G., 1973, “What is Mill’s Principle of Utility?”, in: Canadian Journal of Philosophy 3 (1), pp. 1-12.
  • Coope, Christopher M., 1998, “Was Mill a Utilitarian?”, Utilitas 10 (1), pp. 33-67.
  • Crisp, Roger, 1997, Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Mill on Utilitarianism, London: Routledge.
  • Donner, Wendy, 1991, The Liberal Self. John Stuart Mill’s Moral and Political Philosophy, Ithaca & London: Cornell UP.
  • Donner, Wendy & Richard Fumerton, 2009, Mill, Chichester: Wiley-Blackwell (Blackwell Great Minds).
  • Eggleston, Ben/Dale E. Miller/David Weinstein (eds.), 2011, John Stuart Mill and the Art of Life, Oxford: OUP.
  • Fuchs, Alan, 2006, “Mill’s Theory of Morally Correct Action”, in: The Blackwell Guide to Mill’s Utilitarianism, edited by Henry R. West, Oxford: Blackwell, 139-158.
  • Green, Thomas H., 1883/2003, Prolegomena to Ethics, edited by David O. Brink, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Grote, John, 1870, An Examination of the Utilitarian Philosophy, edited by Joseph Bickersteth, Cambridge: Deighton, Bell, and Co.
  • Lyons, David, 1978/1994, “Mill’s Theory of Justice, in: Rights, Welfare, and Mill’s Moral Theory, Oxford: OUP, 67-88.
  • Lyons, David, 1994, Rights, Welfare, and Mill’s Moral Theory, Oxford: OUP.
  • Miller, Dale E., 2010, J. S. Mill. Moral, Social and Political Thought, Cambridge: CUP.
  • Miller, Dale E., 2011, “Mill, Rule Utilitarianism, and the Incoherence Objection”, in: Eggleston, Ben/Dale E. Miller/David Weinstein (eds.), 2011, John Stuart Mill and the Art of Life, Oxford: OUP, 94-116.
  • Rawls, John, 1971/1999, A Theory of Justice. Revised Edition, Cambridge/Mass.: Belknap Press of HUP.
  • Rawls, John, 2008, Lectures on the History of Political Philosophy, edited by Samuel Freeman, Cambridge/Mass.: Belknap Press of HUP.
  • Reeves, Richard, 2007, John Stuart Mill. Victorian Firebrand, London: Atlantic Books.
  • Riley, Jonathan, 1988, Liberal Utilitarianism. Social Choice Theory and J. S. Mill’s Philosophy, Cambridge: CUP.
  • Sayre-McCord, Geoffrey, 2001, “Mill’s ‘Proof’ of the Principle of Utility: A More than Half-Hearted Defense”, in: Social Philosophy & Policy 18, 330-360.
  • Skorupski, John, 1989, John Stuart Mill. The Arguments of the Philosophers, London & New York: Routledge.
  • Skorupski, John, 2006, Why Read Mill Today? London & New York: Routledge.
  • Urmson, James O., 1953, “The Interpretation of the Moral Philosophy of J. S. Mill”, in: Philosophical Quarterly 3, pp. 33-39.
  • West, Henry R., 2004, An Introduction to Mill’s Ethics, Cambridge: CUP.

 

Author Information

Michael Schefczyk
Email: michael.schefczyk@kit.edu
Karlsruhe Institut für Technologie
Germany

The Yoga Sutras of Patanjali

The tradition of Patañjali in the oral and textual tradition of the Yoga Sūtras is accepted by traditional Vedic schools as the authoritative source on Yoga, and it retains this status in Hindu circles into the present day. In contrast to its modern Western transplanted forms, Yoga essentially consists of meditative practices culminating in attaining a state of consciousness free from all modes of active or discursive thought, and of eventually attaining a state where consciousness is unaware of any object external to itself, that is, is only aware of its own nature as consciousness unmixed with any other object. This state is not only desirable in its own right, but its attainment guarantees the practitioner freedom from every kind of material pain or suffering, and, indeed, is the primary classical means of attaining liberation from the cycle of birth and death in the Indic soteriological traditions, that is, in the theological study of salvation in India. The Yoga Sūtras were thus seen by all schools, not only as the orthodox manual for guidance in the techniques and practices of meditation, but also for the classical Indian position on the nature and function of mind and consciousness, for the mechanisms of action in the world and consequent rebirth, and for the metaphysical underpinnings and description of the attainment of mystical powers.

Table of Contents

  1. Background and Author
  2. Metaphysics
  3. Philosophy and Psychology of Mind
  4. Soteriology and Praxis
  5. Epistemology
  6. Ethics
  7. Theism
  8. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Background and Author

In terms of literary sources, there is evidence as early as the oldest Vedic text, the Ṛg Veda (c. 1200 – c. 1500 B.C.E.), that there were yogī-like ascetics on the margins of the Vedic world. In terms of the archaeological record, seals found in Indus Valley sites (c. 3000 – c. 1500 B.C.E.) with representations of figures seated in a clear yogic posture (the most famous figure is seated in padmāsana, lotus pose, with arms extended and resting on the knees in a classical meditative posture), suggest that, irrespective of its literary origins, Yoga has been practiced on the Indian subcontinent for well over 4000 years. However, it is in the late Vedic age, marked by the fertile speculations expressed in a genre of texts called the Upaniṣads (c. 800 – c. 600 B.C.E.), that practices that can be clearly related to classical Yoga are first articulated in literary sources.

While the Upaniṣads are especially concerned with jñāna, or understanding Brahman, the Absolute Truth, through the cultivation of knowledge, there are also several unmistakable references to a technique for realizing Brahman (in its localized aspect of ātman) called Yoga. As with the Upaniṣads in general, we do not find a systematic philosophy here, but mystico-poetic utterances, albeit profound in content (Kaṭha Upaniṣad VI.11–18; Śvetāśvatara Upaniṣad II.8–15; Maitrī Upaniṣad VI.18). The Mahābhārata Epic, which is the largest literary epic in the world, also preserves significant material representing the evolution of Yoga, indeed, the term “yoga” and “yogī occur about 900 times throughout the Epic. Usually dated somewhere between the 9th–4th centuries C.E., the Epic exhibits the transition between the origins of Yoga in the Upaniṣadic period and its expression in the systematized traditions of Yoga as represented in the classical period by Patañjali. Nestled in the middle of the Epic, the well-known Bhagavad Gītā (c. 4th century B.C.E.), devotes a good portion of its bulk to the practices of Yoga, which it considers to be “ancient” (IV.3).

This, of course, indicates that practices associated with Yoga had gained wide currency in the centuries prior to the common era, with a clearly identifiable set of basic techniques and generic practices, and we will here simply allude to the fact that scholars have long pointed out a commonality of vocabulary, and concepts between the Yoga Sūtras (YS) and Buddhist texts. All this underscores the fact that there was a cluster of numerous interconnected and cross-fertilizing variants of meditational YogaBuddhist and Jain as well as Hindu – prior to Patañjali, all drawn from a common but variegated pool of terminologies, practices and concepts (and, indeed, many strains continue to the present day). Of closer relevance to the Sūtras is the fact that the history of Yoga is inextricable from that of the Sāṁkhya tradition. Sāṁkhya provides the metaphysical infrastructure for Yoga (discussed in the section on metaphysics), and thus is indispensable to an understanding of Yoga. While both Yoga and Sāṁkhya share the same metaphysics and the common goal of liberating purua from its encapsulation, their methods differ.

Sāṁkhya occupies itself with the path of reasoning to attain liberation, specifically concerning itself with the analysis of the manifold ingredients of prakti from which the purua was to be extricated, and Yoga more with the path of meditation, focusing its attention on the nature of mind and consciousness, and the techniques of concentration in order to provide a practical method through which the purua can be isolated and extricated. Sāṁkhya seems to have been perhaps the earliest philosophical system to have taken shape in the late Vedic period, and has permeated almost all subsequent Hindu traditions; indeed the classical Yoga of Patañjali has been seen as a type of neo-Sāṁkhya, updating the old Sāṁkhya tradition to bring it into conversation with the more technical philosophical traditions that had emerged by the 3–5th centuries C.E., particularly Buddhist thought. In fact, Sāṁkhya and Yoga should not be considered different schools until a very late date: the first reference to Yoga itself as a distinct school seems to be in the writings of Śaṅkara in the 9th century C.E. Yoga and Sāṁkhya in the Upaniṣads and Epic simply refer to the two distinct paths of salvation by meditation and salvation by knowledge, respectively.

One might add, as an aside, that from the 900-odd references to Yoga in the Mahābhārata, there are only two mentions of āsana, posture, the third limb of Patañjali’s system. Neither the Upaniṣads nor the Gītā mention posture in the sense of stretching exercises and bodily poses (the term is used as “seat” rather than bodily postures), and Patañjali himself only dedicates three brief sūtras from his text to this aspect of the practice. The reconfiguring, presentation and perception of Yoga as primarily or even exclusively āsana in the sense of bodily poses, then, is essentially a modern Western phenomenon and finds no precedent in the premodern Yoga tradition. From this rich and fertile post-Vedic context, then, emerged an individual called Patañjali whose systematization of the heterogeneous practices of Yoga came to be authoritative for all subsequent practitioners and his system eventually reified into one of the six schools of classical Indian philosophy. It is important to stress here that Patañjali is not the founder or inventor of Yoga, the origins of which, as noted above, had long preceded him in primordial and mythic times.  Patañjali systematized the preexisting traditions and authored what came to be the seminal text for Yoga discipline. There was never one uniform school of Yoga, or Ur-Yoga (or of any Indic school of thought for that matter): there was a plurality of variants, and certainly different conceptualizations of meditative practices that were termed Yoga. For example, while Patañjali organizes his system into eight limbs, and the Mahābhārata, too, speaks of Yoga as having eight “qualities” (aṣṭaguṇita, XII.304.7), as early as in the Maitrī Upaniṣad of the 2nd century B.C.E., there is reference to a six-limbed Yoga (VI.18), as there is in the Viṣṇu Purāṇa (VI.7.91). Along similar lines, there are various references to the twelve yogas and seven dhāraṇās (dhāraṇā is considered the sixth of Patañjali’s limbs) found in the Epic Mahābhārata. Yoga is thus best understood as a cluster of techniques, some more and some less systematized, that pervaded the landscape of ancient India. These overlapped and were incorporated into the various traditions of the day such as the jñāna, knowledge-based traditions, providing these systems with a practical method and technique for attaining an experienced-based transformation of consciousness. Patañjali’s particular systematization of these techniques was in time to emerge as the most dominant, but by no means exclusive, version.

Indeed, internal to his own text, in his very first sūtra, atha yoga anuśāsanam, Patañjali indicates that he is continuing the teachings of Yoga (the verbal prefix anu indicates the continuation of the action denoted by the verb), and the traditional commentators certainly perceive him in this light. In point of fact, the tradition itself ascribes the actual origins of Yoga to the legendary figure Hiraṇyagarbha. Moreover, evidence that Patañjali was addressing an audience already familiar with the tenets of Yoga can be deduced from the Yoga Sūtras themselves. For example, on occasion, Patañjali will mention one member of a list of items followed by “etc.,”, thereby assuming his audience to be familiar with the remainder of the list. But, in short, because he produced the first systematized treatise on the subject, Patañjali was to become the prime or seminal figure for the Yoga tradition after his times, and was accepted as such by other schools. To all intents and purposes, his Yoga Sūtras were to become the canon for the mechanics of generic Yoga, so to speak, that other systems tinkered with, and flavored with their own theological trappings.

As with the reputed founders of the other schools of thought, very little is known about Patañjali himself. Tradition, first evidenced in the commentary of Bhoja Rāja in the 11th century C.E., considers him to be the same Patañjali who wrote the primary commentary on the famous grammar by Pāṇini, and also ascribes to him authorship of a treatise on medicine. There is an ongoing discussion amongst scholars as to whether this was likely or not, but there is not much to be gained by challenging the evidence of traditional accounts in the absence of alternative evidence to the contrary that is uncontroversial or at least adequately compelling.

Patañjali’s date can only be inferred from the content of the text itself. Unfortunately, as with most classical Sanskrit texts from the ancient period, early Sanskrit texts tend to be impossible to date with accuracy, and there are always dissenters against whatever dates become standard in academic circles. Most scholars seem to date the text shortly after the turn of the common era, (c. 1st – c. 2nd century C.E.), but it has been placed as early as several centuries before the common era. Other than the fact that the text does not postdate the 5th century C.E., the date of the Yoga Sūtras cannot be determined with exactitude.

The Sūtra writing style is that used by the philosophical schools of ancient India (thus we have Vedānta Sūtras, Nyāya Sūtras, etc.). The term “sūtra,” (from the Sanskrit root , cognate with “sew”) literally means a thread, and essentially refers to a terse and pithy philosophical statement in which the maximum amount of information is packed into the minimum amount of words. Knowledge systems were handed down orally in ancient India, and thus source material was kept minimal partly with a view to facilitating memorization. Being composed for oral transmission and memorization, the Yoga Sūtras, and sūtra traditions in general, allowed the student to “thread together” in memory the key ingredients of the more extensive body of material with which the student would become thoroughly acquainted. Thus, each sūtra served as a mnemonic device to structure the teachings and facilitate memorization, almost like a bullet point that would then be elaborated upon.

This very succinctness – the Yoga Sūtras contain about 1200 words in 195 sūtras – and the fact that the sūtras are in places cryptic, esoteric and incomprehensible in their own terms points to the fact that they served as manuals to be used in conjunction with a teacher. Therefore, it is an unrealistic (if not impossible) task to attempt to bypass commentary in the hope of retrieving some original pure, pre-commentarial set of Ur-interpretations

Knowledge systems in ancient Indian were transmitted orally, from master to disciple, with an enormous emphasis on fidelity towards the original set of Sūtras upon which the system is founded, the master unpacking the dense and truncated aphorisms to the students.  Periodically, teachers of particular prominence wrote commentaries on the primary texts of many of these knowledge systems. Some of these gained wide currency to the point that the primary text was always studied in conjunction with a commentary, particularly since texts such as the Yoga Sūtras were designed to be unpacked because they contain numerous sūtras that are incomprehensible without further elaboration. One cannot overstress, therefore, that our understanding of Patañjali’s text is completely dependent on the interpretations of later commentators: it is incomprehensible, in places, in its own terms.

In terms of the overall accuracy of the commentaries there is an a priori likelihood that the interpretations of the Sūtras were faithfully preserved and transmitted orally through the few generations from Patañjali until the first commentary by Vyāsa in the 5th Century C.E. Certainly, the commentators from Vyāsa onwards are remarkably consistent in their interpretations of the essential metaphysics of the system for over fifteen hundred years, which is in marked contrast with the radical differences in essential metaphysical understanding distinguishing commentators of the Vedānta school (a Rāmānuja or a Madhva from a Śaṅkara, for example). While the 15th century commentator Vijñānabhikṣu, for example, may not infrequently quibble with the 9th century commentator Vācaspati Miśra, the differences generally are in detail, not essential metaphysical elements. And while Vijñānabhikṣu may inject a good deal of Vedāntic concepts into the basic dualism of the Yoga system, this is generally an addition (conspicuous and identifiable) to the system rather than a reinterpretation of it. There is thus a remarkably consistent body of knowledge associated with the Yoga school for the best part of a millennium and a half, and consequently one can speak of “the traditional understanding” of the Sūtras in the premodern period without overly generalizing or essentializing.

The first extant commentary by the legendary Vyāsa, typically dated to around the 4–5th century C.E., was to attain a status almost as canonical as the primary text by Patañjali himself. Consequently, the study of the Yoga Sūtras has always been embedded in the commentary that tradition attributes to this greatest of literary figures. Practically speaking, when we speak of the philosophy of Patañjali, what we really mean (or should mean) is the understanding of Patañjali according to Vyāsa: it is Vyāsa who determined what Patañjali’s abstruse Sūtras meant, and all subsequent commentators elaborated on Vyāsa. The Vyāsa Bhāṣya (commentary) becomes inseparable from the Sūtras; an extension of it.  From one sūtra of a few words, Vyāsa might write several lines of comment without which the sūtra remains incomprehensible. Vyāsa’s commentary, the Bhāṣya, thus attains the status of canon, and is almost never questioned by any subsequent commentator. Subsequent commentators base their commentaries on unpacking Vyāsa’s Bhāṣya – rarely critiquing it, but rather expanding or elaborating upon it. It is this point of reference that produces a marked uniformity in the interpretation of the Sūtras in the pre-modern period.

The next commentary is called the Vivaraṇa, attributed to the great Vedāntin Śaṅkara in the 8th – 9th century C.E. It has remained unresolved since it was first questioned in 1927 whether the commentary on the Yoga Sūtras assigned to Śaṅkara is authentically penned by him. The next best known commentator is Vācaspati Miśra, whose commentary, the Tattvavai Śāradī, can be dated with more security to the 9th century C.E.  Vācaspati Miśra was a prolific intellectual, penning important commentaries on the Vedānta, Sāṁkhya, Nyāya and Mīmāṁsā schools in addition to his commentary on the Yoga Sūtras, and was noteworthy for his ability to present each tradition in its own terms, without displaying any overt personal predilection.

A fascinating Arabic translation of Patañjali’s Sūtras was undertaken by the famous Arab traveler and historian al-Bīrunī (973–1050 C.E.), the manuscript of which was discovered in Istanbul in the 1920’s. Roughly contemporaneous with al-Bīrunī is the 11th century King Bhoja, poet, scholar and patron of the arts, sciences and esoteric traditions, in whose commentary, called the Rājamārtaṇ∂a, there are on occasion very valuable insights to be found. In the 15th century, Vijñānabhikṣu wrote a most insightful and useful commentary after that of Vyāsa’s, the Yogavārttika. Vijñānabhikṣu was another prolific scholar, noteworthy for his attempt to harmonize Vedānta and Sāṁkhya concepts. In the 16th century C.E., another Vedāntin, Rāmānanda Sarasvatī, wrote his commentary, called Yogamaṇiprabhā, which also adds little to the previous commentaries. But there are valuable insights contained in the Bhāsvatī by Hariharānanda Āraṇya, written in Bengali, from a context nearer our own times, a standpoint exposed to Western thought, but still thoroughly grounded in tradition. While many other commentaries have been written, these are the primary commentaries written in the pre-modern era. The commentaries written in the modern period, many of which have made massive adjustments to modernity or the sensitivities of the Western market, are beyond the scope of this discussion, which limits itself to classical Yoga philosophy.

The Yoga Sūtras is divided into four padas, chapters. The first, samādhi pāda, defines Yoga as the complete cessation of all active states of mind, and outlines various stages of insight that stem from this. The chapter points to the ultimate goal of Yoga, which is content-less awareness, beyond even the most supreme stages of insight. The second, sādhana pāda, outlines the various practices, and moral and ethical observances that are preliminary requirements to serious meditative practice. The third, vibhūti pada, primarily deals with various super-normal powers that can accrue to the practitioner when the mind is in extreme states of concentration. There seems to have been a widespread culture in ancient India of engaging in Yoga-like practices but not in pursuit of the real goal of Yoga as defined by Patañjali, but rather in quest of such super-normal powers; this chapter can be read as Patañjali’s warning against being side-tracked in this way. The fourth, kaivalya pāda deals with liberation, and, amongst other things, contains Patañjali’s response to the Buddhist challenge.

2. Metaphysics

As noted, Yoga is not to be considered as a school distinct from Sāṁkhya until well after Patañjali’s time, but rather as a different approach or method towards enlightenment, although there are minor differences. Sāṁkhya provides the metaphysical or theoretical basis for the realization of purua, and Yoga the technique or practice itself.  While the Yoga tradition does not agree with the Sāṁkhya view that metaphysical analysis, that is, jñāna, knowledge, constitutes a sufficient path towards enlightenment in and of itself the metaphysical presuppositions of the Yoga system assume those of Sāṁkhya. Leaving aside the numerous variants of Sāṁkhya (the Chinese Buddhist pilgrim Hsöen Tsang’s disciple in the 7th century C.E. reports 18 schools, and the loss of the earlier material, the later khya Kārikā of Iśvarakṛṣṇa (4th–5th century C.E.), has by default become the seminal text of the tradition, just as Patañjali’s Yoga Sūtras has for the Yoga tradition.

In the generic Sāṁkhya (literally “numeration”) system, the universe of animate and inanimate entities is perceived as ultimately the product of two ontologically distinct categories; hence this system is quintessentially dvaita, or dualistic in presupposition. These two categories are prakti, or the primordial material matrix of the physical universe, and purua, the innumerable conscious selves embedded within it. As a result of the interaction between these two entities, the material universe evolves in a series of stages. The actual catalysts in this evolutionary process are the three guas, literally “strands” or “qualities,” which are inherent in prakti. These are: sattva, “lucidity;” rajas, “action;” and tamas, “inertia.” These guas are sometimes compared to the threads which underpin the existence of a rope; just as a rope is actually a combination of threads, so all manifest reality actually consists of a combination of the guas.

Given the meditative focus of the text, the guas are especially significant to Yoga in terms of their psychological manifestation; in Yoga, the mind and therefore all psychological dispositions, are prakti, and therefore also comprised of the guas – the only difference between mind and matter being that the former has a larger preponderance of sattva, and the latter of tamas. Therefore, according to the specific intermixture and proportionality of the guas, living beings exhibit different types of mindsets and psychological dispositions. Thus, when sattva is predominant in an individual, the qualities of lucidity, tranquility, wisdom, discrimination, detachment, happiness, and peacefulness manifest; when rajas is predominant, hankering, attachment, energetic endeavor, passion, power, restlessness and creative activity; and when tamas, the gua least favorable for yoga, is predominant, ignorance, delusion, disinterest, lethargy, sleep, and disinclination towards constructive activity.

The guas are continually interacting and competing with each other, one gua becoming prominent for a while and overpowering the others, only to be eventually dominated in turn by the increase of one of the other guas. They are compared to the wick, fire and oil of the lamp which, while opposed to each other in their nature, come together to produce light. Just as there are an unlimited variety of colors stemming from the intermixture of the three primary colors, different hues being simply expressions of the specific proportionality of red, yellow and blue, so the unlimited psychological dispositions of living creatures (and of physical forms) stem from the intermixture of the guas; specific states of mind being reflections of the particular proportionality of the intermixture of the three guas.

The guas not only underpin the philosophy of mind in Yoga, but the activation and interaction of these gua qualities result in the production of the entirety of physical forms that also evolve from the primordial material matrix, prakti, under the same principle. Thus the physical composition of objects like air, water, stone, fire, etc. differs because of their constitutional makeup of specific guas: air contains more of the buoyancy of sattva, stones more of the sluggishness of the tamas element, and fire, of rajas. The guas allow for the infinite plasticity of prakti and the objects of the world.

The process by which the universe evolves from prakti is usefully compared to the churning of milk: when milk receives a citric catalyst, yogurt, curds, or butter emerge. These immediate products, in turn, can be further manipulated to produce a further series of products – milk desserts, cheese, etc. Similarly, according to classical Sāṁkhya, the first evolute emerging from prakti when it is churned by the guas (sattva specifically) is buddhi, intelligence. Intelligence is characterized by the functions of judgment, discrimination, knowledge, ascertainment, will, virtue and detachment, and sattva is predominant in it. This means that in its purest state, when the potential of rajas and tamas are minimized, buddhi is primarily lucid, peaceful, happy, tranquil and discriminatory, all qualities of sattva. It is the interface between purua and all other praktic evolutes. From this vantage point, it can direct awareness out into the objects and embroilments of the world, or, in its highest potential, it can become aware of the presence of purua and consequently redirect itself towards complete realization of the true source of consciousness that pervades it.

From buddhi, ahakāra, or ego is produced (aham “I” + kāra “doing;” referred to as asmitā in this text). This is characterized by the function of self-awareness and self-identity. It is the discursive aspect that processes and appropriates external reality from the perspective of an individualized sense of self or ego – the notion of “I” and “mine” in human awareness. Ahakāra also limits the range of awareness to fit within and identify with the contours of the particular psychophysical organism within which it finds itself in any one embodiment, as opposed to another. In other words, the ahakāra of a typical, unenlightened, bug acts almost like a concave screen, which refracts consciousness to pervade and appropriate the contours of the bug. If the bug dies and becomes, say, a typical, unenlightened dog and then a typical human in subsequent lives, the ahakāra aspect of the citta adjusts to accommodate and absorb consciousness into these new environments.  Thus the bug thinks it is a bug, the dog thinks it is a dog, and the human thinks he or she is a human.

When ego in turn is “churned” by the guṇa of sattva inherent in it, manas, the mind, is produced. The mind is the seat of the emotions, of like and dislike, and is characterized by controlling the senses – filtering and processing the potentially enormous amount of data accessible to the senses. It primarily receives, sorts, categorizes and then transmits. It serves as the liaison between the activities of the senses transmitting data from the external world, and buddhi, intelligence. It therefore partakes both of internal and external functioning: internally, it is characterized by reflective synthesis, while simultaneously being a sense because it acts similar to the senses. The puruṣa, or self, is cloaked in these psychic layers prior to receiving a gross body and senses. The Yoga school, while using the terminology of (especially) buddhi, but also ahaṁkāra and manas, differs somewhat from that of Sāṁkhya in conceiving these three as interacting functions of the one citta, mind, rather than as three distinct metaphysical layers. Citta, then, as the term used by Patañjali and the commentators to refer to all three of these cognitive functions combined, is one of the most important terms in the Yoga Sūtras.

3. Philosophy and Psychology of Mind

Yoga is defined by Patañjali as “citta vtti nirodha” (YS I.2), the stilling of all states of the citta. There are five vttis, a term used frequently throughout the Yoga Sūtras to essentially refer to any sensual impression, thought, idea, or cognition, psychic activity or conscious mental state whatsoever. These five vttis are: right knowledge, error, metaphor, deep sleep and memory (YS I.5-11). They are either kliṣṭa, detrimental to the goal of Yoga, or akliṣṭa, conducive to it. The kliṣṭa vttis are those stemming from the mind when it is subject to the five kleśas, obstacles – ignorance, ego, desire, aversion, clinging to life – discussed below, and the akliṣṭa vttis are those stemming from their opposites – knowledge of the true self and freedom from desire, etc. Put simply, akliṣṭa vttis are the mental activities of a jivanmukta, a being who is liberated while still embodied.

The first of these five vttis is epistemological, pramāa, that is, the sources that constitute the production of valid knowledge of an object – the methods of attaining accurate information about reality. This is discussed in the section on epistemology, and we will simply note here that the first vtti is when the mind is in a state of right knowledge, that is, is accurately reflecting external reality (Yoga would not disagree with the basics of the Nyāya tradition as to what constitutes right knowledge, nor with the criteria that produce it). The second vtti is error, which can be produced from the same sources as knowledge, and is defined as considering something to be what it is not, a state that can be subsequently removed by true knowledge of what the nature of the thing in question is (such as the perception of two moons when in an intoxicated state).

The third type of vtti is, loosely speaking, imagination or metaphor, or, more precisely, the usage of words or expressions that do not correspond to any actual physical reality, but that are understood in common parlance. An example given in the commentaries is the statement that “the arrow stands still, stood still, will stand still.” What this actually means in the mind of the listener is that the arrow has ceased (or will cease) to move, that is, “standing still,” the absence of motion, is really an imagined state of affairs dependent on the idea of motion, but it is then projected as an actual characteristic of the arrow. A more straightforward example from English usage might be: “the sun rises and sets” or “time flies;” common usage has assigned meaning to these imaginary states of affairs, and no one bats an eyelid when such expressions are uttered. In fact, metaphors and similes, which, if dissected to their literal meanings do not correspond to actual objective reality, are normal everyday expressions and ubiquitous in human language, since language is largely figurative.

The fourth vtti is deep sleep defined as a state of mind which is based on an absence [of any content]. There is some difference between schools but (in contrast to e.g. Vedānta), the Yoga tradition views deep sleep as a type of vtti on the grounds that when one awakes, one remembers that one has either slept well, or slept restlessly, or slept in a stupor. One would not be able to do so if these impressions did not relate back to a state of mind that existed during deep sleep. This is because, in Yoga psychology, memory is the product of saskāra, and saskāra is caused by experience. Therefore, the memory of having slept well must relate to a state of mind experienced during deep sleep, which is recorded in the citta as memory (the topic of the next sūtra) and remembered upon awakening. This state of mind according to this line of reasoning must therefore pertain to a category of vtti distinct from others.

Finally, the fifth vtti is memory, defined as the retention of images of sense objects that have been experienced. Any vtti leaves its copy on the citta before fading away. Memories are generated from and thus depend on the other types of vttis. As noted earlier, every object that has ever been experienced forms a saskāra, an imprint, in the citta mind, like a sound is imprinted on a tape recorder, or an image on film. The mind forms an impression of an object through the sense organs, which is called a pratyaya. Once this pratyaya or active image of this object is no longer of active interest to the mind, it becomes an inactive, or latent, saskāra. Thus vttis, and their pratyaya content, are retained as saskāras when they fade. Memory consists of the retrieval of these saskāras; memories are the reactivation of the imprints of sense objects that one has experienced and recognized in the past that are not too covered by forgetfulness (tamas). However, it is important to note that these saskāras are not just passive imprints but vibrant latent impulses that can get activated under conducive circumstances and can exert influence on a person’s thoughts and behaviors.

The notion of the subconscious in Western psychology corresponds to other less retrievable saskāras, primarily from previous lives, which remain latent as subliminal impressions. The mind is thus a storehouse of these recorded saskāras, deposited and accumulated in the citta over countless lifetimes. Saskāras also account for such things as personality traits, habits, compulsive and addictive behaviors, etc. The stronger or more dominant a cluster of saskāras becomes, the more it activates and imposes itself upon the consciousness of the individual, demanding indulgence and perpetuating a vicious cycle that can be very hard to break (the reverse, of course, also holds true with the benevolent akliṣṭa vttis discussed below: one can become “addicted,” so to speak, to benevolent yogic activities and lifestyle by dint of constant repetition).

Any other states of mind that one might conceive of would be considered by the Yoga tradition as a subset of one of these five essential categories. Since the mind is never static but always active and changing, vttis are constantly being produced, and thus constantly absorb the consciousness of purua away from its own pure nature, channeling it out into the realm of subtle or gross prakti.

As noted above, these five categories of vttis can be either akliṣṭa, conducive (at least initially) to the ultimate goal of Yoga, or kliṣṭa, detrimental. These participial terms assume an awareness of their nominal form, kleśa; there are five kleśas: ignorance, ego, desire, aversion and clinging to life (YS II.3-9). These kleśas are deeper elements of the psyche than their surface level manifestations as vttis. In resonance with all Indic soteriological thought, the first kleśa, ignorance, is the foundation of all the other kleśas, and hence of sasāra, so when ignorance is dispelled, the other kleśas, which may exist in latent unconscious form, or in various stages of consciousness, disappear. It is defined as follows: “Ignorance is the notion which takes the self, which is joyful, pure and eternal, to be the non-self, which is painful, unclean and temporary.” The “non-self,” an-ātman, consists not only of the body, which is the locus for enjoyment; and the mind, which is an instrument through which the awareness of purua can contact the world; but also the accessories or paraphernalia of the body, whether animate (such as spouse, animals, and offspring), or inanimate (such as furniture or food).

Ego is to consider the nature of the seer and the nature of the instrumental power of seeing to be the same thing. In other words, ego is the specific aspect of ignorance which identifies the non-self – specifically the intelligence – with the true self, purua (ātman). Ego and ignorance are to some extent the same thing, but there is a difference in degree. Ignorance initially involves a not-as-yet specific notion of “I-ness,” a sense of self as being something other than purua as yet undefined, a partial identification of the real self with buddhi, the intelligence, while ego involves a more developed or complete identity between the purua self and buddhi. The difference is one of degree; ego evolves out of ignorance, and makes the misidentification of non-self with self more concrete and specific.

Moving on to the third kleśa: the hankering, desire or craving for pleasure or the means to attain pleasure by one who remembers past experiences of pleasure, is attachment, rāga. The key ingredient in this process is memory. In other words, one who has experienced pleasure in the past recollects it and hankers to repeat the experience in the present or future, or to attain the means of repeating the experience. It is this dwelling on past experiences that constitutes “attachment.” When a new means of pleasure is perceived, it is memory that infers that the new means of pleasure is the same as or similar to something that produced pleasure in the past, and therefore promises to provide the same or similar pleasure in the present or future.

The fourth kleśa can be understood in a parallel manner to the previous kleśa of attachment: the feeling of resistance, anger, frustration and resentment towards pain and its causes by one who remembers past experiences of similar pain, is aversion. The tendency of clinging-to-life is the fifth kleśa which is taken to be a synonym for the fear of death.  Just as the previous sūtras indicated that attachment or aversion to something is caused by positive or negative memories of that thing, aversion to death likewise indicates that one’s memory retains unpleasant recollections of past deaths, although these are latent or subconscious in the present life.

When under the influence of the detrimental vttis stemming from the kleśas, the mind becomes attracted or repelled by sense objects drawing its attention. In its attempt to attain that which attracts it, that is, to fulfill desires, and avoid that which repels it, avoid aversions, the mind provokes action, karma, which initiates a vicious reactive cycle. Karma, from the root k, to “do” or “make,” literally means “work,” but inherent in the Indic concept of work, or any type of activity, is the notion that every action breeds a reaction. Thus karma refers not only to an initial act, whether benevolent or malicious, but also to the reaction it produces (pleasant or unpleasant in accordance with the original act) which ripens for the actor either in this life or a future one. Hence people are born into different socio-economic situations, and pleasant or unpleasant things happen to them throughout life in accordance with their own previous actions.

This cycle of action and reaction, or sasāra, is potentially eternal and unlimited since not only does any one single act breed a reaction, but the actor must then react to this reaction causing a re-reaction, which in turn fructifies and provokes re-re-reactions, and so on ad infinitum. Since these reactions and re-reactions, etc., cannot possibly be fitted into one life, they spill over from one lifetime to the next. It is in an attempt to portray the sheer unlimited and eternal productive power of karma that Indic thinkers, both Hindu and Buddhist, use such metaphors as “the ocean” of birth and death. Thus, karma, which keeps consciousness bound to the external world and forgetful of its own nature, is generated by the vttis, and the vttis, in turn, are produced by the kleśas. There is thus a cycle of kleśas, vttis and saskāras: vttis, that is thoughts, etc. stemming form sense experience, (and their consequent actions) are recorded in the citta as saskāras, and these saskāras eventually activate consciously or subliminally, producing further vttis. These vttis then provoke action with their corresponding reactions noted above, which in turn are recorded as saskāras, and the cycle continues. Kleśas, vttis, saskāras and karma are thus all interconnected links in the chain of sasāra.

The akliṣṭa non-detrimental mental vṛttis, on the other hand, are produced by the sāttvic faculty of discrimination that seeks to control the influence of rajas and tamas and thereby the detrimental vṛttis that they produce. Through the practice of yoga, the yogī attempts to supplant all the rājasic and tāmasic saṁskāras with sāttvic ones until these, too, are restricted in the higher states of meditative concentration — the notions of detrimental and non-detrimental are from the relative perspective of saṁsāra; the detrimental (rājasic and tāmasic) vṛttis cause pain, and the non-detrimental (sāttvic) ones at least lead in the direction of liberation, even though they too must eventually be given up. But these latter do point to the possibility of acting in the world, in one’s prakṛtic body and mind, from an enlightened perspective free from ignorance. This points to the notion of the jīvanmukta: someone who is still embodied and thus functioning with a citta, but a citta that generates vṛttis that are not subject to ignorance, ego, and attachment, etc.

4. Soteriology and Praxis

We have discussed that ignorance is the cause of suffering and sasāra, and that when this is removed by discrimination, liberation is attained. The core project of the Sūtras, then, is to outline how to accomplish this. The second chapter, kriyā yoga, is dedicated to this effect, featuring the eight limbs of yoga, that is, to the means of achieving discriminative discernment. The eight limbs are: yamas, abstentions; niyamas, observances; āsana, posture; prāāyāma, breath control; pratyahāra disengagement of the senses; dharaā, concentration, dhyāna, meditation and samādhi, absorption.

The yamas are: non-violence, truthfulness; refrainment from stealing; celibacy; and renunciation of [unnecessary] possessions. The first of these, ahi, non-violence, is the yama singled out by the commentators on Patañjali for special attention, indeed, as the root of the other yamas. Patañjali’s goal is to achieve ahi and enhance it. Ahi is defined as not injuring any living creature anywhere at any time. Truth, the second yama, is defined as one’s words and thoughts being in exact correspondence to fact. “Refrainment from stealing”, the third yama, is described as not taking things belonging to others, and not even harboring the desire to do so. Celibacy is the control of the sexual organs, a definition further refined as not seeing, speaking with, embracing, or otherwise interacting with members of the opposite sex as objects of desire. Renunciation of possessions is the ability to see the problems caused by the acquisition, preservation and destruction of things, since these only provoke attachment and injury. These yamas are considered the great vow. They are not exempted by one’s class, place, time or circumstance. They are universal.

The niyamas, observances, are: cleanliness, contentment, austerity, study [of scripture], and devotion to God. Cleanliness is external and internal; the former pertains to the body, and the latter to purifying the mind of all contamination (jealousy, pride, vanity, hatred and attachment.) “Contentment,” santoa, the second niyama, manifests as disinterest in accumulating more than one’s immediate needs of life. “Austerity,” tapas, is the ability to tolerate the urge to eat and drink, as well as the urge for the dualities of life – hot and cold, etc., to avoid useless talk, and to perform fasts. “Study,” svādhyāya, refers to reading sacred scriptures whose subject matter is liberation, and also includes the repetition of the om syllable. The last item on Patañjali’s list, “devotion to God,” śvara-praidhāna, includes offering all one’s activities to śvara, the “original teacher,” (YS I.26), without desire for the fruit. This last niyama will be discussed further in the section on theism.

With regards to the third limb of Yoga, the term “āsana” is hardly found in the older texts, except on occasion in the sense of a “seat.” Although the entirety of Yoga is typically understood and presented as āsana, physical posture, in the popular representations of the term in the West, it is actually only the third limb of Yoga, not an end or goal unto itself. Indeed, given that he dedicated 20 sūtras to the yamas and niyamas, Patañjali has relatively little to say about āsana, leaving us with only three sūtras to the topic consisting of a total of nine words – less than 1% of the text.

Vyāsa, the main commentator, knew of a range of āsanas in the 5th century C.E. (listing 12 followed by “etc.”, suggesting a well known tradition of variants). Nonetheless, essentially, posture is a limb of the actual goal of Yoga to the extent that it allows the meditator to sit “firmly,” sthira, and “comfortably,” sukha, for meditation. Indeed, as noted, āsana in fact literally means “seat.” The point is that yogic postures are useful only to the extent to which they facilitate fixing the mind completely by training the body not to be a source of distraction. Prāāyāma, breath control, consists of the regulation of the incoming and outgoing breaths. It is defined as the external, internal and restrained movements [of breath], which are drawn out and subtle in accordance to place, time and number. Pratyāhāra, the fifth limb, is defined as withdrawal from sense objects.

This process of consecutive stages of internalization seen in these first five limbs, then, continues throughout the remaining three limbs. The fifth limb, dhāraā, concentration, involves fixing the mind on one place. Although Patañjali allows that any object can be used as the support of the mind in dhāraā, theistic meditation comes highly recommended (see section on Theism). The seventh limb, meditation, is the one-pointedness of the mind on one image. More specifically, it consists of the continuous flow of the same thought or image of the object of meditation, without being distracted by any other thought. When the image of the object of meditation “flows” uninterrupted in the mind, that is to say when the mind can focus exclusively on that object without any other distraction, the seventh limb of Yoga, dhyāna, has been achieved. The sixth and seventh limbs of Yoga, as well as the eighth, are not different practices as is the case with the previous five limbs, but a continuation and deepening of the same practice.

 

Samādhi, the final limb, is when that same dhyāna shines forth as the object alone and the mind is devoid of its own reflective nature. When the mind is so fully absorbed in the object of meditation that it loses all notions of itself as a self-conscious, reflective mind, one has reached the state of samādhi. In this state, the mind is no longer aware of itself as meditating on something external to itself; all distinctions between the yogī as the subjective meditator, the act of meditation, and the object of meditation have disappeared. Like a pure crystal which, when placed next to a red flower, appears to completely lose its own character by reflecting the form and color of the flower exclusively, the yogī is no longer self-aware, and is conscious only of the object of meditation, and it is in this level of intensity that samādhi differs from dhyāna. There is thus a progression of concentrative absorption on the object of meditation from dhāraa, through dhyāna, to samādhi, the state of consciousness ensuing when all thought has, in fact, been stilled. This is the final goal of Yoga.

There are four stages of saprajñāta samādhi, all of which have an ālabana, “a support”. This means that the consciousness of the purua is still flowing through the praktic citta to connect with or be supported by an object of meditational focus (albeit in progressively more subtle ways). In this state, the mind is fixed on one pratyaya, image, or undeviating vtti, that of the object of concentration, and resists all change into other states. The object of concentration, whatever it might be, is the ālabana, that is, the unwavering image the object produces on the concentrated mind.

The first level of saprajñāta samādhi, vitarka samādhi, is taken to be contemplation on a gross physical object, that is to say, meditating on an object which one experiences as a manifestation or construct of the gross physical or material atomic elements. It is thus the first level of experiencing an object in samādhi.

This first stage is further refined by Patañjali, and subdivided into two subdivisions: sa– “with” vitarka, and nir– “without” vitarka. When the yogī uses an object such as, say, a cow, as the meditational support, or object of concentration (ālabana), but the yogī’s awareness of this object is conflated with the word for and the concept of a cow, this absorption is known as savitarka samādhi (samāpatti), “absorption with physical awareness.” In other words, the yogī’s experience of the object is still subtly tinged with awareness of what the object is called, and with the memory or idea corresponding to that object. Direct experience of the object in its own right and on its own ground of being is tainted by the imposition of conceptual thought upon it.

When, in contrast, the object stands out in its own right without being conflated with the conventional terminologies of language that might refer to it, or with any idea or meaning it might generate, nirvitarka samādhi has been attained. This non-conceptual, or, perhaps more accurately, super-conceptual stage occurs when the yogī’s citta has been purged of any memory awareness of what the object is and what it is called. In other words, no saskāric imprints pertaining to “cow” are activated on any subconscious or intuitive level whatsoever. In this state there is no recognition of what the object of meditation is, or what its name or function are; recognition is colored exclusively by the object of focus itself without any discursive analysis of the object’s place in the greater scheme of things and without the normal instinctive impulsion to identify it. Moreover, the mind has also given up its own nature of being an organ of knowledge. In other words, awareness is not even aware of the mind as being an instrument channeling awareness onto an object. In a sense, all “knowledge” of the object as conventionally understood has been suspended, and the mind has completely transformed itself into the object, free from any discursive identification or self-awareness. The object can now shine forth in its own right as an object with its own inherent existence, free from labels, categorizations or situatedness in the grand scheme of things. We can note that the object has in effect become the yogi’s entire universe, since awareness is focused on it exclusively and is thus unaware of anything else, even the discursive process itself.

Keeping the metaphysics of Sāṁkhya in mind, we know that the five gross elements which constitute gross physical objects evolve from elements that are more subtle still. That is to say, they are actually evolutes from the tanmātras, the five subtle elements. The second level of samādhi concentration, vicāra samādhi, involves absorption into this more subtle aspect of the object of meditation, that is to say, perceiving the object as actually consisting of these more subtle ingredients. In fact, the subtle substructure of external reality can refer to any of the evolutes from prakti, as the tanmātras themselves evolve from ahakāra which, in turn, evolves from buddhi. Thus, the latter can also be considered sūkma, subtle. As a new archer first aims at large objects, and then progressively smaller ones, so the neophyte yogī first experiences the gross nature of the object in meditation, and then its progressively more subtle nature. Thus, instead of experiencing the object as comprised of compact quantum masses, the bhūtādi gross elements, as in the first state of vitarka, in vicāra, the yogī experiences them as vibratory, radiant potential, subtle energy, (a sublevel of reality normally imperceptible to the senses).

Vicāra samādhi, like vitarka, is also subdivided into two subdivisions of sa– “with,” and nir– “without.” When the intensity of focus on the object of meditation deepens such that the yogī penetrates its gross externalization and experiences the object as consisting of subtle elements, the tanmātras, but subtle elements circumscribed as existing in time and space, then the ensuing concentrative state of awareness is known as savicāra. In other words, in savicāra meditation, an object is perceived as consisting of subtle elements, but the object is still experienced as existing in the present time, rather than in the past or future, and is still bounded by space, that is, it is taking up some distinct physical space in the presence of the meditator rather than being situated anywhere else. Briefly put, at this stage, the yogī still has some level of awareness of space and time.

When, on the other hand, the yogī can focus on the object unconditioned by such dimensionality; in other words when he or she cannot just focus on the subtle nature of an object, but transcends space and time and perceives that these subtle essences pervade and underpin all things at all times, then the yogī has attained the state of nirvicāra. In this state, the yogī is no longer aware of dimensionality and temporality – the here and now. The object is no longer a distinct object taking up extension in a portion of space different from other spatial objects and existing in the present, rather than any other time, because the yogī experiences the subtle elements of the object as underpinning all objects at all times. In other words, the form of the object dissolves as it were under the power of the yogī’s focus, and the yogī now is simply experiencing vibrant subtle energies pervading all reality everywhere and eternally.

There is no consensus amongst the commentators as to the exact nature of the last two stages of samādhi, ānanda and asmitā, underscoring the fact that such states are experiential and do not lend themselves to scholastic categorization and analysis. The version that surfaces most commonly utilizes the three components of knowledge identified in Hindu philosophical discourse to demarcate the differences between these four stages of samādhi. In any act of knowledge, there is the “knower,” or subject of knowledge; the instruments of knowledge (mind and senses, etc.); and the object of knowledge. These are termed “ghit,” “grahaa,” and “grāhya” respectively (literally: the “grasper,” the “instrument of grasping,” and “that which is grasped”). In the first two stages of samādhi outlined above, vitarka and vicāra, the object upon which the mind is fixed, whether perceived as its grosser outer form or subtler inner constituents, is an external one and therefore considered grāhya (“that which is grasped”). Now, in the third stage, ānanda samādhi, the yogī transfers awareness from the objects of the senses, grāhya, to the organs of the senses themselves, grahaa (the instruments of grasping), or more precisely, the powers (śakti) behind the sensual abilities of seeing, touching, smelling, tasting and hearing, (rather than the gross physical organs of eye, ear, nose, etc.). The citta now becomes aware of the mechanisms of cognition, the instruments of the senses. It becomes aware of the internal organ through which external objects are “grasped,” rather than the external objects themselves, whether experienced in their gross or subtle constitutions.

Since, in Sāṁkhya, the grahaa includes the internal organ, manas, buddhi and ahakāra, the support of the mind in ānanda samādhī is the citta itself, specifically in its aspect as ahakāra. Thus, in this third stage, awareness becomes aware of the citta itself in its capacity of acquiring knowledge, as an ‘instrument’ which ‘grasps’ the objects of the senses.  In other words, the mind focuses on its own cognizing nature. Since the gua of sattva predominates in ahakāra and buddhi, and sattva is the source of bliss, Patañjali calls this stage ānanda samādhi, the “blissful absorption.”

Finally, by involuting awareness further still and penetrating the internal organ of meditation to its still more essential nature, one transcends even the instruments of knowledge and arrives at buddhi, to the closest praktic coverings, to the purua itself. Relentless in the pursuit of true and ultimate knowledge, at this point the yogī attains the fourth and final stage of saprajñāta samādhi. Having penetrated the constituents of the external object of meditation through its gross and subtle elements, consecutively in the first two stages of samādhi, and having withdrawn itself from external cognition and into a state of contemplating the powers behind the very organs of cognition in the third, awareness penetrates the citta further still, absorbing itself in the citta’s feature of buddhi, the grahit, “the grasper,” the closest praktic covering to the purua itself.

One final step now remains where this ultimate uncoupling of purua from all connection with prakti and all involvement with the citta occurs. This is asaprajñāta samādhi, samādhi without support. This all results in a total of six stages of saprajñāta samādhi, before the final stage of asaprajñāta samādhi. Therefore, including the latter, there will be a total of seven stages of samādhi explicitly expressed by Patañjali in his system.

As we have seen, the four states of saprajñāta all involved the citta in various ways. Asaprajñāta is beyond the mind. It is therefore beyond thought and word. To underscore this, perhaps, Patañjali has used the simple pronoun anya, “the other,” rather than a descriptive term, thereby pointing to asaprajñāta as a state which transcends all descriptive categories and nomenclatures. The commentators present asaprajñāta samādhi, samādhi “without support,” as being the state where the awareness of purua is no longer aware of any external entity at all, including the citta, since the latter has dissolved itself. This state corresponds with nirbīja, without seed” (I.51). In this final and ultimate state, the supreme goal of Yoga, the mind is not supported by any active thought. The vttis of the mind exist simply as potential, and the saskāras, the subconscious imprints that trigger thoughts, memories and karma, are also latent. Since the mind is now empty of all thoughts, the awareness of purua now no longer has any object whatsoever to be aware of, and thus, for the first time, can only become self-aware (loosely speaking). The final goal of Yoga has been attained.

Another way of considering this is that awareness is eternal, it cannot ever cease being aware. That being the case, the self’s only options are of what it is aware of: it can be object aware, or (again, loosely speaking) subject aware – that is, aware of entities or objects other than itself, or exclusively aware of itself as awareness with no reference to any other entity. After myriad births being aware of the unlimited varieties of prakṛtic objects, puruṣa has now come to the point of self-realization – realizing itself as distinct from not just objects of thought, but the very faculty and process of thought itself, the citta and its vṛttis. When there are no objects to detain its awareness other than its own self, the svarupa of YS I.3, this is asaṁprajñāta samādhi.

5. Epistemology

The Yoga school accepts three sources of receiving knowledge, pramāa, as valid (YS I.7), in accordance with the Sāṁkhya tradition. The first is sense perception, pratyāka, placed first on the list of pramāas because the other pramāas are dependent on it. Vyāsa defines sense perception as being the state or condition of the mind, vtti, which apprehends both the specific (viśea) and generic (sāmānya) nature of an external object discussed further below. This apprehension is accomplished by the citta encountering a sense object through the senses and forming an impression of this object, a vtti. More specifically, the tāmasic nature of sense objects imprint themselves upon the mind, and are then illuminated in the mind by the mind’s sāttvic nature. Due to pervading the mind, the purua, or self, then becomes conscious of this mental impression, as if it were taking place within itself, indistinguishable from itself. In actual fact, the impression is imprinted on the citta, mind, which is pervaded by consciousness but external to it.

The second pramāa, source of receiving valid knowledge, is anumāna, inference (logic), defined as the assumption that an object of a particular category shares the same qualities as other objects in the same category – qualities which are not shared by objects in different categories. Yoga accepts Nyāya principles here.

Finally, agama, “verbal testimony,” the third source of valid knowledge accepted by Patañjali, is the relaying of accurate information through the medium of words by a “trustworthy” person who has perceived or inferred the existence of an object, to someone who has not. “Trustworthy” is someone whose statements cannot be contradicted, has sense organs appropriately working in a suitable external environment, and is trustworthy and compassionate and free from defects such as illusion, laziness, deceit, dull-wittedness and so forth. The words of such a reliable authority enter the ear and produce an image, vtti, in the mind of the hearer that corresponds to the vtti experienced by the trustworthy person. The person receiving the information in this manner has neither personally experienced nor inferred the existence of the object of knowledge, but valid knowledge of the object is nonetheless achieved, which distinguishes this source of knowledge from the two discussed previously.

Returning to the most important episteme, perception, one must note that there are different types of pratyaka: the commentary on the khya Kārikā, the Yuktidīpikā, speaks of yogic perception as well as sensual perception (38.2). Indeed, several schools make a distinction between aparapratyaka, conventional perception, and parapratyaka, supernormal perception, or, as the khya Sūtras put it, external perception, bahya-pratyaka, and internal perception abahya pratyaka (I.90). The perception of interest to Yoga is the latter, that of a supernormal nature. But even the startling claims of omniscience that one encounters in the text are relevant only as signposts of experiences that the yogī will encounter on the path of Yoga, not as articles of faith.

Returning to the term viśea, particularity” or specificity,” the term is best understood in contrast to “sāmānya,” which refers to the general category of an object. Let us consider a “cow,” or the standard item used to exemplify a generic object in philosophical commentarial discourse, a “pot.”  The word “cow” refers to a generic category of bovine creature with udders and horns, who give milk and go “moo”; and “pot” to a roundish container usually made of clay (in India) that holds liquids or other substances. Although there are millions of cows in the world, and each and every one is distinct, individual and unique in some way, the term “cow” does not particularize or distinguish one cow from another. It is a general term that refers to an entire category of creatures. Likewise with the term “pot.” The term sāmānya, then refers to the genus, species or general category of something; terms like “cow” and “pot,” indeed all words in human speech, refer to objects only in terms of their generic characteristics. Viśea, by contrast is what particularizes ultimate entities from each other, and ultimately one atom from another (the delimiting feature an atom has that makes it a unique specific individual, distinct from any other atom).

According to Yoga, these three forms of knowledge as conventionally accepted are all limited because they cannot provide information about “particulars” or specifics. Verbal testimony is dependent on words, and words, like “cow,” can only point to the cow as a member of a general class of things – so when we say something like “there is a cow in the field,” we are only really giving information about the cow as a member of a species, and not about particulars: we are not conveying precise information about the specifics of the particular individual cow in question.

Along exactly the same lines, inference, also, only deals with generalities (and is, in fact, dependent on perception in the first place).  As for empirical sense perception, it is true, say the commentators, that when we look at a particular cow or pot, we might be able to pick up on some characteristic that distinguishes the particular cow or pot in front of us from other cows and pots – perhaps this cow has odd skin color or the pot an odd shape. But conventional sense perception, says Vyāsa, cannot provide us information about the precisely specific or subtle nature of an object – its atomic composition for example, nor about distant or hidden objects beyond the range of the senses.

Only through the clear, unobstructed insight of samādhi can one fully grasp the viśea, particularity, of an object, its subtle substructure of distinct atoms and subtle essences. Patañjali claims that the yogī can tell the difference between two identical items, since, although they appear identical to normal perception, the atoms comprising them are different, and it is these that the yogī can perceive. We must keep in mind that the yogic tradition claims one can actually perceive these essences through the undeviatingly concentrated focus of mind in the higher stages of samādhi, not merely theorize their existence. This perception, then, is actually a form of pratyaka, but not that of conventional sense perception. As noted earlier, the Yuktidīpikā commentary on Sāṁkhya points out that yogic pratyaka transcends normal sense-based perception. It is parapratyaka, “higher,” supreme, supernormal, perception.

Additionally, since the citta is by nature luminous, once the influences of rajas and tamas have been removed, there is nothing to obstruct its natural luminosity, and it can pass beyond the limitations inherent in finite objects due to the tamas preponderant in physical things. The ingredients of the mind itself are the same as those underpinning the object in external reality, the three guṇas; we must keep in mind here that the gross and subtle elements are nothing other than tamas-dominant evolutes from sattva-dominant buddhi and ahaṁkāra. Thus when fully sāttvic, the mind can transcend its own kleśa limitations (II.2ff) and merge into the common substratum of all things. This corresponds to such states as savicāra described in the section on samādhi, when the yogī’s awareness perceives that the subtle nature of the object of meditation as well as the meditating mind itself actually pervades all objects and thus all reality. So, once the obstructing qualities of rajas and tamas have been removed, then the pure luminosity of consciousness passes beyond the limitations of all boundaries and finite objects. In other words, the commentators claim that in the higher stages of samādhi, the yogī becomes essentially omniscient since awareness is no longer limited to the body or dimensionality but can radiate out infinitely and permeate the subtle substratum in the form of buddhi, ahaṁkāra, the tanmātra, etc. (as well as the specific conglomeration of atoms that emerge from these tanmātras), underpinning all objects. It can thus perceive the viśeṣa, particularity, that is, the specific atomic composition, of any particular object. As an aside, this ability reflects the metaphysics of the supernormal mystic powers inherent in the Yoga tradition, a discussion of which occupies almost a quarter of the text (but which are beyond the scope of this entry).

6. Ethics

Patañjali outlines a practice essential for enhancing sattva and lucidity, the prerequisite for attaining steadiness in the mind. We have established by now that the path and attainments of Yoga are nothing other than the maximization of the gua of sattva. Central to the Yoga tradition, then, are the ethical and other practices indispensable to this objective. Verse I.33 states that as a result of cultivating an attitude of “friendship” with those who find themselves in a “situation of happiness,” one of “compassion” towards those in “distress,” one of “joy” towards “pious” selves, and one of “equanimity” or indifference towards the “impious,” sattva is generated. Consequently, the mind becomes lucid – clarity being the nature of sattva. Once clear, one-pointed concentration, or steadiness, which is the goal of meditational Yoga, can be achieved by the mind.

From an ethical point of view, by being a well-wisher towards those who are happy, as well as those who are virtuous, the contamination of envy is removed. By compassion towards those miserable, that is, by wishing to remove someone’s miseries as if they were one’s own, the contamination of the desire to inflict harm on others is removed. By equanimity towards the impious, the contamination of intolerance is removed. By thus removing these traits of envy, desire to inflict harm, and intolerance, which are characteristics of rajas and tamas, the sattva natural to the mind can manifest. In the ensuing state of lucidity, the inclination towards seeking higher truths by controlling the vttis, in other words towards cultivating a focused state of mind by the practice of yoga, spontaneously arises, because the inclination for enlightenment is natural to the pure sāttvic mind.

A further set of ethical practices indispensable for increasing the sattva component of the mind are the five yamas, observances (literally “restraints”) of chapter II: non-violence, truthfulness; refrainment from stealing; celibacy and renunciation of [unnecessary] possessions. From these, ahi, non-violence, is the yama singled out by the commentators for special attention, and therefore leads the list and thus, the entire eight limbs of Yoga (it seems important to note that the yamas themselves lead the list of the eight limbs suggesting that one’s yogic accomplishment remains limited until the yamas are internalized and put into practice) (YS II.30).

Vyāsa accordingly takes ahi as the root of the other yamas. He defines it as not injuring any living creature anywhere at any time. Just as the footprints of an elephant covers the footprints of all other creatures, so does ahi cover all the other yamas – one continues to undertake more and more vows and austerities for the sole purpose of purifying ahi.

Vyāsa defines “truth,” the second yama, as one’s words and thoughts being in exact correspondence to fact, that is, to whatever is known through the three processes of knowledge accepted by the Yoga school. Speech is for the transfer of one’s knowledge to others, and should not be deceitful, misleading or devoid of value. It should be for the benefit of all creatures, and not for their harm. However, underscoring the centrality of ahi – truth must never result in violence. In other words, if there is ever a conflict between the yamas – if observing one yama results in the compromise of another – then ahi must always be respected first.

“Refrainment from stealing,” the third yama, is described as not taking things belonging to others, and not even harboring the desire to do so.  Vyāsa defines “celibacy” as the control of the sexual organs, and this is further refined by Vācaspati Miśra as not seeing, speaking with, embracing, or otherwise interacting with members of the opposite sex as objects of desire. In short, self-realization cannot be attained if one is sexually absorbed because this indicates that one is still seeking fulfillment on the sensual level, and thus misidentifying with the non-self.

Vyāsa defines “renunciation of possessions” as the ability to see the problems caused by the acquisition, preservation and destruction of things, since these only provoke attachment and injury. These yamas are considered the great vow; they are not exempted by one’s class, place, time or circumstance. They are universal in all aspects of life’s affairs and social interactions. Without them rajas and tamas cannot be curtailed, and the sattva essential to the higher stages of Yoga is unattainable.

7. Theism

Patañjali in YS I.23 states that the goal of Yoga can be attained by the grace of God, śvara-prāidhānād vā. The theistic, or śvaravāda element in Indic thought stretches back at least to the late Vedic period. Of the six “schools” of traditional thought that stem from this period, five – Nyāya, Vaiśeṣika, Vedānta, Yoga and Sāṁkhya – were, or became, theistic. Sāṁkhya, although often represented as nontheistic, was, in point of fact, widely theistic in its early expressions, and continued to retain widespread theistic variants outside of the later classical philosophical school associated with Ῑśvarakṛṣṇa, as evidenced in the Purāṇas and Bhagavad Gītā. Reflecting Patañjali’s undogmatic and nonsectarian sophistication, although śvara-praidhāna, “devotion to God” may not be the exclusive or mandatory way to attain realization of the self (given the particle vā “or” in I.23) it is clearly favored by him. The term “śvara” occurs in three distinct contexts in the Yoga Sūtras. The first, beginning with I.23, is in the context of how to attain the ultimate goal of Yoga, namely, the cessation of all thought, saprajñāta samādhi and realization of purua. Patañjali presents dedication to śvara as one such option. But it is important to note the word va, “or,” in this sūtra, indicating that Patañjali presents devotion to śvara, the Lord, as an optional means of attaining samādhi, rather than an obligatory one.

In the ensuing discussion, Patañjali states that:

the Lord is a special self because he is untouched by the deposits of saskāras, karma and its fructification, and the obstacles to the practice of yoga, the kleśas of nescience, ego, attachment, aversion and the will-to-live. He is omniscient, and also the teacher of the ancients, because he is not limited by Time.

Given the primary context of the Sūtras, namely fixing the mind on an object, two sūtras, I.27–28, specify how śvara is to be meditated upon: “his designation is the mystical syllable “om,” and its repetition, japa, and the contemplation of its meaning should be performed.” This points to the ubiquitous and most prominent form of Hindu meditation from the classical period to the present day: mantra recitation (japa). As a result of this devotional type of meditation, “comes the realization of the inner consciousness and freedom from all obstacles.”

The second context in which Patañjali refers to śvara is in the first sūtra in chapter II, where kriyā yoga, the path of action, is described as consisting of austerity, study and devotion to the Lord. By performing such kriyā yoga, samādhi is attained and the obstacles (the kleśas of II.3), are weakened. Finally, śvara surfaces again in a third context in the second chapter, II.32, where the niyamas are listed. The niyamas, which are the second limb of the eight-limbed path of Yoga, consist of cleanliness, contentment, austerity, study and, as in the other two contexts, śvarapraidhāna, devotion to śvara (thus, the three ingredients of kriyā yoga are all niyamas). The various benefits associated with following the yamas and niyamas, ethics and morals, are noted in the ensuing sūtras of the chapter, and II.45 states that the benefit from the niyama of devotion to God is the attainment of samādhi. This is the final reference to śvara in the text, but it is significant, because all the boons mentioned as accruing from the other yamas and niyamas (there are ten in all) represent praktic, or material, attainments – vitality, knowledge of past lives, detachment, etc., etc.  It is only from śvarapraidhāna, the last item on the list of yamas and niyamas, that the ultimate goal of Yoga, samādhi, is achieved. These then are the gleanings that can be extracted from Patañjali’s characteristically frugal sūtras.

From these we can conclude that Patañjali is definitely promoting a degree of theistic practice in the Yoga Sūtras. Although in the first context, śvarapraidhāna, devotional surrender to God, is optional as a means of attaining samādhi, Patañjali does direct six sūtras to śvara, which is not insignificant given the frugality of his sūtras. This devotional surrender is not optional in the second context, kriyā yoga. Since it is likewise not optional in the third context as a niyama, which is a prerequisite to meditational yoga, Patañjali seems to be requiring that all aspiring yogīs be devotionally oriented in the preparatory stages to the higher goals of Yoga and, while in the higher, more meditational stages of practice they may shift their meditational focus of concentration to other objects – even, ultimately, to any object of their pleasing (I.39) – they would best be advised to retain śvara as object thereafter, since this “special purua” can bestow perfection of samādhi which other objects cannot (II.45).

Patañjali also states that śvara is represented by the mystical syllable “om.” Om has been understood as a sonal incarnation of Brahman (which is the most common term used for the Absolute Truth in the Upaniads), since the late Vedic period. A scholastic such as Patañjali would most certainly have been well schooled in the Upaniṣads (especially given his own mandate of the prerequisite of study for success in yoga, II.1 & 44), which, as an orthodox thinker, he would have accepted as śruti, divine revelation. Even though he never refers to Brahman in the Sūtras, here again we must wonder whether along with all the śvara theologies of his time he is quite consciously equating the Upaniṣadic Brahman with this personal śvara, by means of this common denominator of om.

It is through the sound om that the yogi is to fix the mind on Ῑśvara. After all, since Ῑśvara, as a type of puruṣa, is beyond prakṛti, and therefore beyond conceptualization or any type of vṛtti, how is one to fix one’s mind upon him – the prakṛtic mind cannot perceive that which is finer than itself? Patañjali here provides the means: through the recitation of the syllable in which Ῑśvara manifests. Such recitation is called japa (an old Vedic term common in the old Brāhmaṇa texts, where it referred to the soft recitation of Vedic mantras by the priest.) By constantly repeating om and contemplating its meaning, artha, namely Ῑśvara, the mind of the yogī becomes one-pointed – the goal of all yoga practice. Repeating the sound om and “contemplating its meaning,” namely, that it is the sound representation of Ῑśvara, the object of the yogī’s surrender, when coupled with Patañjali’s usage of the word praṇidhāna, surrender, in I.23, points to chanting the mantra in a devotional mood. This is quintessential Hindu theistic meditation, the most prominent form of Hindu Yoga evidenced from antiquity to the present day.

8. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Aranya, Swami Hariharananda. 1984. Yoga Philosophy of Patanjali [with the commentary of Vyasa]. Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Ballantyne, James Robert. 1852. The Aphorisms of the Yoga Philosophy of Patañjali with Illustrative Extracts from the Commentary By Bhoja Raja. Allahabad: Presbyterian Mission Press.
  • Hariharānanda, Mukerji. 1963. Yoga Philosophy of Patañjali. Calcutta: Calcutta University (reprint, New York: SUNY, 1977).
  • Kumar Shiv & Bhargava, D.N. 1980. Yultidipika. Delhi: Eastern Book Linkers.
  • Manikar, T.G.1972. Samkhya Karika of Isvarakrsna with Gaudabhasya. Poona: Oriental Book Agency.
  • Rukmani, T.S.1981. Yogavārttika of Vijñānabhikßu. 4 vols. Delhi: Munshiram Manoharlal.
  • Sharma, Har Dutt. 1933. The Samkhya Karika [with the commentary of Gaudapada]. Poona: Oriental Book Agency.
  • Sharma, Har Dutt. 1934 The Tattva Kaumudi. Poona: Oriental Book Agency.
  • Woods, James Haughton. 1912. The Yoga System of Patañjali [with the commentary of Vacaspati]. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, (reprint, 1998).

b. Secondary Sources

  • Alter, Joseph. 2004. Yoga in Modern India: The Body between Science and Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Bhattacharya, Ram Shankar. 1985. An Introduction to the Yoga Sütra. Delhi: Bharatiya Vidya Prakasansa.
  • Bronkhurst, Johannes. 1993. The Two Traditions of Meditation in Ancient India. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
  • Brockington, John, “Epic Yoga” Journal of Vaishnava Studies 14.1. Fall (2005): 123-138.
  • Bryant, Edwin. 2009. The Yoga Sutras: A New Edition, Translation, and Commentary. New York: North Point Press.
  • Chapple, Christopher. 2003. Reconciling Yogas. Albany: State University of New York.
  • Dasgupta, S. 1922. A History of Indian Philosophy Motilal Banarsidass.
  • Dasgupta, S. Hindu Mysticism. 1927. Chicago: The Open Court Publishing Company.
  • De Michelis, Elizabeth. 2004. History of Modern Yoga: Patanjali and Western Esotericism. New York and London: Continuum.
  • Eliade, Mircea. 1958. Yoga: Immortality and Freedom. Translated by Willard R. Trask. London: Kegan Paul.
  • Feuerstein, Georg. 1989. The Yoga-Sutra of Patañjali: A New Translation and Commentary. Rochester, VT: Inner Traditions.
  • Feuerstein, Georg. 1996. The Philosophy of Classical Yoga. Rochester, VT: Inner Traditions.
  • Feuerstein, Georg. 2001. The Yoga Tradition: Its History, Literature, Philosophy, and Practice. Prescott, AZ: Hohm Press.
  • Feuerstein, Georg. 2003. The Deeper Dimension of Yoga: Theory and Practice. Boston: Shambhala.
  • Hopkins, E.W. 1901 “Yoga Technique in the Great Epic” Journal of the American Oriental Society. Vol 22: 333-379.
  • Larson, Gerald James Classical Sākhya. 1979. Delhi: Motilal Benarsidass.
  • Larson, Gerald James. 1999. “Classical Yoga as Neo- Sāṁkhya: a Chapter in the History of Indian Philosophy” Asiatische Studien Études Asiatiques. LII.3: 723-732.
  • Larson, Gerald James and Bhattacharya. 2008. Yoga: India’s philosophy of Meditation. Encyclopedia of Indian Philosophies. Volume XII. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
  • Singleton, Mark. 2010. Yoga Body: The Origins of Modern Posture Practice. Oxford and New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Yamashita Koichi. 1994. Pātañjala Yoga Philosophy with Reference to Buddhism. Calcutta: Firma KLM.
  • Whicher, Ian. 1998. The Integrity of the Yoga Darśana. New York: SUNY.

 

Author Information

Edwin Bryant
Email: edbryant@rci.rutgers.edu
Rutgers University
U. S. A.

Ludwig Wittgenstein: Later Philosophy of Mathematics

Mathematics was a central and constant preoccupation for Ludwig Wittgenstein (1889–1951). He started in philosophy by reflecting on the nature of mathematics and logic; and, at the end of his life, his manuscripts on these topics amounted to thousands of pages, including notebooks and correspondence. In 1944, he said his primary contribution to philosophy was in the philosophy of mathematics. Yet his later views on mathematics have been less well received than his earlier conception, due to their anti-scientific, even anti-rationalist, spirit.

This article focuses on the relation between the later Wittgenstein’s philosophy of mathematics and other philosophies of mathematics, especially Platonism; however, other doctrines (formalism, conventionalism, constructivism, empiricism) will be discussed as well.

Wittgenstein does not sympathize with any traditional philosophy of mathematics, and in particular his hostility toward Platonism (the conception that mathematics is about a-causal objects and mind-independent truths) is quite evident. This is in line with what can be described as his more general philosophical project: to expose deep conceptual confusions in the academic doctrines, rather than to defend his own doctrine. In fact, it is not even clear that the threads of his thinking on mathematics, when pulled together, amount to what we would today call a coherent, unified -ism. However, one view that can be attributed to him is that mathematical identities such as ‘Three times three is nine’ are not really propositions, as their superficial form indicates, but are certain kinds of rules; and, thus understood, the question is whether they are arbitrary or not. The interpretive position preferred in this article is that they are not, since they are grounded in empirical regularities – hence the recurrence of the theme of the applicability of mathematics in Wittgenstein’s later reflections on this topic.

Some have characterized him as a finitist-constructivist, others as a conventionalist, while many strongly disagree about these labels. He notoriously held the view that philosophy should be eminently descriptive, strongly opposing any interference with how mathematics is actually done (though he also predicted that lucid philosophy would curb the growth of certain mathematical branches). In particular, he was worried about the philosophers’ tendency to provide a foundation for mathematics, mainly because he thought it does not need one.

Table of Contents

  1. The Reaction from Other Philosophers
  2. Which ‘ism’?
  3. Mathematical Reality
  4. Philosophical Method, Finitism-Constructivism, Logicism and Formalism
  5. Regularities, Rules, Agreement, and Contingency
  6. Concluding Remarks
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. Wittgenstein’s Writings
    2. Other Sources

1. The Reaction from Other Philosophers

 

Although Wittgenstein’s earlier views on mathematics and logic (mainly exposed in his 1922 work Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus) have been very influential, his later conception (roughly, post-1929) has been “met with an ambivalent reaction, (…) drawing both the interest and the ire of working logicians” (Floyd [2005, 77]). A good deal of Wittgenstein’s later work on mathematics has been collected and edited by G.H. von Wright, R. Rhees and G.E.M. Anscombe under the title Remarks on the Foundations of Mathematics (RFM hereafter), and was first published in 1956. Another collection, Wittgenstein’s Lectures on the Foundations of Mathematics. Cambridge 1939, was edited by Cora Diamond and published in 1976. Two harsh reviews of RFM, by G. Kreisel [1958] and A. R. Anderson [1958], set the tone for a sceptical attitude toward his later views on mathematics persisting even into the late twentieth century. P. Maddy, for instance, places the following warning at the beginning of her lucid Wittgenstein section in Naturalism in Mathematics: “Some philosophers, especially those with a technical bent, tend to be unsympathetic to the style and content of the late Wittgenstein. I encourage such Wittgenstein-phobes to skip over [the section].” [1997, 161, fn. 1] Perhaps illustrative for this way of thinking is also the omission of the Wittgenstein material in the second edition [1983] of Benacerraf and Putnam’s landmark collection Philosophy of Mathematics: Selected Readings. (The first edition of 1964 included excerpts from RFM.)

This Wittgenstein-phobia, if it truly exists, is surely regrettable – not only because of the intrinsic value of Wittgenstein’s highly original insights, but also because understanding his views on mathematics might illuminate difficult themes in his widely-studied work Philosophical Investigations [1953] (PI). It is telling that the early draft of PI had contained a good portion of what is now RFM, and it is no coincidence that some of the examples and scenarios used to illustrate the much discussed rule-following ‘paradoxes’ appearing in PI are cast in mathematical terms (Fogelin [1976], Kripke [1982]).

2. Which ‘ism’?

This article focuses on the relation between later Wittgenstein’s philosophy of mathematics and other philosophies of mathematics, especially Platonism; however, other doctrines (formalism, conventionalism, constructivism, empiricism) will be discussed as well. Hopefully, even a glance at this relation will give the reader a minimally misleading sense of his later views on mathematics – although, naturally, there is much more to explore than can be covered here (for example, Wittgenstein’s points on proofs as forging ‘internal relations’ and their role in concept formation, his take on mathematical necessity, or on Gödel’s First Incompleteness Theorem, this last issue alone generating a series of interesting exchanges over the years; see Tymoczko [1984), Shanker [1988), Rodych [1999, 2006], Putnam and Floyd [2000], Floyd [2001], Steiner [2001], Bays [2004]). Note also that very little will be said on the debate over the partition of Wittgenstein’s thinking. When it comes to mathematics, the standard demarcation (two Wittgensteins – the ‘early’ one of the Tractatus, and the ‘later’ one of the PI and RFM) is questioned by Gerrard ([1991], [1996]), who distinguishes two lines of thought within the post-Tractarian period: a middle one, or “the calculus conception”, to be found in Philosophical Grammar (PG), and a truly later one, “the language-game conception.” Stern [1991], however, worries about too finely dividing Wittgenstein’s thinking, concerned with the more recent tendency to add even the fourth period, post-PI, which Wittgenstein devoted to philosophical psychology and is illustrated in his Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology.

In addition to the aphoristic and multi-voiced style, one of the most baffling aspects of later Wittgenstein’s views on mathematics is his position relative to the traditional philosophies of mathematics. While his hostility toward Platonism (especially in the version advocated by the Cambridge mathematician G. E. Hardy) is quite pronounced, not much can be confidently said about the doctrine he actually espouses. In fact, given his rejection of theories and theses in philosophy (PI §128), one might even suspect that the threads of his thought, when pulled together, do not amount to what we would today call a ‘position’, let alone a coherent, unified ‘ism.’ He rejects the logicism of his former teachers Frege and Russell, but this does not turn him into a formalist (of Hilbertian inspiration), or an intuitionist-constructivist-finitist (like Brouwer); moreover, Kantian sympathies are discernible, even empiricist ones. Most of Wittgenstein’s remarks, however, are directed against academic schools, and Fogelin [1987], for one, describes his position via a double negative: ‘anti-platonism without conventionalism.’  Here I will not propose a new label, yet the best starting point to discuss Wittgenstein’s conception is its relation to conventionalism. How exactly his views relate to this doctrine is, once again, hard to pin down; what appears relatively clearer is that his conventionalism is not the ‘full-blooded’ conventionalism that Dummett [1959] attributed to him.

As a first approximation, for Wittgenstein arithmetical identities (such as ‘three times three is nine’) are not propositions, as their superficial grammar indicates – but rules. Importantly though, these rules are not arbitrary; in a sense (to be explicated later on), the rules in place are the only ones that could have been adopted or, as Steiner [2009, 12] put it, “the only rules available.” The typical conventionalist difficulty (that they might have an arbitrary character) is answered when it is added that the rules are grounded in objectively verifiable empirical regularities (Fogelin [1987]; Steiner [1996], [2000], [2009]); or, as Wittgenstein says, the empirical regularities are “hardened” into rules (RFM VI-22). In discussing Wittgenstein’s relation to conventionalism, a central task in what follows will be to clarify why (and how, and what kind of) agreement within a community is a crucial presupposition of the very existence of mathematics.

3. Mathematical Reality

As stated above, it is an open question whether Wittgenstein actually held a ‘position’ in the philosophy of mathematics, in the sense of advancing a compact body of doctrine. Most of his remarks seem reactions to what he takes to be (philosophical, non-trivial) misunderstandings concerning the nature of mathematics. Platonism falls in this category. He most likely understood this doctrine as the conjunction of two tenets: a semantic thesis – mathematical propositions state truths, and an ontological claim, according to which the truth-makers of the mathematical propositions, that is, objects like numbers, sets, functions, and so forth, exist, in a fashion similar to Plato’s forms, and populate an a-causal, non-spatiotemporal domain. This is to say that they are abstract; additionally, they are also language- and mind-independent. A third, epistemological, thesis is often added: we humans can know about these objects and truths insofar as we possess a special cognitive faculty of ‘intuition’ (that is, despite the fact that we don’t interact with them causally). However, note that an adequate characterization of Platonism itself, or of the version Wittgenstein dismissed, are substantial philosophical tasks in themselves, and this article will not attempt to undertake them. Yet one issue, among others, is worth mentioning in passing. There are Platonist realists who claim that mathematical statements have truth-value (Shapiro [2000] calls this “realism in truth-value”), yet also hold that this does not entail that certain ‘objects’ need to be postulated as their truth-makers (the view that we do need to postulate these objects is called “realism in ontology”). Many famous mathematicians, philosophers and logicians have been attracted or intrigued by Platonism: Hardy [1929], [1967], Bernays [1935], Gödel [1947], Benaceraff [1973], Dummett [1978a] are loci classici. More recently, Burgess and Rosen [1997] and Balaguer [1998] offer book-length treatments of this conception; Linebo [2009] and Cole [2010] are useful surveys and rich up-to-date bibliographical sources.

What is Wittgenstein’s take on Platonism? The standard view is that for him this conception is what C. Wright [1980, 5] calls a “dangerous error.” Wittgenstein surely believed that it is extremely misleading to understand mathematical identities as stating truths about some (mathematical) objects. This is so because mathematical formulae are not in the business of making statements to begin with: they are not propositions. The acceptance of this assumption – that they are, as their surface grammar indicates – is, for some commentators, one of those “decisive moment[s] in the conjuring trick (…)” he mentions in PI §308, “the very one that we thought quite innocent.” Thus, the decisive step on the road leading to Platonism is asking the question ‘What is mathematics about?’ The query seems innocent indeed: mathematics is a type of discourse, all discourses have a subject-matter, so mathematics must have one too. To see the problem with this question, Wittgenstein urges us to consider another question – ‘What is chess about?’ (This kind of move is characteristic for his style of philosophizing in the later period.) The initial question suggests a certain perspective on the issue, while the new question is meant to challenge this perspective, to reveal other possibilities – in particular, that mathematical equations may not be descriptions (statements, affirmations, declaratives, and so forth), let alone descriptions of some abstract, mind-independent, non-spatiotemporal entities and their relations. As has been noted (Wrigley [1977]), this idea bears clear similarities to one of the key-thoughts of the Tractatus, that not all words (in particular the logical vocabulary) stand for things. The grammatical form of number words (as nouns), and of mathematical formulae (as affirmations), must be treated with care. More concretely, ‘is’ in ‘two and two is four’ does not have the role of a description of a state of affairs (so to speak) holding within an abstract non-spatiotemporal realm.

It is generally accepted, at least among philosophers, that Platonism is the natural, or “default” metaphysical position for the working mathematician (Cole [2010]). Wittgenstein has an interesting answer to the question ‘Why are mathematicians attracted to this view?’ and this section shall close by sketching it.

Commentators have emphasized that his answer is grounded in the distinction between applied and pure (better: not-yet-applied) mathematics, and is thus entirely different from the standard reasons adduced by Platonists themselves. (For them, this doctrine is appealing because: (i) it squares well with our pre-theoretical picture of mathematics (as containing truth-valuable, objective, mind-independent, a priori statements), and (ii) it explains the agreement among mathematicians of all times.) As Maddy [1997, 167-8] points out, Wittgenstein thought it was very important to reflect on how professional mathematicians typically account for the importance of a certain piece of mathematical formalism – say, a new theorem. (He discusses this in terms of subjecting the “interest of calculations” to a test; (RFM II-62)) One thing mathematicians could do is reveal the implications of that bit of mathematics for science and mathematics as a whole. In other words, they could point out the great and unquestionable effectiveness of that formalism in other areas of mathematics and in scientific applications. Yet, when this type of answer is not available – that is, when they have to justify their interest in an unapplied formalism – they usually say things that Wittgenstein calls ‘prose’ (Wittgenstein and the Vienna Circle [WVC], p. 149). Instead of (perhaps boringly) detailing the internal-mathematical complex network of conceptual relations in which the new theorem fits, its unifying power, its capacity to open up new lines of research, and so forth, many mathematicians indulge in the more thrilling project of presenting their activity as one of foray into a mysterious super-empirical realm. Hence the familiar Platonist distinction: the claim that they do not invent theories, but discover objective eternal truths about a-causal, non-spatiotemporal objects. Wittgenstein refers to this as the illusory revelation of “the mysteries of the mathematical world” (RFM II – 40, 41).

These critical points do not amount to a positive view yet. They rather lead to more queries, two of which will be discussed in the next section.  They are: (i) What is wrong with asking what mathematics is about, and (ii) Does the comparison with chess mean that Wittgenstein believes that mathematics is (merely) a game? Note that for Wittgenstein reflection on games occupies a central place in his philosophical methodology, and that chess is his favourite object of comparison (it appears in many contexts; to mention only the PI, see §31, §33, §136, and so forth)

4. Philosophical Method, Finitism-Constructivism, Logicism and Formalism

If one asks ‘what is mathematics about?’, a typical answer is – ‘certain entities, like number 2, inhabiting a Platonic reality.’ The adoption of this metaphysics comes in handy, seemingly increasing our understanding in this matter: we might get the feeling that we now finally know what mathematicians have been talking about for thousands of years. However, this is deceptive; the acceptance of this proposal creates more and deeper problems than the ones we began with. Wittgenstein regards the talk about ‘reality’ in mathematics not as a step toward a better understanding of this human practice, but as a source of confusion, of philosophical problems, which he regards as conceptual ‘illnesses’ requiring ‘treatment.’ Here we encounter his view that philosophy ultimately has a therapeutic role, an idea appearing in PI first at §133, with mathematics mentioned explicitly in §254. The therapy consists in applying one of his philosophical methods – to remind  those who are puzzled of where concepts are ‘at home’, and to reveal how philosophizing uproots them from their natural context:

Consider Professor Hardy’s article (“Mathematical Proof”) and his remark that “to mathematical propositions there corresponds – in some sense, however sophisticated – a reality.”..[Y]ou forget where the expression ‘a reality corresponds to’ is really at home –What is “reality”? We think of “reality” as something we can point to. It is this, that. Professor Hardy is comparing mathematical propositions to the propositions of physics. This comparison is extremely misleading (Lectures on the Foundations of Mathematics, p. 239-40; LFM hereafter)

The diagnosis of PI §38 is that philosophical problems appear when ‘language goes on holiday’, or ‘idles.’ What does this mean? (The original reads “…wenn die Sprache feiert.” Stern [2004, 97] argues that Rhees’ initial translation of ‘feiert’ by ‘idle’ coveys better the idea that the language does no work than Anscombe’s standard translation ‘goes on holiday.’) Steps toward the clarification of this point can be made by observing that Wittgenstein has in mind here the situation in which a concept otherwise fully intelligible, oftentimes even unremarkable, is detached from its original contexts and uses (language-games). Once dragged into a new ‘territory’, the concept idles (just like a cogwheel separated from the gear), as it cannot engage other related concepts anymore. Anyone trying to employ the concept in this new ‘environment’ experiences mental cramps and disquietudes, precisely because, as it happens when one ventures into uncharted ‘terrain’, the familiar ‘paths’ and ‘crossroads’ no longer exist: one does not know her “way about” (PI §123), one does not see things clearly anymore. Hence, according to Wittgenstein, the whole point of philosophizing is not to defend ‘philosophical positions’ but to undo this perplexity, and achieve a liberating ‘perspicuous representation’, or over-view (übersichtliche Darstellung; PI §122).

When discussing the LFM quote above, Maddy observes [1997, 167] that one such problem, of much fame in the current debates in the philosophy of mathematics, is the epistemological problem for Platonists, due to Benacerraf [1973]. Roughly put, the question is how we get to know anything about numbers, if they are a-causal, non-spatiotemporal entities, and if all our knowledge arises by causal interaction with the known objects? This seems a legitimate worry, but Wittgenstein would disagree with one of its assumptions. Not only does he reject the idea that a causal basis is essential for knowledge (‘knowledge’ most likely counts as a “family-resemblance” concept, lacking an essential feature; cf. PI §67), but he tackles the issue from an entirely different angle. He notes that the force of the problem (“the feeling of something queer, “thumb-catching of the intellect”) “comes from a misunderstanding” (RFM V-6). The misunderstanding originates in what can be called a ‘transfer’ move: the Platonist assumes that the talk of ‘reality’ (and ‘entities’, and so forth) can be extended, or transferred, from the natural ‘home’ of these notions (the vernacular and the natural sciences) to the mathematical discourse – and, moreover, that this transfer can take place without loss of meaning. The rejected assumption is not that we can talk about relations and objective truth in mathematics, but that we can talk about them in the same way we talk in empirical science. Once this transfer is made, ‘deep’ questions (like Benacerraf’s) follow immediately. What Wittgenstein urges, then, is to take this epistemological difficulty as exposing the meaning-annihilation effect of the illicit transfer move – so, in the end, Platonism is not even wrong, but (disguised) nonsense.

What is the more general outcome of adopting such a philosophical strategy? A ‘therapeutic’ one: the liberation of our minds from the grip of an ‘illegitimate question’ (‘what is mathematics about?’) Such a strategy can be traced back to Heinrich Hertz’s insight in Principles of Mechanics, one of Wittgenstein’s formative readings: “(…) the question […] will not have been answered; but our minds, no longer vexed, will cease to ask illegitimate questions.” (Hertz [1899 / 2003, 8] The question Hertz entertained was about ‘the ultimate nature of force’).

Before taking up the second issue, it is worth noting that Wittgenstein’s view fails to fit other traditional ‘isms’ too. Wrigley [1977, 50] sketches some of the reasons why he cannot be described as a finitist-constructivist, thus disagreeing with how Dummett [1959] and Bernays [1959] portray him. While following the teachings of this philosophical doctrine would lead to massive changes in mathematics (for example, a big portion of real analysis must be wiped out as meaningless), Wittgenstein notoriously held the view that “philosophy may in no way interfere with the actual use of language; it can in the end only describe it. For it cannot give it a foundation either. It leaves everything as it is. It leaves mathematics as it is, and no mathematical discovery can advance it” (PI §124). Another marked difference between Wittgenstein and the intuitionists is discussed by Gerrard [1996, 196, fn 37]. Brouwer sees mathematics as divorced from the language in which it is done, and says: “FIRST ACT OF INTUITIONISM Completely separating mathematics from mathematical language…recognizing that intuitionistic mathematics is an essentially languageless activity of the mind…” (cited in D. van Dalen [1981, 4]). Yet, as we will see below, it is a constant of Wittgenstein’s view that mathematics cannot be separated from a language and a human practice.

Moreover, Wittgenstein also distances himself from the logicism of Frege and Russell. The previous point about the status of mathematical formulae (that is, not being propositions) explains why. Insofar as mathematical formulae aren’t propositional truths, it is simply out of the question whether they are, or can be reduced to, a particular kind of truths, namely truths of logic. But Wittgenstein’s dissatisfaction with logicism goes further than that; he is unhappy with the ‘epistemically reductive’ character of this doctrine, and emphasizes the “motley” of mathematical techniques of proof (RFM III-46A, III-48). Formulated in the logicist style, mathematical proofs might gain in precision but surely lose in perspicuity and conceptual elegance. Floyd [2005, 109] summarizes the point: “That is not to say that there are no uses for formalized proofs (for example, in running computer programs). It is to say that a central part of the challenge of presenting proofs in mathematics involves synoptic designs and models, the kind of manner of organizing concepts and phenomena that is evinced in elementary arguments by diagram. This Wittgenstein treated as undercutting the force of logicism as an epistemically reductive philosophy of mathematics: the fact that the derivation of even an elementary arithmetical equation (like 7 + 5 = 12) would be unclearly expressed and unwieldy in (Russel’s and Alfred North Whitehead’s) Principia Mathematica shows that arithmetic has not been reduced in its essence to the system of Principia (compare RFM III-25, 45, 46).”

Returning to the second issue (how mathematics is different from a game), recall that this concern arises naturally given Wittgenstein’s insistence that mathematical formulae aren’t genuine propositions, but some kind of rules. This takes us to the question as to how Wittgenstein’s conception differs from formalism. The answer must begin by noting that mathematics provides us with “rules for the identity of descriptions” (Fogelin [1987, 214]).

Consider the multiplication 3 × 3 = 9. Obviously enough, one typical role of this equality is to license the replacement of one string of symbols (‘3’, ‘×’, ‘3’) with another symbol (‘9’) in extensional contexts. Wittgenstein does not disagree with this account, but has a more substantial story to tell. These identifications are not (cannot be) mechanical, disembodied actions – rather, they are grounded in ancestral, natural human practices, such as sorting and arranging objects. A simple example, in essence Fogelin’s [1987], should illustrate this point. Suppose we describe to a child the 3 times 3 operation by the following arrangement:

(a)

■    ■    ■

■    ■    ■

■    ■    ■

Next, suppose we produce another arrangement

(b)

■       ■ ■       ■

and tell her that this also describes the 3 × 3 operation. Thus, the identity ‘3 × 3 = 9’ is the rule that the two descriptions are correct and they say the same thing (that is, are ‘identical’, to use Fogelin’s terminology). So, we hope, the child understands that three batches of three objects amount to nine objects.

Now suppose that a few days later the child no longer remembers all the details of this story and conceives of the 3 × 3 multiplication as follows:

(c)

■   1.

■   2.

3.

She counts the squares, and reports the result: 7. We protest, and the child gets confused. Her puzzlement originates in her belief that she generated arrangement (c) by doing the same thing we did initially – she considered three batches of three objects, and then counted the objects!

This simple example signals a more serious problem. We recognize here one version of the well-known rule-following ‘paradoxes’ in PI highlighted by Kripke [1982] many years ago: “any course of action can be made out to accord with the rule”, and thus “no course of action could be determined by a rule.” (PI §201) It is impossible to draw a list containing all the directives needed to follow a rule, and no matter what one does, there is an interpretation of one’s actions that makes them accord with the rule. In our case, one just can’t draw a list containing everything that is, and is not, allowed in the manipulation of the little black squares when describing the 3 × 3 operation – thus clearing up all possible confusions. (This is easy to see: suppose one proposes as a regress-stopper adding a rule explicitly excluding superpositions. But this won’t work, since yet another Goodmanesque-Kripkean scenario can be invented in which an arrangement is obtained ‘showing’ that, say, 3×3 = 33 because, for instance, one misunderstands what superposition is. And so on. See Goodman [1955], Kripke [1982].)

In essence, here Wittgenstein would urge that it is just a brute fact of nature that we are indeed able to avoid this situation, and sort out our confusion, especially after the teachers intervene and signal the mistake we made. To emphasize, it is a brute fact that when people are asked to represent the multiplication 3 × 3, the (a)-type and (b)-type arrangements predominate, while those of the (c)-type are very rare, and even more so after training.

More generally, it is a given of the human forms of life that we are able to follow rules and orders; that there is a point when we stop ‘interpreting’ them – and just act. Thus, crucial here is our ability to act ‘blindly’ when following directions, as Wittgenstein puts it (PI §219) – that is, blind to “distractions” (Stern [2004, 154-155]), to all the so numerous possibilities to stray away. Were we not able to act this way, were the confusions (such as the ones described above) overwhelmingly prevalent, then the arithmetical practice would not exist to begin with. (It is instructive to peruse Stern’s critique of Fogelin’s [1994, 219-20] misreading of PI §219. But see also Fogelin [2009] for more on these matters.)

So, as a result of training, the child becomes able to recognize that, as Fogelin notes [1987, 215], despite superficial similarities arrangement (c) is not the result of doing ‘the same thing’ we did initially ((a) and (b)). While this might be distressing, there is no guarantee that the child will reach this stage in understanding. Moreover, the process is gradual: some children ‘get it’ faster than others. The immersion in the community of ‘mathematicians’, the continual checking and correcting, the social pressure (through low grades), and so forth, help the children master the technique of distinguishing what is allowed from what is not, to differentiate what must be ‘turned a blind eye on’ from what really matters.  The arithmetical training consists in inculcating in children a certain technique to deploy when presented with situations of the kind discussed here: they understand multiplication when they are able to establish (and recognize) the identity of various descriptions.

The squares example can be invoked to illustrate Wittgenstein’s position regarding formalism. The arithmetical identities are not reducible to mere manipulations of symbols, but come embedded into, and govern the relations of, (arrangement) practices. The arithmetical training consists not only in having the pupils learn the allowed strings of symbols (the multiplication table) by heart, but also, more importantly, in inculcating in them a certain reaction when presented with arrangements of the kind discussed above.

At this point, two aspects of the issue should be distinguished. The first is purely descriptive. In terms of what people actually do, the ‘normal’ situations (arrangements of (a)-type and (b)-type) prevail after training, while the ‘deviant’ ones (arrangements of the (c)-type) are the exception. This is an empirical regularity: with training, most people get the arrangements right most of the time.

The second aspect is normative: this empirical regularity becomes a candidate to be codified into a special form. By doing this, we thus grant it a new status, that of a norm, or rule – an arbiter of ‘right’ and ‘wrong.’ We say that it is incorrect to take an arrangement like (c) to stand for the 3 times 3 operation. The empirical regularity, the uniform application of the technique of multiplication, is thus ‘hardened’ into a rule. When discussing multiplication in LFM X, p. 95, Wittgenstein says the following:

I say to [the trainee], “You know what you’ve done so far. Now do the same sort of thing for these two numbers.”—I assume he does what we usually do. This is an experiment—and one which we may later adopt as a calculation. What does that mean? Well, suppose that 90 per cent do it all one way. I say, “This is now going to be the right result.” The experiment was to show what the most natural way is—which way most of them go. Now everybody is taught to do it—and now there is a right and wrong. Before there was not.

To indicate the change of status, Wittgenstein uses several suggestive metaphors. The first is the road building process:

It is like finding the best place to build a road across the moors. We may first send people across, and see which is the most natural way for them to go, and then build the road that way. (LFM, p. 95)

Here, building the road is a decision, but not an arbitrary one: different crossing paths have been taken over time, but usually one is most often travelled, and thus preferred on a regular basis. It is this one that gradually emerges as the most suited for crossing, and the one which the lasting road will follow.

The second metaphor is legalistic: we regard an empirical regularity as a mathematical proposition when we “deposit [it] in the archives” (LFM, p. 104). Note that what is now in the archives has previously been in circulation, ‘out there’, had a genuine life. On the other hand, what is in the archives is protected, withdrawn from circulation – that is, not open to change and dispute. The relations between the archived items are frozen, solidified. (Note the normative role of archives as well: it is illegal to tamper with them.)

A related metaphor we already encountered above is that of the physical process of condensation: just as an amount of vapor enters a qualitatively different form of aggregation turning into a drop of water, so the empirical-behavioral regularities are turned into arithmetical rules. What happens is that these regularities are ‘condensed’ or, to use Wittgenstein’s own word, “hardened”:

It is as if we had hardened the empirical proposition into a rule. And now we have, not an hypothesis that gets tested by experience, but a paradigm with which experience is compared and judged. And so a new kind of judgment. (RFM VI-22)

The elevation to a new status (performed because of the robust, natural agreement) is indicated by archiving:

 

Because they all agree in what they do, we lay it down as a rule, and put it in the archives. Not until we do that have we got to mathematics. One of the main reasons for adopting this as a standard, is that it’s the natural way to do it, the natural way to go – for all these people. (LFM, p. 107)

5. Regularities, Rules, Agreement, and Contingency

Wittgenstein’s emphasis on conceiving mathematics as essentially presupposing human practices and human language should not be taken as an endorsement of a form of subjectivism of the sort right-is-what-I-(my-community)-take-to-be-right. Thus, interestingly, there is a sense in which Wittgenstein actually agrees with the line taken by Hardy, Frege and other Platonists insisting on the objectivity of mathematics. What Wittgenstein opposes is not objectivity per se, but the ‘philosophical’ explanation of it. The alternative account he proposes is that arithmetical identities emerge as a special codification of these contingent but extremely robust, objectively verifiable behavioral regularities. (Yet, recall that although the arithmetical propositions owe their origin and relevance to the existence of such regularities, they belong to a different order.) So, what Wittgenstein rejects is a certain “metaphysics of objectivity” (Gerrard [1996, 173]). In essence, he rejects the idea that mathematics is transcendent, that an extra-layer of ‘mathematical reality’ is the ultimate judge of what is proved, here and now, by human means. (“We know as much as God does in mathematics” (LFM, p. 104)) Therefore, from this perspective, progress in explaining Wittgenstein’s conception consist in clarifying how he manages to account for the “peculiar inexorability of mathematics” (RFM I-4), while avoiding both Platonism and subjectivism.

A good starting point for this task is understanding Wittgenstein’s view of the relation between mathematical and empirical statements. Unlike some philosophers oftentimes compared with him (such as Quine), he takes mathematical propositions to be non-revisable in light of empirical investigation (“mathematics as such is always measure, not thing measured” RFM, III-75). To see the larger relevance of this point, consider the simple question ‘What if, by putting together two pebbles and other three pebbles, we get sometimes five, sometimes six, and sometimes even four pebbles?’ Importantly, this state of affairs would not be an indication that 2+3=5 is false – and thus needs revision. This situation would only show that pebbles are not good for demonstrating (and teaching) addition. The mathematical identity is untouchable (as it were), and the only option left to us is to suspect that maybe the empirical context is abnormal. Thus, the next step is to ask whether we face the same anomalies when we use other objects, such as fruits, pencils, books, bottles, fingers, and so forth.

So, let us explore, for a moment, for the sake of the argument, the scenario in which a large variety of ordinary items is subject to this strange variation. Under this assumption, the conclusion to draw is a radical one: were this scenario real, the arithmetical practice of summing could not have even gotten off the ground. This would be the situation defining the supreme pointlessness of arithmetic, which would thus become a mere game of symbols. In such a situation, the truth or falsity of the identity 2+3 = 5 would no longer matter, as it is, in a sense, meaningless. As Wittgenstein puts it,

I want to say: it is essential to mathematics that its signs are also employed in mufti. It is the use outside mathematics, and so the meaning of the signs that make the sign game into mathematics. (RFM IV-41)

The terms ‘sense’ and ‘nonsense’, rather than the terms ‘true’ and ‘false’, bring out the relation of mathematical to nonmathematical propositions. (Wittgenstein’s Lectures, Cambridge 1932-35; hereafter AWL, p. 152)

However, the wild variation described above does not exist. It is a contingent, brute natural fact (again!) that we do not live in such a world, but in one in which regularities prevail. Moreover, it is precisely the existence of such regularities – together with, as we will see in a moment, regularities of human behaviour – that makes possible the arithmetical practice in the first place. Wittgenstein, however, realized this rather late, as Steiner [2009] documents. Remarks about the role of empirical regularities are entirely absent in PG and PR; so, according to Steiner, understanding the importance of the empirical regularities for mathematics amounts for Wittgenstein to a “silent revolution”, in addition to the well-known “overt revolution” (the repudiation of the Tractatus).

A closer look at the contingent regularity relevant in this context – behavioural agreement – is now in order. (At PI §206 and 207 Wittgenstein suggests that these regularities form the basis of language itself.) This type of agreement consists in all of us having, roughly, the same natural reactions when presented with the same ‘mathematically’ related situations (arranging, sorting, recognizing shapes, performing one-to-one correspondences, and so forth.) Its existence is supported by the already discussed facts: (i) we can be trained to have these reactions, and (ii) the world itself presents a certain stability, many regular features, including the regularity that people receiving similar training will react similarly in similar situations. (There surely is a neuro-physiological basis for this; cats, unlike dogs, cannot be trained to fetch.)

Yet, as stressed above, it is crucial to note that speaking in terms of behavioural agreement when it comes to understanding the mathematical enterprise should not lead one to believe that Wittgenstein is in the business of undermining the objectivity of mathematics. This is Dummett’s [1959] early influential line of interpretation, describing Wittgenstein as a “full-blooded conventionalist” (or even “anarchist”; this is Dummett’s [1978b, 64] famous label, when comparing Wittgenstein, “in his later phase” with the “Bolsheviks” Brouwer and Weyl.) According to him, Wittgenstein maintains that at any step in a calculation we could go any way we want – and the only reason that we go the way we usually go is an agreement between us, as the members of the community: in essence, a convention we all accept (And which, since it might be changed, is entirely contingent. Dummett [1978b, 67] writes: “What makes a […mathematical] answer correct is that we are able to agree in acknowledging it as correct.” (Cited in Gerrard [1996, 197, fn. 43]).

Thus, one should say that a mathematical identity is true by convention; that is, it is taken, accepted as true by all calculators because a convention binds them. However, textual evidence can be amassed against this reading. Wittgenstein does not regard the agreement among the members of the community’s opinions on mathematical propositions as establishing their truth-value. Convincing passages illustrating this point can be found virtually everywhere in his later works, and Gerrard [1996] collects several of them.

In In PI II, xi, pp.226, Wittgenstein says that “Certainly the propositions ‘Human beings believe that twice two is four’ and ‘Twice two is four’ do not mean the same.” In LFM, p. 240, when talking about ‘mathematical responsibility’, he points out that “(…) one proposition is responsible to another. Given certain principles and laws of deduction, you can say certain things and not others.” Some passages in LFM are most perspicuous: “Mathematical truth isn’t established by their all agreeing that it’s true” (p. 107); also, “it has often been put in the form of an assertion that the truths of logic are determined by a consensus of opinions. Is this what I am saying? No.” (p. p. 183).

So, it is simply not the case that the truth-value of a mathematical identity is established by convention. Yet behavioural agreement does play a fundamental role in Wittgenstein’s view. This is, however, not agreement in verbal, discursive behaviour, in the “opinions” of the members of the community. It is a different, deeper form of consensus – “of action” (LFM, p. 183; both italics in original), or agreement in “what [people] do” (LFM, p. 107). Tellingly, RFM, VI-30C reads: “The agreement of people in calculation is not an agreement in opinions or convictions.” In PI §241, this is spelled out as “not agreement in opinions but in form of life.” Moreover, LFM contains passages like this:

There is no opinion at all; it is not a question of opinion. They are determined by a consensus of action: a consensus of doing the same thing, reacting in the same way. There is a consensus but it is not a consensus of opinion. We all act the same way, walk the same way, count the same way (p. 183-4)

The specific kind of behavioural agreement (in action) is a precondition of the existence of the mathematical practice. The agreement is constitutive of the practice; it must already be in place before we can speak of ‘mathematics.’ The regularities of behaviour (we subsequently ‘harden’) must already hold. So, we do not ‘go on’ in calculations (or make up rules) as we wish: it is the existent regularities of behaviour (to be ‘hardened’) that bind us.

Thus, not much is left of the ‘full-blooded conventionalist’ idea. We don’t really have much freedom. Steiner [2009, 12] explains: the rules obtained from these regularities “are the only rules available. (The only degree of freedom is to avoid laying down these rules, not to adopt alternative rules. It is only in this sense that the mathematician is an inventor, not a discoverer.)” We can now see more clearly how this view contrasts with Dummett’s: mathematical identities are not true by convention, since they themselves are conventions, rules, elevated to this new status (‘archived’) from their initial condition of empirical regularities (Steiner [1996, 196]).

While the behavioural agreement constitutes the background for the arithmetical practice, Wittgenstein takes great care to keep it separated from the content of this practice (Gerrard [1996, 191]). As we saw, his view is that the latter (the relations between the already ‘archived’ items) is governed by necessity, not contingency; the background, however, is entirely contingent. As Gerrard observes, this distinction corresponds, roughly, to the one drawn in LFM, p. 241: “We must distinguish between a necessity in the system and a necessity of the whole system.” (See also RFM VI-49: “The agreement of humans that is a presupposition of logic is not an agreement in opinions on questions of logic.”) It is thus conceivable that the background might cease to exist; should it vanish, should people start disagreeing on a large scale on simple calculations or manipulations, then, as discussed, this would be the end of arithmetic – not a rejection of the truth of 2+3=5, but the end of ‘right’ (and ‘wrong’) itself, the moment when such an identity turns into a mere string of symbols whose truth would not matter more than, say, the truth of ‘chess bishops move diagonally.’ (Note that this rule is not grounded in a behavioural empirical regularity, but it is merely formal, and arbitrary.)

The very fact of the existence of this background is not amenable to philosophical analysis. The question ‘Why do we all act the same way when confronted with certain (mathematical) situations?’ is, for Wittgenstein, a request for an explanation, and it can only be answered by advancing a theory of empirical science (neurophysiology, perhaps, or evolutionary psychology). This is a question that he, qua philosopher, does not take to be his concern. He sees himself as being in the business of only describing this background, with the avowed goal of drawing attention to its existence and (overlooked) function.

Moreover, it now hopefully becomes clearer how his rejection of ‘philosophical’ explanations, still baffling many readers, is connected to his central strategy of dissolving (rather than solving) philosophical puzzles. (Recall Wittgenstein’s warnings about confusing philosophical questions with empirical ones in The Blue and Brown Books, p.18, 35 and the related diagnostic in RFM VI-31, “Our disease is one of wanting to explain.”) When a philosophical explanation is advanced, it usually takes the Platonist form: “we all agree about mathematical identities because we all ‘grasp’ (‘look at’, are ‘guided by’, and so forth) the same (a-causal non-spatiotemporal) mathematical entities and their relations.” But this explanation is preposterous – literally, it gets things in the wrong order. As Steiner puts it [1996, 192; emphasis added), “(w)hat Wittgenstein rejects in mathematical Platonism is not so much its doctrine that ‘mathematical objects exist’, but the illusion it fosters that the existence of mathematical objects, and of a special faculty of intuiting them can explain the extraordinary agreement among mathematicians – of all cultures – about what propositions have been proved. To the contrary, Wittgenstein argues, the ‘great’ and ‘surprising’ agreement among mathematicians underlies mathematics; indeed, makes it possible. But the task of philosophy is, and can be, only to describe, not explain, the fundamental role of the regularity of human mathematical behaviour.”

Related to Platonism, ‘mentalism’ is another target of Wittgenstein, as Putnam [1996] notes. This is the idea that rules are followed (and calculations made) because there is something that ‘guides’ the mind in these activities. If we recall the black squares example, the guide must play the role of a regress-stopper, constituting the explanation as to how all possible interpretations and distractions are averted. The mind and this guide form an infallible mechanism delivering the result. This is a supermechanism, as Putnam calls it, borrowing Wittgenstein’s own way to characterize the proposal. (Wittgenstein talks about ‘super-concepts’ at PI §97b, ‘super-likeness’ at PI §389, and so forth.) Putnam [1996, 245-6] makes the point as follows: “Wittgenstein shows that while the words used in philosophers’ explanations of rule following may sometimes hit it off – for example, it is perfectly true that a rule determines the results of a calculation – the minute we suppose that some entity or process has been described that explains How We Are Able to Follow Rules, then we slip into thinking that we have discovered a ‘supermechanism’; moreover, if we try to take these super-mechanisms seriously we fall into absurdities. Wittgenstein sometimes indicates the general character of such ‘explanations’ by putting forward parodistic proposals, for example, that what happens when we follow a rule is that the mind is guided by invisible train tracks (§218), ‘lines along which [the rule] is to be followed through the whole of space’ (§219).”

6. Concluding Remarks

In 1944, Wittgenstein assessed that his “chief contribution has been in the philosophy of mathematics” (Monk [1990, 466]). According to P.M.S. Hacker, Wittgenstein’s reflections on mathematics are his “least influential and least understood” part of his later philosophy [1996, 295]. Later Wittgenstein’s philosophy of mathematics is indeed difficult to characterize and classify, especially within the framework of academic schools. (For instance, while the tendency to call him today an ‘antirealist’ appears to be well supported by textual evidence, one should not ignore the attempts to identify ‘realist’ tendencies in his work. See Diamond [1991] and Conant [1997] for discussions of Wittgenstein’s location within the broader realist-antirealist landscape). Thus there is ample room for further discussion of his views, and especially for clarifying how his philosophy of mathematics complements, or even augments, his relatively better understood philosophy of language and mind. The relation between his view of mathematics and that of the professional mathematicians is yet another interesting and potentially controversial matter worth of further study – for, if we are to believe him,

A mathematician is bound to be horrified by my mathematical comments, since he has always been trained to avoid indulging in thoughts and doubts of the kind I develop. He has learned to regard them as something contemptible and… he has acquired a revulsion from them as infantile. That is to say, I trot out all the problems that a child learning arithmetic, and so forth, finds difficult, the problems that education represses without solving. I say to those repressed doubts: you are quite correct, go on asking, demand clarification! (PG 381, 1932)

7. References and Further Reading

For comprehensive bibliographical sources, see Sluga and Stern [1996] and Floyd [2005], and, for material available online, see Rodych [2008] and Biletzki and Matar [2009].

a. Wittgenstein’s Writings

  • Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, [1922], London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1961; translated by D.F. Pears and B.F. McGuinness.
  • (PI) Philosophical Investigations, [1953]. [2001], 3rd ed., Oxford: Blackwell Publishing. The German text, with a revised English translation by G. E. M. Anscombe.
  • (RFM) Remarks on the Foundations of Mathematics, [1991], MIT Press: Cambridge Massachusetts and London, England (paperback edition) [1956] 1st ed. Edited by G.H. von Wright, R. Rhees and G.E.M. Anscombe (eds.); translated by G.E.M Anscombe.
  • (PG) Philosophical Grammar, [1974], Oxford: Basil Blackwell; Rush Rhees, (ed.); translated by Anthony Kenny.
  • (PR) Philosophical Remarks, [1975], Oxford: Basil Blackwell; Rush Rhees, (ed.); translated by Raymond Hargreaves and Roger White.
  • (RPP) Remarks on the Philosophy of Psychology, [1980], Vol. I, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, G.E.M. Anscombe and G.H. von Wright, (eds.), translated by G.E.M. Anscombe.
  • (BB) The Blue and Brown Books, [1964], [1958] 1st ed. Oxford: Blackwell
  • (AWL) Ambrose, Alice, (ed.), [1979], Wittgenstein’s Lectures, Cambridge 1932-35: Ed. A. Ambrose, Totowa: NJ: Littlefield and Adams.
  • (LFM) Diamond, Cora, (ed.), [1976], Wittgenstein’s Lectures on the Foundations of Mathematics, Ithaca, N.Y.: Cornell University Press.
  • (WVC) Waismann, Friedrich, [1979], Wittgenstein and the Vienna Circle, Oxford: Basil Blackwell; edited by B.F. McGuinness; translated by Joachim Schulte and B.F. McGuinness.

b. Other Sources

  • Anderson, A.R., [1958], ‘Mathematics and the “Language Game”’, The Review of Metaphysics II, 446-458.
  • Balaguer, Mark [1998], Platonism and Anti-Platonism in Mathematics, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Bays, Timothy, [2004], “On Floyd and Putnam on Wittgenstein on Gödel,” Journal of Philosophy, CI.4, April: 197-210.
  • Benacerraf, Paul, [1973], “Mathematical Truth”, Journal of Philosophy, 70(19): 661–679.
  • Benacerraf, Paul and Putnam, Hilary (eds.), [1983] 2nd ed., Philosophy of Mathematics: Selected Readings, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. ([1964] 1st ed.)
  • Bernays, Paul, [1935], “On Platonism in Mathematics”, Reprinted in Benacerraf and Putnam [1983].
  • Bernays, Paul, [1959], “Comments on Ludwig Wittgenstein’s Remarks on the Foundations of Mathematics,” Ratio, Vol. 2, Number 1, 1-22.
  • Biletzki, Anat and Matar, Anat, [2009], “Ludwig Wittgenstein”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2011 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
  • Burgess, John P. and Rosen, Gideon, [1997], A Subject with No Object, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Cole, Julian, [2010], “Mathematical Platonism”, The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, ISSN 2161-0002, 22 Oct 2011
  • Conant , James, [1997], “On Wittgenstein’s Philosophy of Mathematics” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, New Series, Vol. 97 (1997), pp. 195-222.
  • Dalen, van D., [1981], Brouwer’s Cambridge Lectures on Intuitionism. Cambridge Univ. Press
  • Diamond, Cora, [1991], The Realistic Spirit, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • Dummett, Michael, [1959], “Wittgenstein’s Philosophy of Mathematics,” The Philosophical Review, Vol. LXVIII: 324-348.
  • Dummett, Michael, [1978a], “Platonism”, in Truth and Other Enigmas. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press pp. 202-15
  • Dummett, Michael, [1978b], “Reckonings: Wittgenstein on Mathematics,” Encounter, Vol. L, No. 3 (March 1978): 63-68.
  • Floyd, Juliet, [1991], “Wittgenstein on 2, 2, 2…: The Opening of Remarks on the Foundations of Mathematics,” Synthese 87: 143-180.
  • Floyd, Juliet, and Putnam, Hilary, [2000], “A Note on Wittgenstein’s “Notorious Paragraph” about the Gödel Theorem,” The Journal of Philosophy, Volume XCVII, Number 11, November: 624-632.
  • Floyd, Juliet, [2001], “Prose versus Proof: Wittgenstein on Gödel, Tarski, and Truth,” Philosophia Mathematica 3, Vol. 9: 280-307.
  • Floyd, Juliet, [2005], “Wittgenstein on Philosophy of Logic and Mathematics,” in The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Logic and Mathematics, S. Shapiro (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press: 75-128.
  • Floyd, Juliet, and Putnam, Hilary, [2006], “Bays, Steiner, and Wittgenstein’s ‘Notorious’ Paragraph about the Gödel Theorem,” The Journal of Philosophy, February, Vol. CIII, No. 2: 101-110.
  • Fogelin, Robert J., [1994], [1987; 1st ed. 1976], Wittgenstein, Second Edition, New York: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
  • Fogelin, Robert J., [2009], Taking Wittgenstein at His Word Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2009
  • Gerrard, Steve, [1991], “Wittgenstein’s Philosophies of Mathematics,” Synthese 87: 125-142.
  • Gerrard, Steve, [1996], “A Philosophy of Mathematics Between Two Camps,” in The Cambridge Companion to Wittgenstein, Sluga and Stern, (eds.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press: 171-197.
  • Gödel, Kurt, [1947], “What is Cantor’s Continuum Problem?”, Amer. Math. Monthly, 54: 515–525.
  • Goodman, Nelson, [1955], Fact, Fiction, & Forecast, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Hacker, P. M. S., [1996], Wittgenstein’s Place in Twentieth-Century Analytic Philosophy, Blackwell.
  • Hardy, Geoffrey H, [1929], “Mathematical Proof” Mind 38: 149
  • Hardy, Geoffrey H, [1967], A Mathematician’s Apology, Cambridge Univ. Press
  • Hertz, Heinrich, [1899, 2003], The Principles of Mechanics, Robert S. Cohen (ed.), D.E. Jones and J.T. Walley (trans.), New York: Dover Phoenix Editions 1956.
  • Kreisel, Georg, [1958], “Wittgenstein’s Remarks on the Foundations of Mathematics,” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 9, No. 34, August 1958, 135-57.
  • Kripke, Saul A., [1982], Wittgenstein on Rules and Private Language, Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press.
  • Linnebo, Øystein, [2009] “Platonism in the Philosophy of Mathematics”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2009 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
  • Maddy, Penelope, [1997], Naturalism in Mathematics Oxford Univ. Press
  • Monk, Ray [1990] Ludwig Wittgenstein: The Duty of Genius Macmillan Free Press, London.
  • Morton, Adam, and Stich, Stephen, [1996], Benacerraf and His Critics, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Putnam, Hilary, [1996], ‘On Wittgenstein’s Philosophy of Mathematics’ Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volumes, Vol. 70 (1996), pp. 243-265
  • Putnam, Hilary, and Juliet Floyd, [2000], “A Note on Wittgenstein’s “Notorious Paragraph” about the Gödel Theorem,” The Journal of Philosophy, Volume XCVII, Number 11, November: 624-632.
  • Rodych, Victor, [1999], “Wittgenstein’s Inversion of Gödel’s Theorem,” Erkenntnis, Vol. 51, Nos. 2/3: 173-206.
  • Rodych, Victor, [2006], “Who Is Wittgenstein’s Worst Enemy?: Steiner on Wittgenstein on Gödel,” Logique et Analyse, Vol. 49, No. 193: 55-84.
  • Rodych, Victor, [2008], “Wittgenstein’s Philosophy of Mathematics”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2008 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.).
  • Shanker, Stuart, [1988], “Wittgenstein’s Remarks on the Significance of Gödel’s Theorem,” in Shanker, S. (ed.) Gödel’s Theorem in Focus, Routledge; pp. 155-256.
  • Shapiro, Stewart, [2000], Thinking about Mathematics. The Philosophy of Mathematics. Oxford University Press.
  • Shapiro, Stewart (ed.), [2005], The Oxford Handbook of Philosophy of Logic and Mathematics, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Sluga, Hans, and Stern, David G., (eds.), [1996], The Cambridge Companion to Wittgenstein, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Steiner, Mark, [1996], “Wittgenstein: Mathematics, Regularities, Rules,” in Benacerraf and His Critics, Morton and Stich (eds.), Oxford: Blackwell: 190-212.
  • Steiner, Mark, [2001], “Wittgenstein as His Own Worst Enemy: The Case of Gödel’s Theorem,” Philosophia Mathematica, Vol. 9, Issue 3: 257-279.
  • Steiner, Mark, [2009], “Empirical Regularities in Wittgenstein’s Philosophy of Mathematics” Philosophia Mathematica 17 (1): 1-34
  • Stern, David, [1991], “The ‘Middle Wittgenstein’: From Logical Atomism to Practical Holism” Synthese 87: 203-26.
  • Stern, David, [2004], Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Investigations. An Introduction. Cambridge Univ. Press.
  • Tymoczko, T, [1984], “Gödel, Wittgenstein and the Nature of Mathematical Knowledge” PSA: Proceedings of the Biennial Meeting of the Philosophy of Science Association, Vol. II: Symposia and Invited Papers, pp. 449-468
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Author Information

Sorin Bangu
Email: sorin.bangu@fof.uib.no
University of Bergen
Norway

The Aesthetic Attitude

Aesthetics is the subject matter concerning, as a paradigm, fine art, but also the special, art-like status sometimes given to applied arts like architecture or industrial design or to objects in nature. It is hard to say precisely what is shared among this motley crew of objects (often referred to as aesthetic objects), but the aesthetic attitude is supposed to go some way toward solving this problem. It is, at the very least, the special point of view we take toward an object that results in our having an aesthetic experience (an experience of, for example, beauty, sublimity, or even ugliness). Many aesthetic theories, however, have taken it to play a central role in defining the boundary between aesthetic and non-aesthetic objects. These theories, usually called aesthetic attitude theories, argue that when we take the aesthetic attitude toward an object, we thereby make it an aesthetic object.

These theories originate in the notion of disinterest that was investigated by eighteenth-century aesthetic thinkers. While important to these thinkers, the idea of disinterest becomes even more crucial in the aesthetic theories of Kant and Schopenhauer. In these two philosophers, especially the latter, we begin to find aesthetic attitude theories. In the twentieth century, some major thinkers adopted the aesthetic attitude as a fundamental notion, but did not do so without facing serious criticism. Indeed, aesthetic attitude theories are not as popular as they once were, due to this criticism and to a more general shift of focus.

Table of Contents

  1. The Aesthetic Attitude
    1. Introductory Clarifications
    2. Disinterest
    3. Appreciation for Its Own Sake
  2. Historical Underpinnings
    1. Eighteenth-Century British Philosophers
    2. Kant
    3. Schopenhauer
  3. Twentieth-Century Aesthetic Attitude Theories
    1. Bullough and Psychical Distance
    2. Stolnitz
    3. Scruton
  4. Criticism
    1. Against Aesthetic Attitude Theories
    2. In Defense of Aesthetic Attitude Theories
    3. Where to Go From Here
  5. References and Further Reading

1. The Aesthetic Attitude

There are two parts to the aesthetic attitude: the aesthetic part, and the attitude part. Here, an attitude is a certain state of mind. In particular, it is a way of approaching experiences or orienting oneself toward the world. It may help to think of someone with an optimistic attitude. He has a tendency to see things in a positive light. With the aesthetic attitude, the thought is not that there are certain people who generally see things, so to speak, in an aesthetic light, but more aligned with what is meant by the request that someone “have a more optimistic attitude” or “take a more positive attitude” about a given circumstance. We are asked, in such situations, to make ourselves attend in a certain way. In adopting an optimistic attitude, we focus on features of the situation that we can spin positively – we may realize the bad things are not really so bad and look instead for a silver lining. In adopting the aesthetic attitude, we focus on features of the situation that we think are relevant aesthetically – we may stop thinking about where we are parked and instead begin following the plot and the character development of the play being performed before us.

As these examples suggest, the aesthetic attitude is supposed to be a frame of mind that we can adopt more or less when we choose to. Of course, difficulties can arise for lots of reasons. A cell phone that rings during a symphony is reviled because it inevitably grabs our attention, and problems may arise adopting the aesthetic attitude, too, if we are distracted by hunger or unable to resist work-related worries. Thus, the analogy to optimism may be apt in a further way. It seems much easier for some people to adopt an optimistic attitude than it is for others, and many philosophers have thought that some people have a knack for taking the aesthetic attitude where others find it harder.

a. Introductory Clarifications

There are paradigm cases where we adopt the aesthetic attitude, for example, in a museum or as a spectator at the theater. It is, however, important to realize that the aesthetic attitude is not simply an attitude we take in museums, but one that we can take toward nature, too. Finding the colors of a sunset or the complexity of a nautilus beautiful means directing an aesthetic attitude toward the sunset or the nautilus and thinking about it aesthetically. Indeed, many have argued that we can take the aesthetic attitude toward anything at all, and in doing so, make it an aesthetic object. A street scene, though we would not describe it as art or nature, could thus be approached aesthetically. Since there are things that we can take the aesthetic attitude toward that are not art, the aesthetic attitude is not just an artistic attitude. It is much broader than that.

Not only can we take the aesthetic attitude toward things that are not art, but we can also take it toward things that are not beautiful. Some art is ugly, and certain artworks even flaunt their ugliness for artistic effect. In fact, calling something ugly is giving it an aesthetic evaluation, which in turn requires taking the aesthetic attitude toward it. So, in adopting the aesthetic attitude, say, toward a sunset, you start to look at the aesthetic features of the sunset. For example, you might pay attention to the visual composition of the landscape and view, or perhaps to the soft color gradations. Upon inspecting these elements, you might actually come to find them unsatisfactory. You might notice a traffic jam, a patch of large, barren trees, or a few unappealing vapor trails left by planes. You might reasonably conclude that it was, upon further inspection, kind of an ugly sunset. This conclusion could only be reached by looking at the scene aesthetically, that is, adopting the aesthetic attitude toward the scene. This makes it clear that we adopt the aesthetic attitude not only toward beautiful things, but also toward ugly things. Indeed, we must adopt the aesthetic attitude if any conclusion about a thing’s beauty or ugliness, in other words its aesthetic standing, is to be reached.

While these remarks make it clear that taking the aesthetic attitude toward something is not the same as finding it beautiful, it is a matter of debate whether the aesthetic attitude involves some kind of pleasure. We have seen that it does not necessarily involve straightforward aesthetic enjoyment or positive aesthetic evaluation, but it might still involve some broader kind of enjoyment, pleasure, or satisfaction. Whether it does and what kind exactly is something to be spelled out by the particular aesthetic attitude theory.

As mentioned above, many reserve the term ‘aesthetic attitude theory’ for a theory according to which aesthetic objects are properly distinguished from non-aesthetic objects by our ability to take the aesthetic attitude toward them. Not everyone agrees on this classification of aesthetic attitude theories, but there is sufficient consensus for us to assume it here. Given that, it may be helpful at the outset to point out that aesthetic attitude theories have experienced waning popularity in the past few decades. This may be due to criticism of the theory or to other theories that offer alternative accounts of the relevant distinction, both of which will be canvassed below.

Before continuing, a word of caution may be helpful. The term ‘aesthetic’ is applied to many things: we have already seen aesthetic attitude, aesthetic objects, and aesthetic experience, but philosophers also talk about aesthetic evaluations and aesthetic judgments (for example, judging that something is beautiful), aesthetic features (for example, symmetry), aesthetic contemplation, aesthetic emotions, and so on. Many of these will come up here, but the important thing to keep in mind is that this is just how philosophers refer to the special class of experiences, judgments, emotions, and so forth. that pertains to the art-like realm discussed above. Different theorists take different views of how these notions relate to each other and which is the most basic, but all take as an aim the discussion of the special sphere of the aesthetic.

b. Disinterest

There are two ways of thinking about the aesthetic attitude that have been most prevalent. First, it has been thought of as a special kind of disinterested attitude. The person who adopts the aesthetic attitude does not view (hear, taste, and so forth) objects with some kind of personal interest, that is, with a view to what that object can do for her, broadly speaking. A collector may view an expensive painting she owns and praise herself for owning such a rare and pricey piece. We might say that, in such a case, she takes an economic attitude toward the painting, but she without a doubt fails to think about it aesthetically. If she were instead viewing the painting contemplatively, thinking about its composition, meaning, and so on, then she would be thinking about it aesthetically, and that seems to be due to her disinterested attitude toward it. Similarly, a music student taking a music theory test might listen for certain particular keys or chord progressions, but he seems to listen to the music with the goal of getting a good grade on his test, rather than listen to the music simply to enjoy it, or for the experience of listening to it.

For many, disinterest is only a necessary condition of the aesthetic attitude, so that an attitude’s being disinterested does not guarantee that it is an aesthetic attitude. Something else may have to be present. A court judge will approach a trial with disinterest in this sense. He will try to be impartial and not let any personal feelings or goals cloud his judgment, but he does not thereby approach the trial aesthetically. Something else about his attitude would have to be present.

Furthermore, having this kind of disinterested attitude toward something by no means precludes finding it interesting. If the collector, in her more contemplative state, finds the interactions among a certain cluster of figures especially meaningful, then we can describe her as interested in those figures. This does not mean, however, that she is interested in them for some external purpose. Disinterestedness, then, does not indicate complete lack of interest (finding something uninteresting), but a lack of personal investment or goal-directed interest.

c. Appreciation for Its Own Sake

Suppose now that the music student above were instead listening to the music simply to enjoy it or just for the experience of listening to it. We might say that he was listening to the music for its own sake. This suggests the second traditional way of characterizing the aesthetic attitude. According to this way of thinking about it, the aesthetic attitude involves considering or appreciating something (for example an artwork) for its own sake. This means that we want to experience the work, not because it fulfills some desire for something else, but just because we want to have that experience. So a museum-goer may spend time in the Egyptian art galleries in order to make her son happy, but she may spend time in Islamic art galleries simply because she wants to look at and experience Islamic art, that is, she wants to see the objects for their own sake and not for the sake of anything beyond or outside of them. We will return to both of these traditional characterizations at greater length below.

Now that some idea of the nature of the aesthetic attitude is in place, we can turn to the development of the aesthetic attitude in the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries. After that, we will be appropriately placed to look at the three main twentieth-century aesthetic attitude theories and some of the criticisms that have been made of them.

2. Historical Underpinnings

Aesthetic attitude theories are marked by their general insistence on the fundamental importance of the aesthetic attitude. Some of these theories hold that the nature of art is explained by the aesthetic attitude. This is generally accepted as an insufficient way of setting the boundaries of art, for reasons we have already seen, since nature, too, is a perfectly fine thing to take the aesthetic attitude toward. Most aesthetic attitude theories thus offer subtler and more complex accounts of the interaction among the aesthetic attitude, art, and beauty. Indeed, many of these philosophers have been keen on distinguishing a variety of different aesthetic qualities. In addition to beauty, they are interested in sublimity, novelty, charm, and so on.

There is no consensus regarding where exactly in the history of philosophy the aesthetic attitude first appears. The phrase ‘aesthetic attitude’ only appears in print very late in the nineteenth century, so some maintain that, before the twentieth century, there were no aesthetic attitude theories properly speaking. Even granting this, there is still clear historical precedent for the theory, and in spirit these historical theories bear a great deal of resemblance to the later aesthetic attitude theories.

Tracing the aesthetic attitude theory back to its origins, we may find its clearest early ancestor in the eighteenth-century notion of disinterest. This is to be found among a group of British thinkers writing about beauty and taste. Among these, Lord Shaftesbury is probably the earliest to discuss the notion in any real depth. The next important figure is Immanuel Kant, who wrote his three critiques at the end of the eighteenth century, the third of which, the Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790), is devoted to his theory of aesthetics and teleology. The final seminal figure is Arthur Schopenhauer, whose book The World as Will and Representation (1844) discusses aesthetic contemplation at length. It is in Schopenhauer that some notion of the aesthetic attitude is most noticeable and the similarities to modern theories most apparent. This section will provide an overview of the classical sources of aesthetic attitude theories, starting from their seeds in eighteenth-century British theories of taste, through Kant, and up to Schopenhauer.

a. Eighteenth-Century British Philosophers

The relationship between the aesthetic attitude and eighteenth-century British theories of taste is a subject of debate. Some philosophers, like Jerome Stolnitz, argue that there is a deep continuity, and that, really, these British philosophers have the same essential views as other classical aesthetic attitude theorists like Kant and Schopenhauer. Others, like George Dickie, have argued that there is an important divide between the two groups of theories. The details of the debate aside, it is hard to deny any connection. At the very least, these British philosophers influenced Kant and thus, either directly or indirectly, inspired everyone who has written about the aesthetic attitude since.

Several important British philosophers wrote about aesthetics and art. Shaftesbury, Francis Hutcheson, and David Hume, among yet others, wrote prominently about beauty and taste. Their theories are often referred to as theories of taste because they each essentially involve the notion of a special kind of faculty, the faculty of taste, that we use to determine an object’s aesthetic value. This faculty is generally taken to be naturally better in some than in others, though we can do things to improve it (expose ourselves to variety, learn about the artistic medium, and so on). Later British theorists, such as Edmund Burke, argued against such a faculty, worrying that it failed to really explain anything.

Most importantly, it is in these theories that we first find the notion of disinterest (though in Hume it appears as a lack of “prejudice”). Each of these philosophers argued that aesthetic appreciation involves disinterested pleasure. Despite slight differences among their notions of disinterest, the general idea is clear. When we are disinterested, we do not regard the aesthetic object as a tool for serving our own interests. One might wonder, however, whether it is independent from all other interests and all other values.

Shaftesbury argues that aesthetic experience is disinterested, but has a Platonic picture on which beauty is essentially the same as goodness and truth. Aesthetic appreciation is thus not devoid of any connection whatsoever to other values (ethical and epistemological), despite lacking connection to our personal ends and interests. For him, appreciating something aesthetically involves the same essential feeling as appreciating something morally. Shaftesbury does not, however, have a proper aesthetic attitude theory according to the above classification. His view is not one according to which our approaching something aesthetically makes it an aesthetic object. Beauty, along with morality and truth, are independent of our minds, though it is through taking the aesthetic attitude that we are able to recognize them. Shaftesbury may think that these things depend on the mind of God, but they certainly do not depend on us.

Hutcheson and Hume, on the other hand, disagree with Shaftesbury’s unified view. Both reject the equivalence of beauty, goodness, and truth, and see more of a gap between aesthetic value and other values. The details of Hutcheson and Hume differ, but both adopt Shaftesbury’s stress on disinterest. This is the crucial point on which all three theorists agree: they all share the central idea of disinterested pleasure as independent from personal interest, and it is this notion that forms the starting point for aesthetic attitude theories.

b. Kant

Kant is the next place to look for a theory of the aesthetic attitude. He takes up the notion of our judgments of beauty, but seems to follow earlier suspicions about a special faculty of taste. He opts instead to make his central notion that of aesthetic judgments, also called judgments of taste or judgments of the beautiful. His task is then to explain what exactly these are and how we make them. According to Kant, aesthetic judgments involve four important aspects. They must be disinterested, be universal, exhibit purposiveness without purpose, and be necessary. This article will focus mainly on disinterestedness, as it is there that we see most clearly the connection to the aesthetic attitude. A brief explanation of the other three will be included, as well, in order to present a clearer picture of the overall view. (See also the article on Kant’s Aesthetics.)

The first necessary condition regards the quality that our judgments of taste have. This is not quality in the sense of their being good or bad, accurate or inaccurate, or so on. Instead, by the quality of such judgments, Kant means their nature, what they are like and what they feel like. Kant points out, first, that all judgments of taste are essentially subjective. They come from our feelings, not from any objective fact that exists out in the world. He then argues that there are three kinds of satisfaction: that which we take in the agreeable, the beautiful, and the good, and he uses the contrasts to better clarify the nature of judgments of taste.

First, the agreeable gratifies some desire. We find tea agreeable when we have a desire for tea. In this sense, the pleasure in the tea is interested, since it serves our purpose. Kant also points out that our finding it agreeable depends essentially on us and our psychology. This also means, though, that it is not up to us to choose what to find agreeable. Our psychologies determine what we find agreeable, and we cannot change what we desire simply by willing to. One cannot stop a craving, for example, just by choosing to stop, since cravings do not work that way.

Next, we come to the good. The good is esteemed and approved, and there is objective value set on it. We find being generous good when we set objective value on generosity or generous actions. Pleasure in the good is also interested, since, for Kant, reason determines what we find good. This is still a personal interest because each person has an interest in bringing about the good. The person who finds generosity good has an interest in bringing about a more generous world, for example, by being generous and encouraging other people to do so.

The beautiful, in contrast, is disinterested pleasure. The art collector who enjoys her artwork for its monetary value enjoys that work in an interested way, and thus has not taken the aesthetic attitude toward it. Consequently, any positive judgment she produces will not be a judgment of taste. Kant takes this idea further, arguing that anyone who really approaches something with a contemplative, disinterested attitude and finds it beautiful (that is, takes the aesthetic attitude toward it) will not even be interested in whether the object in fact exists. To want the object to exist is to have an interest wrapped up in it, or in other words, to have something be at stake in its existence. Kant illustrates his point with a helpful example. Imagine a conversation in which one person asks another whether he finds a certain palace beautiful. He answers by saying that he dislikes things made on the backs and at the expense of the proletariat, or that he would never want such a thing for himself. These are cases where the palace’s existence is offensive or undesirable. The man has simply not answered the question of its beauty. The man has not taken an aesthetic attitude toward it. This is what Kant means when he says that the object’s existence cannot factor into the judgment. The aesthetic attitude is related to these remarks in that we must have a certain frame of mind, that is, a disinterested one, in order to make aesthetic judgments.

There are three other conditions of judgments of taste. They must be universal, which just means that they feel as though they apply to everyone. Calling something beautiful means feeling like everyone should recognize it as beautiful (even if we realize that it is not a fact about the object that it is beautiful). The objects of these judgments also exhibit what Kant calls purposiveness without purpose, or alternatively, finality without an end (a translation offered by Creed Meredith). This may sound complex, but it just means that, while there may be no actual purpose of the object (or at least, not one of which we are aware), we are struck by how it seems to be made for a purpose. For example, though we may not know why a plant’s leaves are arranged in angles echoing the Fibonacci sequence, we notice a certain pattern and appreciate the purposiveness there. If, though, the actual purpose entered our judgment, then we would have the beginnings of interested pleasure, which Kant has argued cannot be aesthetic. Finally, these judgments are also necessary in the sense that it feels like we judge according to some unspoken universal rule, from which our judgment necessarily follows.

Above, we saw that Kant takes aesthetic judgments to be subjective. However, the bigger picture reveals a more nuanced view. Such judgments come from our feelings of pleasure, but only when we take that pleasure to be universal, necessary, and felt in response to purposiveness rather than purpose. The universality, necessity, and reaction to the appearance of purpose (and not to actual purpose) exist only because our pleasure is disinterested. It is precisely when we experience this kind of subjective yet disinterested pleasure that we think these judgments hold universally and necessarily. Thus disinterest, a notion first brought to the fore by the eighteenth-century British philosophers, continues to be a central notion in Kant’s aesthetics. However, Kant does not seem to have a true aesthetic attitude theory in the sense defined above. It is a matter of interpretation, but it looks as though he does not think that any object we approach with this frame of mind thereby becomes an aesthetic object. Many argue that it is not until Schopenhauer, for whom disinterest is even more important, that we see an actual aesthetic attitude theory.

c. Schopenhauer

The notion of the aesthetic attitude may not appear fully formed until Schopenhauer, in Book III of The World as Will and Representation. Schopenhauer does not use the term ‘aesthetic attitude’, either, but instead talks about aesthetic contemplation. His understanding of this form of contemplation, however, is clearly related to twentieth-century aesthetic attitude theories, and as such he is generally looked to as the historical philosopher whose view is closest to the contemporary versions of the theory

To understand his view of the aesthetic attitude, it helps to know a little bit about Schopenhauer’s philosophy. He understands life as driven by the Will, which is a kind of unceasing desire and forms the basis of perpetual human suffering. When we desire something, we suffer in not having it. If we were to obtain all the things we desired, we would be overcome with boredom, a deeper and more poignant suffering. Experiencing the world in this way is experiencing the world as Will. However, he sees a few ways out of this. The most permanent solution is to adopt a severe ascetic outlook and stop having desires at all, but a temporary solution is to be found in aesthetic contemplation, where we experience the world as representation rather than as Will.

In a famous passage (section 34), Schopenhauer describes a few things that go along with the aesthetic attitude (although, again, he does not use this term). We may then begin to see how this contemplative state can release us from the cycle of suffering. First, we do not look at things in the ordinary way. This is generally accepted as having both a perceptual meaning and a non-perceptual one. There is a special aesthetic mode of perception where we attend much more fully to the surface features of an object. However, we also typically look at something with an eye to its relationships to other things. Schopenhauer argues that this boils down to looking at it with an eye to how it might help our own goals, that is, relate to our wills. In the aesthetic attitude, though, this relational viewing is completely absent, and we only pay attention to things themselves. Second, we do not have in mind abstract thought or reasoning, but instead focus on the perception alone. Here Schopenhauer says that the representation fills our mind and we are thus filled with calm contemplation. In this way, we stop thinking about the will and, since the perception takes up all of our mental ‘space’, we no longer sense a difference between ourselves and the object perceived. This means that, third, we will begin to see, in a sense, through the object itself to its Idea. So far, what this means is a bit opaque, but we can understand it in the following way. When we stop looking at the particular thing and what it might do for our own ends, we stop experiencing the world as related to our wills. Instead, we experience the world as representation. But these representations must be of something, and indeed they are representations of Ideas. These are similar to Plato’s Ideas or Forms: they are eternal and unchangeable. So when we contemplate things aesthetically, that is, take the aesthetic attitude toward things, we can know the Ideas. (It is, moreover, the aim of the aesthetic attitude to know the Ideas.)

Since everything represents Ideas and manifests the will in some way, anything can become the object of the aesthetic attitude. Not only does this mean that, according to our definition, Schopenhauer has an aesthetic attitude theory, but it also means that the aesthetic attitude has profound practical import. It can release us from the cycle of constant suffering, since we stop experiencing our wills in any way. Aesthetic contemplation also helps us deal with very real, very difficult situations. If we start to think aesthetically about the world, other people, and ourselves, then we will stop being angry, resentful, or sad (though we will also stop being excited or happy). We will instead see things that cause us pain as manifestations of the Idea of humanity, as nothing new or special. To put it a slightly different way, we will stop taking things personally. The vicissitudes of life will become just that, simply fluctuations through which we can have real encounters with Ideas.

It would be misleading to suggest that taking the aesthetic attitude is easy and comes naturally to everyone. It is even slightly misleading to call it aesthetic contemplation. Contemplation suggests passivity, but Schopenhauer argues that artistic geniuses can not only actively adopt the aesthetic attitude, but can also remain in that state for longer than the typical fleeting moment. They find beauty in all kinds of places and use art to communicate their insights to the rest of us. These views have inspired a debate about whether the aesthetic attitude (and aesthetic experience) is active or passive: whether we can make ourselves adopt this outlook and have aesthetic experiences, or whether they simply happen to us when the stars align just right. Schopenhauer answers that the aesthetic attitude is some mix of these, that certain people are more adept at engaging it actively, while it is a transient and happenstance state for others.

In Schopenhauer, we thus see a clear extension of the earlier notion of disinterest. In aesthetic contemplation, we stop thinking about the world and the objects in it as means to our ends, that is, as objects of our will. We also see attention and perception take center stage. Aesthetic contemplation, which can be active or passive, involves intense focus where the perception completely fills the mind. Finally, we see a crucial role for the aesthetic attitude in the larger theory. It helps us know Ideas, and by doing so, releases us from endless suffering. Many aspects of Schopenhauer’s view have resonated with subsequent philosophers of aesthetics. But in order to fully adopt his view, one must adopt much of the rest of his philosophy, that is, his theory of Ideas, representation, and the Will. Later aesthetic attitude theorists are generally unwilling to do this, but they still manage to preserve some key aspects of the view.

3. Twentieth-Century Aesthetic Attitude Theories

There are three prominent aesthetic attitude theorists in the twentieth century: Edward Bullough, Jerome Stolnitz, and Roger Scruton. Each of these three theorists tries to accomplish at least two major goals. First, each tries to give an intuitive definition of what the aesthetic attitude is, one that does not make the wrong attitudes (for example, interested ones) aesthetic attitudes but includes all the attitudes that do seem to be aesthetic. The second aim of each theory is to say something about the relationship between the aesthetic attitude and the philosophy of art and aesthetics more generally. In particular, they all use the aesthetic attitude to provide a definition of aesthetic objects, that is, to demarcate aesthetic objects from non-aesthetic ones.

a. Bullough and Psychical Distance

Bullough, a psychologist, is the first theorist here to use the term ‘aesthetic attitude’, but actually most often uses the interchangeable term ‘aesthetic consciousness’. His theory essentially involves disinterest, which he talks about as psychical distance. It is worth noting at the outset that his theory has not gained widespread support, though it has significantly contributed to the shaping of subsequent theories of the aesthetic attitude. We will see that his way of approaching and developing the notion of disinterest, though perhaps flawed, provides an interesting and evocative metaphor for aesthetic experience.

Bullough calls the central feature of aesthetic consciousness psychical distance, a metaphorical extension of spatial and temporal distance. We are all familiar with what it is to be distanced from something in space; it is just to be far away. Similarly, to be temporally distant from something is to exist, say, a hundred years after it. Bullough characterizes the experience of psychical distance as that of not being very emotionally close to or attached to something and not thinking about its practical role. His example is of a fog. Normally, a fog at sea causes us anxiety because it drastically reduces our field of vision, is associated with unexpected dangers, and is difficult to navigate. If, however, we take the aesthetic attitude toward it, we can direct our attention to its surface features. The fog may look soft and even palpable, and the air may feel peaceful and still. These latter sensations occur because we have been able to insert the proper psychical distance between ourselves and the fog.

This distance, Bullough says, is the result of putting the perceived object “out of gear” with our practical interests. Our practical ends should have no traction on our thoughts when we are properly distanced. We should not think about practical or personal concerns, but instead focus on the object itself. We also need, therefore, to be properly distanced from certain emotions, like those that concern our personal stake or even those that concern morality. That said, emotional response is still intimately involved in aesthetic consciousness and experience, but these emotions need to be generalized beyond our individual, particular feelings. So far, this sounds similar to the notion of disinterest discussed above. Bullough adds to this by explaining two ways distancing can go wrong.

We can fail to be properly distanced from a work if we are too psychically close to it or too psychically far away – that is, if we are too emotionally involved or too emotionally removed. Bullough refers to these conditions respectively as under-distancing and over-distancing. Under-distancing occurs when we are unable to separate our personal interests from what we experience. Suppose a jealous husband watches a performance of Othello and becomes increasingly suspicious, his rage building, and eventually only really sees himself and his wife instead of Othello and Desdemona. This man is under-distanced, since his emotions are too involved in the play’s action. On the other hand, imagine a brilliant satire of ancient Chinese society that we are now in very poor position to appreciate. This is a case of over-distancing. For many such works, the artwork may be sadly unable to engage our emotions sufficiently because we are too removed from it. Thus there is what Bullough terms a distance-limit, beyond which we are too far away to have aesthetic consciousness. He says that, practically speaking, people should err on the side of trying to distance themselves, since our tendency is to get too emotionally involved. What we should aim for, in theory, is the greatest distance without passing the distance-limit.

Here, we can see that spatial and temporal distance are not merely metaphors for psychical distance. We are too temporally removed to properly engage with the brilliant Chinese satire. Similarly, Bullough argues, being too spatially close to a work can make us unable to engage with it properly. This is in fact how he explains the relegation of culinary art to a second class art form. Since we have to taste these things and thus come into direct physical contact with them, we are simply unable to distance ourselves sufficiently from them.

Bullough also uses his theory to interesting effect in explaining why artists are sometimes censored, ostracized, or banned. Artists are better able to distance themselves than the average person, so they see more objects aesthetically. Non-artists, however, may look at the art and see only a hypersexualized youth (Nabokov’s Lolita), say, or a sacrilegious depiction of a holy figure (Serrano’s “Piss Christ”)

Many have found these implications implausible. Physical closeness to a work, for example, does not actually seem to preclude the proper psychical distance or disinterested attitude. There are further worries that, at best, Bullough only offers a necessary condition for the aesthetic attitude. Without something further, he ca not distinguish it from the court judge’s disinterested attitude. That said, Bullough is still an important figure in the development of aesthetic attitude theory. His development of a structured and explanatorily ambitious view set the tone for the aesthetic attitude theories that follow.

b. Stolnitz

For Stolnitz, the aesthetic attitude involves attending to something (anything) in a disinterested and sympathetic way, and doing so for its own sake. When we look at something in a disinterested way, we look at it non-instrumentally. This is just to say that we do not look at it as a means (as an instrument) to some other end. So, as above, the collector who admires her painting for its rarity fails to engage with her painting aesthetically. Similarly, the music student who looks for musical knowledge in the keys and chords of the symphony does not engage with it aesthetically. Interestingly, Stolnitz mentions that this also implies that the attitude of an art critic, either amateur or professional, is opposed to the aesthetic attitude. To see why this is so, it is enough to recognize that the critic has a goal: to form and pass judgment.

By including sympathy as a criterion of the aesthetic attitude, Stolnitz introduces the idea that the right attitude must take the artwork on its own terms. One needs to ignore personal conflicts and biases. The discovery that an artist was a miser should not change one’s aesthetic attitude toward the work, though it may give one pause when thinking morally about the artist. To up the ante, he argues that in order to view propaganda art or Nazi art with the proper aesthetic viewpoint, one will have to view it sympathetically, as well, and ignore the moral backdrop against which these things exist. (Nobody said that taking the aesthetic attitude was easy.) Failure to do so will taint any aesthetic experience that results, something we may be able to see in our occasional complaints to others that they “haven’t even given it a chance.” (To be clear, Stolnitz does not make and is not committed to any claims about the moral import of taking the aesthetic attitude in these difficult situations.)

Stolnitz understands attention, the third major component of his definition, as a kind of alert state. He agrees with predecessors that it is a kind of contemplation, but says that we have to understand contemplation in the right way. He agrees with Schopenhauer that the aesthetic attitude is not as passive as the term ‘contemplation’ suggests. (He disagrees, however, with Schopenhauer’s claim that only artistic geniuses can actively engage in aesthetic contemplation.) Aesthetic contemplation does not involve simply sitting back, relaxing, and letting the mind wander. It involves mental focus and thought, and such intense mental involvement may manifest itself in a tightening of muscles during a thrilling scene, a foot tapping to the beat, or a tilt of one’s head like the figure in a painting. Such physical manifestations are not required by the aesthetic attitude, but they exemplify the active, engaged mental state that itself does constitute the proper attitude.

Stolnitz is a proper aesthetic attitude theorist who argues that we can adopt the aesthetic attitude toward anything. He acknowledges that this implies that nothing is inherently unaesthetic. Stolnitz offers intuitive support for this view, pointing out that artists often approach ugly or boring objects with the aesthetic attitude and create something beautiful. A deformed and hideous bell pepper may, when approached in the right way, become a striking aesthetic object, as in the photographs of Edward Weston. Similarly, a humble shipping container or typeface may, when one takes the proper aesthetic attitude toward it, appear noble, subtle, and beautiful. So we can find traditionally ugly things aesthetic, but we can also find boring, everyday objects aesthetic when we approach them in the right way. It follows, moreover, from this view that neither art nor nature is inherently more aesthetic than the other. Since nothing is inherently unaesthetic, nothing in art is at an aesthetic disadvantage to anything in nature, and vice versa.

He also uses the aesthetic attitude to demarcate the bounds between things that count as aesthetically relevant and irrelevant, that is, what is and is not relevant to the aesthetic experience and to any verdict that may result from it. Thoughts that are compatible with disinterested, sympathetic attention can be aesthetically relevant as long as they do not divert attention away from the aesthetic object. Certain kinds of interpretation can thus count as aesthetically relevant or be ruled out as irrelevant. A poem might perfectly well suggest a cathedral without saying it explicitly. The thought of a cathedral that accompanies the poem is thus aesthetically relevant. However, it might also remind one of a personal experience, say, of one’s wedding that took place in a cathedral. This diverts attention away from the poem and is thus, argues Stolnitz, aesthetically irrelevant.

Stolnitz also applies these ideas to the problem of determining the aesthetic relevance of external facts. Such facts are aesthetically relevant when they (1) do not weaken our aesthetic attention, (2) pertain to the meaning or expressiveness of the object, and (3) enhance the quality of one’s aesthetic response. For example, it may be relevant to know that a certain painting is of the crucifixion of Jesus. It may, however, be irrelevant that Gauguin’s rendering of the Crucifixion does not accurately capture the story as it is told in the gospels. Perhaps the point is, so to speak, precisely to paint it in a different light.

Of all the theorists surveyed here, Stolnitz falls most squarely into our model of an aesthetic attitude theorist. His notion of the aesthetic attitude is completely explicit and forms the core of his theory. He uses it to define aesthetic objects and explain the aesthetic relevance of external thoughts and facts, as well as a host of related aesthetic issues.

c. Scruton

For Scruton, the aesthetic attitude has three main components. First, its goal is some kind of pleasure, enjoyment, or satisfaction. This means that, although the aesthetic attitude may not always in fact yield pleasure, it is our hope in taking such an attitude that it will. If we thought there were no enjoyment of any kind we could get out of an object, we would not attend to it aesthetically. The view should not be mistaken for what we might call aesthetic hedonism, the view that aesthetic value resides solely in a thing’s ability to give us pleasure. Pleasure should not be thought of too narrowly, either. Sad music can afford aesthetic satisfaction, as can paintings of violent scenes.

The aesthetic attitude must also involve attention to an object for its own sake. Scruton expresses dissatisfaction about how little the notion of ‘for its own sake’ has been explained by other theorists. To see this, consider that we know perfectly well what it means to do something for our own sake or for someone else’s sake. It is to do something with their interests in mind. What would attending to art for the sake of the art’s interests be, though? Scruton finds the particular phrase strange, but tries to find the kernel of insight in it. To be interested in something for its own sake involves a desire to go on experiencing it, but not in order to satisfy another, separate desire. This means that, if the art collector has a desire to look at her painting, and part of her desire to look at it is that she desires to admire its rarity, then she has not taken the aesthetic attitude. She is interested in it for its own sake only when there are no other desires she has that seeing the painting would satisfy.

Third and finally, the aesthetic attitude is normative. Normative just means that there is a certain kind of ‘should’-ness about it or that it explicitly or implicitly contains a value judgment. If a mother tells her son to be respectful, she makes a normative claim on him: that it is good to be respectful, and that he should do it. Furthermore, if she just notices that he is being disrespectful and disapproves, there is something normative involved in her disapproving reaction. The aesthetic attitude is normative in the sense that any judgment that comes out of the aesthetic attitude carries normative force. In other words, when we think that something is beautiful, we think that other people should find it beautiful, too. This is how Scruton, a self-proclaimed Kantian, sees himself as taking on Kant’s view above that aesthetic judgments are universal.

It is worth remarking that Scruton may not be talking about the aesthetic attitude as we have seen it so far. Until now, the aesthetic attitude has been understood as a state of mind or a kind of viewpoint that one can generally adopt at will, and that must exist prior to any aesthetic experience. Scruton writes, however, that the aesthetic attitudes are what we express when we make aesthetic judgments. This would mean that, in calling something beautiful, we make an aesthetic judgment and thus express an aesthetic attitude, namely, the aesthetic attitude we had when we judged or experienced the object as beautiful. While not a problem with his view, this means that he may not be talking about exactly the same thing as the earlier theorists. Among other things, this view leads to there being many different aesthetic attitudes, rather than just one special frame of mind or mode of perception that we are in when we have particular aesthetic experiences. Scruton’s definition may actually come closer to the normal meaning of ‘attitude’, in the way that we talk about an attitude of disapproval or an attitude of hope. Here, we find attitudes of beauty, elegance, loveliness, their opposites, and so on.

4. Criticism

In 1964, George Dickie offered a set of famous objections to aesthetic attitude theories. After Dickie, the aesthetic attitude has received very little attention outside Scruton, which may suggest a general acceptance of his objections. A few defenses of aesthetic attitude theories have been offered, but the literature has not stirred much since, indicating perhaps instead simply a waning interest in the topic.

a. Against Aesthetic Attitude Theories

In his well-known paper, “The Myth of the Aesthetic Attitude,” Dickie objects in turn to each of Bullough and Stolnitz’s theories. Dickie argues that the former thinks of distancing as a special kind of action that we can perform: we put ourselves “out of gear” with practical concerns. We can aim to and can successfully distance ourselves from perceived objects. These make distancing sound very much like an action. Dickie swiftly dismisses this view on the grounds that there really is no such special action. What really happens in such cases is that we attend differently, and attending is a perfectly normal and unmysterious action. One might worry about the details of Dickie’s argument here, but since Stolnitz’s view is the more nuanced and fully developed of the two, the majority of criticism is focused on his view.

Recall that, for Stolnitz, the aesthetic attitude involves a special kind of aesthetic perception: disinterested, sympathetic attention. Dickie focuses on the ‘disinterested’ part of this definition, noting first that ‘disinterested’ is an unhelpful clarification unless it means something to be ‘interested’. Stolnitz, so far, should be fine with this, and we may recall that he gives many cases of interested attention to clarify what disinterest amounts to.

In essence Dickie argues that there are really no cases of interested attention. Any alleged case of interested attention in fact falls into one of two categories: either it is not attention to the artwork at all; or it is, but it really is not a different kind of attention from disinterested attention. On the one hand, there are examples like the jealous husband watching Othello or the art collector who is happy about her investment. Dickie argues that these are really cases where the perceiver is not actually paying attention to the artwork. In the former case, the jealous husband is paying attention to the situation with his wife rather than the play. In the latter case, the art collector is paying attention to her finances, rather than the painting.

On the other hand, there are cases like the music student paying attention to chord progressions or a father watching his daughter at a piano recital. In these situations, Dickie argues, the music student and the father are paying attention to the artwork. There is no difference in their manner of attending or perceiving, despite perhaps a difference in motive. To sharpen this, the idea is that there is no special mode of perception that corresponds uniquely to the way we perceive when we adopt the aesthetic attitude. There is only one way to perceive or attend to something, and that is just by looking at it or noting features of it. The father, the music student, and the ideal aesthetic perceiver are all doing just that. The father and music student may be differently motivated, but this means nothing for the way in which they actually perceive or attend to the work.

The key to Dickie’s argument is that he takes Bullough and Stolnitz to understand the aesthetic attitude as involving a special kind of action or attention. From this, he argues that there is no special mode or manner of acting or attending that uniquely produces aesthetic experiences.

b. In Defense of Aesthetic Attitude Theories

As mentioned earlier, some responses to this have been offered. Gary Kemp offered an extended response to Dickie’s objections. Foremost among these is the denial of Dickie’s crucial premise that there is only really one way of acting or attending. Kemp argues that there are many different ways of attending. The music student may attend to the chord progressions, to the orchestration, or to the rhythms. Here, the student seems to be attending fully, but also in an interested way. But if he attends for the sake of enjoyment, then he is certainly attending differently and perhaps disinterestedly. These, Kemp says, are genuinely different ways of attending, and the real difficulty of the aesthetic attitude theory is to explain why some of them seem aesthetic and some do not. He then offers his own explanation of this distinction.

Kemp argues that disinterested attention does not seem to select the right cases. For example, it is intuitive that the father who attends his daughter’s recital could attend perfectly aesthetically to her performance, despite the fact that the reason he is there is to see his daughter. Kemp instead prefers Scruton’s notion of interest in the experience for its own sake. This supports examples like the father. Once he starts listening, he has a desire to go on listening to the music, we can imagine, and this desire does not now depend on any other desire to sustain it (although it came to exist only because he wanted to hear his daughter play). There is now no reason for his desire aside from his wanting to keep listening to the music.

c. Where to Go From Here

Aesthetic attitude theories have enjoyed isolated appearances in the past forty years, but the interest in it may be declining. Again, this may be due in part to the belief that Dickie’s criticisms were devastating and final, but it may also be due to the general dissatisfaction with the theoretical role the aesthetic attitude has been made to play. Many have moved to views of aesthetic experience, rather than aesthetic attitude, as the crucial notion to be considered. The differences between the two are subtle, but definite. Recall that the aesthetic attitude is a point of view one takes. It is, in a sense, a way of priming our experience in which we mentally set ourselves up to pay attention to certain things. The experiences that result, if we have been successful, are aesthetic experiences. These aesthetic experiences, in certain contemporary views, play the theoretical role that the aesthetic attitude was originally meant to play. Thus, philosophers have recently tried to draw the boundary between aesthetic and non-aesthetic objects using the notion of an aesthetic experience instead of the aesthetic attitude. The things that afford aesthetic experiences (or, alternatively, facilitate it) are aesthetic objects. These views can extend their theoretical reaches further in many ways. For example, they can offer a definition of artworks as the things that are created intentionally in order to afford aesthetic experiences. As such, these theories may have largely supplanted the original aesthetic attitude theories, since aesthetic experience can seem like a less presumptuous notion and more theoretically powerful. This move to aesthetic experience is most prominent in the work of Monroe Beardsley, but also to be found in Malcolm Budd, Kendall Walton, and many other contemporary thinkers. Whatever the fate of the aesthetic attitude theories and the aesthetic experience theories that follow them, the notion of a special kind of aesthetic attitude or experience remains, if not of central theoretical importance, of great interest in thinking about our aesthetic lives.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Beardsley, Monroe. 1982. The Aesthetic Point of View. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
    • A collection of Beardsley’s essays. For the turn to aesthetic experience, see especially the essay “The Aesthetic Point of View.”
  • Budd, Malcolm. 1995. Values of Art. London: Penguin Books.
    • Budd’s main work in aesthetics that addresses aesthetic value across different media.
  • Bullough, Edward. 1957. Aesthetics: Lectures and Essays, ed. Elizabeth M. Wilkinson. London: Bowes & Bowes.
    • A collection of Bullough’s essays that includes both “‘Psychical Distance’” and “The Modern Conception of Aesthetics.”
  • Bullough, Edward. 1912. “‘Psychical Distance’ as a Factor in Art and an Aesthetic Principle.” British Journal of Psychology 5, 87-118.
    • The classic article in which the notion of psychical distance first appears.
  • Burke, Edmund. 1958. A Philosophical Enquiry into the Origin of our Ideas of the Sublime and the Beautiful, ed. James T. Boulton. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
    • Where Burke criticizes the faculty of taste and presents his own views of the beautiful and sublime.
  • Dickie, George. 1964. “The Myth of the Aesthetic Attitude.” American Philosophical Quarterly 1, 56-65.
    • The most famous objections to the aesthetic attitude theory.
  • Fenner, David. 1996. The Aesthetic Attitude. New Jersey: Humanities Press.
    • A thorough, historical overview of the issues. A great secondary resource.
  • Guyer, Paul. 1993. Kant and the Experience of Freedom: Essays on Aesthetics and Morality. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • A collection of essays about Kant’s aesthetics and the historical context surrounding it.
  • Hume, David. 1987. “Of the Standard of Taste.” In Eugene Miller (ed.), Essays: Moral, Political, and Literary (pp. 226-249). Indianapolis: Liberty Fund.
    • Hume explains how the faculty of taste develops and works.
  • Hutcheson, Francis. 1971. An Inquiry into the Original of Our Ideas of Beauty and Virtue. New York: Garland.
    • Hutcheson’s theory of the moral and aesthetic faculties.
  • Kant, Immanuel. 2000. Critique of the Power of Judgment, ed. Paul Guyer, trans. Paul Guyer and Eric Matthews. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • Kant’s systematic treatment of aesthetics and teleology.
  • Kemp, Gary. 1999. “The Aesthetic Attitude.” British Journal of Aesthetics 39, 392-399.
    • A series of responses to Dickie’s objections, and a further analysis of aesthetic attitude theory.
  • Langfeld, Herbert Sidney. 1920. The Aesthetic Attitude. New York: Harcourt, Brace and Co.
    • An introduction to prominent theories of the time, mixed with Langfeld’s own views on the issues.
  • Schopenhauer, Arthur. 1969. The World as Will and Representation, Volume I, trans. Eric F. J. Payne. New York: Dover.
    • Schopenhauer’s magnum opus, in which he offers his theory of the world as developing Will and represented Ideas.
  • Scruton, Roger. 1982. Art and Imagination: A Study in the Philosophy of Mind. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
    • A theory of aesthetics developed on the basis of an empiricist philosophy of mind.
  • Shaftesbury, Anthony Ashley Cooper, Third Earl of. 1999. Characteristics of Men, Manners, Opinions, Times, ed. Lawrence E. Klein. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • Shaftesbury’s views on a wide range of topics. For his aesthetic theory, see especially the section “The Moralists.”
  • Stolnitz, Jerome. 1960. Aesthetics and Philosophy of Art Criticism. Cambridge: Riverside Press.
    • A topic-based introduction to aesthetics, mixed with Stolnitz’s own views on the issues.

 

Author Information

Alexandra King
Email: alexandra_king@brown.edu
Brown University
U. S. A.

Modal Metaphysics

Modal metaphysics concerns the metaphysical underpinning of our modal statements. These are statements about what is possible or what is necessarily so. We can construe the primary question of modal metaphysics as, “When we make a statement about what is possible or necessary, what determines the truth or falsity of the statement?” As an illustration, consider the statement “It is possible for me to be a dentist.” This says that one possibility for me is to enter the dentistry profession. That seems true enough. But if so, what determines its truth? Normally, a statement is true because it represents a situation that actually obtains, but in the present case, the statement represents a situation which does not actually obtain. So, why is the statement true?

Some philosophers, such as W.V.O Quine, dismiss this question by rejecting the coherence of modal notions. More typically, though, metaphysicians will answer that modal statements are not evaluated by how things actually are, but rather by how things might be or must be. Following Saul Kripke (1959; 1963), modal facts are construed as facts about possible worlds, where the actual world is just one among the many worlds that are possible. Kripke’s modal logic first defines each possible world by a maximally consistent set of statements, a consistent set such that for any statement p, either p or ~p is a member. Once these worlds are defined, a statement with the normal form “Possibly, p” is said  [in the most elementary kind of Kripkean logic]  to be true if, and only if, there is at least one possible world in which the state-of-affairs p obtains. Similarly, “Necessarily, p” is true precisely when p obtains in every possible world. So, the sentence “It is possible for me to become a dentist” is true because there is at least one possible world, so defined, where I am a dentist. Note that the above concerns metaphysical possibilities, specifically. The article will not discuss epistemic possibilities.

The  Kripkean apparatus was a great advance in logic, but it did not resolve the distinctly metaphysical issue. If our question was roughly, “What determines the truth or falsity of modal statements?,” then Kripke’s logic just seems to replace this question with “What are these ‘possible worlds’ that determine their truth or falsity?” Yet due to the influence of Kripke’s system, the latter question is often the one pursued in the literature and not the former question. So, this article reviews five kinds of answer to the question about possible worlds: (1) Meinong’s Realism, (2) David Lewis’ Realism, (3) Ersatzism, (4) Fictionalism, and (5) David Armstrong’s hybrid of (3) and (4). The last section considers Quine’s skepticism about the issue and about modality in general.

Table of Contents

  1. Meinong’s Realism
  2. Lewis’ Realism
  3. Ersatzism
    1. Sententialism
    2. Propositionalism and Property Ersatzism
    3. Pictorial Ersatzism
    4. Combinatorialism
    5. Non-Reductivism
  4. Fictionalism
  5. Armstrong’s Hybrid
  6. Quine’s Skepticism
  7. References and Further Reading

1. Meinong’s Realism

Meinong’s Realism, also called Meinongian Realism, is the contemporary Meinongian view which starts with Kripke’s possible worlds and attempts to make metaphysical sense of non-actual worlds and their denizens. The label ‘Meinongian,’ however, is anachronistic since Alexius Meinong was writing years before the advent of Kripkean worlds. Yet Meinong’s view of non-actual objects is one position to take regarding non-actual worlds. And indeed, the most important figure in modal metaphysics—David Lewis—was initially construed as a Meinongian about these worlds (see, for example, Plantinga 1976, Lycan 1979). Though Lewis’ (1986) view is clearly not a Meinongian one, as we shall see in the next section.

According to the Meinongian, it is intuitively evident that there are non-existent objects, such as Pegasus, unicorns, and the like. Even impossible objects, such as round squares, are counted among the things that there are. Infamously, Meinong once expressed this in the slogan “there are objects such that it is true to say of them that there are no such objects” (1904, p. 83). Despite the air of paradox, however, the idea that non-existent objects somehow “exist” can claim several advantages. For one, it is eminently faithful to ordinary language use, where apparently speakers refer freely to non-existents. For another, the view naturally extends the commonsense semantics of ordinary names to empty names such as ‘Pegasus.’ Unlike the descriptivist, say, the Meinongian simply regards ‘Pegasus’ labeling an object (albeit a non-existing one), just in the way that people commonly regard ‘Tony Blair’ as a label for a person. And besides this straightforward linguistic account, the Meinongian view also delivers objects to thoughts which might otherwise seem void. Thus, the Meinongian can say (for example) that physicists who hypothesized Vulcan were not literally thinking of no object; rather, they were thinking of a bona fide object, albeit a non-existent one.

Yet the reader may already sense one urgent objection for Meinongianism, namely, that it just dresses up something contradictory. On this line, once all the obfuscation is cleared away, Meinong is committed to the absurdity that non-existents exist. Meinong, however, anticipated this reaction and suggested that his intent was not to place non-existent objects in the categories of both being and non-being. Rather, they are to be placed in neither category, and instead lie “beyond being and non-being” (op. cit., p. 86).

Alternatively, some Meinongians respond to the charge by distinguishing two kinds of being, that is to say, the usual kind of being, and the sort of the “being” that Pegasus has (with scare quotes). This would allow us to reconstrue Meinong’s slogan as the claim that “there are” objects of which it is true to say that there are no such objects. However, these Meinongians often do not provide much explication of “being” in the scare-quoted sense, and critics have thus doubted its intelligibility.

Relatedly, there is Russell’s objection that Meinong’s commitment to the existence of round squares lands in contradiction.  In “On Denoting,” Russell generally objects to Meinong’s lack of a “robust sense of reality;” however, Russell regards  impossibilia (that is, objects which are neither actual nor possible) as especially problematic. Nonetheless, our concern here is with possibilia only, and Meinong’s view of impossibilia can be bracketted,

Regardless, even if the Meinongian view is intelligible, it faces additional difficulties. For instance, it appears Occam’s Razor would have us shave off Meinongian objects from our ontology (Quine 1948). A second concern is that some Meinongian objects seem incomplete or gappy. For instance, does Sherlock Holmes have a mole on his left knee? Even though “there is” such a person, Meinongianism apparently does not determine a fact of the matter. (Though again, a Meinongian view of possibilia, specifically, might just reject incomplete objects.) Quine protested that Meinongian objects have no clear individuation-conditions. Imagine first a non-existent bald man in a doorway, and then imagine a non-existent fat man in the doorway. Now ask yourself: Have you imagined the same man or not? The Meinongian seems to lack the resources to determine a fact of the matter.

2. Lewis’ Realism

The Meinongian view could be seen as Realist view about possible objects, since it holds that all possible objects (possibilia) are “real” in an important sense. A more robust kind of Realism, however, is expounded by David Lewis (1969; 1973; 1986). Unlike Meinongians who identify different kinds of “being” (or a realm “beyond being and non-being”), Lewis makes clear that there is only one kind of being, and that all possibilia (that is, all actual and non-actual possible objects) have it. Thus Lewis’ provocatively suggests that non-actual possibles exist in just the same way that you and I do (1986, pp. 2-3) Despite the prima facie implausibility, however, there is a type of indispensability argument which may speak in favor of the view. The idea is that talk of “possible worlds” is too useful to modal semantics to see it as a mere façon de parler (way of speaking). In the hard sciences, moreover, if an unobservable entity is theoretically useful, that is often seen as a reason to think it exists. In like manner, says Lewis, the theoretical utility of possible worlds provides at least some reason to believe that these objects exist (in the only sense of ‘exist’ that there is).

Now even if we are inclined to posit possibilia, it may seem that Lewis goes too far in declaring that possible worlds exist “in just the same way” that you and I do. After all, you and I are actual whereas Pegasus and his world are not. However, it is crucial that when Lewis calls a possible object “actual,” he is not attributing it any ontological status beyond the fact that it exists. For when Lewis says we are “actual” (and Pegasus is not), he only means that we are actual relative to this world. In contrast, relative to a world of Greek mythology, he will say it is Pegasus who is actual and we who are not. This should not suggest that there is a special property of “actuality” that is being passed around. Rather, it illustrates that Lewis uses ‘actual’ as an indexical term vis-à-vis worlds: Just as the pronoun ‘I’ picks out different people on different occasions (depending on the speaker), ‘actual’ can denote the objects of different worlds, depending on which world is relevant. Accordingly, Lewis’ use of ‘actual’ only serves to locate an object in the world of concern, among the myriad of worlds that exist. But consequently, there is no non-relative sense in which we (but not Pegasus) are “actual.”

So again, anything possible exists (in the only sense of ‘exists’ that there is); nonetheless, some objects are also actual though this merely serves to locate them in a contextually relevant world. But this talk of “locating” should not suggest that possible worlds exist in a shared space, where each world has a “location” in that space. For Lewis denies that spatio-temporal relations hold between worlds. Worlds are spatio-temporally isolated on his view; we cannot speak of events occurring at the same time in different worlds, nor can we speak of distances between worlds. As a corollary, there cannot be causal relations between worlds either (assuming causes bear some temporal relation to their effects). So oddly, even though alternate worlds exist just as much as we do, they do not exist anywhere in relation to us.

This could mislead, however, in suggesting that Lewisian worlds are a type of abstract object, akin to universals or sets. Realists about abstracta sometimes say that their objects lack a location, despite the fact they exist. However, Lewis concedes at least three senses in which his worlds qualify as “concrete.” First, note that if sets and universals are counted as abstract, then a contrast can be with individuals or particulars. In that case, Lewisian worlds qualify as non-abstract or “concrete,” since they are particulars. (But, note that a concrete world can be home to abstract objects all the same.) Second, the abstract/concrete distinction sometimes concerns whether an object has spatio-temporal dimensions. Yet here too, since Lewis’ worlds are spatio-temporal kinds of entities, they qualify as “concrete.” Finally, Lewis recognizes that some things might be abstract in the sense of being an “abstraction,” that is, they might be the kind of entity represented by an incomplete or gappy description. (An example would be “the Average American”). In line with Kripke, however, Lewis accepts that each possible world is described by the sentences in some maximally consistent set—and the set would describe the world completely. So worlds are concrete by this criterion also.

However, in talking of maximally consistent sets, Lewis would seem to utilize the modal notion of “consistency.” Note that consistency is indeed modal; a set of sentences is consistent if and only if it is possible for those sentences to be jointly true. So at first, it may seem that Lewis’ theory simply helps itself to one of the modal notions it was supposed to account for. But this is misleading. Although Lewis accepts Kripke’s way of characterizing worlds, it is ultimately unnecessary to his metaphysics. Since Lewis’ worlds genuinely exist, he can say instead that worlds are non-gappy by simply appealing to the non-gappy facts of such worlds.

Not only is each world “gapless,” he also thinks there is no gap in the collective of worlds. That is to say, absolutely every way that a world could possibly be is the way that some world is. But oddly, this last statement looks truistic given Lewis’ Realism. For if robust facts about worlds determine what is possible, then trivially the worlds exhaust the possibilities—even if there are only 17 worlds or 1 (or even none)! To secure the “plentitude” of worlds, then, Lewis makes use of a certain Recombination Principle. In its most basic form, this principle states that any object can co-exist with any other object. However, Lewis eventually revises this in considering two objects from different worlds. Objects from different worlds cannot co-exist, since Lewis presumes that worlds cannot “overlap” in any way. So in the end, Lewis achieves the plentitude of worlds with a modified Recombination Principle; this says that if x ¹ y, then in some possible world, x or a duplicate of x co-exists with y or a duplicate of y (assuming the spacetime of some world is large enough to contain the two).

Lewis’ “no overlap” intuition brings us to an important feature of his modal metaphysics. Consider that, according to this intuition, you are part of the actual world and only the actual world. There is no sense in which you inhabit some genuinely existing alternative universe. Nonetheless, if we follow Kripke’s logic to the letter, the statement “It is possible for me to be a dentist” is true (if uttered by you), in virtue of some alternate world where you yourself exist and are a dentist. Occupying more than one world may be fine as concerns pure logic, but when taken as a metaphysical thesis, Lewis finds it intolerable. So in the end, he denies that in alternate worlds, you make true the modal statements about you.

But if not you, who else could do this job? Lewis (1973) responds with the idea of a counterpart: Even though you only occupy the actual world, you have counterparts in other possible worlds that determine the truth of ‘It is possible for me to be a dentist.’ In general, a counterpart will be a non-actual object that is “sufficiently similar” to you in certain worlds. But when is an object “sufficiently similar?”  Lewis in fact thinks there are no absolute conditions on this. In some contexts ‘It is possible for me to be a dentist’ (uttered by you) is true in virtue of a non-actual dentist that, say, merely looks like you. Whereas in other contexts, perhaps the only thing that will do is a dentist who is a strict molecule-for-molecule duplicate of you.

Counterpart theory, even independent of Lewisian Realism, has several objections to reckon with. For instance, simply as a logical point, it has the strange consequence that “Necessarily, I am myself” is true only in virtue of objects that are neither identical to me nor to one another. (Technical aside: Lewis thinks there is nothing strange here if we think of a counterpart as a “deferred referent.”) Regardless, let us now turn to criticisms of Lewis’ Realism itself.

As Lewis is aware, the most glaring issue is that the view just ignores the Principle of Parsimony, which demands that entities should not be multiplied beyond necessity. According to this objection, the uncountable worlds that Lewis’ posits are just ontologically gratuitous, akin to Ptolemy’s epicycles-upon-epicycles for the planetary orbits. Lewis (1973), however, distinguishes so-called quantitative parsimony from qualitative parsimony. He grants that his Realism may well violate quantitative parsimony, given the number of entities in his ontology, yet he suggests it is only qualitative parsimony that really matters. The latter just concerns the number of kinds that a theory acknowledges, rather than the raw number of entities themselves—and Lewis claims his Realism is indeed qualitatively parsimonious. After all, we already believe in the actual world, and Lewis is merely asking us to believe in more entities of that kind. In contrast, Meinongian Realism increases the kinds that entities exist. For Meinongian objects have “being” in a different kind of way than ordinary objects (or worse, they belong to a sui generis kind that lies “beyond being and non-being”).

A different issue that Lewis acknowledges concerns the epistemology of worlds. It is natural to think that causal interaction with x is required in order to know about x, as when the senses causally interact with the world. Yet for Lewis, there is no causal interaction between us and other worlds, and so knowledge of other worlds looks problematic. (The issue here is analogous to Benacerraf’s dilemma for Mathematical Realism.)

Lewis’ solution here is to say that knowledge of non-actual worlds does not require causal interaction. But if not, how do we acquire modal knowledge? His reply is that for the most part, our modal knowledge follows from our (tacit) knowledge of the Recombination Principle. Though typically, we do not strictly derive modal truths from the Principle; instead, we imagine some state-of-affairs and “test” it against the Principle. Yet even if we grant all this, Lewis may need to explain further how we know that this Principle accords precisely with the real modal facts.

Further worries about Lewis’ view concern the individuation of worlds. He contends that a continuous region of space-time is necessary and sufficient to individuate a world. More exactly, objects constitute a possible world just in case all the parts of the objects bear spatio-temporal relations to each other. (When they do, the objects are called “worldmates.”)  This, in conjunction with the spatio-temporal isolation of worlds, blocks the consequence that all possible worlds form one Big Possible World. Yet in this, Lewis is forced to say that no possible world contains isolated space-time regions. And as Lewis admits, it is counter-intuitive to say that. Still, he claims that such a possibility is “no central part of our modal thinking,” so he prefers to bite the bullet instead of rejecting his definitions of ‘worldmate’ and ‘world’ (1986, p. 71).

Another important critique of Lewis, expressed by Plantinga (1987), runs as follows. Suppose that physicists really did discover uncountably many alternative universes, each different from the others. Why, asks Plantinga, would we suppose that these have anything to do with modality? After all, intuitively, what is possible for me does not depend on facts about any “maximal objects” that exist; it is not as if facts about these spatiotemporally removed objects are what make it possible for me to be a dentist. Yet it is unclear how much force the point has; Lewis might reply that Plantinga’s “intuition” on this is merely a bias against his view.

Here is one further issue for Lewis’ account. One of its biggest advantages is supposedly that it avoids circularity—that is, it does not explicate our modal notions by utilizing a modal notion. (In contrast, circularity is a recurring problem for Lewis’ competitors, as we shall see.) However, Lycan (1994) has objected that Lewis’ analysis indeed employs a modal notion. Namely, ‘world’ in Lewis’ mouth means possible world, in contrast to the impossible worlds whose existence Lewis rejects. To be sure, if Lewis’ possible worlds genuinely exist, the facts about those worlds might metaphysically determine the modal facts unproblematically. But the issue is whether Lewis’ theory understands modal talk in completely nonmodal terms. Lycan’s point is that it does not, given that the theory rests on the distinction between “possible” and “impossible” worlds.

If Lewis were to surrender this distinction, so that ‘world’ denotes any kind of world whatsover, then ‘world’ could be a nonmodal term in Lewis’ primitive vocabulary. Indeed, many have said that Lewis should admit impossible worlds anyway, for the same kind of indispensability reasons in favor of possible worlds. (Impossible worlds facilitate the semantics of, for example, “Some round squares are round” or “Crazy people believe that some round squares exist.”) However, Lewis resists impossibilia, since he takes it as axiomatic that we can never assert a truth about an object by uttering a contradiction. Yet if Lewis’ worlds do not include impossible worlds, then his use of ‘world’ may indeed express a modal notion, meaning that circularity would again be a worry.

There is one final objection to Lewis we should note. Suppose for the sake of argument that Lewis has adequately answered the objections raised thus far. Still, the claim that the plentitude of worlds genuinely exists seems ridiculously, outrageously implausible by commonsense standards. This kind of reaction is what Lewis calls “The Incredulous Stare.” Lewis acknowledges that his view violates commonsense, even “to an extreme extent,” and that this is a liability for the theory. Nevertheless, he emphasizes that commonsense is not the final arbiter on what is philosophically best, and that the theoretical advantages of his Realism ultimately outweigh the disadvantages. Though, as he grants, this may be somewhat open to debate.

3. Ersatzism

We now come to the primary alternative to Modal Realism, the Ersatz approach. Most basically, the Ersatzer construes talk about a possible world as talk about some ersatz object. (‘Ersatz’ is German for ‘replacement’ or ‘substitute.’) Thus the truth or falsity of a modal statement is explained by appeal to surrogates or proxies for possible worlds, rather than to genuinely existing worlds themselves. Thus, “It is possible for me to be a dentist” is true not because of a concretely existing alternate world, but rather because there is some ersatz world, according to which I am a dentist.

Different writers take different entities as their ersatz worlds, but the common idea is to use objects that are just plain actual, thus avoiding a Realist commitment to non-actuals. Yet to be clear, even though ersatz worlds are all actual, only one is actualized. This indicates another shared feature of worlds among Ersatzers; a world-surrogate is in some sense representational. After all, besides implying that some ersatz world “corresponds” to our world, the Ersatzers generally speak of what is true “according to a world.” Nevertheless, Ersatzers diverge on which actual representational objects should be the world-surrogate. The abstract objects recruited for this purpose include (a) sets of sentences, (b) sets of propositions or properties/relations, (c) pictorial objects, (d) combinations of matter and empty space (defined set-theoretically), and (e) objects that lack any specification beyond “abstract.” Let us review these options in turn.

a. Sententialism

 

 

One of the first Ersatz views was Rudolf Carnap’s (1947) Sententialism, where maximally consistent sets of sentences took the place of possible worlds. Writing before Kripke, however, Carnap did not speak of these sets as “ersatze” for worlds. He just utilized the sets as they were, referring to them as “state descriptions.” Still, posterior to Kripke’s modal logic, one might naturally assimilate state descriptions to ersatz worlds, since state descriptions fulfill the semantic role that is otherwise played by worlds.

According to Sententialism, then, truth or falsity of a sentence “Possibly, p” is ultimately a matter of whether some maximally consistent set contains the sentence “p” as a member. In similar fashion, “Necessarily, p” is true or false depending on whether all such sets contain “p.” Naturally, such a view requires an ontological commitment to sets, but such abstract objects might be required anyway (perhaps due to Quine-Putnam indispensability arguments). And a commitment to sets and the like may not seem quite as objectionable as a Realist’s commitment to nonactual objects.

Still, there are other issues. For one, the sets cannot just contain sentence-tokens (individual sentences that have actually been spoken or uttered), since there have only been finitely many tokens in the history of the world. (In contrast, every maximally consistent set patently contains infinitely many sentences.) Charitably speaking, then, Sententialism instead holds that ersatz worlds are sets of linguistic (or possibly mental) sentence-types. (Though, note, Lewis thinks that there are still cardinality problems unless the sentences are “Lagadonian,” where objects themselves are used as their own names). And so besides sets, the Ersatzer now may incur an ontological commitment to a further kind of abstract object, “types.”

Finally, the Sententialist faces a circularity worry. In utilizing maximally consistent sets, the Sententialist account depends on the modal notion of “consistency.” And unlike Lewis, the Sententialist cannot try to eliminate this notion by instead depending on robust facts about concrete possible worlds. So the Sententialist apparently takes as given one of the notions it wants to explicate.

b. Propositionalism and Property Ersatzism

It is notable that similar worries persist if the Ersatzer opts instead for maximally consistent sets of propositions, as in Plantinga (1972) and Adams (1974). This is obvious enough if propositions are identified with linguistic (or mental) sentence-types. And if propositions are construed as a different kind of abstract object, the number of ontological commitments seems to increase unnecessarily. Nonetheless, the Ersatzer might insist that the ontological cost here is not as high as it is with Lewisian worlds. (Though the problem remains that the Ersatzer apparently presupposes a modal notion of “consistency”)

Typically, a proposition is a complex of objects and properties/relations (or representations thereof). For instance, the proposition that I am a dentist would often be seen as composed of (representations of) myself and the property of being a dentist. But as noted in Lycan (1994), an Ersatzer can instead follow Parsons (1980), who individuates objects in terms of properties. (Unlike Parsons, however, the Ersatzer would regard the property-bundles as actual abstracta rather than Meinongian nonexistents.) In more detail, the Property Ersatzer identifies objects with bundles of properties (intuitively, the properties that the object has). And from these, worlds are built by describing relations between the property-groupings. One advantage of such an Ersatzism is that the property-groupings and their interrelations are all stipulated, meaning that unlike Lewis, the Ersatzer need not explain how knowledge of spatiotemporally isolated, concrete worlds is possible. Though again, the property-groupings must be “consistent,” meaning that circularity may be an issue here as well.

In fact, Property Ersatzers as well as Propositionalists have even more circularity worries when it comes to the metaphysics of the propositions or properties themselves. Many times, a proposition is defined by a set of possible worlds (intuitively, the worlds where the proposition is true)—whereas a property is often defined by a set of possible objects (intuitively, the objects that have the property in question). But both accounts depend on the notion of “possibility”, so they apparently cannot underwrite the Ersatzer’s propositions or properties, on pain of circularity.

Lewis gives two further objections to these Ersatz views. One is that if ersatz worlds are defined via properties, then it will be impossible to have distinct yet indiscernible objects. After all, for this Ersatzer, possible objects are individuated only by their properties—so if x and y are objects that have exactly the same properties, it would follow on this view that x = y. In addition, Lewis holds that such Ersatz accounts cannot allow other “alien” (that is, non-actual) properties, even though such properties seem possible. The intuition is that there might have been other properties than the properties we encounter in the actual world. But Property Ersatzers seem unable to accommodate this intuition. For they wish to limit themselves to actual abstracta when building the ersatz world. And that means non-actual abstracta, which would include non-actual properties, would not characterize any ersatz world.

Nevertheless, one could reply in typical Ersatz fashion that all properties, including alien properties, are actual abstract objects—it’s just that the alien properties are not actualized. Even so, Lewis replies that the Ersatzer should still provide individuation-conditions for alien properties. (Otherwise, the view would not secure the possibility of two objects differing only in alien properties.) But, says Lewis, since the Ersatzer denies the existence of alien properties, their individuation-conditions would presumably be supplied by some general theory of properties. Yet as we saw, the standard theory of properties would only create circularity in the Ersatzer’s account.

c. Pictorial Ersatzism

However, perhaps an Ersatzer can accommodate the possibility of alien properties in a different way. On this, Lewis considers a “Pictorial Ersatzer,” an Ersatzer who holds that all possible properties (including alien properties) are actually instantiated on abstract pictures. But to understand this properly, some further set-up is needed.

In general, the pictorial objects would act as ersatz worlds, representing the possible ways the world might be. Lewis suggests that the pictures would be representative, specifically, by isomorphism, by a mirroring between parts of the picture and parts of what is represented.  Strictly speaking, however, “isomorphism” is achieved by parts of the picture instantiating the very same properties and relations instantiated by the objects. Thus, a splotch of the picture would be isomorphic to the cat by having the very same shape and the very same color as the cat.

But of course, real pictures do not represent by such strict isomorphism. Yet the reason an oil paining can still represent a cat is because there are various conventions in place for us to associate cat-esque parts of the painting with real cats. Lewis thinks, however, that if Pictorial Ersatzism is meant to be a genuine alternative to Sententialism, such conventional elements must be absent from the pictorial ersatz worlds. Thus, Lewis proposes that these abstract pictorial objects should be idealized pictures which represent by a complete isomorphism (in as much as this is possible).

When it comes to alien properties, however, this idealization would prove helpful. The Ersatzer would hold that the alien properties are actually instantiated by abstract pictures (though they remain “alien” in being uninstantiated concretely.) And in brief, Lewis thinks this might allow the Ersatzer to individuate the alien properties. If so, then unlike the Property Ersatzer, the Pictorial Ersatzer could meet Lewis’ demand to individuate alien properties. She would do so, moreover, without invoking the standard general theory of properties (which, recall, would create circularity).

Regardless, Lewis identifies (at least) three difficulties for Pictorial Ersatzism. One is that the view presupposes rather than explicates the notion of “possible,” since the isomorphisms are each understood to hold between a picture and a possible scenario. Another is that the isomorphisms would fail, since an abstract ersatz cat is not a cat—an abstract object is not the sort of thing that can instantiate felinehood. Finally, it is dubious whether an ontological commitment to these world-pictures is better than a commitment to concrete worlds. For although every Ersatzer is committed to abstract objects, the Pictorial Ersatzer’s objects are not “abstract” in the usual senses of the term. Most notably, an abstract object is prototypically one that does not enter into spatio-temporal relations. Yet the isomorphism between the picture of the cat on the mat required a certain spatial arrangement of the parts. (Note that there are other ways to construe ‘abstract,’ but Lewis finds these no better.)

d. Combinatorialism

Combinatorialism is yet another view which prefers abstract surrogates over concrete possible worlds. The view has roots in the Ludwig Wittgenstein’s Tractatus, but interestingly it was Quine, our modal skeptic, who first developed it in some detail. Yet it was Creswell 1972 who first accepted and defended the view. According to the Combinatorialist, an ersatz world is roughly a set-theoretic construction of some distribution of matter throughout a space-time region. As an illustration, a Combinatorialist might start with a co-ordinate system in a four-dimensional Newtonian spacetime, and identify the position of each space-time point in the usual manner, using numerical values along the x-axis, the y-axis, and the z-axis. Next, we can assign a time t to each point, so that the spatial-temporal location of a point is completely defined by an ordered quadruple <x, y, z, t>. Finally, for each point in the co-ordinate system, we stipulate that the point either is filled with matter or is empty space, by assigning it the number 1 or 0, respectively. The result then represents a four-dimensional space-time where matter is distributed according to the 1s and 0s.  (Technical addendum: Since a space can be mapped by more than one co-ordinate system, a world is ultimately defined by an equivalence class of such systems.)

The example of course utilizes a Newtonian spacetime, but a Combinatorialist can identify other space-times, describe them by co-ordinate systems, and assign 1s and 0s as before. Regardless, there is always the chance that some possible space-time remains unidentified, leaving the combinatorial possibilities incomplete. Moreover, as Lewis highlights, our modal intuitions can be infirm about whether certain space-times are possible. For instance, is it possible to have entities which are temporally but not spatially located? In contrast, Lewis believes he has no need to answer this since he can just let the concrete modal facts fall where they may.

As might be expected, circularity is also a worry for this brand of Ersatzism. Perhaps the best way to levy the charge is by considering how a distribution of simples relates to macro states-of-affairs. In the first instance, the set-theoretic constructions determine the position of a world’s mereological atoms (that is, indivisible parts making up a whole), yet the assumption is that this also determines all the goings-on in the world at the macro-level. But in what sense “determines?” This would seem to concern the micro-facts metaphysically necessitating the macro-facts in a world. Yet metaphysical necessitation is of course a modal notion. So as before, it appears the Ersatzer has a circular analysis on her hands.

On a different note, the Combinatorialist should be concerned that her worlds only contain matter. After all, this implies that materialism is necessarily true—even though spiritual entities like Cartesian souls would seem to be at least possible. Now the Combinatorialist may simply bite the bullet here; after all, the fact that people believe in spiritual entities does not show their possibility (although, if propositions are sets of worlds, then it is harder to characterize those beliefs without worlds containing such entities). Or, a Combinatorialist might instead propose a kind of “neutral monism” whereby arrangements of atoms can result in either material or immaterial objects. Admittedly, however, it is hard to see how immaterial objects could be composed of “atoms,” much less the same type of “atoms” as material objects.

There is a further concern about the metaphysics of the atoms. Since the Combinatorialists wants to avoid non-actual objects, it seems her set-theoretic constructions must include only actual atoms. This is unfortunate, however, since limiting ourselves to actual matter rules out possible worlds with more matter than in our world, as well as worlds with different matter.

Nevertheless, a Combinatorialist may try to avoid both this problem and the problem about immaterial possibilia by recruiting (say) numbers as substitutes for non-actual substances. Yet it is unclear whether this is satisfactory, since numbers do not literally represent anything (much less represent nonactual matter); hence, the numbers will apparently be chosen arbitrarily. Consequently, once we have a set-theoretic construction using these numbers, we may be strained to believe that this specific construction really is what determines the truth of our modal statements. For why should this particular construction earn this status, over a structurally identical one that uses different numbers?

e. Non-Reductivism

A rather different approach is that of Stalnaker (1984) and (on one reading) Plantinga (1972). As in other Ersatz views, concrete possible worlds are replaced with actual abstract objects. But these ersatz worlds are simply identified as “maximal states-of-affairs” or “ways the world might have been” without further analysis in terms of sentences, propositions, universals, or anything else. Non-Reductionist Ersatzism may very well have some appeal, especially in light of the perceived failures of other Ersatz accounts, though talk of “maximal” states-of-affairs alone may be enough to make the account circular.

Note that even if the ersatz worlds are ontologically basic, they can nonetheless have structure. In line with Kripke’s logic, the Non-Reductivist can say that her worlds consist of states-of-affairs, which in turn are comprised of individuals and their properties/relations. Interestingly, Plantinga includes individual essences as well, sometimes called “hacceities”; such a thing is possessed by an individual necessarily, and is necessarily unique to the individual.

But at the most basic level, the Non-Reductivist simply interprets Kripke’s logic with respect to a domain of abstract objects, which are not analyzed in terms of anything more ontologically fundamental. Lewis thus calls the view “non-descript” Ersatzism, complaining that the theory is not much of a theory at all. (Lewis levies this criticism against a view he calls “Magical Ersatzism,” where ersatz worlds are structureless, mereological atoms. But he thinks the point carries over.) In fact, since Non-Reductivism is simply silent on reductive matters, it thus seems compatible with any of the reductions given by other Ersatzers. Lewis even suggests it compatible with reducing possible states-of-affairs to sets of Lewisian concrete worlds (if the sets are actual abstracta).

The Non-Reductivist can respond, however, by explicitly denying such reductions. But in that case, her ersatz worlds start to look like abstract objects that cannot be given any further reduction. Yet this would not put her at a disadvantage, says the Non-Reductivist, since Lewis’ Realism apparently cannot reduce concrete possibilia into more basic facts either.

Still, Lewis thinks the Ersatzer owes us more about what makes the modal truths true, if not concrete facts. And apparently, the Non-Reductivist is simply taking as primitive the crucial explanatory notions like “states-of-affairs,” “properties,” and so forth. What’s more, recall that the ersatz worlds are supposed to be representational, since certain things are true “according to a world.” Yet Non-Reductivism just leaves this representational feature as mysterious. (In contrast, Sententialism can explain the representational nature of its ersatz worlds by the representational nature of sentences.)

4. Fictionalism

A later approach to come on the scene is the Fictionalist view of possibilia. Fictionalism proper was first developed by Gideon Rosen (1990), although Armstrong’s (1989) view is expressly Fictionalist in part, as we shall see in the next section. Notably, Rosen does not always identify himself as a Fictionalist, and similarly with Daniel Nolan (who is arguably the leading expert on Fictionalism in the early 21st century). Nonetheless, the Fictionalist strategy has garnered a lot of attention, since at the least, it may be no more problematic than the Ersatz views. Plus, it can be applied to other problematic objects besides possible worlds, “moral facts” for example.

As concerns possible worlds, the Fictionalist says that a statement about such worlds should be understood as analogous to a statement like “According to Arthur Conan Doyle’s stories, Sherlock Holmes lives at 221B Baker Street in London.” Note first that Holmes-statement is false if we leave off the clause “According to the…stories,” also known as the “story-prefix.” After all, it’s not literally true that Sherlock Holmes lives in London. Yet when the story-prefix is added, the assertion is indeed literally true. For there literally are sentences in the Doyle stories which specify this as the location of Holmes’ home.

In an analogous manner, the Fictionalist suggests that “There is some possible world with a talking donkey” is false strictly speaking, since (with all due respect to David Lewis) there are no such worlds. Nonetheless, it is entirely true to say “According to Lewis’ theory, there is some possible world with a talking donkey.” Taking this as her cue, the Fictionalist says that for any modal statement p, the statement is true if and only if, according to Lewis’ view, p.

One advantage that Fictionalism has over Lewis’ Realism is that the view is not as apt to provoke the “Incredulous Stare” by ignoring commonsense. A second advantage is that the Fictionalist does not have the same troubles with the epistemology of worlds. Recall: Lewis’ difficulty was that we bear no causal relationships to non-actual worlds, meaning that our epistemic access to these worlds seems problematic. Lewis responded by explaining modal knowledge via “imaginative tests,” where we judge whether an imaginary scenario is possible using the Principle of Recombination. One complaint against Lewis, then, is that these tests provide knowledge of the concrete existing worlds only if we antecedently know that the Recombination Principle provides for exactly the possibilities found in those worlds. However, the Fictionalist does not face this problem. Since she denies the concrete existence of the worlds, she can hold that the “imaginative tests” are enough for modal knowledge. After all, on her view, what Lewis’ Recombination Principle says (in conjunction with the rest of Lewis’ view) wholly determines what is possible. And to know what Lewis’ theory says, one does not need knowledge of any correspondence with concretely existing worlds.

Yet Fictionalism of course is not without its problems. One is that in talking of stories such as the PWF (Possible World Fiction), the Fictionalist would seem committed to a certain kind of abstract object, namely, “stories.” Rosen nonetheless sees this commitment as less severe than the Lewisian commitment to worlds. However, if the Fictionalist accepts that the PWF exists as an abstract story, understood as a set of sentences, then it may not be entirely clear how her view differs from Sententialist Ersatzism.

A second difficulty is that, according to Lewis’ Realism, Modal Realism is necessarily true—that is, Modal Realism is true at every world. And the Fictionalist holds that the truth of “Necessarily, p” is determined by whether Lewis’ Realism says “Necessarily, p.” Hence, if Lewis’ Realism says that Realism is necessary, the Fictionalist is then committed to the truth of “Necessarily, Lewis’ Realism is true,” and thereby surrenders her Fictionalism in favor of Modal Realism.

However, it has been subsequently argued that Lewis’ (1969) Realism does not entail the necessity of the view. It is key that Lewis’ early version of Modal Realism holds that “‘There are x’ is true at a world iff x exists in that world,” that is, as a spatio-temporal part of that world. But if so, then ‘There are multiple worlds’ will be true in no possible world. For within the space-time of a world W, there will only be one world that exists as an (improper) part, namely W itself.

A separate obstacle for Fictionalism is that Lewis is agnostic on certain modal matters, for example, the possible sizes of space-time. Such agnosticism is no threat to Lewis’ own metaphysics, since real concrete facts will determine whichever space-times are possible. But how does Fictionalist fix the facts here? In such a case, a Fictionalist might say that it is literally false that, for example, there is a possible spacetime that houses uncountably many donkeys. After all, it is false to say “According to the PWF, there is a possible world containing uncountably many donkeys,” for Lewis never says if space-time could contain that many donkeys. Yet Rosen points out that, given Lewis’ silence, the contrary statement “no possible spacetime houses uncountably many donkeys” would also come out false. And so, contrary statements would have the same truth-value. Consequently, Rosen instead advises the Fictionalist to leave such statements without a truth-value.

Another glaring issue for the Fictionalist is to give an adequate semantics of her story-prefix.  A standard sort of semantics would say that a statement of the form “According to the PWF, p” means “In a possible world where the PWF is true, p.” Yet if the Fictionalist analyzes possible-worlds statements in terms of story-prefixed statements, she cannot also analyze the latter in terms of the former, on pain of circularity. Of course, one might forego the possible-worlds analysis of the story-prefix and give a Meinongian account instead. But the typical Fictionalist is aiming for a slim ontology. As a final option, then, the Fictionalist might simply take her story-prefix as primitive. Though as Rosen says, this is hard to stomach especially if the story-prefixed statements occasionally lack a truth-value (in accordance with Rosen’s advice above). Besides, says Rosen, story-prefixes seem to have a compound structure that should be analyzable into more basic terms.

On a related matter, the Fictionalist seems to face a dilemma. Since PWF is a fiction, the claims it makes are false—yet is the PWF contingently or necessarily false? It is natural to understand “According to PWF, p” as saying that “if PWF were true, then p would be true.” Yet if the PWF is necessarily false, then the antecedent of this conditional is necessarily false. And that means the conditional will be true, even if p is an impossible proposition. On the other horn of the dilemma, if PWF is contingently false, then Fictionalism is inadequate to explicate the truth of “the PWF is contingently false.” For the Fictionalist would construe this as entailing “According to the PWF, there is a possible world where the PWF is true.” And per the schema above, that is equivalent to the truism “If the PWF were true, then the truth of the PWF would be possible.” Yet this is not equivalent to the claim that the PWF might have been true, since the latter is entirely nontrivial.

Nolan raises yet another objection concerning the “artificiality” of fiction. It seems we can create fictional states-of-affairs at whim, but modal matters do not seem so arbitrary. It thus seems we need to specify which fiction is the “right” fiction for possible worlds. Yet what would make the PWF the “right” fiction? Since the Fictionalist is not a Realist, she cannot say that the right fiction is the one that corresponds to the real possible worlds. But then, what would “rightness” consist in?

Finally, the Fictionalist also faces a more general circularity worry. Even if we ignore cases where Lewis is agnostic, the PWF will have gaps since it does not explicitly list every modal statement. So it seems that for the Fictionalist, some modal truths are true because they are entailed by the PWF. Yet entailment is a modal notion; a conjunction of statements entails a statement just in case it is impossible for the conjunction to be true and the latter false. So once again, our analysis of possible worlds seems to use one of the modal notions it was supposed to explicate.

5. Armstrong’s Hybrid

David Armstrong offers us a different type of modal metaphysics which is Ersatzist in part, but also partly Fictionalist. Most basically, however, Armstrong wants a “Naturalist” metaphysics, a metaphysics where anything that exists (i) has a location in actual space-time, and also (ii) enters into causal relations. This is in opposition to the Ersatz views which seem only to swap Lewis’ worlds for other ontologically dubious entities, namely, actual yet non-locatable abstracta. The Naturalism that drives Armstrong’s project will thus result in several notable modifications to both the Ersatzist and Fictionalist aspects of his view.

In general, it is fair to say that Armstrong adopts the Combinatorialist strategy of using combinatorial possibilities as ersatz worlds. But in line with Naturalism, Armstrong rejects the abstract set-theoretic constructions which the typical Combinatorialist posits. Instead, a possible world is construed as an ungrouped plurality or “heap” of elements.

As a further departure from the usual Combinatorialism, Armstrong’s elements are not mereological simples (that is, indivisible parts)—rather, they are whole states-of-affairs (which may or may not involve simples). The reason is that Armstrong sees states-of-affairs as more ontologically basic than particulars and their properties/relations, since those have no existence apart from states-of-affairs. He grants, however, that we may consider particulars and properties/relations in abstraction from states-of-affairs. So in some epistemic sense, it is true that Armstrong recombines particulars and their properties/relations, similar to other Combinatorialists. But from the more relevant, ontological angle, Armstrong’s combinations have states-of-affairs as the combinatorial elements, since nothing is more ontologically fundamental than these.

Armstrong’s worlds thus exist as “heaps” of states-of-affairs. However, only one heap is actual, so it may seem that Armstrong needs to posit non-actuals anyway, against his Naturalism. Yet Armstrong believes this conflict is resolvable if we think of non-actual heaps as fictional objects akin to “ideal” scientific entities, for example, ideal gasses, frictionless planes, perfect vacuums, and so forth. For although ideal scientific entities seem to be fictitious, our tendency is nonetheless to view, for example, the ideal gas laws as literally true. That is, we do not see the ideal gas laws as simply “true in fiction” in the way that we regard “Sherlock Holmes lives at 221B Baker Street” as merely true in fiction. But if we view these laws as literally true, it that would mean the ideal entities literally enter into causal relations and occupy space-time. And if so, then such fictitious entities would meet the constraints imposed by Naturalism.

Of course, not everyone is happy with Armstrong’s picture. The most important objection is that Armstrong does not describe the metaphysics of his fictions, beyond comparing them to frictionless surfaces and perfect vacuums. And it is not clear what account he could give. Naturalism of course precludes a Meinongian view of such objects, but also, the standard counterfactual analysis of fiction would result in circularity. As with other Fictionalists, Armstrong could not analyze worlds using fiction, and also analyze fictional discourse using counterfactual worlds.

Another point of contention is the anti-essentialism which is part of Armstrong’s view. Many philosophers follow Kripke (1972) in holding that at least some individuals have essential properties, properties that they necessarily exhibit. (So for instance, Bertrand Russell is essentially a member of homo sapiens.) However, Armstrong puts no constraints on what properties a possible individual might instantiate. Consequently, the view entails that it is possible (say) for Bertrand Russell to be a poached egg—though the current philosophical trends at the beginning of the 21st century are against such a thing.

6. Quine’s Skepticism

So far the views here have all assumed Realism about modal truths, even though most refuse Realism about possible worlds. That is, they all assume that a statement like “I might have been a dentist” can be literally true, even though what makes it true may be something other than a concretely existing alternative world. Yet the reader can verify that Lewis’ Realism, Ersatzism, Fictionalism, the Armstrong Hybrid, and Conventionalism face circularity worries; each seems to implicitly deploy a modal notion in the analysis of modal notions. But to W.V.O. Quine, this would hardly come as a surprise. Quine argues that such circularity is in fact ineliminable, and that our modal notions are therefore defective. If so, the implication seems to be an Anti-Realism about modal truth or that modal notions cannot be used in expressing legitimate truths.

Quine’s argument here is found in his “Two Dogmas of Empiricism” (one of the most celebrated philosophical article of the twentieth century). In the main, the paper concerns whether the terms ‘analytic’ and ‘synthetic’ can be properly defined, even provided the stock examples of analytic statements, for example, ‘Bachelors are unmarried men.’ Yet Quine’s investigation bears on modal terms as well, since he presumes that a statement would be analytic if and only if it is necessary. (Against the philosophical lore, Quine is aware that this is contentious; see Quine 1960, p. 66; see below as well.) The upshot is that, for Quine, if one could appropriately define ‘analytic’, this would bring us closer to understanding modal terms.

A traditional definition of analyticity (from Kant) is dismissed as metaphorical, since it simply says that in an analytic statement, the predicate is “contained” in the subject. A different suggestion is that analytic statements are either logical truths or “true by definition.” The latter kind of truth would be a statement with a predicate that is synonymous with the subject-term, where synonyms could be listed by dictionary definitions. But for Quine, this just pushes back the question onto “synonymy.” When do terms count as synonymous?

One of the main proposals here is that synonyms are terms that can replace each other in the statements they occur, without altering the truth-values of those statements. (Quotational contexts and propositional attitude reports will be exceptions, but they could be catalogued as such.) Yet Quine worries that ‘creature with a heart’ and ‘creature with a kidney’ might pass this substitutivity test, since they supposedly co-refer, despite being non-synonymous. But in fact, these phrases do not intersubstitute, in a sentence like “Necessarily, a creature with a heart is a creature with a heart.” For while this statement is true, it is false that “Necessarily, a creature with a heart is a creature with a kidney.”

However, Quine protests that our definition of synonymy cannot rest on the notion of necessity, for otherwise we will have gone in a small definitional circle. Recall that Quine presumes necessity would be definable in terms of analyticity, but the present suggestion ultimately explicates analyticity in terms of necessity (via the notion of synonymy). So at best, the result is a rather tight circle of definitions.

Regardless, if we are presently unable to define these notions adequately, it does not follow that we will never be able to. But this is partly why, at the end of “Two Dogmas,” Quine provides a very general picture of the relations between statements, where the analytic/synthetic distinction (and the necessary/possible distinction) apparently can have no application. The picture, known as the “web of belief,” is one which (in the first instance) jettisons the idea that an individual hypothesis can be confirmed or disconfirmed by experience. Instead, a statement must first be embedded in an entire network of statements. Without going into the details, however, a consequence of this confirmation holism is that a disconfirming experience can motivate a revision of any statement in the network. Hence, Quine thinks it could conceivably be rational to revise even logical truths such as the Law of Excluded Middle in light of experimental results from quantum physics. More generally, since experience may prompt any statement to be revised, Quine sees it as folly to speak of statements that are analytic or necessarily true—that is, true no matter what.

A number of objections have been raised against Quine. Kripke (1972) suggests that there is a tendency to conflate notions of analyticity, necessity, and the a priori. Yet these notions are clearly different: As Kripke says, analyticity is a semantic notion, necessity is a metaphysical notion, and the apriori is an epistemic one. Kripke then argues further that some necessities are aposteriori, such as ‘Hesperus = Phosphorus’, (and as a lesser point, that some contingencies seem apriori, such as ‘I am here now’). However, charitably Quine recognizes that different concepts are in play here. (It would be odd for him to speak of a definitional circle if he thought only one concept was in play.)

Even so, Quine apparently assumes that these concepts are co-extensional, and Kripke’s aposteriori necessities would discredit that. Yet Quine could reply that his concern is mainly with analyticity and necessity, and not the apriori. (It is notable that ‘apriori’ only occurs once in “Two Dogmas of Empiricism,” and merely as a rhetorical flourish.) Thus if Quine merely assumes that the necessities = the analyticities, Kripke’s examples of aposteriori truths have no immediate relevance. Still, many assume that Kripke’s aposteriori necessities are also synthetic truths. And if that is so, then Quine is wrong to assume that all necessities would be analytic. (But note, since “aposteriori” and “synthetic” are different notions, it may remain a bit unclear why aposteriori necessities must be synthetic.)

As concerns the “web of belief,” Grice & Strawson (1956) argue that this picture does not in fact preclude an analytic/synthetic distinction. For it is possible to distinguish cases where we revise a statement’s truth-value, from cases where we revise a statement’s meaning. As a simple example, suppose you believe that all swans are white (along with suitable auxiliary hypotheses). Yet suppose you see a black swan while traveling in Australia. Then, Grice & Strawson would say that you could either revise your belief about swans, or you could revise what you mean by ‘swan.’ In the latter case, you might revise ‘swan’ to mean “white swan” specifically. And then it would seem that “All swans are white” is analytic, since it simply amounts to the logical truth that “All white swans are white.”

For Quine, however, reducing “All swans are white” to a logical truth does not show it to be analytic or necessary, since even logical truths are revisable (as quantum physics seems to illustrate). Still, Quine’s views are radically at odds with the current philosophical orthodoxies, and so many philosophers remain unconvinced. One clear sign of this is the recent revival of conventionalism. This is the view that truths about what is possible or what is necessary are determined by linguistic convention, rather than by possible worlds, ersatz worlds, or the like. Such a view states that, pace Quine, logical truths are necessarily true, since linguistic conventions (more or less) stipulate them to be such. In earlier work, Quine (1936) more directly attacks such “truth by convention;” the reader is referred to Sider (2003), section 4, for an introduction to this debate. But interestingly, the conventionalist and Quine apparently would agree that facts about concrete or ersatz worlds do not ground modal statements. So regardless of whether Quine or the conventionalist is right, the primary lesson of this section stands, namely, that metaphysical accounts of possible worlds might be mistaken not just in detail, but in their most basic assumptions.

7. References and Further Reading

  • Armstrong, D. (1989). A Combinatorial Theory of Possibility, Cambridge: Cambridge UP
    • Presents Armstrong’s hybrid of Combinatorialism and Fictionalism, putatively in line with Naturalist ontology.
  • Carnap, R. (1947). Meaning and Necessity, Chicago: U of Chicago Press.
    • Historically the first articulation of the Sententialist view.
  • Cresswell, M. J. (1972). “The World is Everything that is the Case,” Australasian Journal of Philosophy, vol. 50, pp. 113.
    • The first defense of a Combinatorialist view akin to that of Quine (1968).
  • de Rosset, L. (2009a). Possible Worlds I: Modal Realism, Philosophy Compass, 4(6), 998-1008.
    • This, along with Part II below, provide a useful overview of the latest developments in the debate regarding Modal Realism vs. its competitors.
  • de Rosset, L. (2009b). Possible Worlds II:  Nonreductive Theories of Possible Worlds, Philosophy Compass, 4(6), 1009-1021.
  • Divers, J. (2002). Possible Worlds, London: Routledge.
    • An detailed introduction  to the dialectic between Modal Realists and Ersatzers.
  • Grice, H. P. & P. F. Strawson (1956). “In Defense of a Dogma,” Philosophical Review, vol. 65, pp. 141-158.
    • Contains some of the most important criticisms of Quine (1953).
  • Kripke, S.A. (1959). A Completeness Theorem in Modal Logic, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 24(1), pp. 1–14.
    • This is where it all started; it presents Kripke’s logic for modal statements.
  • Kripke, S.A.  (1972). “Naming and Necessity,” in Davidson, D. & Harman, G., (eds.) Semantics of Natural Language, Dordrecht: Reidel, 253-355 & 763-769.    Reprinted as Naming and Necessity, Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP, 1980.
    • Provides an extremely influential theory of names and their behavior in modal statements. Also, it is cited when accusing Quine of conflating analyticity, necessity, and the a priori.
  • Lewis, D. (1969). Convention: A Philosophical Study, Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP.
    • Contains Lewis’ first statement of his Realism, also includes a noteworthy preface by Quine.
  • Lewis, D. (1973). Counterfactuals, Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP.
    • Another articulation of Lewis’ Realism; this is also the main source for Lewis on counterparts.
  • Lewis, D. (1986). On the Plurality of Worlds, Cambridge, MA: Blackwell.
    • A sustained defense of Lewis’ Realism, and an attack on the alternative, Ersatz views. The most important primary source in modal metaphysics.
  • Lewis, D. (1999). Papers in Metaphysics and Epistemology, Cambridge: Cambridge UP.
    • Contains several relevant papers on modal metaphysics, including Lewis’ criticisms of Routley (a contemporary Meinongian) and of Armstrong.
  • Lycan, W. (1979). The Trouble with Possible Worlds, in Loux, M. (ed.), The Possible and the Actual, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, pp. 274-316.
    • Contains some historically important criticisms of Lewis’ Realism. Also sketches a Propositionalist/Property Ersatz view.
  • Lycan, W. (1994). Modality and Meaning, Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
    • Chapter 1-4 revise and expand the material from Lycan (1979). The book is a highly effective overview and response to the literature on modal metaphysics. Deserves to be widely read.
  • Meinong, A. (1904). “The Theory of Objects,” in Realism and the Background of Phenomenology, trans. I. Levi, D. B. Terrell, and R. Chisholm. Free Press, 1960.
    • Contains the slogan “There are objects of which it is true to say that there are no such objects.” One of the few pieces by Meinong widely available in English.
  • Melia, J. (2003). Modality, Montreal: McGill-Queen’s University Press.
    • An excellent introduction to many of the issues presented in this article.
  • Nolan, D. (2002). Topics in the Philosophy of Possible Worlds, New York: Routledge.
    • Nolan’s dissertation, contains several useful reflections on Fictionalism.
  • Plantinga, A. (1974) The Nature of Necessity, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
    • Plantinga’s magnum opus on modality. Highlights include the discussion of counterpart theory and trans-world identity in Chapter 6, and the treatment of fictional objects in Chapter 8. Also, Plantinga’s modal version of Anselm’s ontological argument is not to be missed (Chapter 10).
  • Plantinga, A. (2003). Essays on the Metaphysics of Modality, M. Davidson (ed.), Oxford: Oxford UP.
    • A handy collection of Plantinga’s work in the area, including Chapter 8 of Plantinga (1974). It also has Plantinga’s (1972) modal metaphysics, as well as his (1987) relevance objection to Lewis’ Realism.
  • Quine, W. V. (1936). Truth by Convention, Reprinted in The Ways of Paradox and Other Essays, Revised edition, Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP, (1976), pp. 77-106.
    • Contains Quine’s best-known critique of the idea of “truth by convention.”
  • Quine, W.V. (1953). Two Dogmas of Empiricism, Reprinted in From a Logical Point of View, 2nd edition (pp. 20-46). Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP.
    • Presents Quine’s arguments against the analytic/synthetic distinction, and the necessary/possible distinction. Required reading for any student of philosophy.
  • Quine, W.V. (1968). “Propositional Objects,” in Ontological Relativity and Other Essays, Cambridge, MA: Harvard UP, (pp. 139-160)
    • Provides the first developed version of Combinatorialism, though Quine ultimately rejects the view.
  • Rosen, G. (1990). Modal Fictionalism, Mind 99 (395), pp. 327-354.
    • The first place where Fictionalism is developed in detail, as a modal metaphysics in its own right.
  • Sider, T. (2003). Reductive Theories of Modality, in Loux & Zimmerman (eds.), The Oxford Handbook of Metaphysics, New York: Oxford UP, pp. 180-208.
    • Section 4 is a very useful introduction to conventionalism about modality; other sections are helpful as well regarding Modal Realism, Fictionalism, and the various Ersatzisms.
  • Stalnaker, R. (1984). Inquiry, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
    • Presents a Non-Reductivist metaphysics, the last chapter is explicitly devoted to comparing Non-Reductivism to Reductivism.

 

Author Information

Ted Parent
Email: parentt@vt.edu
Virginia Polytechnic Institute and State University
U. S. A.

The Hard Problem of Consciousness

The hard problem of consciousness is the problem of explaining why any physical state is conscious rather than nonconscious.  It is the problem of explaining why there is “something it is like” for a subject in conscious experience, why conscious mental states “light up” and directly appear to the subject.  The usual methods of science involve explanation of functional, dynamical, and structural properties—explanation of what a thing does, how it changes over time, and how it is put together.  But even after we have explained the functional, dynamical, and structural properties of the conscious mind, we can still meaningfully ask the question, Why is it conscious? This suggests that an explanation of consciousness will have to go beyond the usual methods of science.  Consciousness therefore presents a hard problem for science, or perhaps it marks the limits of what science can explain.  Explaining why consciousness occurs at all can be contrasted with so-called “easy problems” of consciousness:  the problems of explaining the function, dynamics, and structure of consciousness.  These features can be explained using the usual methods of science.  But that leaves the question of why there is something it is like for the subject when these functions, dynamics, and structures are present.  This is the hard problem.

In more detail, the challenge arises because it does not seem that the qualitative and subjective aspects of conscious experience—how consciousness “feels” and the fact that it is directly “for me”—fit into a physicalist ontology, one consisting of just the basic elements of physics plus structural, dynamical, and functional combinations of those basic elements.  It appears that even a complete specification of a creature in physical terms leaves unanswered the question of whether or not the creature is conscious.  And it seems that we can easily conceive of creatures just like us physically and functionally that nonetheless lack consciousness.  This indicates that a physical explanation of consciousness is fundamentally incomplete:  it leaves out what it is like to be the subject, for the subject.  There seems to be an unbridgeable explanatory gap between the physical world and consciousness.  All these factors make the hard problem hard.

The hard problem was so-named by David Chalmers in 1995.  The problem is a major focus of research in contemporary philosophy of mind, and there is a considerable body of empirical research in psychology, neuroscience, and even quantum physics.  The problem touches on issues in ontology, on the nature and limits of scientific explanation, and on the accuracy and scope of introspection and first-person knowledge, to name but a few.  Reactions to the hard problem range from an outright denial of the issue  to naturalistic reduction to panpsychism (the claim that everything is conscious to some degree) to full-blown mind-body dualism.

Table of Contents

  1. Stating the Problem
    1. Chalmers
    2. Nagel
    3. Levine
  2. Underlying Reasons for the Problem
  3. Responses to the Problem
    1. Eliminativism
    2. Strong Reductionism
    3. Weak Reductionism
    4. Mysterianism
    5. Interactionist Dualism
    6. Epiphenomenalism
    7. Dual Aspect Theory/Neutral Monism/Panpsychism
  4. References and Further Reading

1. Stating the Problem

a. Chalmers

David Chalmers coined the name “hard problem” (1995, 1996), but the problem is not wholly new, being a key element of the venerable mind-body problem.  Still, Chalmers is among those most responsible for the outpouring of work on this issue.  The problem arises because “phenomenal consciousness,” consciousness characterized in terms of “what it’s like for the subject,” fails to succumb to the standard sort of functional explanation successful elsewhere in psychology (compare Block 1995).   Psychological phenomena like learning, reasoning, and remembering can all be explained in terms of playing the right “functional role.”  If a system does the right thing, if it alters behavior appropriately in response to environmental stimulation, it counts as learning.  Specifying these functions tells us what learning is and allows us to see how brain processes could play this role.  But according to Chalmers,

What makes the hard problem hard and almost unique is that it goes beyond problems about the performance of functions. To see this, note that even when we have explained the performance of all the cognitive and behavioral functions in the vicinity of experience—perceptual discrimination, categorization, internal access, verbal report—there may still remain a further unanswered question:  Why is the performance of these functions accompanied by experience? (1995, 202, emphasis in original).

Chalmers explains the persistence of this question by arguing against the possibility of a “reductive explanation” for phenomenal consciousness (hereafter, I will generally just use the term ‘consciousness’ for the phenomenon causing the problem).  A reductive explanation in Chalmers’s sense (following David Lewis (1972)), provides a form of deductive argument concluding with an identity statement between the target explanandum (the thing we are trying to explain) and a lower-level phenomenon that is physical in nature or more obviously reducible to the physical.  Reductive explanations of this type have two premises.  The first presents a functional analysis of the target phenomenon, which fully characterizes the target in terms of its functional role.  The second presents an empirically-discovered realizer of the functionally characterized target, one playing that very functional role.  Then, by transitivity of identity, the target and realizer are deduced to be identical.  For example, the gene may be reductively explained in terms of DNA as follows:

  1. The gene = the unit of hereditary transmission.  (By analysis.)
  2. Regions of DNA = the unit of hereditary transmission.  (By empirical investigation.)
  3. Therefore, the gene = regions of DNA. (By transitivity of identity, 1, 2.)

Chalmers contends that such reductive explanations are available in principle for all other natural phenomena, but not for consciousness.  This is the hard problem.

The reason that reductive explanation fails for consciousness, according to Chalmers, is that it cannot be functionally analyzed.  This is demonstrated by the continued conceivability of what Chalmers terms “zombies”—creatures physically (and so functionally) identical to us, but lacking consciousness—even in the face of a range of proffered functional analyses.  If we had a satisfying functional analysis of consciousness, zombies should not be conceivable.  The lack of a functional analysis is also shown by the continued conceivability of spectrum inversion (perhaps what it looks like for me to see green is what it looks like when you see red), the persistence of the “other minds” problem, the plausibility of the “knowledge argument” (Jackson 1982) and the manifest implausibility of offered functional characterizations.  If consciousness really could be functionally characterized, these problems would disappear.  Since they retain their grip on philosophers, scientists, and lay-people alike, we can conclude that no functional characterization is available.  But then the first premise of a reductive explanation cannot be properly formulated, and reductive explanation fails.  We are left, Chalmers claims, with the following stark choice:  either eliminate consciousness (deny that it exists at all) or add consciousness to our ontology as an unreduced feature of reality, on par with gravity and electromagnetism.  Either way, we are faced with a special ontological problem, one that resists solution by the usual reductive methods.

b. Nagel

Thomas Nagel sees the problem as turning on the “subjectivity” of conscious mental states (1974, 1986).  He argues that the facts about conscious states are inherently subjective—they can only be fully grasped from limited types of viewpoints.  However, scientific explanation demands an objective characterization of the facts, one that moves away from any particular point of view.  Thus, the facts about consciousness elude science and so make “the mind-body problem really intractable” (Nagel 1974, 435).

Nagel argues for the inherent subjectivity of the facts about consciousness by reflecting on the question of what it is like to be a bat—for the bat.  It seems that no amount of objective data will provide us with this knowledge, given that we do not share its type of point of view (the point of view of a creature able to fly and echolocate).  Learning all we can about the brain mechanisms, biochemistry, evolutionary history, psychophysics, and so forth, of a bat still leaves us unable to discover (or even imagine) what it’s like for the bat to hunt by echolocation on a dark night.  But it is still plausible that there are facts about what it’s like to be a bat, facts about how things seem from the bat’s perspective.  And even though we may have good reason to believe that consciousness is a physical phenomenon (due to considerations of mental causation, the success of materialist science, and so on), we are left in the dark about the bat’s conscious experience.  This is the hard problem of consciousness.

c. Levine

Joseph Levine argues that there is a special “explanatory gap” between consciousness and the physical (1983, 1993, 2001).  The challenge of closing this explanatory gap is the hard problem.  Levine argues that a good scientific explanation ought to deductively entail what it explains, allowing us to infer the presence of the target phenomenon from a statement of laws or mechanisms and initial conditions (Levine 2001, 74-76).  Deductive entailment is a logical relation where if the premises of an argument are true, the conclusion must be true as well.  For example, once we discover that lightning is nothing more than an electrical discharge, knowing that the proper conditions for a relevantly large electrical discharge existed in the atmosphere at time t allows us to deduce that lightning must have occurred at time t.  If such a deduction is not possible, there are three possible reasons, according to Levine.  One is that we have not fully specified the laws or mechanisms cited in our explanation.  Two is that the target phenomenon is stochastic in nature, and the best that can be inferred is a conclusion about the probability of the occurrence of the explanatory target.  The third is that there are as yet unknown factors at least partially involved in determining the phenomenon in question.  If we have adequately specified the laws and mechanisms in question, and if we have adjusted for stochastic phenomena, then we should possess a deductive conclusion about our explanatory target, or the third possibility is in effect.  But the third possibility is “precisely an admission that we don’t have an adequate explanation” (2001, 76).

And this is the case with consciousness, according to Levine.  No matter how detailed our specification of brain mechanisms or physical laws, it seems that there is an open question about whether consciousness is present.  We can still meaningfully ask if consciousness occurred, even if we accept that the laws, mechanisms, and proper conditions are in place.  And it seems that any further information of this type that we add to our explanation will still suffer from the same problem.  Thus, there is an explanatory gap between the physical and consciousness, leaving us with the hard problem.

2. Underlying Reasons for the Problem

But what it is about consciousness that generates the hard problem?  It may just seem obvious that consciousness could not be physical or functional.  But it is worthwhile to try and draw a rough circle around the problematic features of conscious experience, if we can.  This both clarifies what we are talking about when we talk about consciousness and helps isolate the data a successful theory must explain.

Uriah Kriegel (2009; see also Levine 2001) offers a helpful conceptual division of consciousness into two components.  Starting with the standard understanding of conscious states as states there is something it’s like for the organism to be in, Kriegel notes that we can either focus on the fact that something appears for the organism or we can focus on what it is that appears, the something it’s like.  Focusing on the former, we find that subjects are aware of their conscious states in a distinctive way.  Kriegel labels this feature the subjective component of consciousness.    Focusing on the latter we find the experienced character of consciousness—the “redness of red” or the painfulness of pain— often termed “qualia” or “phenomenal character” in the literature (compare Crane 2000).  Kriegel labels this the qualitative component of consciousness.

Subdividing consciousness in this way allows us to concentrate on how we are conscious and what we are conscious of.  When we focus on the subjective “how” component, we find that conscious states are presented to the subject in a seemingly immediate way.  And when we focus on the qualitative “what” component, we find that consciousness presents us with seemingly indescribable qualities which in principle can vary independently of mental functioning.  These features help explain why consciousness generates the hard problem.

The first feature, which we can call immediacy, concerns the way we access consciousness from the first-person perspective.  Conscious states are accessed in a seemingly unmediated way.  It appears that nothing comes between us and our conscious states.  We seem to access them simply by having them—we do not infer their presence by way of any evidence or argument.  This immediacy creates the impression that there is no way we could be wrong about the content of our conscious states.  Error in perception or error in reasoning can be traced back to poor perceptual conditions or to a failure of rational inference.  But in the absence of such accessible sources of error, it seems that there is no room for inaccuracy in the introspective case.  And even if we come to believe we are in error in introspection, the evidence for this will be indirect and third-personal—it will lack the subjective force of immediacy.  Thus, there is an intuition of special accuracy or even infallibility when it comes to knowing our own conscious states.  We might be wrong that an object in the world is really red, but can we be wrong that it seems red to us?  But if we cannot be wrong about how things seem to us and conscious states seem inexplicable, then they really are inexplicable.  In this way, the immediacy of the subjective component of consciousness underwrites the hard problem.

But what we access may be even more problematic than how we access it:  we might, after all, have had immediate access to the physical nature of our conscious states (see P.M. Churchland 1985).  But conscious experience instead reveals various sensory qualities—the redness of the visual experience of an apple or the painfulness of a stubbed toe, for example.  But these qualities seem to defy informative description.  If one has not experienced them, then no amount of description will adequately convey what it’s like to have such an experience with these qualities.  We can call this feature of the qualitative component of consciousness indescribability. If someone has never seen red (a congenitally blind person, for example), it seems there is nothing informative we could say to convey to them the true nature of this quality.  We might mention prototypical red objects or explain that red is more similar to purple than it is to green, but such descriptions seem to leave the quality itself untouched.  And if experienced qualities cannot be informatively described, how could they be adequately captured in an explanatory theory?  It seems that by their very nature, conscious qualities defy explanation.  This difficulty lies at the heart of the hard problem.

A further problematic feature of what we access is that we can easily imagine our conscious mental processes occurring in conjunction with different conscious qualities or in the absence of consciousness altogether.  The particular qualities that accompany specific mental operations—like the reddish quality accompanying our detection and categorization of an apple, say—seem only contingently connected to the functional processes involved in detection and categorization.  We can call this feature of what is accessed independence.  Independence is the apparent lack of connection between conscious qualities and anything else, and it underwrites the inverted and absent qualia thought experiments used by Chalmers to establish the hard problem (compare Block 1980).  If conscious qualities really are independent in this way, then there seems to be no way to effectively tie them to the rest of reality.

The challenge of the hard problem, then, is to explain consciousness given that it seems to give us immediate access to indescribable and independent qualities.  If we can explain these underlying features, then we may see how to fit consciousness into a physicalist ontology.  Or it perhaps taking these features seriously motivates a rejection of physicalism and the acceptance of conscious qualities as fundamental features of our ontology.  The following section briefly surveys the range of responses to the hard problem, from eliminativism and reductionism to panpsychism and full-blown dualism.

3. Responses to the Problem

a. Eliminativism

Eliminativism holds that there is no hard problem of consciousness because there is no consciousness to worry about in the first place.  Eliminativism is most clearly defended by Rey 1997, but see also Dennett 1978, 1988, Wilkes 1984, and Ryle 1949.  On the face of it, this response sounds absurd:  how can one deny that conscious experience exists?  Consciousness might be the one thing that is certain in our epistemology.  But eliminativist views resist the idea that what we call experience is equivalent to consciousness, at least in the phenomenal, “what it’s like” sense.  They hold that consciousness so-conceived is a philosopher’s construction, one that can be rejected without absurdity.  If it is definitional of consciousness that it is nonfunctional, then holding that the mind is fully functional amounts to a denial of consciousness.  Alternately, if qualia are construed as nonrelational, intrinsic qualities of experience, then one might deny that qualia exist (Dennett 1988).  And if qualia are essential to consciousness, this, too, amounts to an eliminativism about consciousness.

What might justify consciousness eliminativism?  First, the very notion of consciousness, upon close examination, may not have well-defined conditions of application—there may be no single phenomenon that the term picks out (Wilkes 1984).  Or the term may serve no use at all in any scientific theory, and so may drop out of a scientifically-fixed ontology (Rey 1997).  If science tells us what there is (as some naturalists hold), and science has no place for nonfunctional intrinsic qualities, then there is no consciousness, so defined.  Finally, it might be that the term ‘consciousness’ gets its meaning as part of a falsifiable theory, our folk psychology. The entities posited by a theory stand or fall with the success of the theory.  If the theory is falsified, then the entities it posits do not exist (compare P.M. Churchland 1981).  And there is no guarantee that folk psychology will not be supplanted by a better theory of the mind, perhaps a neuroscientific or even quantum mechanical theory, at some point.  Thus, consciousness might be eliminated from our ontology.  If that occurs, obviously there is no hard problem to worry about.  No consciousness, no problem!

But eliminativism seems much too strong a reaction to the hard problem, one that throws the baby out with the bathwater.  First, it is highly counterintuitive to deny that consciousness exists.  It seems extremely basic to our conception of minds and persons.  A more desirable view would avoid this move.  Second, it is not clear why we must accept that consciousness, by definition, is nonfunctional or intrinsic.  Definitional, “analytic” claims are highly controversial at best, particularly with difficult terms like ‘consciousness’ (compare Quine 1951, Wittgenstein 1953).  A better solution would hold that consciousness still exists, but it is functional and relational in nature.  This is the strong reductionist approach.

b. Strong Reductionism

Strong reductionism holds that consciousness exists, but contends that it is reducible to tractable functional, nonintrinsic properties.  Strong reductionism further claims that the reductive story we tell about consciousness fully explains, without remainder, all that needs to be explained about consciousness.  Reductionism, generally, is the idea that complex phenomena can be explained in terms of the arrangement and functioning of simpler, better understood parts.  Key to strong reductionism, then, is the idea that consciousness can be broken down and explained in terms of simpler things.  This amounts to a rejection of the idea that experience is simple and basic, that it stands as a kind of epistemic or metaphysical “ground floor.”  Strong reductionists must hold that consciousness is not as it prima facie appears, that it only seems to be marked by immediacy, indescribability, and independence and therefore that it only seems nonfunctional and intrinsic.  Consciousness, according to strong reductionism, can be fully analyzed and explained in functional terms, even if it does not seem that way.

A number of prominent strongly reductive theories exist in the literature.  Functionalist approaches hold that consciousness is nothing more than a functional process.  A popular version of this view is the “global workspace” hypothesis, which holds that conscious states are mental states available for processing by a wide range of cognitive systems (Baars 1988, 1997; Dehaene & Naccache 2001).  They are available in this way by being present in a special network—the “global workspace.”  This workspace can be functionally characterized and it also can be given a neurological interpretation.  In answer to the question “why are these states conscious?” it can be replied that this is what it means to be conscious.  If a state is available to the mind in this way, it is a conscious state (see also Dennett 1991).  (For more neuroscientifically-focused versions of the functionalist approach, see P.S Churchland 1986; Crick 1994; and Koch 2004.)

Another set of views that can be broadly termed functionalist is “enactive” or “embodied” approaches (Hurley 1998, Noë 2005, 2009).  These views hold that mental processes should not be characterized in terms of strictly inner processes or representations.  Rather, they should be cashed out in terms of the dynamic processes connecting perception, bodily and environmental awareness, and behavior.  These processes, the views contend, do not strictly depend on processes inside the head; rather, they loop out into the body and the environment.  Further, the nature of consciousness is tied up with behavior and action—it cannot be isolated as a passive process of receiving and recording information.  These views are cataloged as functionalist because of the way they answer the hard problem:  these physical states (constituted in part by bodily and worldly things) are conscious because they play the right functional role, they do the right thing.

Another strongly reductive approach holds that conscious states are states representing the world in the appropriate way (Dretske 1995, Tye 1995, 2000).  This view, known as “first-order representationalism,” contends that conscious states make us aware of things in world by representing them.  Further, these representations are “nonconceptual” in nature:  they represent features even if the subject in question lacks the concepts needed to cognitively categorize those features.  But these nonconceptual representations must play the right functional role in order to be conscious.  They must be poised to influence the higher-level cognitive systems of a subject.  The details of these representations differ from theorist to theorist, but a common answer to the hard problem emerges.  First-order representational states are conscious because they do the right thing:  they make us aware of just the sorts of features that make up conscious experience, features like the redness of an apple, the sweetness of honey, or the shrillness of a trumpet.  Further, such representations are conscious because they are poised to play the right role in our understanding of the world—they serve as the initial layer of our epistemic contact  with reality, a layer we can then use as the basis of our more sophisticated beliefs and theories.

A further point serves to support the claims of first-order representationalism.  When we reflect on our experience in a focused way, we do not seem to find any distinctively mental properties.  Rather, we find the very things first-order representationalism claims we represent:  the basic sensory features of the world.  If I ask you to reflect closely on your experience of a tree, you do not find special mental qualities.  Rather, you find the tree, as it appears to you, as you represent it.  This consideration, known as “transparency,” seems to undermine the claim that we need to posit special intrinsic qualia, seemingly irreducible properties of our experiences (Harman 1990, though see Kind 2003).  Instead, we can explain all that we experience in terms of representation.  We have a red experience because we represent physical red in the right way.  It is then argued that representation can be given a reductive explanation.  Representation, even the sort of representation involved in experience, is no more than various functional/physical processes of our brains tracking the environment.  It follows that there is no further hard problem to deal with.

A third type of strongly reductive approach is higher-order representationalism (Armstrong 1968, 1981; Rosenthal 1986, 2005; Lycan 1987, 1996, 2001; Carruthers 2000, 2005).  This view starts with the question of what accounts for the difference between conscious and nonconscious mental states.  Higher-order theorists hold that an intuitive answer is that we are appropriately aware of our conscious states, while we are unaware of our nonconscious states.  The task of a theory of consciousness, then, is to explain the awareness accounting for this difference.  Higher-order representationalists contend that the awareness is a product of a specific sort of representation, a representation that picks out the subject’s own mental states.  These “higher-order” representations (representations of other representations) make the subject aware of her states, thus accounting for consciousness.  In answer to the hard problem, the higher-order theorist responds that these states are conscious because the subject is appropriately aware of them by way of higher-order representation.  The higher-order representations themselves are held to be nonconscious.  And since representation can plausibly be reduced to functional/physical processes, there is no lingering problem to explain (though see Gennaro 2005 for more on this strategy).

A final strongly reductive view, “self-representationalism,” holds that troubles with the higher-order view demand that we characterize the awareness subjects have of their conscious states as a kind of self-representation, where one complex representational state is about both the world and that very state itself (Gennaro 1996, Kriegel 2003, 2009, Van Gulick 2004, 2006, Williford 2006).  It may seem paradoxical to say that a state can represent itself, but this can dealt with by holding that the state represents itself in virtue of one part of the state representing another, and thereby coming to indirectly represent the whole.  Further, self-representationalism may provide the best explanation of the seemingly ubiquitous presence of self-awareness in conscious experience.  And, again, in answer to the question of why such states are conscious, the self-representationalist can respond that conscious states are ones the subject is aware of, and self-representationalism explains this awareness.  And since self-representation, properly construed, is reducible to functional/physical processes, we are left with a complete explanation of consciousness.  (For more details on how higher-order/self-representational views deal with the hard problem, see Gennaro 2012, chapter 4.)

However, there remains considerable resistance to strongly reductive views.  The main stumbling block is that they seem to leave unaddressed the pressing intuition that one can easily conceive of a system satisfying all the requirements of the strongly reductive views but still lacking consciousness (Chalmers 1996, chapter 3).  It is argued that an effective theory ought to close off such easy conceptions.  Further, strong reductivists seem committed to the claim that there is no knowledge of consciousness that cannot be grasped theoretically.  If a strongly reductive view is true, it seems that a blind person can gain full knowledge of color experience from a textbook.  But surely she still lacks some knowledge of what it’s like to see red, for example?  Strongly reductive theorists can contend that these recalcitrant intuitions are merely a product of lingering confused or erroneous views of consciousness.  But in the face of such worries, many have felt it better to find a way to respect these intuitions while still denying the potentially unpleasant ontological implications of the hard problem.  Hence, weak reductionism.

c. Weak Reductionism

Weak reductionism, in contrast to the strong version, holds that consciousness is a simple or basic phenomenon, one that cannot be informatively broken down into simpler nonconscious elements.  But according to the view we can still identify consciousness with physical properties if the most parsimonious and productive theory supports such an identity (Block 2002, Block & Stalnaker 1999, Hill 1997, Loar 1997, 1999, Papineau 1993, 2002, Perry 2001).  What’s more, once the identity has been established, there is no further burden of explanation.  Identities have no explanation:  a thing just is what it is.  To ask how it could be that Mark Twain is Sam Clemens, once we have the most parsimonious rendering of the facts, is to go beyond meaningful questioning.  And the same holds for the identity of conscious states with physical states.

But there remains the question of why the identity claim appears so counterintuitive and here weak reductionists generally appeal to the “phenomenal concepts strategy” (PCS) to make their case (compare Stoljar 2005).  The PCS holds that the hard problem is not the result of a dualism of facts, phenomenal and physical, but rather a dualism of concepts picking out fully physical conscious states.  One concept is the third-personal physical concept of neuroscience.  The other concept is a distinctively first-personal “phenomenal concept”—one that picks out conscious states in a subjectively direct manner.  Because of the subjective differences in these modes of conceptual access, consciousness does not seem intuitively to be physical.  But once we understand the differences in the two concepts, there is no need to accept this intuition.

Here is a sketch of how a weakly reductive view of consciousness might proceed.  First, we find stimuli that reliably trigger reports of phenomenally conscious states from subjects.  Then we find what neural processes are reliably correlated with those reported experiences.  It can then be argued on the basis of parsimony that the reported conscious state just is the neural state—an ontology holding that two states are present is less simple than one identifying the two states.  Further, accepting the identity is explanatorily fruitful, particularly with respect to mental causation.  Finally, the PCS is appealed to in order to explain why the identity remains counterintuitive.  And as to the question of why this particular neural state should be identical to this particular phenomenal state, the answer is that this is just the way things are.  Explanation bottoms out at this point and requests for further explanation are unreasonable.

But there are pressing worries about weak reductionism.  There seems to be an undischarged phenomenal element within the weakly reductive view (Chalmers 2006).  When we focus on the PCS, it seems that we lack a plausible story about how it is that phenomenal concepts reveal what it’s like for us in experience.  The direct access of phenomenal concepts seems to require that phenomenal states themselves inform us of what they are like. A common way to cash out the PCS is to say that the phenomenal properties themselves are embedded in the phenomenal concepts, and that alone makes them accessible in the seemingly rich manner of introspected experience.  When it is asked how phenomenal properties might underwrite this access, the answer given is that this is in the nature of phenomenal properties—that is just what they do.  Again, we are told that explanation must stop somewhere.  But at this point, it seems that there is little to distinguish that weak reductionist from the various forms of nonreductive and dualistic views cataloged below.  They, too, hold that it is in the nature of phenomenal properties to underwrite first-person access.  But they hold that there is no good reason to think that properties with this sort of nature are physical.  We know of no other physical property that possesses such a nature.  All that we are left with to recommend weak reductionism is a thin claim of parsimony and an overly-strong fealty to physicalism.  We are asked to accept a brute identity here, one that seems unprecedented in our ontology given that consciousness is a macro-level phenomenon.  Other examples of such brute identity—of electricity and magnetism into one force, say—occur at the foundational level of physics.  Neurological and phenomenal properties do not seem to be basic in this way.  We are left with phenomenal properties inexplicable in physical terms, “brutally” identified with neurological properties in a way that nothing else seems to be.  Why not take all this as an indication that phenomenal properties are not physical after all?

The weak reductionist can respond that the question of mental causation still provides a strong enough reason to hold onto physicalism.  A plausible scientific principal is that the physical world is causally closed:  all physical events have physical causes.  And since our bodies are physical, it seems that denying that consciousness is physical renders it epiphenomenal.  The apparent implausibility of epiphenomenalism may be enough to motivate adherence to weak reductionism, even with its explanatory short-comings.  Dualistic challenges to this claim will be discussed in later sections.

It is possible, however, to embrace weak reductionism and still acknowledge that some questions remain to be answered.  For example, it might be reasonable to demand some explanation of how particular neural states correlate with differences in conscious experience.  A weak reductionist might hold that this is a question we at present cannot answer.  It may be that one day we will be in a position to so, due to a radical shift in our understanding of consciousness or physical reality.  Or perhaps this will remain an unsolvable mystery, one beyond our limited abilities to decipher.  Still, there may be good reasons to hold at present that the most parsimonious metaphysical picture is the physicalist picture.  The line between weak reductionism and the next set of views to be considered, mysterianism, may blur considerably here.

d. Mysterianism

The mysterian response to the hard problem does not offer a solution; rather, it holds that the hard problem cannot be solved by current scientific method and perhaps cannot be solved by human beings at all.  There are two varieties of the view.  The more moderate version of the position, which can be termed “temporary mysterianism,” holds that given the current state of scientific knowledge, we have no explanation of why some physical states are conscious (Nagel 1974,  Levine 2001).  The gap between experience and the sorts of things dealt with in modern physics—functional, structural, and dynamical properties of basic fields and particles—is simply too wide to be bridged at present.  Still, it may be that some future conceptual revolution in the sciences will show how to close the gap.  Such massive conceptual reordering is certainly possible, given the history of science.  And, indeed, if one accepts the Kuhnian idea of shifts between incommensurate paradigms, it might seem unsurprising that we, pre-paradigm-shift, cannot grasp what things will be like after the revolution.  But at present we have no idea how the hard problem might be solved.

Thomas Nagel, in sketching his version of this idea, calls for a future “objective phenomenology” which will “describe, at least in part, the subjective character of experiences in a form comprehensible to beings incapable of having those experiences” (1974, 449).  Without such a new conceptual system, Nagel holds, we are left unable to bridge the gap between consciousness and the physical.  Consciousness may indeed be a physical, but we at present have no idea how this could be so.

It is of course open for both weak and strong reductionists to accept a version of temporary mysterianism.  They can agree that at present we do not know how consciousness fits into the physical world, but the possibility is open that future science will clear up the mystery.  The main difference between such claims by reductionists and by mysterians is that the mysterians reject the idea that current reductive proposals do anything at all to close the gap.  How different the explanatory structure must be to count as truly new and not merely an extension of the old is not possible to gauge with any precision.  So the difference between a very weak reductionist and a temporary, though optimistic mysterian may not amount to much.

The stronger version of the position, “permanent mysterianism,” argues that our ignorance in the face of the hard problem is not merely transitory, but is permanent, given our limited cognitive capacities (McGinn 1989, 1991).  We are like squirrels trying to understand quantum mechanics:  it just is not going to happen.  The main exponent of this view is Colin McGinn, who argues that a solution to the hard problem is “cognitively closed” to us.  He supports his position by stressing consequences of a modular view of the mind, inspired in part by Chomsky’s work in linguistics.  Our mind just may not be built to solve this sort of problem.  Instead, it may be composed of dedicated, domain-specific “modules” devoted to solving local, specific problems for an organism.  An organism without a dedicated “language acquisition device” equipped with “universal grammar” cannot acquire language.  Perhaps the hard problem requires cognitive apparatus we just do not possess as a species.  If that is the case, no further scientific or philosophical breakthrough will make a difference.  We are not built to solve the problem:  it is cognitively closed to us.

A worry about such a claim is that it is hard to establish just what sorts of problems are permanently beyond our ken.  It seems possible that the temporary mysterian may be correct here, and what looks unbridgeable in principle is really just a temporary roadblock.  Both the temporary and permanent mysterian agree on the evidence.  They agree that there is a real gap at present between consciousness and the physical and they agree that nothing in current science seems up to the task of solving the problem.  The further claim that we are forever blocked from solving the problem turns on controversial claims about the nature of the problem and the nature of our cognitive capacities.  Perhaps those controversial claims will be made good, but at present, it is hard to see why we should give up all hope, given the history of surprising scientific breakthroughs.

e. Interactionist Dualism

Perhaps, though, we know enough already to establish that consciousness is not a physical phenomenon.   This brings us to what has been, historically speaking, the most important response to the hard problem and the more general mind-body problem: dualism, the claim that consciousness is ontologically distinct from anything physical.  Dualism, in its various forms, reasons from the explanatory, epistemological, or conceptual gaps between the phenomenal and the physical to the metaphysical conclusion that the physicalist worldview is incomplete and needs to be supplemented by the addition of irreducibly phenomenal substance or properties.

Dualism can be unpacked in a number of ways.  Substance dualism holds that consciousness makes up a distinct fundamental “stuff” which can exist independently of any physical substance.  Descartes’ famous dualism was of this kind (Descartes 1640/1984).  A more popular modern dualist option is property dualism, which holds that the conscious mind is not a separate substance from the physical brain, but that phenomenal properties are nonphysical properties of the brain.  On this view, it is metaphysically possible that the physical substrate occurs without the phenomenal properties, indicating their ontological independence, but phenomenal properties cannot exist on their own.  The properties might emerge from some combination of nonphenomenal properties (emergent dualism—compare Broad 1925) or they might be present as a fundamental feature of reality, one that necessarily correlates with physical matter in our world, but could in principle come apart from the physical in another possible world.

A key question for dualist views concerns the relationship between consciousness and the physical world, particularly our physical bodies.  Descartes held that conscious mental properties can have a causal impact upon physical matter—this is known as interactionist dualism.  Recent defenders of interactionist dualism include Foster 1991, Hodgson 1991, Lowe 1996, Popper and Eccles 1977, H. Robinson 1982, Stapp 1993, and Swinburne 1986.  However, interactionist dualism requires rejecting the “causal closure” of the physical domain, the claim that every physical event is fully determined by a physical cause.  Causal closure is a long-held principle in the sciences, so its rejection marks a strong break from current scientific orthodoxy (though see Collins 2011).  Another species of dualism accepts the causal closure of physics, but still holds that phenomenal properties are metaphysically distinct from physical properties.  This compatibilism is achieved at the price of consciousness epiphenomenalism, the view that conscious properties can be caused by physical events, but they cannot in turn cause physical events.  I will discuss interactionist dualism in this section, including a consideration of how quantum mechanics might open up a workable space for an acceptable dualist interactionist view.   I will discuss epiphenomenalism in the following section.

Interactionist dualism, of both the substance and property type, holds that consciousness is causally efficacious in the production of bodily behavior.  This is certainly a strongly intuitive position to take with regard to mental causation, but it requires rejecting the causal closure of the physical.  It is widely thought that the principle of causal closure is central to modern science, on par with basic conservation principles like the conservation of energy or matter in a physical reaction (see, for example, Kim 1998).  And at macroscopic scales, the principle appears well-supported by empirical evidence.  However, at the quantum level it is more plausible to question causal closure.  On one reading of quantum mechanics, the progression of quantum-level events unfolds in a deterministic progression until an observation occurs.  At that point, some views hold that the progression of events becomes indeterminstic.  If so, there may be room for consciousness to influence how such “decoherence” occurs—that is, how the quantum “wave function” collapses into the classical, observable macroscopic world we experience.  How such a process occurs is the subject of speculative theorizing in quantum theories of consciousness.  It may be that such views are better cataloged as physicalist:  the properties involved might well be labeled as physical in a completed science (see, for example, Penrose 1989, 1994; Hameroff 1998).  If so, the quantum view is better seen as strongly or weakly reductive.

Still, it might be that the proper cashing out of the idea of “observation” in quantum theory requires positing consciousness as an unreduced primitive.  Observation may require something intrinsically conscious, rather than something characterized in the relational terms of physical theory.   In that case, phenomenal properties would be metaphysically distinct from the physical, traditionally characterized, while playing a key role in physical theory—the role of collapsing the wave function by observation.  Thus, there seems to be theoretical space for a dualist view which rejects closure but maintains a concordance with basic physical theory.

Sill, such views face considerable challenges.  They are beholden to particular interpretations of quantum mechanics and this is far from a settled field, to put it mildly.  It may well be that the best interpretation of quantum mechanics rejects the key assumption of indeterminacy here (see Albert 1993 for the details of this debate).  Further, the kinds of indeterminacies discoverable at the quantum level may not correspond in any useful way to our ordinary idea of mental causes.  The pattern of decoherence may have little to do with my conscious desire to grab a beer causing me to go to the fridge.  Finally, there is the question of how phenomenal properties at the quantum level come together to make up the conscious experience we have.  Our conscious mental lives are not themselves quantum phenomenon—how, then, do micro-phenomenal quantum-level properties combine to constitute our experiences?  Still, this is an alluring area of investigation, bringing together the mysteries of consciousness and quantum mechanics.  But such a mix may only compound our explanatory troubles!

f. Epiphenomenalism

A different dualistic approach accepts the causal closure of physics by holding that phenomenal properties have no causal influence on the physical world (Campbell 1970, Huxley 1874, Jackson 1982, and W.S. Robinson 1988, 2004).  Thus, any physical effect, like a bodily behavior, will have a fully physical cause.  Phenomenal properties merely accompany causally efficacious physical properties, but they are not involved in making the behavior happen.  Phenomenal properties, on this view, may be lawfully correlated with physical properties, thus assuring that whenever a brain event of a particular type occurs, a phenomenal property of a particular type occurs.  For example, it may be that bodily damage causes activity in the amygdala, which in turn causes pain-appropriate behavior like screaming or cringing.   The activity in the amygdala will also cause the tokening of phenomenal pain properties.  But these properties are out of the causal chain leading to the behavior.  They are like the activity of a steam whistle relative to the causal power of the steam engine moving a train’s wheels.

Such a view has no obvious logical flaw, but it is in strong conflict with our ordinary notions of how conscious states are related to behavior.  It is extremely intuitive that our pains at times cause us to scream or cringe.  But on the epiphenomenalist view, that cannot be the case.  What’s more, our knowledge of our conscious states cannot be caused by the phenomenal qualities of our experiences.  On the epiphenomenalist view, my knowledge that I’m in pain is not caused by the pain itself.  This, too, seems absurd:  surely, the feeling of pain is causally implicated in my knowledge of that pain!  But the epiphenomenalist can simply bite the bullet here and reject the commonsense picture.  We often discover odd things when we engage in serious investigation, and this may be one of them.  Denying commonsense intuition is better than denying a basic scientific principle like causal closure, according to epiphenomenalists.  And it may be that experimental results in the sciences undermine the causal efficacy of consciousness as well, so this is not so outrageous a claim (See Libet, 2004; Wegner 2002, for example).  Further, the epiphenomenalist can deny that we need a causal theory of first-person knowledge.  It may be that our knowledge of our conscious states is achieved by a unique kind of noncausal acquaintance.  Or maybe merely having the phenomenal states is enough for us to know of them—our knowledge of consciousness may be constituted by phenomenal states, rather than caused by them.  Knowledge of causation is a difficult philosophical area in general, so it may reasonable to offer alternatives to the causal theory in this context.  But despite these possibilities, epiphenomenalism remains a difficult view to embrace because of its strongly counterintuitive nature.

g. Dual Aspect Theory/Neutral Monism/Panpsychism

A final set of views, close in spirit to dualism, hold that phenomenal properties cannot be reduced to more basic physical properties, but might reduce to something more basic still, a substance that is both physical and phenomenal or that underwrites both.  Defenders of such views agree with dualists that the hard problem forces a rethinking of our basic ontology, but they disagree that this entails dualism.  There are several variations of the idea.  It may be that there is a more basic substance underlying all physical matter and this basic substance possesses phenomenal as well as physical properties (dual aspect theory:  Spinoza 1677/2005, P. Strawson 1959, Nagel 1986).  Or it may be that this more basic substance is “neutral”—neither phenomenal nor physical, yet somehow underlying both (neutral monism:  Russell 1926, Feigl 1958, Maxwell 1979, Lockwood 1989, Stubenberg 1998, Stoljar 2001, G. Strawson 2008).  Or it may be that phenomenal properties are the intrinsic categorical bases for the relational, dispositional properties described in physics and so everything physical has an underlying phenomenal nature (panpsychism:  Leibniz 1714/1989, Whitehead 1929, Griffin 1998, Rosenberg 2005, Skrbina 2007).  These views have all received detailed elaboration in past eras of philosophy, but they have seen a distinct revival as responses to the hard problem.

There is considerable variation in how theorists unpack these kinds of views, so it is only possible here to give generic versions of the ideas.  All three views make consciousness more basic or as basic as physical properties; this is something they share with dualism.  But they disagree about the right way to spell out the metaphysical relations between the phenomenal, the physical, and any more basic substance there might be.  The true differences between the views are not always clear even to the views’ defenders, but we can try to tease them apart here.

A dual-aspect view holds that there is one basic underlying stuff that possesses both physical and phenomenal properties.  These properties may only be instantiated when the right combinations of the basic substance are present, so panpsychism is not a necessary entailment of the view.  For example, when the basic substance is configured in the form of a brain, it then realizes phenomenal as well as physical properties.  But that need not be the case when the fundamental stuff makes up a table.  But in any event, phenomenal properties are not themselves reducible to physical properties.  There is a fine line between such views and dualist views, mainly turning on the difference between constitution and lawful correlation.

Neutral monist views hold that there is a more basic neutral substance underlying both the phenomenal and the physical.  ‘Neutral’ here means that the underlying stuff really is neither phenomenal nor physical, so there is a good sense in which such a position is reductive:  it explains the presence of the phenomenal by reference to something else more basic.  This distinguishes it from the dual-aspect approach—on the dual-aspect view, the underlying stuff already possesses phenomenal (and physical) properties, while on neutral monism it does not.  That leaves neutral monism with the challenge of explaining this reductive relationship, as well as explaining how the neutral substance underlies physical reality without itself being physical.

Panpsychism holds that the phenomenal is basic to all matter.  Such views hold that the phenomenal somehow underwrites the physical or is potentially present at all times as a property of a more basic substance.  This view must explain what it means to say that everything is conscious in some sense.  Further, it must explain how it is that the basic phenomenal (or “protophenomenal”) elements combine to form the sorts of properties we are acquainted with in consciousness.  Why is it that some combinations form the experiences we enjoy and others (presumably) do not?

One line of support for these types of views comes from the way that physical theory defines its basic properties in terms of their dispositions to causally interact with each other.  For example, what it is to be a quark of a certain type is just to be disposed to behave in certain ways in the presence of other quarks.  Physical theory is silent about what stuff might underlie or constitute the entities with these dispositions—it deals only in extrinsic or relational properties, not in intrinsic properties.  At the same time, there is reason to hold that consciousness possesses nonrelational intrinsic qualities.  Indeed, this may explain why we cannot know what it’s like to be a bat—that requires knowledge of an intrinsic quality not conveyable by relational description.  Putting these two ideas together, we find a motivation for the sorts of views canvassed here.  Basic physics is silent about the intrinsic categorical bases underlying the dispositional properties described in physical theory.  But it seems plausible that there must be such bases—how could there be dispositions to behave thus-and-so without some categorical base to ground the disposition?  And since we already have reason to believe that conscious qualities are intrinsic, it makes sense to posit phenomenal properties as the categorical bases of basic physical matter. Or we can posit a neutral substance to fill this role, one also realizing phenomenal properties when in the right circumstances.

These views all seem to avoid epiphenomenalism.  Whenever there is a physical cause of behavior, the underlying phenomenal (or neutral) basis will be present to do the work.  But that cause might itself be constituted by the phenomenal, in the senses laid out here.  What’s more, there is nothing in conflict with physics—the properties posited appear at a level below the range of relational physical description.  And they do not conflict with or preempt anything present in physical theory.

But we are left with several worries.  First, it is again the case that phenomenal properties are posited at an extreme micro-level.  How it is that such micro-phenomenal properties cohere into the sorts of experiential properties present in consciousness is unexplained.  What’s more, if we take the panpsychic route, we are faced with the claim that every physical object has a phenomenal nature of some kind.  This may not be incoherent, but it is a counterintuitive result.  But if we do not accept panpsychism, we must explain how the more basic underlying substance differs from the phenomenal and yet instantiates it in the right circumstances.  Simply saying that this just is the nature of the neutral substance is not an informative answer.  Finally, it is unclear how these views really differ from a weakly reductionist account.  Both hold that there is a basic and brute connection between the physical brain and phenomenal consciousness.  On the weakly reductionist account, the connection is one of brute identity.  On the dual-aspect/neutral monist/panpsychic account, it is one of brute constitution, where two properties, the physical and the phenomenal, constantly co-occur (because the one constitute the categorical base of the other, or they are aspects of a more basic stuff, etc.), though they are held to be metaphysically distinct.  Is there any evidence that could decide between the views?  The apparent differences here may be more one of style than of substance, despite the intricacies of these metaphysical debates.

4. References and Further Reading

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  • Broad, C.D. The Mind and its Place in Nature. Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1925.
  • Campbell, K. K. Body and Mind. London: Doubleday, 1970.
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  • Chalmers, D.J. The Conscious Mind:  In Search of a Fundamental Theory. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1996.
  • Chalmers, D.J. “Phenomenal Concepts and the Explanatory Gap.” In T. Alter & S. Walter, eds. Phenomenal Concepts and Phenomenal Knowledge: New Essays on Consciousness and Physicalism Oxford:  Oxford University Press, 2006.
  • Churchland, P.M. “Eliminative Materialism and the Propositional Attitudes.” Journal of Philosophy, 78, 2, 1981.
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  • Dennett, D.C. “Why You Can’t Make a Computer that Feels Pain.” Synthese 38, 415-456, 1978.
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  • Jackson, F. “Epiphenomenal Qualia.” In Philosophical Quarterly 32: 127-136, 1982.
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  • Lewis, C.I. Mind and the World Order.  London:  Constable, 1929.
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  • Loar, B. “Phenomenal States”. In N. Block, O. Flanagan, and G. Güzeldere eds. The Nature of Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1997.
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Author Information

Josh Weisberg
Email: jweisberg@uh.edu
University of Houston
U. S. A.

Renaissance Philosophy

The Renaissance, that is, the period that extends roughly from the middle of the fourteenth century to the beginning of the seventeen century, was a time of intense, all-encompassing, and, in many ways, distinctive philosophical activity. A fundamental assumption of the Renaissance movement was that the remains of classical antiquity constituted an invaluable source of excellence to which debased and decadent modern times could turn in order to repair the damage brought about since the fall of the Roman Empire. It was often assumed that God had given a single unified truth to humanity and that the works of ancient philosophers had preserved part of this original deposit of divine wisdom. This idea not only laid the foundation for a scholarly culture that was centered on ancient texts and their interpretation, but also fostered an approach to textual interpretation that strove to harmonize and reconcile divergent philosophical accounts. Stimulated by newly available texts, one of the most important hallmarks of Renaissance philosophy is the increased interest in primary sources of Greek and Roman thought, which were previously unknown or little read. The renewed study of Neoplatonism, Stoicism, Epicureanism, and Skepticism eroded faith in the universal truth of Aristotelian philosophy and widened the philosophical horizon, providing a rich seedbed from which modern science and modern philosophy gradually emerged.

Table of Contents

  1. Aristotelianism
  2. Humanism
  3. Platonism
  4. Hellenistic Philosophies
  5. New Philosophies of Nature
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Aristotelianism

Improved access to a great deal of previously unknown literature from ancient Greece and Rome was an important aspect of Renaissance philosophy. The renewed study of Aristotle, however, was not so much because of the rediscovery of unknown texts, but because of a renewed interest in texts long translated into Latin but little studied, such as the Poetics, and especially because of novel approaches to well-known texts. From the early fifteenth century onwards, humanists devoted considerable time and energy to making Aristotelian texts clearer and more precise. In order to rediscover the meaning of Aristotle’s thought, they updated the Scholastic translations of his works, read them in the original Greek, and analyzed them with philological techniques. The availability of these new interpretative tools had a great impact on the philosophical debate. Moreover, in the four decades after 1490, the Aristotelian interpretations of Alexander of Aphrodisias, Themistius, Ammonius, Philoponus, Simplicius, and other Greek commentators were added to the views of Arabic and medieval commentators, stimulating new solutions to Aristotelian problems and leading to a wide variety of interpretations of Aristotle in the Renaissance period.

The most powerful tradition, at least in Italy, was that which took Averroes’s works as the best key for determining the true mind of Aristotle. Averroes’s name was primarily associated with the doctrine of the unity of the intellect. Among the defenders of his theory that there is only one intellect for all human beings, we find Paul of Venice (d. 1429), who is regarded as the founding figure of Renaissance Averroism, and Alessandro Achillini (1463–1512), as well as the Jewish philosopher Elijah del Medigo (1458–1493). Two other Renaissance Aristotelians who expended much of their philosophical energies on explicating the texts of Averroes are Nicoletto Vernia (d. 1499) and Agostino Nifo (c. 1469–1538). They are noteworthy characters in the Renaissance controversy about the immortality of the soul mainly because of the remarkable shift that can be discerned in their thought. Initially they were defenders of Averroes’s theory of the unity of the intellect, but from loyal followers of Averroes as a guide to Aristotle, they became careful students of the Greek commentators, and in their late thought both Vernia and Nifo attacked Averroes as a misleading interpreter of Aristotle, believing that personal immortality could be philosophically demonstrated.

Many Renaissance Aristotelians read Aristotle for scientific or secular reasons, with no direct interest in religious or theological questions. Pietro Pomponazzi (1462–1525), one of the most important and influential Aristotelian philosophers of the Renaissance, developed his views entirely within the framework of natural philosophy. In De immortalitate animae (Treatise on the Immortality of the Soul, 1516), arguing from the Aristotelian text, Pomponazzi maintained that proof of the intellect’s ability to survive the death of the body must be found in an activity of the intellect that functions without any dependence on the body. In his view, no such activity can be found because the highest activity of the intellect, the attainment of universals in cognition, is always mediated by sense impression. Therefore, based solely on philosophical premises and Aristotelian principles, the conclusion is that the entire soul dies with the body. Pomponazzi’s treatise aroused violent opposition and led to a spate of books being written against him. In 1520, he completed De naturalium effectuum causis sive de incantationibus (On the Causes of Natural Effects or On Incantations), whose main target was the popular belief that miracles are produced by angels and demons. He excluded supernatural explanations from the domain of nature by establishing that it is possible to explain those extraordinary events commonly regarded as miracles in terms of a concatenation of natural causes. Another substantial work is De fato, de libero arbitrio et de praedestinatione (Five Books on Fate, Free Will and Predestination), which is regarded as one of the most important works on the problems of freedom and determinism in the Renaissance. Pomponazzi considers whether the human will can be free, and he considers the conflicting points of view of philosophical determinism and Christian theology.

Another philosopher who tried to keep Aristotle’s authority independent of theology and subject to rational criticism, is Jacopo Zabarella (1533–1589), who produced an extensive body of work on the nature of logic and scientific method. His goal was the retrieval of the genuine Aristotelian concepts of science and scientific method, which he understood as the indisputable demonstration of the nature and constitutive principles of natural beings. He developed the method of regressus, a combination of the deductive procedures of composition and the inductive procedures of resolution that came to be regarded as the proper method for obtaining knowledge in the theoretical sciences. Among his main works are the collected logical works Opera logica (1578), which are mainly devoted to the theory of demonstration, and his major work on natural philosophy, De rebus naturalibus (1590). Zabarella’s work was instrumental in a renewal of natural philosophy, methodology, and theory of knowledge.

There were also forms of Aristotelian philosophy with strong confessional ties, such as the branch of Scholasticism that developed on the Iberian Peninsula during the sixteenth century. This current of Hispanic Scholastic philosophy began with the Dominican School founded in Salamanca by Francisco de Vitoria (1492–1546) and continued with the philosophy of the newly founded Society of Jesus, among whose defining authorities were Pedro da Fonseca (1528–1599), Francisco de Toledo (1533–1596), and Francisco Suárez (1548–1617). Their most important writings were in the areas of metaphysics and philosophy of law. They played a key role in the elaboration of the law of nations (jus gentium) and the theory of just war, a debate that began with Vitoria’s Relectio de iure belli (A Re-lecture of the Right of War, 1539) and continued with the writings of Domingo de Soto (1494–1560), Suárez, and many others. In the field of metaphysics, the most important work is Suárez’ Disputationes metaphysicae (Metaphysical Disputations, 1597), a systematic presentation of philosophy—against the background of Christian principles—that set the standard for philosophical and theological teaching for almost two centuries.

2. Humanism

The humanist movement did not eliminate older approaches to philosophy, but contributed to change them in important ways, providing new information and new methods to the field. Humanists called for a radical change of philosophy and uncovered older texts that multiplied and hardened current philosophical discord. Some of the most salient features of humanist reform are the accurate study of texts in the original languages, the preference for ancient authors and commentators over medieval ones, and the avoidance of technical language in the interest of moral suasion and accessibility. Humanists stressed moral philosophy as the branch of philosophical studies that best met their needs. They addressed a general audience in an accessible manner and aimed to bring about an increase in public and private virtue. Regarding philosophy as a discipline allied to history, rhetoric, and philology, they expressed little interest in metaphysical or epistemological questions. Logic was subordinated to rhetoric and reshaped to serve the purposes of persuasion.

One of the seminal figures of the humanist movement was Francesco Petrarca (1304–1374). In De sui ipsius et multorum aliorum ignorantia (On His Own Ignorance and That of Many Others), he elaborated what was to become the standard critique of Scholastic philosophy. One of his main objections to Scholastic Aristotelianism is that it is useless and ineffective in achieving the good life. Moreover, to cling to a single authority when all authorities are unreliable is simply foolish. He especially attacked, as opponents of Christianity, Aristotle’s commentator Averroes and contemporary Aristotelians that agreed with him. Petrarca returned to a conception of philosophy rooted in the classical tradition, and from his time onward, when professional humanists took interest in philosophy, they nearly always concerned themselves with ethical questions. Among those he influenced were Coluccio Salutati (1331–1406), Leonardo Bruni (c.1370–1444) and Poggio Bracciolini (1380–1459), all of whom promoted humanistic learning in distinctive ways.

One of the most original and important humanists of the Quattrocento was Lorenzo Valla (1406–1457). His most influential writing was Elegantiae linguae Latinae (Elegances of the Latin Language), a handbook of Latin language and style. He is also famous for having demonstrated, on the basis of linguistic and historical evidence, that the so-called Donation of Constantine, on which the secular rule of the papacy was based, was an early medieval forgery. His main philosophical work is Repastinatio dialecticae et philosophiae (Reploughing of Dialectic and Philosophy), an attack on major tenets of Aristotelian philosophy. The first book deals with the criticism of fundamental notions of metaphysics, ethics, and natural philosophy, while the remaining two books are devoted to dialectics.

Throughout the fifteenth and early sixteenth century, humanists were unanimous in their condemnation of university education and their contempt for Scholastic logic. Humanists such as Valla and Rudolph Agricola (1443–1485), whose main work is De inventione dialectica (On Dialectical Invention, 1479), set about to replace the Scholastic curriculum, based on syllogism and disputation, with a treatment of logic oriented toward the use of persuasion and topics, a technique of verbal association aiming at the invention and organization of material for arguments. According to Valla and Agricola, language is primarily a vehicle for communication and debate, and consequently arguments should be evaluated in terms of how effective and useful they are rather than in terms of formal validity. Accordingly, they subsumed the study of the Aristotelian theory of inference under a broader range of forms of argumentation. This approach was taken up and developed in various directions by later humanists, such as Mario Nizolio (1488–1567), Juan Luis Vives (1493–1540), and Petrus Ramus (1515–1572).

Vives was a Spanish-born humanist who spent the greater part of his life in the Low Countries. He aspired to replace the Scholastic tradition in all fields of learning with a humanist curriculum inspired by education in the classics. In 1519, he published In Pseudodialecticos (Against the Pseudodialecticians), a satirical diatribe against Scholastic logic in which he voices his opposition on several counts. A detailed criticism can be found in De disciplinis (On the Disciplines, 1531), an encyclopedic work divided into three parts: De causis corruptarum artium (On the Causes of the Corruption of the Arts), a collection of seven books devoted to a thorough critique of the foundations of contemporary education; De tradendis disciplinis (On Handing Down the Disciplines), five books where Vives’s educational reform is outlined; and De artibus (On the Arts), five shorter treatises that deal mainly with logic and metaphysics. Another area in which Vives enjoyed considerable success was psychology. His reflections on the human soul are mainly concentrated in De anima et vita (On the Soul and Life, 1538), a study of the soul and its interaction with the body, which also contains a penetrating analysis of the emotions.

Ramus was another humanist who criticized the shortcomings of contemporary teaching and advocated a humanist reform of the arts curriculum. His textbooks were the best sellers of their day and were very influential in Protestant universities  in the later sixteenth century. In 1543, he published Dialecticae partitiones (The Structure of Dialectic), which in its second edition was called Dialecticae institutiones (Training in Dialectic), and Aristotelicae animadversions (Remarks on Aristotle). These works gained him a reputation as a virulent opponent of Aristotelian philosophy. He considered his own dialectics, consisting of invention and judgment, to be applicable to all areas of knowledge, and he emphasised the need for learning to be comprehensible and useful, with a particular stress on the practical aspects of mathematics. His own reformed system of logic reached its definitive form with the publication of the third edition of Dialectique (1555).

Humanism also supported Christian reform. The most important Christian humanist was the Dutch scholar Desiderius Erasmus (c.1466–1536). He was hostile to Scholasticism, which he did not consider a proper basis for Christian life, and put his erudition at the service of religion by promoting learned piety (docta pietas). In 1503, he published Enchiridion militis christiani (Handbook of the Christian Soldier), a guide to the Christian life addressed to laymen in need of spiritual guidance, in which he developed the concept of a philosophia Christi. His most famous work is Moriae encomium (The Praise of Folly), a satirical monologue first published in 1511 that touches upon a variety of social, political, intellectual, and religious issues. In 1524, he published De libero arbitrio (On Free Will), an open attack a one central doctrine of Martin Luther’s theology: that the human will is enslaved by sin. Erasmus’s analysis hinges on the interpretation of relevant biblical and patristic passages and reaches the conclusion that the human will is extremely weak, but able, with the help of divine grace, to choose the path of salvation.

Humanism also had an impact of overwhelming importance on the development of political thought. With Institutio principis christiani (The Education of a Christian Prince, 1516), Erasmus contributed to the popular genre of humanist advice books for princes. These manuals dealt with the proper ends of government and how best to attain them. Among humanists of the fourteenth century, the most usual proposal was that a strong monarchy should be the best form of government. Petrarca, in his account of princely government that was written in 1373 and took the form of a letter to Francesco da Carrara, argued that cities ought to be governed by princes who accept their office reluctantly and who pursue glory through virtuous actions. His views were repeated in quite a few of the numerous “mirror for princes” (speculum principis) composed during the course of the fifteenth century, such as Giovanni Pontano’s De principe (On the Prince, 1468) and Bartolomeo Sacchi’s De principe (On the Prince, 1471).

Several authors exploited the tensions within the genre of “mirror for princes” in order to defend popular regimes. In Laudatio florentinae urbis (Panegyric of the City of Florence), Bruni maintained that justice can only be assured by a republican constitution. In his view, cities must be governed according to justice if they are to become glorious, and justice is impossible without liberty.

The most important text to challenge the assumptions of princely humanism, however, was Il principe (The Prince), written by the Florentine Niccolò Machiavelli (1469–1527) in 1513, but not published until 1532. A fundamental belief among the humanists was that a ruler needs to cultivate a number of qualities, such as justice and other moral values, in order to acquire honour, glory, and fame. Machiavelli deviated from this view claiming that justice has no decisive place in politics. It is the ruler’s prerogative to decide when to dispense violence and practice deception, no matter how wicked or immoral, as long as the peace of the city is maintained and his share of glory maximized. Machiavelli did not hold that princely regimes were superior to all others. In his less famous, but equally influential, Discorsi sopra la prima deca di Tito Livio (Discourses on the First Ten Books of Titus Livy, 1531), he offers a defense of popular liberty and republican government that takes the ancient republic of Rome as its model.

3. Platonism

During the Renaissance, it gradually became possible to take a broader view of philosophy than the traditional Peripatetic framework permitted. No ancient revival had more impact on the history of philosophy than the recovery of Platonism. The rich doctrinal content and formal elegance of Platonism made it a plausible competitor of the Peripatetic tradition. Renaissance Platonism was a product of humanism and marked a sharper break with medieval philosophy. Many Christians found Platonic philosophy safer and more attractive than Aristotelianism. The Neoplatonic conception of philosophy as a way toward union with God supplied many Renaissance Platonists with some of their richest inspiration. The Platonic dialogues were not seen as profane texts to be understood literally, but as sacred mysteries to be deciphered.

Platonism was brought to Italy by the Byzantine scholar George Gemistos Plethon (c.1360–1454), who, during the Council of Florence in 1439, gave a series of lectures that he later reshaped as De differentiis Aristotelis et Platonis (The Differences between Aristotle and Plato). This work, which compared the doctrines of the two philosophers (to Aristotle’s great disadvantage), initiated a controversy regarding the relative superiority of Plato and Aristotle. In the treatise In calumniatorem Platonis (Against the Calumniator of Plato), Cardinal Bessarion (1403–1472) defended Plethon against the charge levelled against his philosophy by the Aristotelian George of Trebizond (1396–1472), who in Comparatio philosophorum Aristotelis et Platonis (A Comparison of the Philosophers Aristotle and Plato) had maintained that Platonism was unchristian and actually a new religion.

The most important Renaissance Platonist was Marsilio Ficino (1433–1499), who translated Plato’s works into Latin and wrote commentaries on several of them. He also translated and commented on Plotinus’s Enneads and translated treatises and commentaries by Porphyry, Iamblichus, Proclus, Synesius, and other Neoplatonists. He considered Plato as part of a long tradition of ancient theology (prisca theologia) that was inaugurated by Hermes and Zoroaster, culminated with Plato, and continued with Plotinus and the other Neoplatonists. Like the ancient Neoplatonists, Ficino assimilated Aristotelian physics and metaphysics and adapted them to Platonic purposes. In his main philosophical treatise, Theologia Platonica de immortalitate animorum (Platonic Theology on the Immortality of Souls, 1482), he put forward his synthesis of Platonism and Christianity as a new theology and metaphysics, which, unlike that of many Scholastics, was explicitly opposed to Averroist secularism. Another work that became very popular was De vita libri tres (Three Books on Life, 1489) by Ficino; it deals with the health of professional scholars and presents a philosophical theory of natural magic.

One of Ficino’s most distinguished associates was Giovanni Pico della Mirandola (1463–1494). He is best known as the author of the celebrated Oratio de hominis dignitate (Oration on the Dignity of Man), which is often regarded as the manifesto of the new Renaissance thinking, but he also wrote several other prominent works. They include Disputationes adversus astrologiam divinatricem (Disputations against Divinatory Astrology), an influential diatribe against astrology; De ente et uno (On Being and the One), a short treatise attempting to reconcile Platonic and Aristotelian metaphysical views; as well as Heptaplus (Seven Days of Creation), a mystical interpretation of the Genesis creation myth. He was not a devout Neoplatonist like Ficino, but rather an Aristotelian by training and in many ways an eclectic by conviction. He wanted to combine Greek, Hebrew, Muslim, and Christian thought into a great synthesis, which he spelled out in nine hundred theses published as Conclusiones in 1486. He planned to defend them publicly in Rome, but three were found heretical and ten others suspect. He defended them in Apologia, which provoked the condemnation of the whole work by Pope Innocent VIII. Pico’s consistent aim in his writings was to exalt the powers of human nature. To this end he defended the use of magic, which he described as the noblest part of natural science, and Kabbalah, a Jewish form of mysticism that was probably of Neoplatonic origin.

Platonic themes were also central to the thought of Nicholas of Cusa (1401–1464), who linked his philosophical activity to the Neoplatonic tradition and authors such as Proclus and Pseudo-Dionysius. The main problem that runs through his works is how humans, as finite created beings, can think about the infinite and transcendent God. His best-known work is De docta ignorantia (On Learned Ignorance, 1440), which gives expression to his view that the human mind needs to realize its own necessary ignorance of what God is like, an ignorance that results from the ontological and cognitive disproportion between God and the finite human knower. Correlated to the doctrine of learned ignorance is that of the coincidence of opposites in God. All things coincide in God in the sense that God, as undifferentiated being, is beyond all opposition. Two other works that are closely connected to De docta ignorantia are De coniecturis (On Conjectures), in which he denies the possibility of exact knowledge, maintaining that all human knowledge is conjectural, and Apologia docta ignorantiae (A Defense of Learned Ignorance, 1449). In the latter, he makes clear that the doctrine of learned ignorance is not intended to deny knowledge of the existence of God, but only to deny all knowledge of God’s nature.

One of the most serious obstacles to the reception and adoption of Platonism in the early fifteenth century was the theory of Platonic love. Many scholars were simply unable to accept Plato’s explicit treatment of homosexuality. Yet by the middle of the sixteenth century this doctrine had become one of the most popular elements of Platonic philosophy. The transformation of Platonic love from an immoral and offensive liability into a valuable asset represents an important episode in the history of Plato’s re-emergence during the Renaissance as a major influence on Western thought.

Bessarion and Ficino did not deny that Platonic love was essentially homosexual in outlook, but they insisted that it was entirely honourable and chaste. To reinforce this point, they associated Platonic discussions of love with those found in the Bible. Another way in which Ficino made Platonic love more palatable to his contemporaries was to emphasise its place within an elaborate system of Neoplatonic metaphysics. But Ficino’s efforts to accommodate the theory to the values of a fifteenth-century audience did not include concealing or denying that Platonic love was homoerotic. Ficino completely accepted the idea that Platonic love involved a chaste relationship between men and endorsed the belief that the soul’s spiritual ascent to ultimate beauty was fuelled by love between men.

In Gli Asolani (1505), the humanist Pietro Bembo (1470–1547) appropriated the language of Platonic love to describe some aspects of the romance between a man and a woman. In this work, love was presented as unequivocally heterosexual. Most of the ideas set out by Ficino are echoed by Bembo. However, Ficino had separated physical love, which had women as its object, from spiritual love, which was shared between men. Bembo’s version of Platonic love, on the other hand, dealt with the relationship between a man and a woman which gradually progresses from a sexual to a spiritual level. The view of Platonic love formulated by Bembo reached its largest audience with the humanist Baldesar Castiglione’s (1478–1529) Il libro del cortegiano (The Courtier, 1528). Castiglione carried on the trend, initiated by Bessarion, of giving Platonic love a strongly religious coloring, and most of the philosophical content is taken from Ficino.

One of the most popular Renaissance treatises on love, Dialoghi d’amore (Dialogues of Love, 1535), was written by the Jewish philosopher Judah ben Isaac Abravanel, also known as Leone Ebreo (c.1460/5–c.1520/5). The work consists of three conversations on love, which he conceives of as the animating principle of the universe and the cause of all existence, divine as well as material. The first dialogue discusses the relation between love and desire; the second the universality of love; and the third, which provides the longest and most sustained philosophical discussion, the origin of love. He draws upon Platonic and Neoplatonic sources, as well as on the cosmology and metaphysics of Jewish and Arabic thinkers, which are combined with Aristotelian sources in order to produce a synthesis of Aristotelian and Platonic views.

4. Hellenistic Philosophies

Stoicism, Epicureanism, and Skepticism underwent a revival over the course of the fifteenth and sixteenth centuries as part of the ongoing recovery of ancient literature and thought. The revival of Stoicism began with Petrarca, whose renewal of Stoicism moved along two paths. The first one was inspired by Seneca and consisted in the presentation, in works such as De vita solitaria (The Life of Solitude) and De otio religioso (On Religious Leisure), of a way of life in which the cultivation of the scholarly work and ethical perfection are one. The second was his elaboration of Stoic therapy against emotional distress in De secreto conflictu curarum mearum (On the Secret Conflict of My Worries), an inner dialogue of the sort prescribed by Cicero and Seneca, and in De remediis utriusque fortunae (Remedies for Good and Bad Fortune, 1366), a huge compendium based on a short apocryphal tract attributed at the time to Seneca.

While many humanists shared Petrarca’s esteem for Stoic moral philosophy, others called its stern prescriptions into question. They accused the Stoics of suppressing all emotions and criticized their view for its inhuman rigidity. In contrast to the extreme ethical stance of the Stoics, they preferred the more moderate Peripatetic position, arguing that it provides a more realistic basis for morality, since it places the acquisition of virtue within the reach of normal human capacities. Another Stoic doctrine that was often criticized on religious grounds was the conviction that the wise man is entirely responsible for his own happiness and has no need of divine assistance.

The most important exponent of Stoicism during the Renaissance was the Flemish humanist Justus Lipsius (1547–1606), who worked hard to brighten the appeal of Stoicism to Christians. His first Neostoic work was De constantia (On Constancy, 1584), in which he promoted Stoic moral philosophy as a refuge from the horrors of the civil and religious wars that ravaged the continent at the time. His main accounts of Stoicism were Physiologia Stoicorum (Physical Theory of the Stoics) and Manuductio ad stoicam philosophiam (Guide to Stoic Philosophy), both published in 1604. Together they constituted the most learned account of Stoic philosophy produced since antiquity.

During the Middle Ages, Epicureanism was associated with contemptible atheism and hedonist dissipation. In 1417, Bracciolini found Lucretius’s poem De rerum natura, the most informative source on Epicurean teaching, which, together with Ambrogio Traversari’s translation of Diogenes Laertius’s Life of Epicurus into Latin, contributed to a more discriminating appraisal of Epicurean doctrine and a repudiation of the traditional prejudice against the person of Epicurus himself. In a letter written in 1428, Francesco Filelfo (1398–1481) insisted that, contrary to popular opinion, Epicurus was not “addicted to pleasure, lewd and lascivious,” but rather “sober, learned and venerable.” In the epistolary treatise Defensio Epicuri contra Stoicos, Academicos et Peripateticos (Defense of Epicurus against Stoics, Academics and Peripatetics), Cosma Raimondi (d. 1436) vigorously defended Epicurus and the view that the supreme good consists in pleasure both of the mind and the body. He argued that pleasure, according to Epicurus, is not opposed to virtue, but both guided and produced by it. Some humanists tried to harmonize Epicurean with Christian doctrine. In his dialogue De voluptate (On Pleasure, 1431), which was two years later reworked as De vero falsoque bono (On the True and False Good), Valla examined Stoic, Epicurean, and Christian conceptions of the true good. To the ultimate good of the Stoics, that is, virtue practiced for its own sake, Valla opposed that of the Epicureans, represented by pleasure, on the grounds that pleasure comes closer to Christian happiness, which is superior to either pagan ideal.

The revival of ancient philosophy was particularly dramatic in the case of Skepticism, whose revitalisation grew out of many of the currents of Renaissance thought and contributed to make the problem of knowledge crucial for early modern philosophy. The major ancient texts stating the Skeptical arguments were slightly known in the Middle Ages. It was in the fifteenth and sixteenth century that Sextus Empiricus’s Outlines of Pyrrhonism and Against the Mathematicians, Cicero’s Academica, and Diogenes Laertius’s Life of Pyrrho started to receive serious philosophical consideration.

The most significant and influential figure in the development of Renaissance Skepticism is Michel de Montaigne (1533–1592). The most thorough presentation of his Skeptical views occurs in Apologie de Raimond Sebond (Apology for Raymond Sebond), the longest and most philosophical of his essays. In it, he developed in a gradual manner the many kinds of problems that make people doubt the reliability of human reason. He considered in detail the ancient Skeptical arguments about the unreliability of information gained by the senses or by reason, about the inability of human beings to find a satisfactory criterion of knowledge, and about the relativity of moral opinions. He concluded that people should suspend judgment on all matters and follow customs and traditions. He combined these conclusions with fideism.

Many Renaissance appropriators of Academic and Pyrrhonian Skeptical arguments did not see any intrinsic value in Skepticism, but rather used it to attack Aristotelianism and disparage the claims of human science. They challenged the intellectual foundations of medieval Scholastic learning by raising serious questions about the nature of truth and about the ability of humans to discover it. In Examen vanitatis doctrinae gentium et veritatis Christianae disciplinae (Examination of the Vanity of Pagan Doctrine and of the Truth of Christian Teaching, 1520), Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola (1469–1533) set out to prove the futility of pagan doctrine and the truth of Christianity. He regarded Skepticism as ideally suited to his campaign, since it challenged the possibility of attaining certain knowledge by means of the senses or by reason, but left the scriptures, grounded in divine revelation, untouched. In the first part of the work, he used the Skeptical arguments contained in the works of Sextus Empiricus against the various schools of ancient philosophy; and in the second part he turned Skepticism against Aristotle and the Peripatetic tradition. His aim was not to call everything into doubt, but rather to discredit every source of knowledge except scripture and condemn all attempts to find truth elsewhere as vain.

In a similar way, Agrippa von Nettesheim (1486–1535), whose real name was Heinrich Cornelius, demonstrated in De incertitudine et vanitate scientiarum atque artium (On the Uncertainty and Vanity of the Arts and Sciences, 1530) the contradictions of scientific doctrines. With stylistic brilliance, he described the controversies of the established academic community and dismissed all academic endeavors in view of the finitude of human experience, which in his view comes to rest only in faith.

The fame of the Portuguese philosopher and medical writer Francisco Sanches (1551–1623) rests mainly on Quod nihil scitur (That Nothing Is Known, 1581), one of the best systematic expositions of philosophical Skepticism produced during the sixteenth century. The treatise contains a radical criticism of the Aristotelian notion of science, but beside its critical aim, it had a constructive objective, which posterity has tended to neglect, consisting in Sanches’s quest for a new method of philosophical and scientific inquiry that could be universally applied. This method was supposed to be expounded in another book that was either lost, remained unpublished, or was not written at all.

5. New Philosophies of Nature

In 1543, Nicolaus Copernicus (1473–1543) published De revolutionibus orbium coelestium (On the Revolutions of the Heavenly Spheres), which proposed a new calculus of planetary motion based on several new hypotheses, such as heliocentrism and the motion of the earth. The first generation of readers underestimated the revolutionary character of the work and regarded the hypotheses of the work only as useful mathematical fictions. The result was that astronomers appreciated and adopted some of Copernicus’s mathematical models but rejected his cosmology. Yet, the Aristotelian representation of the universe did not remain unchallenged and new visions of nature, its principles, and its mode of operation started to emerge.

During the sixteenth century, there were many philosophers of nature who felt that Aristotle’s system could no longer regulate honest inquiry into nature. Therefore, they stopped trying to adjust the Aristotelian system and turned their backs on it altogether. It is hard to imagine how early modern philosophers, such as Francis Bacon (1561–1626), Pierre Gassendi (1592–1655,) and René Descartes (1596–1650), could have cleared the ground for the scientific revolution without the work of novatores such as Bernardino Telesio (1509–1588), Francesco Patrizi (1529–1597), Giordano Bruno (1548–1600), and Tommaso Campanella (1568–1639).

Telesio grounded his system on a form of empiricism, which maintained that nature can only be understood through sense perception and empirical research. In 1586, two years before his death, he published the definitive version of his work De rerum natura iuxta propria principia (On the Nature of Things according to their Own Principles). The book is a frontal assault on the foundations of Peripatetic philosophy, accompanied by a proposal for replacing Aristotelianism with a system more faithful to nature and experience. According to Telesio, the only things that must be presupposed are passive matter and the two principles of heat and cold, which are in perpetual struggle to occupy matter and exclude their opposite. These principles were meant to replace the Aristotelian metaphysical principles of matter and form. Some of Telesio’s innovations were seen as theologically dangerous and his philosophy became the object of vigorous attacks. De rerum natura iuxta propria principia was included on the Index of Prohibited Books published in Rome in 1596.

Through the reading of Telesio’s work, Campanella developed a profound distaste for Aristotelian philosophy and embraced the idea that nature should be explained through its own principles. He rejected the fundamental Aristotelian principle of hylomorphism and adopted instead Telesio’s understanding of reality in terms of the principles of matter, heat, and cold, which he combined with Neoplatonic ideas derived from Ficino. His first published work was Philosophia sensibus demonstrata (Philosophy as Demonstrated by the Senses, 1591), an anti-Peripatetic polemic in defense of Telesio’s system of natural philosophy. Thereafter, he was censured, tortured, and repeatedly imprisoned for his heresies. During the years of his incarceration, he composed many of his most famous works, such as De sensu rerum et magia (On the Sense of Things and On Magic, 1620), which sets out his vision of the natural world as a living organism and displays his keen interest in natural magic; Ateismus triomphatus (Atheism Conquered), a polemic against both reason of state and Machiavelli’s conception of religion as a political invention; and Apologia pro Galileo (Defense of Galileo), a defense of the freedom of thought (libertas philosophandi) of Galileo and of Christian scientists in general. Campanella’s most ambitious work is Metaphysica (1638), which constitutes the most comprehensive presentation of his philosophy and whose aim is to produce a new foundation for the entire encyclopedia of knowledge. His most celebrated work is the utopian treatise La città del sole (The City of the Sun), which describes an ideal model of society that, in contrast to the violence and disorder of the real world, is in harmony with nature.

In contrast to Telesio, who was a fervent critic of metaphysics and insisted on a purely empiricist approach in natural philosophy, Patrizi developed a program in which natural philosophy and cosmology were connected with their metaphysical and theological foundations. His Discussiones peripateticae (Peripatetic Discussions) provides a close comparison of the views of Aristotle and Plato on a wide range of philosophical issues, arguing that Plato’s views are preferable on all counts. Inspired by such Platonic predecessors as Proclus and Ficino, Patrizi elaborated his own philosophical system in Nova de universalis philosophia (The New Universal Philosophy, 1591), which is divided in four parts: Panaugia, Panarchia, Pampsychia, and Pancosmia. He saw light as the basic metaphysical principle and interpreted the universe in terms of the diffusion of light. The fourth and last part of the work, in which he expounded his cosmology showing how the physical world derives its existence from God, is by far the most original and important. In it, he replaced the four Aristotelian elements with his own alternatives: space, light, heat, and humidity. Gassendi and Henry More (1614–1687) adopted his concept of space, which indirectly came to influence Newton.

A more radical cosmology was proposed by Bruno, who was an extremely prolific writer. His most significant works include those on the art of memory and the combinatory method of Ramon Llull, as well as the moral dialogues Spaccio de la bestia trionfante (The Expulsion of the Triumphant Beast, 1584), Cabala del cavallo pegaseo (The Kabbalah of the Pegasean Horse, 1585) and De gl’heroici furori (The Heroic Frenzies, 1585). Much of his fame rests on three cosmological dialogues published in 1584: La cena de le ceneri (The Ash Wednesday Supper), De la causa, principio et uno (On the Cause, the Principle and the One) and De l’infinito, universo et mondi (On the Infinite, the Universe and the Worlds). In these, with inspiration from Lucretius, the Neoplatonists, and, above all, Nicholas of Cusa, he elaborates a coherent and strongly articulated ontological monism. Individual beings are conceived as accidents or modes of a unique substance, that is, the universe, which he describes as an animate and infinitely extended unity containing innumerable worlds. Bruno adhered to Copernicus’s cosmology but transformed it, postulating an infinite universe. Although an infinite universe was by no means his invention, he was the first to locate a heliocentric system in infinite space. In 1600, he was burned at the stake by the Inquisition for his heretical teachings.

Even though these new philosophies of nature anticipated some of the defining features of early modern thought, many of their methodological characteristics appeared to be inadequate in the face of new scientific developments. The methodology of Galileo Galilei (1564–1642) and of the other pioneers of the new science was essentially mathematical. Moreover, the development of the new science took place by means of methodical observations and experiments, such as Galileo’s telescopic discoveries and his experiments on inclined planes. The critique of Aristotle’s teaching formulated by natural philosophers such as Telesio, Campanella, Patrizi, and Bruno undoubtedly helped to weaken it, but it was the new philosophy of the early seventeenth century that sealed the fate of the Aristotelian worldview and set the tone for a new age.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Allen, M. J. B., & Rees, V., eds., Marsilio Ficino: His Theology, his Philosophy, his Legacy (Leiden: Brill, 2002).
  • Bellitto, C., & al., eds., Introducing Nicholas of Cusa: A Guide to a Renaissance Man (New York: Paulist Press, 2004).
  • Bianchi, L., Studi sull’aristotelismo del Rinascimento (Padua: Il Poligrafo, 2003).
  • Blum, P. R., ed., Philosophers of the Renaissance (Washington, D.C.: The Catholic University of America Press, 2010).
  • Copenhaver, B. P., & Schmitt, C. B., Renaissance Philosophy (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1992).
  • Damiens, S., Amour et Intellect chez Leon l’Hébreu (Toulouse: Edouard Privat Editeur, 1971).
  • Dougherty, M. V., ed., Pico della Mirandola: New Essays (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2008).
  • Ernst, G., Tommaso Campanella: The Book and the Body of Nature, transl. D. Marshall (Dordrecht: Springer, 2010).
  • Fantazzi, C., ed., A Companion to Juan Luis Vives (Leiden: Brill, 2008).
  • Gatti, H., ed., Giordano Bruno: Philosopher of the Renaissance (Aldershot: Ashgate, 2002).
  • Granada, M. A., La reivindicación de la filosofía en Giordano Bruno (Barcelona: Herder, 2005).
  • Guerlac, R., Juan Luis Vives against the Pseudodialecticians: A Humanist Attack on Medieval Logic (Dordrecht: Reidel, 1979).
  • Hankins, J., Plato in the Italian Renaissance, 2 vols. (Leiden: Brill, 1990).
  • Hankins, J., Humanism and Platonism in the Italian Renaissance, 2 vols. (Rome: Edizioni di storia e letteratura, 2003–4).
  • Hankins, J., ed., The Cambridge Companion to Renaissance Philosophy (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2007).
  • Headley, J. M., Tommaso Campanella and the Transformation of the World (Princeton, N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1997).
  • Kraye, J., Classical Traditions in Renaissance Philosophy (Aldershot: Ashgate, 2002).
  • Mack, P., Renaissance Argument: Valla and Agricola in the Traditions of Rhetoric and Dialectic (Leiden: Brill, 1993).
  • Mahoney, E. P., Two Aristotelians of the Italian Renaissance: Nicoletto Vernia and Agostino Nifo (Aldershot: Ashgate, 2000).
  • Mikkeli, H., An Aristotelian Response to Renaissance Humanism: Jacopo Zabarella on the Nature of Arts and Sciences (Helsinki: Societas Historica Finlandiae, 1992).
  • Nauert, C. A., Agrippa and the Crisis of Renaissance Thought (Urbana: University of Illinois Press, 1965).
  • Nauta, L., In Defense of Common Sense: Lorenzo Valla’s Humanist Critique of Scholastic Philosophy (Cambridge, MA.: Harvard University Press, 2009).
  • Noreña, C. G., Juan Luis Vives (The Hague: Nijhoff, 1970).
  • Ong, W. J., Ramus: Method and the Decay of Dialogue (Cambridge, MA.: Harvard University Press).
  • Paganini, G., & Maia Neto, J. R., eds., Renaissance Scepticisms (Dordrecht: Springer, 2009).
  • Pine, M. L., Pietro Pomponazzi: Radical Philosopher of the Renaissance (Padova: Antenore, 1986).
  • Popkin, R. H., The History of Scepticism from Savonarola to Bayle (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2003).
  • Rummel, E., The Humanist-Scholastic Debate in the Renaissance and Reformation (Cambridge, MA.: Harvard University Press, 1995).
  • Schmitt, C. B., Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola (1469–1533) and His Critique of Aristotle (The Hague: Nijhoff, 1967).
  • Schmitt, C. B., Cicero Scepticus: A Study of the Influence of the Academica in the Renaissance (The Hague: Nijhoff, 1972).
  • Schmitt, C. B., Aristotle and the Renaissance (Cambridge, MA.: Harvard University Press, 1983).
  • Schmitt, C. B., & al., eds., The Cambridge History of Renaissance Philosophy (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988).
  • Skinner, Q., The Foundations of Modern Political Thought, vol. 1, The Renaissance (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1978).
  • Yates, F. A., Giordano Bruno and the Hermetic Tradition (London: Rouledge & Kegan Paul, 1964).

Author Information

Lorenzo Casini
Email: lorenzo.casini@filosofi.uu.se
Uppsala University
Sweden

Pluralist Theories of Truth

Truth pluralism (or ‘alethic’ pluralism) is a view about the nature of truth. Broadly speaking, the thought behind the view is that truth may require different treatments for different kinds of subject matter. In particular, there is the prospect for it to be consistent to conceive of truth in a realist manner for discourse about the material world, while maintaining an anti-realist notion of truth for discourse about subjects that are perhaps more mind-dependent in character, such as discourse about ethics or comedy. Contemporary pluralist theories of truth have their roots in William James’s pragmatism. The literature on truth pluralism is expanding rapidly; new avenues of research on the subject are constantly being explored. This article introduces the central motivations, frameworks, and problems for the view which have preoccupied much of the discussion to date in contemporary analytic philosophy. Part 1 gives a brief history of some of the main inspirations behind the views outlined in contemporary debates. Part 2 goes through some preliminary issues. Part 3 outlines one of the main motivations for truth pluralism. Part 4 details the main formulations of the view that have been offered, and discusses the problems each formulation faces. Finally, Part 5 discusses some concerns about the general approach of the view.

Table of Contents

  1. A Brief History of Truth Pluralism
  2. Truth Pluralism Preliminaries
  3. Motivations for Truth Pluralism
  4. Forms of Truth Pluralism
    1. Simple Alethic Pluralism
      1. The Problem of Mixed Inferences (Form 1)
      2. The Problem of Mixed Compounds (Form 1)
      3. Norm of Inquiry
      4. Generalizations
    2. One Concept Many Properties
      1. The Problem of Mixed Inferences (Form 2)
      2. The Problem of Mixed Compounds (Form 2)
      3. Norm of Inquiry
      4. Generalizations
    3. Second-Order Functionalism
    4. Manifestation Functionalism
    5. Disjunctivism and Simple Determination Pluralism
  5. General Issues
    1. The Problem of Domain Individuation
    2. The Demandingness Objection
    3. Problems with Platitudes
    4. The Deflationary Challenge
  6. References and Further Reading

1. A Brief History of Truth Pluralism

The majority of this article is focused on a contemporary debate in analytical philosophy, but, of course, debates about the nature of truth are long-established in the history of philosophy, and in a variety of philosophical traditions. Some of the more prominent theories are correspondence theories, coherence theories, pragmatist theories, identity theories, and deflationary theories, and there are of course a number of different varieties of each of these views (for more information on these theories, see the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy article on Truth).

Contemporary pluralist theories of truth have their roots in William James’s pragmatism (though he himself disliked the name), which is outlined most prominently in his collection of lectures entitled Pragmatism, first published in 1907. James himself took true beliefs to be those beliefs that served some useful purpose, but recognised that there are many different ways that beliefs can be useful, often depending on the kinds of things the beliefs were about, with observational beliefs, moral beliefs, and mathematical beliefs, being just a few examples. Moreover, James noted that what made these different kinds of beliefs useful might vary from case to case. For instance, for observational beliefs we might think that their utility is established by their being verified, for mathematical beliefs by being capable of being proved, and for moral beliefs by cohering with other moral beliefs we have. Thus, although James held the general pragmatist thesis that for a belief to be true is for it to be useful:

Our account of truth is an account of truths in the plural…having only this quality in common: that they pay. (James 1975: 104)

He also held that there were various different ways in which beliefs could be useful:

To copy a reality is, indeed, one way of agreeing with it, but it is by no means essential. (James 1975: 102)

The spirit of James’s approach was built on in the mid-20th Century by Michael Dummett, who, in his famous 1959 essay ‘Truth’, very much echoed James when he wrote:

The question is not whether [“true” and “false”] are in practice applied to ethical statements, but whether, if they are so applied, the point of doing so would be the same as the point of applying them to statements of other kinds, and, if not, in what ways it would be different. (Dummett 1978: 3)

Perhaps the first explicit statement of the kind of pluralism found in contemporary debates is given by Alan White in his 1957 essay, “Truth as Appraisal”. Like James, White held that there is some unity to the use of the word true, but he instead holds that this unity is supplied by the term’s use as a term of appraisal, as a way to commend a particular statement. White held a ‘dual-aspect’ theory of truth, which held that this appraisal-aspect is combined with a descriptive aspect, which states the criteria for establishing when the term ‘true’ is used correctly. White then argued that these criteria vary according to the subject matter of the statement, holding that different ‘theories’ of truth, such as correspondence theory and coherence theory are apt to give the criteria for the correct use of ‘true’ in different cases.

With the rise of deflationary theories of truth in the mid to late 20th Century, James and White’s observations received perhaps less attention than they deserved. The general project of truth pluralism was revitalized, however, by the publication of Crispin Wright’s 1992 book Truth and Objectivity, which aimed to place a broadly pluralist account of truth at the heart of a new method of understanding debates about realism and anti-realism. Wright’s book had significant influence in a number of different areas of philosophy, and provoked considerable debate. In the 21st Century, Michael P. Lynch, along with Crispin Wright, has further developed the project of truth pluralism, and his 2009 book Truth as One and Many is the most comprehensive single study of truth pluralism and its potential implications to date. As we will see below, there are many different ways to understand the exact specification of truth pluralism, but before we approach these it will be useful to try to get to the heart of what drives each of these views, and to clarify some of the terminology commonly used.

2. Truth Pluralism Preliminaries

The basic idea behind all forms of truth pluralism is that the analysis of truth may require different treatment for different kinds of subject matter. This idea is normally spelled out using the notion of a domain of discourse (or region of thought). This is a formalization of the idea that human thought and discourse can be about a large number of different subjects. For instance, we may debate about whether a particular joke is funny, whether an action is morally wrong, whether the earth goes around the sun, or whether there is a largest prime number. The thought is that these debates concern very different things, and this needs to be taken into account when we come to analyse the claims made in them.

The truth pluralist draws upon these intuitive distinctions when it comes to the matter of investigating the nature of truth. As we will see below, truth pluralists have reason to think that there are important things to be said about the nature of truth, but typically – at least at some stage of the theory – hold that the question of what needs to be said is addressed on a domain-by-domain basis. That is, they are unhappy with the thought that we can give an account of the nature of truth without taking into account the subject-matter of the claims of which truth is predicated. A full account of the nature of truth, on the pluralist view, will need to look at truth in a specific domain, as opposed to (or as well as) what constitutes truth per se.

Before moving on to the motivations for truth pluralism, and the various forms of the view, it is worth briefly pausing to note some distinctions which are important in the truth pluralism literature. These distinctions are between the truth predicate, the truth concept, and the truth property. The truth predicate, typically taking the form ‘is true’ is the linguistic entity appended to certain sentences, as in “‘snow is white” is true’. One who competently uses the words ‘true’ and ‘truth’ can be said to possess the concept of truth, and an analysis of the concept of truth will aim to uncover what those conditions of competent use consist in. The property of truth is what is ascribed by the truth predicate.

To get clearer on these distinctions, consider the following analogy with water (this analogy is originally due to Alston (1996), and is also emphasised by Wright (2001) and Lynch (2009)). We have the predicate ‘is water’, which we use to say of a certain substance that it is water (for example, ‘the liquid in the bottle is water’). We also have the concept of water, that any competent user of the term ‘water’ understands (for example, that water is a clear, colourless, tasteless liquid, that it comes out of taps, and runs through rivers and streams). We also have the property of being water, which is what the stuff that corresponds to the concept, and is referred to by the predicate, consists in. Scientific discoveries have deemed the property of water to be identical to the property of being H2O, and this tells us what the nature of water is. In the water case, then, the system works as follows. We have the water predicate, which is used to ascribe a particular property – being water – to particular substances. Competent users of the water predicate will be said to possess the concept of water, and this concept demarcates a kind of worldly substance. The property of water captures the essence of this worldly substance (H­2O). Note also that it is not a condition on competent users of the concept that they be aware of the nature of the property (as indeed was not the case before the discovery of water as H2O): possessing the concept does not necessarily require possessing knowledge of the essence of the property.

Most of the investigations into the nature of truth concern the essence of the truth property. However, as we will see, in the story of truth pluralism, the concept of truth has an important role to play. (For more on the concept/property distinction in this context, and how the nature of the truth property may not be transparent from the truth concept, see Alston 2002.)

It is also worth saying a little about truth-bearers before we progress. There are a number of different things that philosophers have taken to be the bearers of truth, with beliefs, statements, sentences, utterances of sentences, and propositions to be perhaps the most prominent examples. One form of truth pluralism would perhaps be a view which held that all of these potential bearers are genuine truth-bearers, and that there are different kinds of truth appropriate to each bearer. This would be an interesting kind of truth pluralism, though it is not a view which seems to necessarily share the same motivations as the views discussed here. For the purposes of this article, we will follow the majority of truth pluralists in holding that it is propositions that are the primary bearers of truth, and when we speak of sentences, utterances, or beliefs as being true it is in the sense that they express a proposition that is true.

3. Motivations for Truth Pluralism

Correspondence theories of truth may appear to be intuitively attractive: they promise to make truth a matter of a relation between linguistic or mental entities and the separate objects and properties that they purport to represent. However, subscribing to such a view about truth for a particular domain of discourse carries with it significant metaphysical commitments: in other words, it can be thought of as implying that there are mind-independent facts of the matter which our statements, thoughts or beliefs map onto. This has posed particular problems about employing the notion of truth in the moral domain, for example, where the idea of there being mind-independent facts of the matter causes a degree of uneasiness (see, for example, Mackie 1977). It also causes problems in the mathematical domain, where we might be more comfortable thinking that there are mind-independent facts of the matter, but, due to the abstract nature of the facts involved, the notion of ‘mapping onto’ these facts seems misguided. Thoughts along these lines have been expressed by Lynch (2009) as what he calls the ‘Scope Problem’, which suggests that each existing ‘robust’ theory of truth (such as correspondence and coherence theories) is limited to accounting only for the truth of claims of a certain type. (See Dodd 2012 and Edwards 2011b for further discussion of the strength of the Scope Problem.)

It is tempting to respond to this uneasiness by denying that truth is applicable in these problematic domains, and adopting ‘expressivist’ or ‘fictionalist’ views of the subject matter instead, for example. However, pulling in the opposite direction is the attractive view of minimal truth-aptness. This is the thought that a domain of discourse can sustain a notion of truth in virtue of meeting very basic standards of syntactic discipline (see, for example, Boghossian 1990, Wright 1992), allowing them to express propositions which are, in turn, apt for truth. The basic idea is that a domain will qualify as being syntactically disciplined if its component sentences can be used as the antecedents of conditionals, be negated, and feature as the targets of propositional attitude statements. In addition to these features, if a domain is syntactically disciplined then there is a distinction between seeming to be right and being right, along with the intelligibility of speakers saying ‘I used to think that p but now I realize I was mistaken’. Moral discourse, for example, plausibly meets these standards. We often say things like ‘I used to think that eating meat was morally wrong, but now I realize I was mistaken’, or ‘I wonder whether abortion is morally wrong’. We can also note that moral sentences, such as ‘murder is wrong’, can feature as the antecedents of conditionals, such as ‘if murder is wrong, then those that murder will be punished’, or be negated, as in ‘it is not the case that murder is right’, which – on the terms of the view – are further hallmarks of sentences which express truth-apt propositions. Consequently, it is not so clear that we can give up on truth in these domains. But that seems to lead us back into an implausible realism, and herein lies the problem.

However, one may well point out that this is not such a problem, as there is already a plausible, and popular, theory of truth which explains how these kinds of claims are truth-apt, and without any unwanted metaphysical baggage: so-called ‘deflationary’ theories of truth (see, for example, Horwich 1998, Field 1994, and Stoljar and Damnjanovic 2010 for an overview of deflationary theories). The deflationist insists that the truth predicate exists just to perform certain logical functions, such as the endorsement of a proposition, or generalisation over a potentially infinite number of propositions. Deflationary theories of truth thus typically focus on the use of the truth predicate, and the possession of the truth concept, as opposed to the truth property. (See Devitt 2001 for a good discussion of the project undertaken by deflationists.) Deflationism though may be able to give us the resources to explain how all of the classes of sentences we are considering can be true, but it does so at the cost of being unable to use truth as an explanatory resource when attempting to understand other concepts, and requires revision to some of our basic thoughts that connect truth to other concepts of philosophical interest (for discussion see, for example, Lynch 2004a, Davidson 1999, Field 1986). There are also concerns that deflationism is an internally unstable view, outlined in Wright’s (1992) ‘inflationary argument’ (for further discussion see Horwich 1996 and 1998, Rumfitt 1995, van Cleve 1996, Kölbel 1997 and Miller 2001). I will not go into these problems in depth here, but suffice to say that deflationism does not offer a problem-free solution to the problem under discussion.

The truth pluralist agrees with the deflationist that all of the domains we have considered contain sentences that are capable of expressing true propositions. However, the truth pluralist does not think, like the deflationist, that this is the end of the matter. There is a story to tell about the nature of truth, the pluralist thinks, but this story will not always be the same. According to the truth pluralist, there will be a property in virtue of which the propositions expressed by sentences in a particular domain of discourse will be true, but this property will change depending on the domain we are considering. In other words, although the notion of truth as correspondence to the facts might fit our domain of discourse about the material world, a different notion of truth – perhaps one with less metaphysical baggage, constructed out of coherence, or justification or warrant (for example Wright’s notion of ‘superassertibility’ – see Wright 1992) – may fit the domains in which the correspondence notion looks problematic. Consequently, truth pluralism offers a treatment of truth which allows for a wide range of beliefs, sentences and the like to be true, although holding onto the idea that there are interesting things to say about truth.

There are thus initially two constraints on all truth pluralist theories. They must:

(1) Adequately explain how truth is to be analysed differently in different domains of discourse, and

(2) Ensure that truth is held to be robust enough to avoid the criticisms of deflationism.

With these motivations in mind, we will now examine some of the specific formulations of the view. Note that the versions I will be looking at will be those that hold that there are roles for different types of properties, such as correspondence and coherence, to play in the different accounts of truth in different domains, but there are also views of a pluralist persuasion which hold that truth is always correspondence, with there being different kinds of correspondence (for example Horgan 2001, Sher 2004).

4. Forms of Truth Pluralism

a. Simple Alethic Pluralism

The first option is a view which Lynch calls ‘Simple Alethic Pluralism’ (SAP) (Lynch does not hold the view, and it is unclear whether anyone ever has – though some attribute the view to Wright’s (1992) formulation of truth pluralism, which speaks of a plurality of truth predicates. Wright has since clarified his position – see below). Recalling the differences between concept and property noted above, this view holds that there are different concepts of truth in different domains of discourse. That is, that the concept of truth in discourse about the material world is identified with the concept of corresponding to fact, and the concept of truth in arithmetic is identified with the concept of coherence. Associated with each of these concepts will be their corresponding predicates and properties, so, if the concept of truth changes from domain to domain, the content of the truth predicate and the nature of the truth property will also change from domain to domain. On this view, then, there are different concepts, predicates and properties associated with the word ‘true’ in different domains of discourse.

Returning to the two dimensions of meaning that we discussed earlier, SAP holds that the meaning of ‘true’ varies from domain to domain at both the level of concept and property. It varies at the level of concept as different concepts are associated with ‘true’ in different domains, and it varies at the level of property as different properties are associated with the different concepts in different domains. One implication of this view, then, is that – at least on the two dimensions of meaning discussed – there is no domain-invariant meaning of ‘true’: the meaning of the predicate always depends on the subject-matter to which it is attributed, and is thus multiply ambiguous.

We will now turn to discuss the main problems for the SAP formulation of truth pluralism.

i. The Problem of Mixed Inferences (Form 1)

On the SAP view, truth (both as predicate and property) is tied to specific domains of discourse. However, as Tappolet (1997) pointed out, our reasoning frequently mixes statements from different domains. Consider the following example:

(1) This cat is wet

(2) This cat is funny

Therefore, this cat is wet and funny

Validity of arguments is traditionally understood as necessary preservation of truth, but how could we understand the validity of this argument on the SAP view? To make the point explicit, let us use the truth predicates from different domains:

(1*) ‘This cat is wet’ is truem

(2*) ‘This cat is funny’ is truec

Therefore, ‘this cat is wet and funny’ is true?

Disregarding for the moment the issue of what truth predicate applies to the conclusion (see the problem of mixed compounds below), this reformulation of the argument is invalid as different truth predicates are applied to each premise and conclusion, thus rendering the argument guilty of the fallacy of equivocation. Appeal to properties will not help either, as different truth properties correspond to each different truth predicate, thus ensuring that no single property is preserved across the inference (see below and Pedersen 2006 for detailed further discussion of the different aspects of this problem).

ii. The Problem of Mixed Compounds (Form 1)

Now consider compound claims, like conjunctions or disjunctions. Tappolet (2000) observes that we often make compounds of claims from different domains of discourse, such as the already mentioned ‘this cat is wet and funny’. (Williamson 1994 makes a similar point.) We have already noted that there is some puzzlement over what truth predicate could apply to this conjunction, but, more worryingly, Tappolet states, is that there is a basic statement about conjunctions, namely that a conjunction is true iff its conjuncts are true. If different truth predicates apply to the conjunction and to the conjuncts, then principles like this look under threat, once more from concerns about equivocation. These principles seem to require a general truth predicate, but SAP can provide none.

iii. Norm of Inquiry

One of the main motivations for moving beyond deflationism is to accommodate the thought that truth constitutes a norm of inquiry. It seems on the face of it as though SAP can accommodate this thought as there are different truth properties in different domains of discourse. However, Lynch (2006) argues that we need to read this constraint as the need for truth to constitute a single general norm of inquiry. All SAP would give us is lots of different norms (truth-in-ethics, truth-in-mathematics, and so forth) which would provide different norms for different domains of discourse, as opposed to a single general norm that all assertions (regardless of domain) aim at. If Lynch’s argument is correct, then, SAP has trouble accommodating the normative dimension of truth.

iv. Generalizations

One common use of the truth predicate is to make general claims, such as ‘Everything Socrates said is true’. This effectively allows us to endorse everything Socrates said without having to re-assert everything he did say. But how could we understand this usage on the SAP view? In particular, what truth predicate appears in the statement? For instance, suppose that Socrates remarks on a wide variety of subjects, from the weather to what is morally good to the axioms of set theory. All of these claims would seemingly be subject to different truth predicates, so how is a general claim like ‘Everything Socrates said is true’ even expressible without the aid of a general truth predicate?

b. The One Concept Many Properties View (OCMP)

The second option, due to Crispin Wright (1992, 2001, 2003), holds that there is a single concept of truth, held fixed across domains, and different truth properties which satisfy this concept in different domains. This view aims to hold one aspect of the meaning of the predicate ‘true’ fixed across domains – namely the concept associated with ‘true’ – although accommodating diversity of content by holding that there are different properties of truth in different domains, identified by their ability to (locally) satisfy the truth concept.

On this view, the content of the concept of truth is specified by a list of ‘platitudes’ about truth, which are taken to be truths about truth, knowable a priori, which specify the features that truth is taken to necessarily have, often by reference to connections between truth and other closely related concepts. Some candidate platitudes are as follows:

Transparency. That to assert a proposition is to present it as true and, more generally, that any attitude to a proposition is an attitude to its truth – that to believe, doubt, or fear, for example, that p is to believe, doubt, or fear that p is true.

(E). <p> is true iff p. (Note: ‘<p>’ here and below stands for ‘the proposition that p’, following Horwich’s (1998) notation.)

Embedding. A proposition’s aptitude for truth is preserved under a variety of operations – in particular, truth-apt propositions have negations, conjunctions, disjunctions, and so forth, which are likewise truth-apt.

Straight-talking. A true proposition ‘tells it like it is’, in some way.

Contrast. A proposition may be true but not justified, or justified but not true.

Stability. If a proposition is ever true, then it always is, so that whatever may, at any particular time, be truly asserted may – perhaps by appropriate transformations of mood, or tense – be truly asserted at any time.

Absoluteness. Truth is absolute – there is, strictly, no such thing as a proposition’s being more or less true; propositions are completely true if true at all.

The basic idea is that a complete list of truth platitudes will characterise the concept of truth exhaustively. This concept will be associated with the truth predicate in all of its relevant uses, regardless of the subject-matter of which it is attributed. One dimension of the meaning of ‘true’ is thus held fixed: the concept of truth with which the predicate is associated.

The aspect of meaning of ‘true’ which varies on this view is the property associated with ‘true’. What this property is will vary from one domain to the next. For example, the truth property for the empirical domain might well be correspondence, and the truth property for the mathematical domain might be coherence. Thus, at the level of property, there is variation in the nature of truth, but not variation at the level of concept.

According to Wright, a property’s ability to be considered a truth property is dependent on its ability to satisfy the following procedure. First of all, occurrences of the term ‘true’ are replaced with the name of the candidate property (so, for example, in the case of correspondence, the Contrast platitude would become “A proposition may correspond to the facts but not be justified, and vice versa”). If truth is preserved by these reformulations (that is, if all the platitudes remain true when rewritten), then, according to Wright, the property in question has the pedigree to be considered a truth property.

The method here can be compared with the methods employed by functionalists in the philosophy of mind (for example, Lewis 1972, Kim 1998) in that properties such as correspondence realize the role set out by the truth platitudes, as, for instance, c-fibers firing realize the role set out by our folk concept of pain. However, it is contentious whether Wright’s view should be understood along those lines (Lynch 2006, 2009, for example, interprets OCMP in this way, but Wright (2011) resists this interpretation).

OCMP gives us a single truth predicate, but not a single truth property. How might this help it avoid the problems posed for SAP? Not much, on first glance, but, as I will note, there has been more effort to defend OCMP than SAP on these fronts.

i. The Problem of Mixed Inferences (Form 2)

As we have a single truth predicate, the meaning of which is fixed by a single truth concept, the charge of equivocation when it comes to mixed inferences may be circumvented. However, there is still the more pressing issue of truth preservation to address. Remember that we noted that it is widely held that validity is necessary preservation of truth across an inference. This way of putting it sounds distinctly like there is a single property (truth) preserved from premises to conclusion. However, note that there is no single property of truth on the OCMP view, so different truth properties will be possessed by premises from different domains of discourse. The problem now kicks in at the level of properties: how to explain preservation of truth across mixed inferences when there is no single truth property.

Responses to this form of the problem have been offered by Beall (2000), who argues that the pluralist should adopt a conception of validity favoured by many-valued logics, and Pedersen (2006) who explores the possibility of using plural quantification. Cotnoir (2012) offers an algebraic account of how an OCMP pluralist can account for the validity of mixed inferences.

ii. The Problem of Mixed Compounds (Form 2)

The initial statement of the problem only seems to affect SAP, as it is a challenge to understand the phrase ‘a conjunction is true iff its conjuncts are true’ in the absence of a general truth predicate. As SAP is the only view which lacks a single truth predicate, it only seems to affect this view and not the others: all the other views can hold that it is the same predicate in both uses. However, there is a deeper challenge which is not averted by this response. That is to explain in what way the conjunction is true, and this can kick in just as well at the level of properties. On the OCMP view, the challenge will be to explain what truth property the mixed conjunction has. On the other views, it will be a challenge to explain which lower level property the mixed conjunction has which explains why it has the general truth property.

One route to explore is to observe that the truth of a compound is, in some sense, supervenient on its components, and to try to construct a truth (or lower level) property out of this idea. This option is explored by Edwards (2008, 2009), who, defending the OCMP view, suggests that we can understand the truth property for compounds as being the property of satisfying the rules for compounds laid out by the preferred system of logic. This option could also be extended to the other views (bar SAP) which could hold that this is the relevant lower level property for compounds that explains why they have the general truth property. This option is discussed by Cotnoir (2009), and rejected by Lynch (2009), who prefers to think of the truth of compounds as instances of truth “self-manifesting”, as a consequence of its being grounded in the truth of the components. See Lynch 2009 Chapter 5 for further discussion of this idea.

iii. Norm of Inquiry

The norm of inquiry problem seems to hold in its original form (indeed, it was originally pressed by Lynch against the OCMP view). Again, there is no general property possessed by all truths, but, if truth is to be considered a general norm of inquiry, then there needs to be a general truth property capable of grounding this norm. Insofar as OCMP cannot allow for this, it falls prey to the objection.

iv. Generalizations

The matter of generalizations is again subtle. Equipped with a general truth predicate the puzzlement over what predicate appears in the sentence ‘Everything Socrates said is true’ disappears. But, again, one may think that the problem kicks in at the level of properties. We could read the sentence as attributing a property to all the things Socrates said – the property of truth. But, we cannot take this statement at face-value on the OCMP view, as, in this case, there is no general truth property that is possessed by all the things Socrates said.

However, OCMP may have a response to this problem which draws on the solution to the problem of mixed conjunctions. If OCMP interprets ‘everything Socrates said is true’ as a long conjunction of all the things Socrates said, then perhaps it can analyze that conjunction in much the same way as the mixed conjunction discussed above. Alternatively, as Wright 2012 explores, OCMP may prefer to instead say that the same style of solution may be adopted for generalizations themselves. That is, a generalization is true just in case all of the propositions that fall under the scope of that generalization are themselves true in their appropriate ways.

The remaining views which we will discuss all allow for a general truth property, as well as a general truth predicate. As a result they seem, on the face of it, to avoid the problem of mixed inferences, norm of inquiry, generalization and mixed compounds problems, and, as a result, I will not discuss each problem in turn for each view. However, as we will see below, the norm of inquiry problem still has relevance in some cases. Also, as hinted above, there are issues over whether the mixed compounds problem will still affect these views, which are explored further in Lynch 2009 and Edwards 2008.

c. Second-Order Functionalism (SOF)

Lynch (2001a, 2004, 2006) proposes to think of truth as a functional concept. A functional concept describes the role that anything that falls under the concept must play, but it is intended to stay reasonably neutral on the issue of what it is that realizes that role. This idea originated in the philosophy of mind by way of giving a method of systematizing particular causal roles of particular mental phenomena, but Lynch extends the idea to systematize the non-causal, perhaps normative, role of truth in our cognitive lives. Lynch’s method of constructing the functional role of the concept of truth begins, like Wright’s, with the collection of a number of platitudes about truth, which locate truth on the conceptual map, linking it with the related concepts of fact, proposition and belief. Lynch’s platitudes are:

The proposition that p is true if and only if p.

The proposition that p is false if and only if it is not the case that p.

Propositions are the bearers of truth and falsity.

Every proposition has a negation.

A proposition can be justified but not true, and true but not justified. (Lynch 2001a: 730)

These platitudes form a structure which will provide a complete account of the role truth is taken to play. This structure takes the form of a ‘network analysis’ (the term is due to Smith 1994). That is, once we have our full list of platitudes, we first rewrite them slightly, replacing simple instances of ‘is true’ with ‘has the property of being true’, so that, instead of, say ‘The proposition that p is true if and only if p.’, we have ‘The proposition that p has the property of being true if and only if p.’ We then make a conjunction of all the platitudes we have collected, and replace all of the alethic concepts in the platitudes with variables. What we end up with is a condition which is billed to give us the exact specification of the ‘job description’ for truth, its ‘functional role’. (For more on this process see Lynch 2001a, and also Smith 1994 and Jackson 1998.)

This process yields a functional definition of truth, as it gives us the precise features that a property must have if it is to be regarded as realizing the truth role: it must be related to a number of other properties in the required way. As noted before, these features may be exhibited by different properties in different domains of discourse, and SOF allows for this, as, provided a property discharges the functional role set out in the network analysis, it counts as the realizer of the truth role in that particular domain of discourse.

So far, it may not seem as though there is a great deal distinguishing SOF from OCMP, but the main point of difference becomes apparent when SOF says a bit more about the truth property. Functionalists in general, according to Lynch, have two options when characterizing the truth property: they can either hold that truth is a second-order property – the property of having a property that plays the specified role – or hold – in each domain – that truth is a first-order property, that is, the property that plays that certain role in that domain. The truth property could thus be taken to be either the second-order property of possessing some property that plays the truth role, or, in each domain, the property that actually plays that role in a particular domain of discourse. SOF plumps for the former, and, as a result, the truth property is to be thought of as a second-order functional role property, not as a realizer property. There is a single second-order role property, and a plurality of realizer properties across discourses, and the truth property is to be identified with the former.

 

There is thus a property that all truths have in common on the SOF view. All truths will have the property of having a property that plays the truth role. As the truth property is to be identified with this second-order property, as opposed to the first-order realizer property, all truths will be true in virtue of having this second-order property, whatever their individual realizer properties are.

There are two main problems that SOF faces. The first concerns the ‘robustness’ of second-order properties. Remember that truth, considered here as a second-order property, needs to be robust enough to ground truth as a general norm of inquiry. However, one might think that the robust properties here are the first-order properties, like correspondence and coherence, as opposed to the property of having one of those properties, which seems to be a thinner, less complex property. If so, SOF provides us with a truth property which is not fit to ground truth as a general norm of inquiry, and thus fails to move the view significantly beyond OCMP (for concerns like these about second-order properties in general, see Kim 1998). The second, related, problem (raised in Lynch 2009) is that it is questionable whether the second-order truth property will satisfy the truth platitudes. Remember that to be a truth-realizing property, on a functionalist view, a property has to exhibit the features set out in the truth platitudes. The first-order properties must do this, and this is how they are identified in their domains, but does the general second-order property exhibit these features? Lynch argues not, and thus the view is unstable: it offers as a truth property a property which fails to meet its own standards for being considered a truth property.

d. Manifestation Functionalism

In Lynch 2009, Lynch presents a significant revision of his earlier proposal. Lynch maintains the central role afforded to the list of platitudes about truth, holding that the concept of truth is captured by the following (slightly different) list:

Objectivity: The belief that p is true if, and only if, with respect to the belief that p, things are as they are believed to be.

Warrant Independence: Some beliefs can be true but not warranted and some can be warranted without being true.

Norm of Belief: It is prima facie correct to believe that p if and only if the proposition that p is true.

End of Inquiry: Other things being equal, true beliefs are a worthy goal of inquiry. (Lynch 2009: 8-12)

According to MF, we ought to take the truth platitudes (or the ‘truish features’ in Lynch’s words) to specify the nature of the truth property, as well as the nature of the truth concept:

the functionalist…can claim that there is a single property and concept of truth. The property being true (or the property of truth) is the property that has the truish features essentially or which plays the truth-role as such. (Lynch 2009: 74)

MF does not disregard the ‘domain-specific’ properties, such as correspondence and superassertibility, but MF does not want to identify truth with these properties, rather that truth is manifested in these properties:

this approach allows the functionalist to claim that truth is, as it were, immanent in ontologically distinct properties. Let us say that where property F is immanent in or manifested by property M, it is a priori that F’s essential features are a subset of M’s features. (Lynch 2009: 74)

MF thus requires that the truth features – as expressed in the characterisation of the truth property – are a subset of the features of the particular domain-specific properties. That is, each of the properties that, in Lynch’s terms, ‘manifest’ truth in a domain, must contain the truth property as a proper part. So, for example, for superassertibility to manifest truth in a domain, it would have to be part of the features of superassertibility that the belief that p is superassertible if, and only if, things are as they are believed to be; that some beliefs can be superassertible but not warranted and some can be warranted without being superassertible; that it is prima facie correct to believe that p if and only if the proposition that p is superassertible; and that, other things being equal, superassertible beliefs are a worthy goal of inquiry.

A key issue for this view is the metaphysics of manifestation. Lynch claims that the metaphysics of manifestation are similar to the metaphysics of the determinate/determinable relation. A classic example of this relation is the relation between being coloured and being red. There is an asymmetry between these properties: if something is red, then, necessarily, it is coloured, whereas if something is coloured it is not necessarily red. Being red, we might say, is one way of being coloured. One way of putting this point is to say that being red is a determinate of the more general determinable, being coloured. According MF, something similar occurs in the case of truth, where properties such as correspondence and superassertibility are different ways of being true. (However, Lynch does not want to say that the manifestation relation as it occurs in the case of truth is the same as the determinate/determinable relation: see Lynch 2009: 75 for details.)

Perhaps the most pressing objection, due to Wright (2012), concerns the ability of properties such as correspondence and superassertibility to manifest truth on the terms of Lynch’s view. Recall that Lynch holds that the truth-manifesting properties contain the essential features of truth as a proper part of their own features. But, Wright argues, if Lynch’s view in general is correct, then surely one of the essential features of truth is that truth is manifested in, for example, correspondence and superassertibility. However, now it looks difficult for those properties to manifest truth, for it cannot be that correspondence and superassertibility are themselves manifested in correspondence and superassertibility. But, if this cannot be the case, then they cannot manifest truth, for they do not possess one of the essential features of truth. Lynch (2012) attempts to respond to this problem, and Wright (2012) also considers his response.

As was the case with SOF, there has also been discussion of how far MF progresses beyond deflationism, and, in particular, whether the property MF identifies with truth – the property that has the truish features essentially – is a property which is as robust as Lynch claims it to be. This issue is discussed in detail in Jarvis 2012, Edwards 2012 and Pedersen and Edwards 2011.

e. Disjunctivism and Simple Determination Pluralism

In addition to the proposals put forward by Crispin Wright and Michael Lynch, there are also a couple of emerging views in the recent literature. The first is the ‘disjunctivist’ proposal offered by Pedersen (2010) and Pedersen and C.D. Wright (2012). The basic idea behind this view is to take the basic structure of OCMP, and add an additional property that will serve as a general truth property. This property will be a disjunctive property which contains each of the domain-specific truth properties as disjuncts.

Pedersen expresses the domain-specific truth properties (of which correspondence to reality and superassertibility are examples) as properties Tl … Tn. His thought is that the existence of a further property can immediately be inferred, a ‘universal’ notion of truth – TU – defined in the following way:

(∀p)(TU (p) ↔ Tl(p) v … v Tn(p))

This states that if we have properties Tl … Tn, we can immediately infer the existence of a further property, TU, by noting that a proposition (p) has TU just when it has one of Tl … Tn. The thought is that this property, TU, has the pedigree to be considered a truth property (it is taken to be possessed by all and only truths, after all). We can call this proposal ‘disjunctivism’, as the single truth property is taken to be a disjunctive property.

The main challenge for disjunctivism is to show that the disjunctive truth property has the necessary credentials to be considered the truth property. In particular, it faces concerns that a disjunctive property is not ‘robust’ enough to meet the requirements of being a substantive norm of inquiry, and also that, as with SOF, it fails to guarantee exhibition of the features laid out in the truth platitudes. Disjunctive proposals are defended from these concerns by Pedersen and Wright (2012a) and Edwards (2012).

The second emerging view is offered by Edwards (2011a, 2012b), which draws upon Dummett’s (1978) analogy between truth and winning. Just as winning is the aim of playing a game, truth is the aim of assertion and belief. It is evident that what it takes to win differs from game to game, but there is good reason to think that winning qua property has a significant degree of constancy. The thought is that the property of being a winner is a property that one can get in a variety of different ways, and that the rules of each game establish a property the possession of which determines the possession of the property of being a winner. Thus, in each game, we get biconditionals of the form:

(Bx) When playing game x: one wins (has the property of winning) iff one possesses property F.

The thought is that this structure can be applied to the truth case. Take it that truth qua property is exhaustively accounted for by the list of platitudes about truth. We can then, for each domain, construct biconditionals of the following form:

(Bdx) In domain of discourse x: <p> is true (has the property of truth) iff <p> has property F.

There will be an order of determination on the biconditionals which reflects the explanatory primacy of the right-to-left direction. That is, in the material world domain, for example, it is because <p> corresponds to the facts that <p> is true, and not because <p> is true that <p> corresponds to the facts. It is in virtue of the order of determination on these biconditionals that we can say that the properties in question determine truth in their respective domains.

The structure of simple determination pluralism is thus as follows. Truth is given as the property that is exhaustively described by the truth platitudes. This property is the property possessed by all true propositions, regardless of domain. This allows the view to avoid the problem with SOF, as the truth property necessarily exhibits the truth features. Moreover, for each domain there will be a property that determines possession of the truth property, and these properties are held fully distinct from the truth property itself. This allows simple determination pluralism to avoid some of the problems with MF as truth itself is not considered to be manifested in the domain-specific properties. The relationship between the truth-determining properties and truth is underwritten by the order of determination on the biconditionals of the form (Bdx).

A key issue for simple determination pluralism is the specification of the relationship between the domain-specific truth-determining properties and the truth property itself. There is also the matter of how exactly the truth-determining properties are identified, and the provenance of the (Bdx) biconditionals. These issues are explored in Edwards 2011a and 2011c, and in Wright 2012.

5. General Issues

These are some of the main formulations of truth pluralism that are currently available. Evidently, the intricacies of each view are more complex than I have been able to outline here, and the reader is directed to the relevant references for more on the structure and motivations for each view. I hope, though, that it is clear that the term ‘truth pluralism’ covers a variety of different proposals which, although they share a certain general approach to truth, differ on the details.

Each proposal, then, faces specific challenges of its own, but there are also some concerns about the general project which all pluralists will need to address. I will close by briefly noting three such concerns.

a. The Problem of Domain Individuation

Truth pluralism seemingly rests on the idea that natural language can be separated into different domains of discourse. Note that this rough separation of thought and talk into different domains is not solely the work of truth pluralists, it is perhaps a separation that is subscribed to, though a lot less explicitly, by a number of different kinds of theorists. The very fact that philosophy itself is separated into different areas corresponding to these divisions might be one example: moral philosophy is taken to concern different subject matter to aesthetics, and philosophy of mathematics different to the philosophy of science. Also, those who take particular positions in these areas may be implicitly subscribing to such distinctions. One who claims to be an expressivist about moral discourse, for example, will need to be able to demarcate what is moral discourse and what is not. Likewise, one who is a fictionalist about mathematics needs some distinction between what are mathematical statements, and what are not.

However, one might think that pluralism is committed to this idea in a particularly acute way. For instance, some of the views above use the notion of a domain as a parameter when it comes to platitude satisfaction. For example, on the OCMP view, truth properties do not satisfy the truth platitudes simpliciter, they satisfy them in a specific domain. Identifying precisely what a domain of discourse is, and how, exactly, they are to be individuated is an issue which has been at the forefronts of the minds of those sceptical of the pluralist project since its inception (see, for example, Williamson 1994), and, at present, one might think that more needs to be done to ease these concerns.

b. The Demandingness Objection

The supposed benefit of being able to use different theories of truth in different domains may be considered a problem when one considers what that entails, namely that a truth pluralist is committed to defending the use of a particular theory of truth in each domain. This worry is particularly acute when one considers that there is no generally accepted version of any of the theories of truth usually cited as examples. For instance, although it may seem a benefit that truth pluralism allows correspondence theory a limited scope, it is worth noting that there is general scepticism over whether there is a satisfactory formulation of the correspondence theory to start with. The same may well be true of coherence theory. Truth pluralism thus inherits the problems with formulating each of the different theories of truth it wants to use in each of its domains. This makes it a very demanding view to defend: not only does it have to find a structure that works, it has to outline and defend each account of truth in each domain. This point is developed by C.D. Wright (2011).

c. Problems with Platitudes

All of the pluralist views I have discussed involve the notion of platitudes at some stage in the theory. As is also clear, different formulations favour slightly different platitudes. This disagreement might make us worry about the use of the term ‘platitude’, which seems to signify some uncontroversial, even obvious, principle. However, although the platitudes in each case are taken to stem from some intuitive thoughts about truth, the eventual formulations may be open to dispute (see Wright 2003: 271, and also Nolan 2009 for more on platitudes), so we should think of them as refined conceptual truths, perhaps, as opposed to simple obvious, uncontroversial, statements. Nevertheless, one might be concerned that there are no platitudes about truth: no principles that are entitled to this status. This is backed up by the fact that most (if not all) of the platitudes cited by truth pluralists have been questioned (C.D. Wright 2005 argues this point, and Lynch 2005 responds).

Usually the scepticism comes from one of two fronts: either from those who think the platitude in question is false, or from those who think the platitude in question is not about truth, and can thus be explained away without committing one to any attitude about the nature of truth. Deflationists about truth often use this second strategy, with Paul Horwich being one prominent example with his discussion of the ‘Norm of Belief’ platitude (see Horwich 1998, 2010). Wolfgang Künne (2003: Chapter 5) gives an example of the first kind of scepticism, arguing that Wright’s ‘Stability’ platitude is false. There are also concerns that even the (in)famous ‘(E)’ platitude is up for grabs, coming from those who wish to admit truth-value gaps, and those who think that the schema leads to paradox (though note that these particular concerns would affect deflationary theories just as much as pluralist theories, given their reliance on the instances of (E)).

Although, as we have seen, disagreement over a platitude does not immediately rule it out as a platitude, there are still issues over the truth of a platitude which need to be taken seriously. Even if pluralists claim that the platitudes are rough formulations approximating some conceptual truth that would be reached when appropriately refined, there is still room for scepticism.

d. The Deflationary Challenge

Throughout contemporary debates on truth pluralism, lurking in the shadows has been the challenge from deflationary theories of truth. In particular, there is an underlying puzzlement as to why we need to go beyond deflationism into pluralism. After all, deflationism and pluralism share some of the same motivations in that they are both dissatisfied with traditional ‘monist’ accounts of truth, yet the deflationary account seemingly offers a far simpler solution to this dissatisfaction, without a lot of the problems for pluralism we have discussed above. The basic worry seems to be: why bring in all of these complications when we can get by with far less? This challenge is compounded by the influence of deflationary theories of truth in current debates, with many holding that deflationism ought to be considered the default view of truth (see, for example, Field 1994, Armour-Garb Beall 2000, and Dodd 2012). As noted above, this challenge has not been ignored by pluralists, with Wright (1992) and Lynch (2009: Chapter 6) building arguments against deflationism into the motivations for their pluralist views. However, despite this work, it is probably still fair to say that one of the central challenges facing pluralists today is to convince those in the deflationary camp that there are strong reasons to consider pluralism an attractive alternative.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Alston, W.P. 1996. A Realist Conception of Truth. Cornell University Press.
  • Alston, W.P. 2002. Truth: Concept and Property. In What is Truth? ed. R. Schantz. Berlin and New York: Walter de Gruyter: 11-26.
  • Beall, J.C. 2000. On Mixed Inferences and Pluralism about Truth Predicates. The Philosophical Quarterly Vol. 50, No. 200: 380-382.
  • Boghossian, P.A. 1990. The Status of Content. The Philosophical Review, Vol. 99, No. 2: 157-184.
  • Cotnoir, A.J. 2009. Generic Truth and Mixed Conjunctions: Some Alternatives. Analysis, Vol. 69, No.2: 473-479.
  • Cotnoir, A.J. 2012. Validity for Strong Pluralists. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research.
  • Davidson, D. 1999. The Folly of Trying to Define Truth. Journal of Philosophy 93, no. 6: 263-279.
  • Devitt, M. 2001. The Metaphysics of Truth. In Lynch (ed.) 2001.
  • Dodd, J. 2012. Deflationism Trumps Pluralism! In Pedersen and Wright (eds.) 2012.
  • Dummett, M. 1978. Truth. In his Truth and Other Enigmas. Oxford University Press.
  • Edwards, D. 2008. How to Solve the Problem of Mixed Conjunctions. Analysis, Vol. 68, No. 2: 143-149.
  • Edwards, D. 2009. Truth-Conditions and the Nature of Truth: Re-Solving Mixed Conjunctions. Analysis, Vol. 69, No. 4: 684-688
  • Edwards, D. 2011a. Simplifying Alethic Pluralism. The Southern Journal of Philosophy 49: 28-48.
  • Edwards, D. 2011b. Naturalness, Representation, and the Metaphysics of Truth. European Journal of Philosophy.
  • Edwards, D. 2012a. On Alethic Disjunctivism. dialectica, Vol. 66, Issue 1: 200-214.
  • Edwards, D. 2012b. Truth, Winning, and Simple Determination Pluralism. In Pedersen and Wright (eds.) 2012.
  • Edwards, D. 2012c. Alethic vs Deflationary Functionalism. International Journal of Philosophical Studies, 20 (1): 115-124.
  • Field, H. 1986. The Deflationary Conception of Truth. In C. Wright and G. Macdonald (eds.) Fact, Science and Morality. Blackwell, Oxford: 55-119.
  • Field, H. 1994. Deflationist Views of Meaning and Content. Mind, 103: 247-285.
  • Horgan, T. 2001. Contextual Semantics and Metaphysical Realism: Truth as Indirect Correspondence. In Lynch 2001: 67-96.
  • Horwich, P. 1996. Realism Minus Truth. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 877-881.
  • Horwich, P. 1998. Truth: Second Edition. Blackwell.
  • Horwich, P. 2010. Truth-Meaning-Reality. Oxford University Press.
  • Jackson, F. 1998. From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford University Press.
  • Jackson, F., Oppy, G. and Smith, M. 1994. Minimalism and Truth Aptness. Mind, New Series, Vol. 103, No. 411: 287-302.
  • James, W. 1975. Pragmatism and The Meaning of Truth. Harvard University Press.
  • Jarvis, B. 2012. Truth as One and Very Many. International Journal of Philosophical Studies, 20 (1):
  • Kim, J. 1998. Mind in a Physical World. MIT Press.
  • Kölbel, M. 1997. Wright’s Argument from Neutrality. Ratio NS 10: 35-47.
  • Künne, W. 2003. Conceptions of Truth. Oxford University Press.
  • Lewis, D. 1972. Psychophysical and Theoretical Identifications. Australasian Journal of Philosophy 50: 249-58.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2001. The Nature of Truth. MIT Press.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2001a. A Functionalist Theory of Truth. In Lynch 2001.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2004. Truth and Multiple Realizibility. Australasian Journal of Philosophy, Volume 82, Number 3: 384-408.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2004a. Minimalism and the Value of Truth. The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 54, No. 217: 497-517.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2005. Alethic Functionalism and our Folk Theory of Truth. Synthese Vol. 145, No. 1: 29-43.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2006. ReWrighting Pluralism. The Monist, Vol. 89, No. 1: 63-84.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2009. Truth as One and Many. Oxford University Press.
  • Lynch, M.P. 2012. Three Questions about Truth. In Pedersen and Wright (eds.) 2012.
  • Mackie, J.L. 1977. Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. Penguin.
  • Miller, A. 2001. On Wright’s Argument against Deflationism. The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 51, No. 205: 527-531.
  • Nolan, D. 2009. Platitudes and Metaphysics. In D. Braddon-Mitchell and R. Nola (eds.) Conceptual Analysis and Philosophical Naturalism. MIT Press.
  • Pedersen, N. 2006. What Can the Problem of Mixed Inferences Teach Us about Alethic Pluralism? The Monist, Vol. 89, No. 1: 102-117.
  • Pedersen, N. 2010. Stabilizing Alethic Pluralism. The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 60, No. 238: 92-108.
  • Pedersen, N. and Edwards, D. 2011. Truth as One(s) and Many: On Lynch’s Alethic Functionalism. Analytic Philosophy, 52 (63): 213-30.
  • Pedersen, N. and Wright, C.D. (eds.) 2012. Truth and Pluralism: Current Debates. Oxford University Press.
  • Pedersen, N. and Wright, C.D. 2012a. Why Alethic Disjunctivism is Relatively Compelling. In Pedersen and Wright (eds.) 2012.
  • Pedersen, N. and Wright, C.D. 2012b. Pluralist Theories of Truth. Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • Rumfitt, I. 1995. Truth Wronged. Ratio, NS 8: 100-7.
  • Sher, G. 2004. In Search of a Substantive Theory of Truth. Journal of Philosophy, 101: 5-36.
  • Smith, M. 1994. The Moral Problem. Blackwell.
  • Stoljar, D. and Damnjanovic, N. 2010. The Deflationary Theory of Truth. Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
  • Tappolet, C. 1997. Mixed Inferences: A Problem for Pluralism about Truth Predicates. Analysis 57: 209-10
  • Tappolet, C. 2000. Truth, Pluralism and Many-Valued Logics. The Philosophical Quarterly, Vol. 50, No. 200: 382-383.
  • Tarksi, A. 1944. The Semantic Conception of Truth and the Foundations of Semantics. Reprinted in A.P. Martinich (ed.) The Philosophy of Language. Oxford University Press. 2001.
  • Van Cleve, J. 1996. Minimal Truth is Realist Truth. Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 56: 869-75.
  • White, A. 1957. Truth as Appraisal. Mind 66, No. 263: 318-330.
  • Williamson, T. 1994. A Critical Study of Truth and Objectivity. International Journal of Philosophical Studies 30.1: 130-44.
  • Wright, C.D. 2005. On the Functionalization of Pluralist Approaches to Truth. Synthese Vol. 145, No. 1: 128.
  • Wright, C.D. 2010. Truth, Ramsification, and the Pluralist’s Revenge. Australasian Journal of Philosophy, Vol. 88, No. 2, pp. 265283.
  • Wright, C.D. 2011. Is Pluralism about Truth Inherently Unstable? Philosophical Studies.
  • Wright, C.J.G. 1992. Truth and Objectivity. Harvard University Press.
  • Wright, C.J.G. 2001. Minimalism, Deflationism, Pragmatism, Pluralism. In Lynch (ed.) 2001.
  • Wright, C.J.G. 2003. Truth: A Traditional Debate Reviewed. In his Saving the Differences. Harvard University Press.
  • Wright, C.J.G. 2012. A Plurality of Pluralisms. In Pedersen and Wright (eds.) 2012.

 

Author Information

Douglas Edwards
Email: d.o.edwards@abdn.ac.uk
Northern Institute of Philosophy, University of Aberdeen
United Kingdom

Sen’s Capability Approach

Amartya Sen
Amartya Sen

The Capability Approach is defined by its choice of focus upon the moral significance of individuals’ capability of achieving the kind of lives they have reason to value. This distinguishes it from more established approaches to ethical evaluation, such as utilitarianism or resourcism, which focus exclusively on subjective well-being or the availability of means to the good life, respectively. A person’s capability to live a good life is defined in terms of the set of valuable ‘beings and doings’ like being in good health or having loving relationships with others to which they have real access.

The Capability Approach was first articulated by the Indian economist and philosopher Amartya Sen in the 1980s, and remains most closely associated with him. It has been employed extensively in the context of human development, for example, by the United Nations Development Programme, as a broader, deeper alternative to narrowly economic metrics such as growth in GDP per capita. Here ‘poverty’ is understood as deprivation in the capability to live a good life, and ‘development’ is understood as capability expansion.

Within academic philosophy the novel focus of Capability Approach has attracted a number of scholars. It is seen to be relevant for the moral evaluation of social arrangements beyond the development context, for example, for considering gender justice. It is also seen as providing foundations for normative theorising, such as a capability theory of justice that would include an explicit ‘metric’ (that specifies which capabilities are valuable) and ‘rule’ (that specifies how the capabilities are to be distributed). The philosopher Martha Nussbaum has provided the most influential version of such a capability theory of justice, deriving from the requirements of human dignity a list of central capabilities to be incorporated into national constitutions and guaranteed to all up to a certain threshold.

This article focuses on the philosophical aspects of the Capability Approach and its foundations in the work of Amartya Sen. It discusses the development and structure of Sen’s account, how it relates to other ethical approaches, and its main contributions and criticisms. It also outlines various capability theories developed within the Capability Approach, with particular attention to that of Martha Nussbaum.

Table of Contents

  1. The Development of Sen’s Capability Approach
    1. Sen’s Background
    2. Sen’s Concerns
  2. Sen’s Critiques of Utilitarianism and Resourcism
    1. Utilitarianism
      1. Act-Consequentialism
      2. Welfarism
      3. Sum Ranking
    2. Resourcism
  3. Core Concepts and Structure of Sen’s Capability Approach
    1. Functionings and Capability
    2. Valuation: Which Functionings Matter for the Good Life?
    3. Evaluation: What Capability do People Have to Live a Good Life?
  4. Applying Sen’s Capability Approach
  5. Criticisms of Sen’s Capability Approach
    1. Illiberalism
    2. Under-Theorisation
    3. Individualism
    4. Information Gaps
  6. Theorising the Capability Approach
    1. Generating Lists for Empirical Research in the Social Sciences (Ingrid Robeyns)
    2. A Participatory Approach to Evaluating Capability Expansion (Sabina Alkire)
    3. Justice as Equal Capability of Democratic Citizenship (Elizabeth Anderson)
    4. Capability as Freedom from Domination (John Alexander)
  7. Martha Nussbaum’s Capability Theory of Justice
    1. Structure and Development of Nussbaum’s Capability Theory
    2. Criticisms of Nussbaum’s Theory
    3. Sen and Nussbaum
  8. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. The Development of Sen’s Capability Approach

a. Sen’s Background

Amartya Sen had an extensive background in development economics, social choice theory (for which he received the 1998 Nobel Prize in Economics), and philosophy before developing the Capability Approach during the 1980s. This background can be pertinent to understanding and assessing Sen’s Capability Approach because of the complementarity between Sen’s contributions to these different fields. Sen’s most influential and comprehensive account of his Capability Approach, Development as Freedom (Sen 1999), helpfully synthesizes in an accessible way many of these particular, and often quite technical, contributions.

Sen first introduced the concept of capability in his Tanner Lectures on Equality of What? (Sen 1979) and went on to elaborate it in subsequent publications during the 1980s and 1990s. Sen notes that his approach has strong conceptual connections with Aristotle’s understanding of human flourishing (this was the initial foundation for Nussbaum’s alternative Capability Theory); with Adam Smith, and with Karl Marx. Marx discussed the importance of functionings and capability for human well-being. For example, Sen often cites Smith’s analysis of relative poverty in The Wealth of Nation in terms of how a country’s wealth and different cultural norms affected which material goods were understood to be a ‘necessity’. Sen also cites Marx’s foundational concern with “replacing the domination of circumstances and chance over individuals by the domination of individuals over chance and circumstances”.

b. Sen’s Concerns

The Capability Approach attempts to address various concerns that Sen had about contemporary approaches to the evaluation of well-being, namely:

(1) Individuals can differ greatly in their abilities to convert the same resources into valuable functionings (‘beings’ and ‘doings’). For example, those with physical disabilities may need specific goods to achieve mobility, and pregnant women have specific nutritional requirements to achieve good health. Therefore, evaluation that focuses only on means, without considering what particular people can do with them, is insufficient.

(2) People can internalize the harshness of their circumstances so that they do not desire what they can never expect to achieve. This is the phenomenon of ‘adaptive preferences’ in which people who are objectively very sick may, for example, still declare, and believe, that their health is fine. Therefore, evaluation that focuses only on subjective mental metrics is insufficient without considering whether that matches with what a neutral observer would perceive as their objective circumstances,.

(3) Whether or not people take up the options they have, the fact that they do have valuable options is significant. For example, even if the nutritional state of people who are fasting and starving is the same, the fact that fasting is a choice not to eat should be recognized. Therefore evaluation must be sensitive to both actual achievements (‘functionings’) and effective freedom (‘capability’).

(4) Reality is complicated and evaluation should reflect that complexity rather than take a short-cut by excluding all sorts of information from consideration in advance. For example, although it may seem obvious that happiness matters for the evaluation of how well people are doing, it is not all obvious that it should be the only aspect that ever matters and so nothing else should be considered. Therefore, evaluation of how well people are doing must seek to be as open-minded as possible. (Note: This leads to the deliberate ‘under-theorization’ of the Capability Approach that has been the source of some criticism, and it motivated the development of Nussbaum’s alternative Capability Theory.)

2. Sen’s Critiques of Utilitarianism and Resourcism

An important part of Sen’s argument for the Capability Approach relates to his critique of alternative philosophical and economics accounts. In particular, he argues that, whatever their particular strengths, none of them provide an analysis of well-being that is suitable as a general concept; they are all focused on the wrong particular things (whether utility, liberty, commodities, or primary goods), and they are too narrowly focused (they exclude too many important aspects from evaluation). Sen’s criticisms of economic utilitarianism and John Rawls’ primary goods are particularly important in the evolution of his account and its reception.

a. Utilitarianism

Economics has a branch explicitly concerned with ethical analysis (‘Welfare Economics’). Sen’s systematic criticism of the form of utilitarianism behind welfare economics identifies and rejects each of its three pillars: act consequentialism, welfarism, and sum-ranking.

i. Act-Consequentialism

According to act consequentialism, actions should be assessed only in terms of the goodness or badness of their consequences. This excludes any consideration of the morality of the process by which consequences are brought about, for example, whether it respects principles of fairness or individual agency. Sen argues instead for a ‘comprehensive consequentialism’ which integrates the moral significance of both consequences and principles. For example, it matters not only whether people have an equal capability to live a long life, but how that equality is achieved. Under the same circumstances women generally live longer than men, for largely biological reasons. If the only thing that mattered was achieving equality in the capability to live a long life this fact suggests that health care provision should be biased in favor of men. However, as Sen argues, trying to achieve equality in this way would override important moral claims of fairness which should be included in a comprehensive evaluation.

ii. Welfarism

Welfarism is the view that goodness should be assessed only in terms of subjective utility. Sen argues that welfarism exhibits both ‘valuational neglect’ and ‘physical condition neglect’. First, although welfarism is centrally concerned with how people feel about their lives, it is only concerned with psychological states, not with people’s reflective valuations. Second, because it is concerned only with feelings it neglects information about physical health, though this would seem obviously relevant to assessing well-being. Not only does subjective welfare not reliably track people’s actual interests or even their urgent needs, it is also vulnerable to what Sen calls ‘adaptive preferences’. People can become so normalized to their conditions of material deprivation and social injustice that they may claim to be entirely satisfied. As Sen puts it,

Our mental reactions to what we actually get and what we can sensibly expect to get may frequently involve compromises with a harsh reality. The destitute thrown into beggary, the vulnerable landless labourer precariously surviving at the edge of subsistence, the overworked domestic servant working round the clock, the subdued and subjugated housewife reconciled to her role and her fate, all tend to come to terms with their respective predicaments. The deprivations are suppressed and muffled in the scale of utilities (reflected by desire-fulfilment and happiness) by the necessity of endurance in uneventful survival. (Sen 1985, 21-22)

iii. Sum Ranking

Sum-ranking focuses on maximizing the total amount of welfare in a society without regard for how it is distributed, although this is generally felt to be important by the individuals concerned. Sen argues, together with liberal philosophers such as Bernard Williams and John Rawls, that sum-ranking does not take seriously the distinction between persons. Sen also points out that individuals differ in their ability to convert resources such as income into welfare. For example, a disabled person may need expensive medical and transport equipment to achieve the same level of welfare. A society that tried to maximize the total amount of welfare would distribute resources so that the marginal increase in welfare from giving an extra dollar to any person would be the same. Resources would therefore be distributed away from the sick and disabled to people who are more efficient convertors of resources into utility.

b. Resourcism

Resourcism is defined by its neutrality about what constitutes the good life. It therefore assesses how well people are doing in terms of their possession of the general purpose resources necessary for the construction of any particular good life. Sen’s criticism of John Rawls’ influential account of the fair distribution of primary goods stands in for a criticism of resourcist approaches in general. Sen’s central argument is that resources should not be the exclusive focus of concern for a fairness-based theory of justice, even if, like Rawls’s primary goods, they are deliberately chosen for their general usefulness to a good life. The reason is that this focus excludes consideration of the variability in individuals’ actual abilities to convert resources into valuable outcomes. In other words, two people with the same vision of the good life and the same bundle of resources may not be equally able to achieve that life, and so resourcists’ neutrality about the use of resources is not as fair as they believe it is. More specifically, Sen disputes Rawls’ argument that the principles of justice should be worked out first for the ‘normal’ case, in terms of a social contract conceived as a rational scheme for mutually advantageous cooperation between people equally able to contribute to society, and only later extended to ‘hard’ cases, such as of disability. Sen believes such cases are far from abnormal and excluding them at the beginning risks building a structure that excludes them permanently. The general problem is that such accounts ‘fetishize’ resources as the embodiment of advantage, rather than focusing on the relationship between resources and people. Nevertheless Sen acknowledges that although the distribution of resources should not be the direct concern in evaluating how well people are doing, it is very relevant to considerations of procedural fairness.

3. Core Concepts and Structure of Sen’s Capability Approach

This section provides a technical overview of Sen’s account.

a. Functionings and Capability

When evaluating well-being, Sen argues, the most important thing is to consider what people are actually able to be and do. The commodities or wealth people have or their mental reactions (utility) are an inappropriate focus because they provide only limited or indirect information about how well a life is going. Sen illustrates his point with the example of a standard bicycle. This has the characteristics of ‘transportation’ but whether it will actually provide transportation will depend on the characteristics of those who try to use it. It might be considered a generally useful tool for most people to extend their mobility, but it obviously will not do that for a person without legs. Even if that person, by some quirk, finds the bicycle delightful, we should nevertheless be able to note within our evaluative system that she still lacks transportation. Nor does this mental reaction show that the same person would not appreciate transportation if it were really available to her.

The Capability Approach focuses directly on the quality of life that individuals are actually able to achieve. This quality of life is analyzed in terms of the core concepts of ‘functionings’ and ‘capability’.

  • Functionings are states of ‘being and doing’  such as being well-nourished, having shelter. They should be distinguished from the commodities employed to achieve them (as ‘bicycling’ is distinguishable from ‘possessing a bike’).
  • Capability refers to the set of valuable functionings that a person has effective access to. Thus, a person’s capability represents the effective freedom of an individual to choose between different functioning combinations – between different kinds of life – that she has reason to value. (In later work, Sen refers to ‘capabilities’ in the plural (or even ‘freedoms’) instead of a single capability set, and this is also common in the wider capability literature. This allows analysis to focus on sets of functionings related to particular aspects of life, for example, the capabilities of literacy, health, or political freedom.)

 

 

 

 

 

 

 

 

 

Figure 1. Outline of the core relationships in the Capability Approach

Figure 1 outlines the core relationships of the Capability Approach and how they relate to the main alternative approaches focused on resources and utility. Resources (such as a bicycle) are considered as an input, but their value depends upon individuals’ ability to convert them into valuable functionings (such as bicycling), which depends, for example, on their personal physiology (such as health), social norms, and physical environment (such as road quality). An individual’s capability set is the set of valuable functionings that an individual has real access to. Achieved functionings are those they actually select. For example, an individual’s capability set may include access to different functionings relating to mobility, such as walking, bicycling, taking a public bus, and so on. The functioning they actually select to get to work may be the public bus. Utility is considered both an output and a functioning. Utility is an output because what people choose to do and to be naturally has an effect on their sense of subjective well-being (for example, the pleasure of bicycling to work on a sunny day). However the Capability Approach also considers subjective well-being – feeling happy – as a valuable functioning in its own right and incorporates it into the capability framework.

b. Valuation: Which Functionings Matter for the Good Life?

Sen argues that the correct focus for evaluating how well off people are is their capability to live a life we have reason to value, not their resource wealth or subjective well-being. But in order to begin to evaluate how people are performing in terms of capability, we first need to determine which functionings matter for the good life and how much, or at least we need to specify a valuation procedure for determining this.

One way of addressing the problem is to specify a list of the constituents of the flourishing life, and do this on philosophical grounds (Martha Nussbaum does this for her Capability Theory of Justice). Sen rejects this approach because he argues that it denies the relevance of the values people may come to have and the role of democracy (Sen 2004b). Philosophers and social scientists may provide helpful ideas and arguments, but the legitimate source of decisions about the nature of the life we have reason to value must be the people concerned. Sen therefore proposes a social choice exercise requiring both public reasoning and democratic procedures of decision-making.

One reason that social scientists and philosophers are so keen to specify a list is that it can be used as an index: by ranking all the different constituents of the flourishing life with respect to each other it would allow easier evaluation of how well people are doing. Sen’s social choice exercise is unlikely to produce collective agreement on a complete ranking of different functionings, if only because of what Rawls called the ‘fact of reasonable disagreement’. But Sen argues that substantial action-guiding agreement is possible. First, different valuational perspectives may ‘intersect’ to reach similar judgments about some issues, though by way of different arguments. Second, such agreements may be extended by introducing ‘ranges’ of weights rather than cardinal numbers. For example, if there are four conflicting views about the relative weight to be attached to literacy vis-à-vis health, of ½, ⅓, ¼ and 1/5, that contains an implicit agreement that the relative weight on education should not exceed ½, nor fall below 1/5, so having one unit of literacy and two of health would be better than having two units of literacy and one of health.

Sen does suggest that in many cases a sub-set of crucially important capabilities associated with basic needs may be relatively easily identified and agreed upon as urgent moral and political priorities. These ‘basic capabilities’, such as education, health, nutrition, and shelter up to minimally adequate levels, do not exhaust the resources of the capability approach, only the easy agreement on what counts as being scandalously deprived. They may be particularly helpful in assessing the extent and nature of poverty in developing countries. However, taking a basic capability route has implications for how the exercise of evaluating individuals’ capability can proceed, since it can only evaluate how well people’s lives are going in terms of the basics.

c. Evaluation: What Capability do People Have to Live a Good Life?

Evaluating capability is a second order exercise concerned with mapping the set of valuable functionings people have real access to. Since it takes the value of functionings as given, its conclusions will reflect any ambiguity in the valuation stage.

Assessing capability is more informationally demanding than other accounts of advantage since it not only takes a much broader view of what well-being achievement consists in but also tries to assess the freedom people actually have to choose high quality options. This is not a purely procedural matter of adding up the number of options available, since the option to purchase a tenth brand of washing powder has a rather different significance than the option to vote in democratic elections. For example, Sen argues that the eradication of malaria from an area enhances the capability of individuals living there even though it doesn’t increase the number of options those individuals have (since they don’t have the ‘option’ to live in a malarial area anymore). Because the value of a capability set represents a person’s effective freedom to live a valuable life in terms of the value of the functionings available to that individual, when the available functionings are improved, so is the person’s effective freedom.

The capability approach in principle allows a very wide range of dimensions of advantage to be positively evaluated (‘what capabilities does this person have?’). This allows an open diagnostic approach to what is going well or badly in people’s lives that can be used to reveal unexpected shortfalls or successes in different dimensions, without aggregating them all together into one number. The informational focus can be tightened depending on the purpose of the evaluation exercise and relevant valuational and informational constraints. For example, if the approach is limited to considering ‘basic capabilities’ then the assessment is limited to a narrower range of dimensions and attempts to assess deprivation – the shortfall from the minimal thresholds of those capabilities – which will exclude evaluation of how well the lives of those above the threshold are going.

As well as being concerned with how well people’s lives are going, the Capability Approach can be used to examine the underlying determinants of the relationship between people and commodities, including the following (Sen 1999, 70-71):

(1)      Individual physiology, such as the variations associated with illnesses, disability, age, and gender. In order to achieve the same functionings, people may have particular needs for non-standard commodities – such as prosthetics for a disability – or they may need more of the standard commodities – such as additional food in the case of intestinal parasites. Note that some of these disadvantages, such as blindness, may not be fully ‘correctable’ even with tailored assistance.

(2)      Local environment diversities, such as climate, epidemiology, and pollution. These can impose particular costs such as more or less expensive heating or clothing requirements.

(3)      Variations in social conditions, such as the provision of public services such as education and security, and the nature of community relationships, such as across class or ethnic divisions.

(4)      Differences in relational perspectives. Conventions and customs determine the commodity requirements of expected standards of behaviour and consumption, so that relative income poverty in a rich community may translate into absolute poverty in the space of capability. For example, local requirements of ‘the ability to appear in public without shame’ in terms of acceptable clothing may vary widely.

(5)      Distribution within the family – distributional rules within a family determining, for example, the allocation of food and health-care between children and adults, males and females.

 

The diagnosis of capability failures, or significant interpersonal variations in capability, directs attention to the relevant causal pathways responsible. Note that many of these interpersonal variations will also influence individuals’ abilities to access resources to begin with. For example, the physically handicapped often have more expensive requirements to achieve the same capabilities, such as mobility, while at the same time they also have greater difficulty earning income in the first place.

4. Applying Sen’s Capability Approach

The concept of a capability has a global-local character in that its definition abstracts from particular circumstances, but its realization depends on specific local requirements. For example, the same capability to be well-nourished can be compared for different people although it may require different amounts and kinds of food depending on one’s age, state of health, and so on. This makes the Capability Approach applicable across political, economic, and cultural borders. For example, Sen points out that being relatively income poor in a wealthy society can entail absolute poverty in some important capabilities, because they may require more resources to achieve. For example, the capability for employment may require more years of education in a richer society

Many capabilities will have underlying requirements that vary strongly with social circumstances (although others, such as adequate nourishment, may vary less). For example, the ‘ability to appear in public without shame’ seems a capability that people might generally be said to have reason to value, but its requirements vary significantly according to cultural norms from society to society and for different groups within each society (such as by gender, class, and ethnicity). Presently in Saudi Arabia, for example, women must have the company of a close male relative to appear in public, and require a chauffeur and private car to move between private spaces (since they are not permitted to use public transport or drive a car themselves). Strictly speaking the Capability Approach leaves open whether such ‘expensive’ capabilities, if considered important enough to be guaranteed by society as a matter of justice, should be met by making more resources available to those who need them (subsidized cars and chauffeurs), or by revising the relevant social norms. The Capability Approach only identifies such capability failures and diagnoses their causes. However, if there is general agreement in the first place that such capabilities should be equally guaranteed for all, there is a clear basis for criticizing clearly unjust social norms as the source of relative deprivation and thus as inconsistent with the spirit of such a guarantee.

The capability approach takes a multi-dimensional approach to evaluation. Often it may seem that people are generally well-off, yet a closer analysis reveals that this ‘all-things-considered’ judgement conceals surprising shortfalls in particular capabilities, for example, the sporting icon who can’t read. Capability analysis rejects the presumption that unusual achievement in some dimensions compensates for shortfalls in others. From a justice perspective, the capability approach’s relevance here is to argue that if people are falling short on a particular capability that has been collectively agreed to be a significant one, then justice would require addressing the shortfall itself if at all possible, rather than offering compensation in some other form, such as increased income.

Capability evaluation is informationally demanding and its precision is limited by the level of agreement about which functionings are valuable. However, Sen has shown that even where only elementary evaluation of quite basic capabilities is possible (for example, life-expectancy or literacy outcomes), this can still provide much more, and more relevant, action-guiding information than the standard alternatives. In particular, by making perspicuous contrasts between successes and failures the capability approach can direct political and public attention to neglected dimensions of human well-being. For example, countries with similar levels of wealth can have dramatically different levels of aggregate achievement – and inequality – on such non-controversially important dimensions as longevity and literacy. And, vice versa, countries with very small economies can sometimes score as highly on these dimensions as the richest. This demonstrates both the limitations of relying exclusively on economic metrics for evaluating development, and the fact that national wealth does not pose a rigid constraint on such achievements (that GNP is not destiny). Such analyses are easily politicized in the form of the pointed question, Why can’t we do as well as them?

Philippines South Africa
Gross National Income per capita (ppp) $ 4,002 $9,812
Life expectancy (years) 72.3 52
Mean years of schooling 8.7 8.2

Figure 2. Perspicuous contrasts: The Philippines does more with less

(Data from the 2010 UNDP Human Development Report)

5. Criticisms of Sen’s Capability Approach

This section outlines important criticisms of Sen’s approach, together with his responses.

a. Illiberalism

Liberal critics of Sen often identify the focus of the Capability Approach – ‘the ability to achieve the kind of lives we have reason to value’ – as problematic because it appears to impose an external valuation of the good life, whatever people may actually value. Rawls, for example, notes that the reason for liberals to focus on the fair allocation of general purpose resources rather than achievement is that this best respects each individual’s fundamental right to pursue their own conception of the good life. This relates to Rawls’ conception of justice as political rather than metaphysical: it is not the task of justice to assess people’s achievements, but rather to ensure the fairness of the conditions of participation in a society. Justice should be neutral with regard to judging different people’s conceptions of the good. But this neutrality seems incompatible with the Capability Approach’s concern with assessing people’s achievements, which would seem to require a much more substantive view of what counts as a good life than one needs for assessing general purpose resources. Rawls suggests that this constitutes the privileging of a particular (non-political) comprehensive conception of rational advantage or the good.

In replying to this criticism, Sen particularly points to the heterogeneity (variability) in people’s abilities to convert the same bundle of resources into valuable functionings. Theories of justice that focus on the distribution of means implicitly assume that they will provide the same effective freedom to live the life one has reason to value to all, but this excludes relevant information about the relationship between particular people and resources. Even if one abstracts from existing social inequalities or the results of personal choices (‘option luck’), as many liberal theories of justice do, one will still find a substantial and pervasive variation in the abilities of different members of a society to utilize the same resources – whether of specific goods like education or general purpose goods like income. That means that even if it happened that everyone had the same conception of the good, and the same bundle of resources, the fact of heterogeneity would mean that people would have differential real capability to pursue the life they had reason to value. Therefore, Sen argues, a theory of justice based on fairness should be directly and deeply concerned with the effective freedom – capability – of actual people to achieve the lives they have reason to value.

b. Under-Theorisation

Both capability theorists and external critics express concern that the content and structure of Sen’s Capability Approach is under-theorised and this makes it unsuitable as a theory of justice. Sen does not say which capabilities are important or how they are to be distributed: he argues that those are political decisions for the society itself to decide. Many philosophers have argued that without an objectively justified list of valuable capabilities the nature of the life ‘we have reason to want’ is unclear and so it is hard to identify the goal that a just society should be aiming towards, to assess how well a society is doing, or to criticize particular shortfalls. Different capability theorists have taken different approaches to the valuation of capabilities, from procedural accounts to ones based on substantive understandings of human nature. There are related concerns about the institutional structure of the Capability Approach, for example, brought by the Rawlsian social justice theorist, Thomas Pogge (Pogge 2002). How should capabilities be weighted against each other and non-capability concerns? For example, should some basic capabilities be prioritized as more urgent? What does the Capability Approach imply for interpersonal equality? How should capability enhancement be paid for? How much responsibility should individuals take for the results of their own choices? What should be done about non-remediable deprivations, such as blindness?

Sen’s main response to such criticisms has been to admit that the Capability Approach is not a theory of justice but rather an approach to the evaluation of effective freedom.

c. Individualism

Sen’s emphasis on individual effective freedom as the focal concern of the Capability Approach has been criticized as excessively individualistic. There are several components to this family of criticisms. Some communitarians see Sen’s account as lacking interest in, and even sometimes overtly hostile to, communal values and ways of life because of an excessive focus on individuals. Charles Gore, for example, has argued that Sen’s approach only considers states of affairs and social arrangements in terms of how good or bad they are for an individual’s well-being and freedom (Gore 1997). But this excludes consideration of certain other goods which individuals may have reason to value which are ‘irreducibly social’ because they cannot be reduced to properties of individuals, such as a shared language, set of moral norms, or political structure. A related criticism argues that Sen’s emphasis on individual freedom is vague and fails to consider how one individual’s freedom may affect others. Martha Nussbaum, for example, points out that a just society requires balancing and even limiting certain freedoms, such as regarding the expression of racist views, and in order to do so must make commitments about which freedoms are good or bad, important or trivial (Nussbaum 2003).  Others have noted that ‘freedom’ though broad, is a poor way of conceptualizing certain inter-personal goods such as friendship, respect, and care. A third line of critique takes issue with Sen’s ‘thin’ agency based picture of persons as too abstract and rationalistic. It is said to be founded too closely in Sen’s personal dialectical relationship between economics and philosophy, and not enough in the perspectives and methods of anthropology, sociology, or psychology (see, for example, Giri 2000; Gasper 2002). As a result Sen’s account is said to have a poor grasp, for example, of the centrality and complexity of personal growth and development.

With regard to ‘irreducibly social goods’ like culture, Sen argues that they not only enter into the analysis instrumentally (such as in the requirements for appearing in public without shame) but also as part of the lives people have reason to value. Nevertheless Sen is clear in his view that the value of social goods is only derivative upon the reflective choices of those concerned (see, for example, Sen 2004a). So if people on reflection don’t value such social goods as the traditional religious institutions of their society or continuing to speak a minority language then that should trump the ‘right’ of those institutions to continue. With regard to freedom, Sen distinguishes the ability to choose between different options from the value of those options. These two together make up effective freedom or capability. Simple freedom to choose may be vulnerable to the objection that it is compatible with invidious freedoms, but the Capability Approach is concerned with people’s ability to live a life they have reason to value, which incorporates an ethical evaluation of the content of their options. It is not concerned only with increasing people’s freedom-as-power. Finally, Sen’s Capability Approach is particularly concerned with grasping the dimensions of human well-being and advantage missing from standard approaches. This relates to its concern with tracing the causal pathways of specific deprivations, with how exactly different people are able or unable to convert resources into valuable functionings. Although this remains somewhat abstractly presented in the formal structure of the Capability Approach, Sen’s analysis of, for example, adaptive preferences and intra-household distribution do go at least some way to a situated and sociological analysis.

d. Information Gaps

Sen’s Capability Approach is founded on the idea that much more information about the quality of human lives can and should be taken into account in evaluating them. The Human Development Index developed by Amartya Sen and the economist Mahbub ul Haq in 1990 for the United Nations Development Programme’s Human Development Reports is the most influential capability metric currently used. However it has been criticized for its crudeness. It contains only three dimensions – longevity, literacy (mean years of schooling), and Gross National Income per capita – which are weighted equally. The Capability Approach is supposed to be interested in assessing how people fare on many dimensions of life including some which seem very difficult to obtain information about, such as people’s real choice sets or such complicated capabilities as the ability to appear in public without shame or to form relationships with others. It also requires detailed information on the real inter-personal variations in translating commodities into functionings. It is not clear however that such informational ambitions could ever be realized. Furthermore even the effort of trying to collect such detailed information about people’s lives and their ‘real’ disabilities can be seen as invasive.

Sen was concerned about the crudeness of the Human Development Index (HDI) from the start, but was won over by Mahbub ul Haq’s argument for the rhetorical significance of a composite index of human well-being that could compete directly with the crude GDP per capita numbers that have been so influential in development thinking. Thus the HDI does not fully reflect the scope or methodology of the Capability Approach. Nevertheless it has succeeded in demonstrating that capability related information can be used systematically as a credible supplement to economic metrics. Sen accepts that some information about capabilities is easier to obtain than others. Firstly, he argues that we already have quite extensive information about some basic capabilities even for many quite poor countries, such as about health, that can and should be systematically assessed. There is therefore no need to limit our assessment to economic metrics which firstly count the wrong things (means) and secondly also come with significant measurement error despite their apparent numerical precision. Secondly, he argues that if researchers accept the capability space as the new priority for evaluation that will motivate the development of new data collection priorities and methods. As a result more information will become available about how people are faring on the currently ‘missing dimensions’ of the lives we have reason to value, for example, relating to employment or gender equality in domestic arrangements. Nevertheless, the Capability Approach is not concerned with information collection for its own sake, but rather with the appropriate use of information for assessment. It is therefore not committed to, nor does its effective use require, building a perfect information collection and assessment bureaucracy.

6. Theorising the Capability Approach

A number of philosophers sympathetic to Sen’s foundational concerns have nevertheless been dissatisfied with the vagueness and under-elaboration of the theoretical structure of his Capability Approach (although these features seem to be quite deliberate on Sen’s part). A number of theoretical accounts have been developed that seek to elaborate the Capability Approach more systematically and to address these philosophers’ particular concerns. Some theoretical accounts are primarily concerned with operationalising the evaluative dimension of the Capability Approach: the assessment of quality of life, well-being and human development. Others focus on developing a capability based ‘Theory of Justice’ in the spirit of its concerns. This section provides a brief outline of some of these.

a. Generating Lists for Empirical Research in the Social Sciences (Ingrid Robeyns)

Ingrid Robeyns argues that attempting to develop a single all-purpose list of capabilities would be incompatible with Sen’s concern with a general framework of evaluation. Instead she proposes a procedural approach to the selection of capabilities for particular purposes, such as the evaluation of gender inequality in terms of capabilities (Robeyns 2003). She claims that valuational procedures that meet her criteria provide epistemic, academic, and political legitimacy for empirically evaluating capability. Her five criteria are:

(1) Explicit formulation. All proposed list elements should be explicit, so they can be discussed and debated.

(2) Methodological justification. The method of generating the list should be made explicit so it can be scrutinized.

(3) Sensitivity to context. The level of abstraction of the list should be appropriate to its purposes, whether for philosophical, legal, political, or social discussion.

(4) Different levels of generality. If the list is intended for empirical application or public policy then it should be drawn up in two distinct stages, first an ideal stage and then a pragmatic one that reflects perhaps temporary feasibility constraints on information and resources.

(5) Exhaustion and non-reduction. The list should include all important elements and those elements should not be reducible to others (though they may overlap).

b. A Participatory Approach to Evaluating Capability Expansion (Sabina Alkire)

Sabina Alkire has developed a philosophically grounded framework for the participatory valuation and evaluation of development projects in terms of capability enhancement (Alkire 2005). This allows her to go beyond standard cost-benefit analyses of development projects in financial terms to investigate which capabilities that the people concerned have reason to value are enhanced and by how much.

Alkire’s approach has 2 stages of evaluation: i) a theoretical one-off stage in which ‘philosophers’ employ practical reason to reflexively identify the basic spheres or categories of value, and ii) a local participatory phase in which members of a social group deliberate, with the aid of a facilitator, about what their needs are and what, and how, they would like to do about them (with the basic categories employed as prompts to ensure that all main dimensions of value are discussed). For the first, philosophical, stage Alkire proposes an adaptation of the practical reasoning approach of John Finnis to identify the basic dimensions of human well-being by asking iteratively, ‘why do I/others do what we do?’ until one comes to recognize the basic reasons for which no further reasoned justification can be given. This method is intended to yield substantive and objective descriptions of the fundamental, non-hierarchically ordered, dimensions of human flourishing, while allowing the content and relative importance of these dimensions to be specified in a participatory process according to a particular group’s historical, cultural, and personal values. The intrinsically important dimensions identified by this method are: Life; Knowledge; Play; Aesthetic experience; Sociability; Practical reasonableness; Religion.

One of the advantages Alkire claims for her approach is its ability to elicit what the people whose lives are the subject of development projects really consider valuable, which may sometimes surprise external planners and observers. Her use of the participatory approach for assessing NGO fieldwork in Pakistan showed, for example, that even the very poor can and do reasonably value other things than material well-being, such as religion and social participation.

c. Justice as Equal Capability of Democratic Citizenship (Elizabeth Anderson)

Elizabeth Anderson has proposed a partial theory of justice based on equal capability of democratic citizenship (Anderson 1999). Anderson takes equality in social relationships as the focus for her egalitarian theory of justice and argues that one should analyze the requirements of such equality in terms of the social conditions supporting it as a capability. Although Anderson’s primary concern is for equality in the particular dimension of democratic citizenship, she suggests that this has extensive egalitarian implications for the nature of the society as a whole, because other capabilities – such as relating to health, education, personal autonomy and self-respect, and economic fairness – are required as supporting conditions to realize truly equal citizenship.  She argues that, “Negatively, people are entitled to whatever capabilities are necessary to enable them to avoid or escape entanglement in oppressive social relationships. Positively, they are entitled to whatever capabilities are necessary for functioning as an equal citizen in a democratic state (Anderson 1999, 317).”

d. Capability as Freedom from Domination (John Alexander)

John Alexander has proposed a capability theory based on a Republican understanding of the importance of freedom as non-domination (Alexander 2008). He argues that the Capability Approach’s concern with people’s ‘real freedom’ sets it outside and against the standard liberal egalitarian theory of justice framework which understands freedom as the absence of constraints. But he argues that the Capability Approach should go further to elaborate this commitment to real freedom in Republican terms. In this perspective it is not only important that one be able to achieve certain functionings, such as mobility, but whether one’s achievement of these are conditional on the favor or goodwill of other people or are independently guaranteed by one’s own rights and powers. Capability is standardly understood as mapping one’s range of choices over valuable functionings regardless of their content. For example, the ability of a physically disabled but socially well-connected person to travel outside whenever she wants by arranging the help of friends, family and voluntary organizations. In addition the Republican perspective requires that her capability for mobility should be independent of context. For example, in the form of a guaranteed legal right to government assistance on demand, or by the provision of her own specially adapted self-drive vehicle. Otherwise she may be said to be still deprived since her capability is not completely free.

Domination should also be integrated into capability evaluation because it will often be a cause of capability deprivation. It is no coincidence that the people who are most capability deprived are often the poorest and weakest in society, and as a result also vulnerable to yet further exploitation. This emphasis on freedom from domination also gives a strong normative orientation to the Capability Approach’s evaluation of the causes of capability failure: some causes are simply unacceptable, such as social norms restricting women’s freedom of movement and employment, and should be removed rather than mitigated.

7. Martha Nussbaum’s Capability Theory of Justice

This section outlines Martha Nussbaum’s work on the Capability Approach: its structure, criticisms, and relationship to Amartya Sen’s work.

a. Structure and Development of Nussbaum’s Capability Theory

Martha Nussbaum has developed the most systematic, extensive, and influential capability theory of justice to date. Nussbaum aims to provide a partial theory of justice (one that doesn’t exhaust the requirements of justice) based on dignity, a list of fundamental capabilities, and a threshold.

Nussbaum’s list of The Central Human Capabilities (Reproduced from Creating Capabilities 2011, 33-4)

1. Life. Being able to live to the end of a human life of normal length; not dying prematurely, or before one’s life is so reduced as to be not worth living.

2. Bodily Health. Being able to have good health, including reproductive health; to be adequately nourished; to have adequate shelter.

3. Bodily Integrity. Being able to move freely from place to place; to be secure against violent assault, including sexual assault and domestic violence; having opportunities for sexual satisfaction and for choice in matters of reproduction.

4. Senses, Imagination, and Thought. Being able to use the senses, to imagine, think, and reason – and to do these things in a ‘‘truly human’’ way, a way informed and cultivated by an adequate education, including, but by no means limited to, literacy and basic mathematical and scientific training. Being able to use imagination and thought in connection with experiencing and producing works and events of one’s own choice, religious, literary, musical, and so forth. Being able to use one’s mind in ways protected by guarantees of freedom of expression with respect to both political and artistic speech, and freedom of religious exercise. Being able to have pleasurable experiences and to avoid non-beneficial pain.

5. Emotions. Being able to have attachments to things and people outside ourselves; to love those who love and care for us, to grieve at their absence; in general, to love, to grieve, to experience longing, gratitude, and justified anger. Not having one’s emotional development blighted by fear and anxiety. (Supporting this capability means supporting forms of human association that can be shown to be crucial in their development.)

6. Practical Reason. Being able to form a conception of the good and to engage in critical reflection about the planning of one’s life. (This entails protection for the liberty of conscience and religious observance.)

7. Affiliation.

A. Being able to live with and toward others, to recognize and show concern for other human beings, to engage in various forms of social interaction; to be able to imagine the situation of another. (Protecting this capability means protecting institutions that constitute and nourish such forms of affiliation, and also protecting the freedom of assembly and political speech.)

B. Having the social bases of self-respect and nonhumiliation; being able to be treated as a dignified being whose worth is equal to that of others. This entails provisions of nondiscrimination on the basis of race, sex, sexual orientation, ethnicity, caste, religion, national origin.

8. Other Species. Being able to live with concern for and in relation to animals, plants, and the world of nature.

9. Play. Being able to laugh, to play, to enjoy recreational activities.

10. Control Over One’s Environment.

A. Political. Being able to participate effectively in political choices that govern one’s life; having the right of political participation, protections of free speech and association.

B. Material. Being able to hold property (both land and movable goods), and having property rights on an equal basis with others; having the right to seek employment on an equal basis with others; having the freedom from unwarranted search and seizure. In work, being able to work as a human being, exercising practical reason, and entering into meaningful relationships of mutual recognition with other workers.

In her early contributions to the capability approach, Nussbaum justified the composition of her list by explicitly Aristotelian argument about the perfectionist requirements of the truly human life (Nussbaum 1988). In the mid-1990s however she converted the structure of her account to a Rawlsian style ‘politically liberal’ account. This means that she now presents her list as a proposal that is neutral with respect to particular conceptions of the good, but can be endorsed by many different groups in a society through an overlapping consensus. However the list components themselves remain almost identical and retain a distinctively Aristotelian cast.

Nussbaum’s account is motivated by a concept of human dignity (in contrast to Sen’s emphasis on freedom), which she links to flourishing in the Aristotelian sense. She argues that her list of 10 fundamental capabilities follow from the requirements of dignity and have been tested and adapted over the course of an extensive cross-cultural dialogue she has carried out, particularly in India (as related in her book, Women and Human Development, 2001). The threshold is a ‘sufficientarian’ principle that specifies the minimum requirements of justice: everyone must be entitled to each capability at least to this degree by their governments and relevant international institutions. Access to these capabilities is required by human dignity, Nussbaum argues, but this does not mean that a life lacking in any of these, whether from external deprivation or individual choice, is a less than human life. Choice and deprivation are different however. If someone lacks access to these capabilities, for example, to be well-nourished (bodily health), that reflects a failure by society to respect her human dignity. If someone chooses not to take up her opportunities to certain capabilities, for example, to adopt an ascetic life-style and fast for religious reasons at the expense of her bodily health, respecting that choice is also an aspect of respecting her dignity.

Nussbaum suggests that her list, together with the precise location of the threshold, should be democratically debated and incorporated into national constitutional guarantees, international human rights legislation and international development policy. In keeping with its commitment to political liberalism, the components of Nussbaum’s list have a ‘thick-vague’ character in that while they have a universal claim to be of central importance to any human life, their definition is vague enough to allow their specification in multiple ways that reflect the values, histories, and special circumstances of particular political societies. For example, freedom of speech may be defined differently in law in the USA and Germany, because of their different histories, without endangering the fundamental capability. Nevertheless, because each capability is equally centrally important and a shortfall in any area is significant in itself, the scope for governments to make trade-offs between them, for example, on the basis of quantitative cost-benefit analysis, is limited.

b. Criticisms of Nussbaum’s Theory

Nussbaum’s capability theory of justice received quite intense criticism. Some have questioned the epistemological basis of her approach, finding it rather suspicious that after all her years of cross-cultural discussion her list remains basically the same rather ‘intellectualized’ Aristotelian one she had suggested in the first place (Okin 2003), and suggest that it rather reflects the values of a typical 21st century American liberal than a set of timeless universal values or a contemporary global overlapping consensus (Stewart 2001). Others have argued that her legal-moral-philosophical orientation is elitist and over-optimistic about what constitutions and governments are like and are capable of (Menon 2002); is over-specified and paternalistic yet still misses out important capabilities and is inappropriate for many uses, such as quality of life measurement or development fieldwork (Alkire 2005, 35-45).

In response to such criticisms, Nussbaum has defended the contents of her list as having cross-cultural credibility, but also emphasised that she is not trying to impose a definitive capability theory on everyone. She makes a clear and explicit distinction between the dimensions of justification (why her theory is best) and implementation (its more humble meta-status as an object for democratic deliberation and decision by those concerned) (Nussbaum 2004).

c. Sen and Nussbaum

Nussbaum and Sen collaborated in the late 1980s and early 1990s and since they are the most high-profile writers in the Capability Approach their accounts are often elided, despite significant differences. When they are distinguished, Nussbaum’s account is often seen as the more ‘philosophical’ because she has developed the Capability Approach in a more orthodox philosophical way, for example, by focusing on theoretical rigor, coherence and completeness. As a result, Sen’s approach is sometimes perceived merely as a predecessor to Nussbaum’s more developed second generation account, and therefore of primarily historical interest to understanding the Capability Approach rather than a parallel account in its own right.

The accounts of Sen and Nussbaum differ significantly in ways that relate to their different concerns and backgrounds. In particular:

  • Nussbaum is concerned to produce a philosophically coherent normative (partial) theory of justice; Sen is concerned with producing a general framework for evaluating the quality of lives people can lead that can incorporate the very diverse concerns and dimensions that may be applicable.
  • While Sen’s approach is founded on enhancing individual freedom, Nussbaum’s theory is founded on respecting human dignity.
  • Sen’s comprehensive consequentialism makes room for incorporating empirical information about feasibility and instrumental relationships between capabilities when considering policies; Nussbaum largely rejects such instrumental analysis because she is wary of its ‘Utilitarian associations’.
  • Sen’s Capability Approach in its normative ‘developmental’ aspect, is mainly concerned with practical incremental improvements; Nussbaum’s approach is rather more utopian in that it demands the full implementation of minimal justice (achievement of the minimum thresholds of all fundamental capabilities) for all, and this is specified so demandingly that no country yet meets it (though she has suggested that Finland may be close).

8. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • John M. Alexander 2008. Capabilities and Social Justice. Ashgate Publishing, Ltd.
    • Introduction to the Capability Approach, with attention to Sen’s, Nussbaum’s, and Anderson’s accounts and a development of his own Republican account in the final chapter.
  • Sabina Alkire. 2005. Valuing Freedoms. Oxford University Press.
    • First half of the book develops a procedure for operationalizing the Capability Approach for participatory development; second half applies this to the evaluation of development projects.
  • Elizabeth Anderson. 1999. “What Is the Point of Equality?” Ethics 109 (2): 287-337.
    • Critique of luck egalitarianism and outline of a capability theory of justice based on the capability for equal democratic citizenship.
  • Martha Nussbaum. 1988. Nature, Function, and Capability: Aristotle on Political Distribution. In Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy. Oxford University Press.
    • Martha Nussbaum’s first contribution to the capability approach, based on a reading of Aristotle’s politics and ethics.
  • Martha Nussbaum. 2001. Women and Human Development (Cambridge University Press,).
    • Key text in Nussbaum’s second stage – political – development of a capability theory of justice.
  • Martha Nussbaum. 2004. “On Hearing Women’s Voices: A Reply to Susan Okin.” Philosophy and Public Affairs 32 (2): 193-205.
    • Nussbaum replies to criticisms of the methodology and legitimacy of her list.
  • Martha Nussbaum. 2011. Creating Capabilities: The Human Development Approach (Harvard University Press).
    • Non-technical introduction to the capability approach and Nussbaum’s capability theory of justice intended for university undergraduates.
  • Ingrid Robeyns. 2003. “Sen’s Capability Approach and Gender Inequality: selecting relevant capabilities.” Feminist Economics 9 (2): 61-92.
    • Robeyns outlines her procedure for choosing capabilities and applies it to the case of gender equality.
  • Amartya Sen. 1979. Equality of What? Stanford University: Tanner Lectures on Human Values (Available from the Tanner Lectures website)
    • Amartya Sen’s first publication on the capability approach, particularly focused on criticizing utilitarian and Rawlsian perspectives on well-being.
  • Amartya Sen. 1985. Commodities and Capabilities. North-Holland.
    • The most formal (technical) elaboration of Sen’s capability approach.
  • Amartya Sen. 1989. “Development as Capability Expansion,” Journal of Development Planning 19: 41–58.
    • An especially accessible and succinct account of the capability approach to human development.
  • Amartya Sen. 1999. Development as Freedom. Oxford University Press.
    • Important and influential synthesis of Sen’s work on human development and the Capability Approach.
  • Amartya Sen. 2004a. UN Human Development Report 2004: Chapter 1 Cultural Liberty and Human Development. UN Human Development Reports. United Nations Development Programme. (Available from the UNDP website).
    • Strong argument by Sen that cultural rights should be derivative upon individuals’ freedom to choose.
  • Amartya Sen. 2004b. “Capabilities, Lists, and Public Reason: Continuing the Conversation,” Feminist Economics 10, no. 3: 77-80.
    • An interview with Amartya Sen in which he elaborates on his rejection of a fixed list of capabilities (frequently cited).

b. Secondary Sources

  • Des Gasper. 2002. “Is Sen’s Capability Approach an Adequate Basis for Considering Human Development?” Review of Political Economy 14 (4): 435-461.
    • Thorough analysis of Sen’s account, including a critique of its excessive abstraction.
  • Ananta Kumar Giri. 2000. “Rethinking Human Well-being: A Dialogue with Amartya Sen.” Journal of International Development 12 (7): 1003-1018.
    • Critique of Sen’s neglect of personal development.
  • Charles Gore. 1997. “Irreducibly Social Goods and the Informational Basis of Amartya Sen’s Capability Approach.” Journal of International Development 9 (2): 235-250.
    • Critique of Sen’s neglect of social values.
  • Susan Moller Okin. 2003. “Poverty, Well-Being, and Gender: What Counts, Who’s Heard?” Philosophy and Public Affairs 31 (3): 280-316.
    • Feminist critique of Nussbaum’s theory
  • Nivedita Menon. 2002. “Universalism without Foundations?” Economy and Society 31 (1): 152.
    • Critique of the political philosophy in Nussbaum’s theory.
  • Martha Nussbaum. 2003. “Capabilities as Fundamental Entitlements: Sen and Social Justice.” Feminist Economics 9 (2): 33.
    • Critique of Sen’s Capability Approach as too vaguely specified to support normative judgments.
  • Thomas Pogge. 2002. “Can the Capability Approach Be Justified?” Philosophical Topics 30 (2): 167–228.
    • Important Rawlsian critique of Sen’s account, frequently cited.
  • Frances Stewart. 2001. Book Review “Women and Human Development: The Capabilities Approach, by Martha Nussbaum” Journal of International Development 13 (8): 1191-1192.
    • Short but powerful critique of Nussbaum’s capability theory from a leading human development scholar.

 

Author Information

Thomas Wells
Email: t.r.wellsdunelm.org.uk
Erasmus University Rotterdam
The Netherlands

German Idealism

German idealism is the name of a movement in German philosophy that began in the 1780s and lasted until the 1840s. The most famous representatives of this movement are Kant, Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel. While there are important differences between these figures, they all share a commitment to idealism. Kant’s transcendental idealism was a modest philosophical doctrine about the difference between appearances and things in themselves, which claimed that the objects of human cognition are appearances and not things in themselves. Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel radicalized this view, transforming Kant’s transcendental idealism into absolute idealism, which holds that things in themselves are a contradiction in terms, because a thing must be an object of our consciousness if it is to be an object at all.

German idealism is remarkable for its systematic treatment of all the major parts of philosophy, including logic, metaphysics and epistemology, moral and political philosophy, and aesthetics.  All of the representatives of German idealism thought these parts of philosophy would find a place in a general system of philosophy. Kant thought this system could be derived from a small set of interdependent principles. Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel were, again, more radical. Inspired by Karl Leonhard Reinhold, they attempted to derive all the different parts of philosophy from a single, first principle. This first principle came to be known as the absolute, because the absolute, or unconditional, must precede all the principles which are conditioned by the difference between one principle and another.

Although German idealism is closely related to developments in the intellectual history of Germany in the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries, such as classicism and romanticism, it is also closely related to larger developments in the history of modern philosophy. Kant, Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel sought to overcome the division between rationalism and empiricism that had emerged during the early modern period. The way they characterized these tendencies has exerted a lasting influence on the historiography of modern philosophy. Although German idealism itself has been subject to periods of neglect in the last two hundred years, renewed interest in the contributions of the German idealism have made it an important resource for contemporary philosophy.

Table of Contents

  1. Historical Background
  2. Logic
  3. Metaphysics and Epistemology
  4. Moral and Political Philosophy
  5. Aesthetics
  6. Reception and Influence
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. Kant
      1. German Editions of Kant’s Works
      2. Cambridge Edition of the Works of Immanuel Kant in Translation
      3. Other English Translations of Kant’s Works
    2. Fichte
      1. German Editions of Fichte’s Works
      2. English Translations of Fichte’s Works
    3. Hegel
      1. German Editions of Hegel’s Works
      2. English Translations of Hegel’s Works
        1. Cambridge Hegel Translations
        2. Other English Translations of Hegel’s Works
    4. Schelling
      1. German Editions of Schelling’s Works
      2. English Translations of Schelling’s Works
    5. Editions and Translations of Other Primary Sources
      1. Jacobi
      2. Reinhold
      3. Hölderlin
      4. Kierkegaard, Søren
      5. Marx
      6. Schopenhauer
    6. Other Works on German Idealism

1. Historical Background

 

German idealism can be traced back to the “critical” or “transcendental” idealism of Immanuel Kant (1724-1804). Kant’s idealism first came to prominence during the pantheism controversy in 1785-1786. When the controversy arose, Kant had already published the first (A) edition of the Critique of Pure Reason (1781) and the Prolegomena to Any Future Metaphysics (1783). Both works had their admirers, but they received unsympathetic and generally uncomprehending reviews, conflating Kant’s “transcendental” idealism with Berkeley’s “dogmatic” idealism (Allison and Heath 2002, 160-166). Thus, Kant was taken to hold that space and time are “not actual” and that the understanding “makes” the objects of our cognition (Sassen 2000, 53-54).

Kant insisted that this reading misrepresented his position. While the dogmatic idealist denies the reality of space and time, Kant takes space and time to be forms of intuition. Forms of intuition are, for Kant, the subjective conditions of the possibility of all of our sense perception. It is only because space and time are a priori forms that determine the content of our sensations that Kant thinks we can perceive anything at all. According to Kant, “critical” or “transcendental” idealism serves merely to identify those a priori conditions, like space and time, that make experience possible. It certainly does not imply that space and time are unreal or that the understanding produces the objects of our cognition by itself.

Kant hoped to enlist the support of famous German philosophers like Moses Mendelssohn (1729-1786), Johan Nicolai Tetens (1738-1807), and Christian Garve (1742-1798) in order to refute the “dogmatic” idealist interpretation of his philosophy and win a more favorable hearing for his work. Unfortunately, the endorsements Kant hoped for never arrived. Mendelssohn, in particular, was preoccupied with concerns about his health and the dispute that had arisen between himself and Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi (1743-1819) about the alleged Spinozism of his friend Gotthold Ephraim Lessing (1729-1781). This dispute came to be known as the pantheism controversy, because of Spinoza’s famous equivocation between God and nature.

During the controversy, Jacobi charged that any attempt to demonstrate philosophical truths was fatally flawed. Jacobi pointed to Spinoza as the chief representative of the tendency toward demonstrative reason in philosophy, but he also drew parallels between Spinozism and Kant’s transcendental idealism throughout On the Doctrine of Spinoza (1785). In 1787, the same year Kant published the second (B) edition of the Critique of Pure Reason, Jacobi published David Hume on Faith or Realism and Idealism, which included a supplement On Transcendental Idealism. Jacobi concluded that transcendental idealism, like Spinozism, subordinates the immediate certainty, or faith, through which we know the world, to demonstrative reason, transforming reality into an illusion. Jacobi later called this “nihilism.”

Kant’s views were defended by Karl Leonhard Reinhold (1757-1823) during the pantheism controversy. Reinhold thought Kant’s philosophy could refute skepticism and nihilism and provide a defense of morality and religion which was not to be found in the rationalism of the Leibnizian-Wolffian philosophy. The publication of Reinhold’s Letters on the Kantian Philosophy, first in Der Teutsche Merkur in 1786-1787 and then again in an enlarged version in 1790-1792, helped make Kant’s philosophy one of the most influential, and most controversial, philosophies of the period. Jacobi remained a thorn in the side of the Kantians and the young German idealists, but he was unable to staunch interest in philosophy in general or idealism in particular.

In 1787, Reinhold assumed a position at the university in Jena, where he taught Kant’s philosophy and began developing his own ideas. While Reinhold’s thought continued to be influenced by Kant, he also came to believe that Kant had failed to provide philosophy with a solid foundation. According to Reinhold, Kant was a philosophical genius, but he did not have the “genius of system” that would allow him to properly order his discoveries. Reinhold’s Elementarphilosophie (Elementary Philosophy/Philosophy of Elements), laid out in his Essay Towards a New Theory of the Faculty of Representation (1789), Contribution to the Correction of the Previous Misunderstandings of the Philosophers (1790), and On the Foundation of Philosophical Knowledge (1791), was intended to address this shortcoming and show that Kant’s philosophy could be derived from a single foundational principle. Reinhold called this principle “the principle of consciousness” and states that “in consciousness, representation is distinguished by the subject from subject and object and is referred to both.” With this principle, Reinhold thought he could explain what is fundamental to all cognition, namely, that 1) cognition is essentially the conscious representation of an object by a subject and 2) that representations refer to both the subject and object of cognition.

When Reinhold left Jena for a new position in Kiel in 1794, his chair was given to Johann Gottlieb Fichte (1762-1814), who quickly radicalized Kant’s idealism and Reinhold’s attempts to systematize philosophy. In response to a skeptical challenge to Reinhold’s Elementarphilosophie, raised anonymously by Gottlob Ernst Schulze (1761-1833) in his work Aenesidemus (1792), Fichte asserted that the principle of representation was not, as Reinhold had maintained, a fact (Tatsache) of consciousness, but rather an act (Tathandlung) whereby consciousness produces the distinction between subject and object by positing the distinction between the I and not-I (Breazeale, 1988, 64). This insight became the foundation of Fichte’s Wissenschaftslehre (Doctrine of Science/Doctrine of Scientific Knowledge) which was first published in 1794. It was soon followed by Fichte’s Foundations of Natural Right (1797) and the System of Ethics (1798). In later years, Fichte presented a number of substantially different versions of the Wissenschaftslehre in lectures in Berlin.

When, as a result of a controversy concerning his religious views, Fichte left Jena in 1799, Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph von Schelling (1775-1854) became the most important idealist in Jena. Schelling had arrived in Jena in 1798, when he was only 23 years old, but he was already an enthusiastic proponent of Fichte’s philosophy, which he defended in early works like On the I as Principle of Philosophy (1795). Schelling had also established close relationships with the Jena romantics, who, despite their great interest in Kant, Reinhold, and Fichte, maintained a more skeptical attitude towards philosophy than the German idealists. Although Schelling did not share the romantics’ reservations about idealism, the proximity between Schelling and the romantics is evident in Schelling’s writings on the philosophy of nature and the philosophy of art, which he presented in his Ideas for a Philosophy of Nature (1797), System of Transcendental Idealism (1800), and Philosophy of Art (1802-1803).

Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel (1770-1831) had been Schelling’s classmate in Tübingen from 1790-1793. Along with the poet Friedrich Hölderlin (1770-1843), the two had collaborated on The Oldest Program for a System of German Idealism (1796). After following Schelling to Jena in 1801, Hegel published his first independent contributions to German idealism, The Difference Between Fichte’s and Schelling’s System of Philosophy (1801), in which he distinguishes Fichte’s “subjective” idealism from Schelling’s “objective” or “absolute” idealism. Hegel’s work documented the growing rift between Fichte and Schelling. This rift was to expand following Hegel’s falling-out with Schelling in 1807, when Hegel published his monumental Phenomenology of Spirit (1807). Although Hegel only published three more books during his lifetime, Science of Logic (1812-1816), Encyclopedia of the Philosophical Sciences (1817-1830), and Elements of the Philosophy of Right (1821), he remains the most widely-read and most influential of the German idealists.

2. Logic

The German idealists have acquired a reputation for obscurity, because of the length and complexity of many of their works. As a consequence, they are often considered to be obscurantists and irrationalists. The German idealists were, however, neither obscurantists nor irrationalists. Their contributions to logic are earnest attempts to formulate a modern logic that is consistent with the idealism of their metaphysics and epistemology.

Kant was the first of the German idealists to make important contributions to logic. In the Preface to the second (B) edition of the Critique of Pure Reason, Kant argues that logic has nothing to do with metaphysics, psychology, or anthropology, because logic is “the science that exhaustively presents and strictly proves nothing but the formal rules of all thinking” (Guyer and Wood 1998, 106-107/Bviii-Bix). Kant came to refer to this purely formal logic as “general” logic, which is to be contrasted with the “Transcendental Logic” that he develops in the second part of the “Transcendental Doctrine of Elements” in the Critique of Pure Reason. Transcendental logic differs from general logic because, like the principles of a priori sensibility that Kant presents in the “Transcendental Aesthetic” of the Critique of Pure Reason, transcendental logic is part of metaphysics. Transcendental logic also differs from general logic because it does not abstract from the content of cognition. Transcendental logic contains the laws of pure thinking as they pertain to the cognition of objects. This does not mean that transcendental logic is concerned with empirical objects as such, but rather with the a priori conditions of the possibility of the cognition of objects. Kant’s famous “Transcendental Deduction of the Pure Concepts of the Understanding” is meant to demonstrate that the concepts the transcendental logic presents as the a priori conditions of the possibility of the cognition of objects do, in fact, make the cognition of objects possible and are necessary conditions for any and all cognition of objects.

In The Foundation of Philosophical Knowledge, Reinhold objects that Kant’s transcendental logic presupposed general logic, because transcendental logic is a “particular” logic from which general logic, or “logic proper, without surnames,” cannot be derived. Reinhold insisted that the laws of general logic had to be derived from the principle of consciousness if philosophy was to become systematic and scientific, but the possibility of this derivation was contested by Schulze in Aenesidemus. Schulze’s critique of Reinhold’s Elementarphilosophie focuses on the priority Reinhold attributes to the principle of consciousness. Because the principle of consciousness has to be consistent with basic logical principles like the principle of non-contradiction and the principle of the excluded middle, Schulze concluded that it could not be regarded as a first principle. The laws of general logic were, it seemed, prior to the principle of consciousness, so that even the Elementarphilosophie presupposed general logic.

Fichte accepted many aspects of Schulze’s critique of Reinhold, but, like Reinhold, he thought it was crucial to demonstrate that the laws of logic could be derived from “real philosophy” or “metaphysics.” In his Personal Meditations on the Elementarphilosophie (1792-1793), his essay Concerning the Concept of the Wissenschaftslehre (1794), and then again in the Wissenschaftslehre of 1794, Fichte argued that the act that posits the distinction between the I and not-I determines consciousness in a way that makes logical analysis possible. Logical analysis is always undertaken reflectively, according to Fichte, because it presupposes that consciousness has already been determined in some way. So, while Kant maintains that transcendental logic presupposes general logic, Reinhold attempts to derive the laws of general logic from the principle of consciousness, and Schulze shows Reinhold to presuppose the same principles, Fichte forcefully asserts that logic presupposes the determination of thought “as a fact of consciousness,” which itself depends upon the act through which consciousness is originally determined.

Hegel’s contributions to logic have been far more influential than those of Reinhold or Fichte. His Science of Logic (also known as the “Greater Logic”) and the Logic that constitutes the first part of the Encyclopedia of the Philosophical Sciences (also known as the “Lesser Logic”) are not contributions to earlier debates about the priority of general logic. Nor do they accept that what Kant called “general” logic and Reinhold called “logic proper, without surnames” is purely formal logic. Because Hegel was convinced that truth is both formal and material, and not one or the other, he sought to establish the dialectical unity of the formal and the material in his works on logic. The meaning of the word “dialectical” is, of course, much debated, as is the specific mechanism through which the dialectic produces and resolves the contradictions that move thought from one form of consciousness to another. For Hegel, however, this process accounts for the genesis of the categories and concepts through which all cognition is determined. Logic reveals the unity of that process.

German idealism’s contributions to logic were largely dismissed following the rise of empiricism and positivism in the nineteenth century, as well as the revolutions in logic that took place at the beginning of the twentieth century. Today, however, there is a renewed interest in this part of the idealist tradition, as is evident in the attention which has been paid to Kant’s lectures on logic and the new editions and translations of Hegel’s writings and lectures on logic.

3. Metaphysics and Epistemology

German idealism is a form of idealism. The idealism espoused by the German idealists is, however, different from other kinds of idealism with which contemporary philosophers may be more familiar. While earlier idealists maintained that reality is ultimately intellectual rather than material (Plato) or that the existence of objects is mind-dependent (Berkeley), the German idealists reject the distinctions these views presuppose. In addition to the distinction between the material and the formal and the distinction between the real and the ideal, Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel also reject the distinction between being and thinking, further complicating the German idealists’ views on metaphysics and epistemology.

Kant’s idealism is, perhaps, the most moderate form of idealism associated with German idealism. Kant holds that the objects of human cognition are transcendentally ideal and empirically real. They are transcendentally ideal, because the conditions of the cognition human beings have of objects are to be found in the cognitive faculties of human beings. This does not mean the existence of those objects is mind-dependent, because Kant thinks we can only know objects to the extent that they are objects for us and, thus, as they appear to us. Idealism with respect to appearances does not entail the mind-dependence of objects, because it does not commit itself to any claims about the nature of things in themselves. Kant denies that we have any knowledge of things in themselves, because we do not have the capacity to make judgments about the nature of things in themselves based on our knowledge of things as they appear.

Despite our ignorance of things in themselves, Kant thought we could have objectively valid cognition of empirically real objects. Kant recognized that we are affected by things outside ourselves and that this affection produces sensations. These sensations are, for Kant, the “matter” of sensible intuition. Along with the pure “forms” of intuition, space and time, sensations constitute the “matter” of judgment. The pure concepts of the understanding are the “forms” of judgment, which Kant demonstrates to be the conditions of the possibility of objectively valid cognition in the “Deduction of the Pure Concepts of the Understanding” in the Critique of Pure Reason. The synthesis of matter and form in judgment therefore produces objectively valid cognition of empirically real objects

To say that the idealism of Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel is more radical than Kant’s idealism is to understate the difference between Kant and the philosophers he inspired. Kant proposed a “modest” idealism, which attempted to prove that our knowledge of appearances is objectively valid. Fichte, however, maintains the very idea of a thing in itself, a thing which is not an object for us and which exists independently of our consciousness, is a contradiction in terms. There can be no thing in itself, Fichte claims, because a thing is only a thing when it is something for us. Even the thing in itself is, in fact, a product of our own conscious thought, meaning the thing in itself is nothing other a postulation of our own consciousness. Thus, it is not a thing in itself, but just another object for us.  From this line of reasoning, Fichte concludes that “everything which occurs in our mind can be completely explained and comprehended on the basis of the mind itself” (Breazeale 1988, 69). This is a much more radical form of idealism than Kant maintained. For Fichte holds that consciousness is a circle in which the I posits itself and determines what belongs to the I and what belongs to the not-I. This circularity is necessary and unavoidable, Fichte maintains, but philosophy is a reflective activity in which the spontaneous positing activity of the I and the determinations of the I and not-I are comprehended.

Schelling defended Fichte’s idealism in On the I as Principle of Philosophy, where he maintained that the I is the unconditioned condition of both being and thinking. Because the existence of the I precedes all thinking (I must exist in order to think) and because thinking determines all being (A thing is nothing other than an object of thought), Schelling argued, the absolute I, not Reinhold’s principle of consciousness, must be the fundamental principle of all philosophy. In subsequent works like the System of Transcendental Idealism, however, Schelling pursued a different course, arguing that the essential and primordial unity of being and thinking can be understood from two different directions, beginning either with nature or spirit. It could be deduced from the absolute I as Fichte had done, but it could also arise from the unconscious but dynamic powers of nature. By showing how these two different approaches complemented one another, Schelling thought he had shown how the distinction between being and thinking, nature and spirit, could be overcome.

Fichte was not pleased with the innovations of Schelling’s idealism, because he initially thought of Schelling as a disciple and a defender of his own position. Fichte did not initially respond to Schelling’s works, but, in an exchange that began in 1800, he began to argue that Schelling had confused the real and the ideal, making the I, the ideal, dependent upon nature, the real. Fichte thought this violated the principles of transcendental idealism and his own Wissenschaftslehre, leading him to suspect that Schelling was no longer the disciple he took him to be. Intervening on Schelling’s behalf as the dispute became more heated, Hegel argued that Fichte’s idealism was “subjective” idealism, while Schelling’s idealism was “objective” idealism. This means that Fichte considers the I to be the absolute and denies the identity of the I and the not-I. He privileges the subject at the expense of the identity of subject and object. Schelling, however, attempts to establish the identity of the subject and object by establishing the objectivity of the subject, the I, as well as the subjectivity of the object, nature. The idealism Schelling and Hegel defend recognizes the identity of subject and object as the “absolute,” unconditioned first principle of philosophy. For that reason, it is often called the philosophy of identity.

It is clear that by the time he published the Phenomenology of Spirit, Hegel was no longer interested in defending Schelling’s system. In the Phenomenology, Hegel famously calls Schelling’s understanding of the identity of subject and object “the night in which all cows are black,” meaning that Schelling’s conception of the identity of subject and object erases the many and varied distinctions which determine the different forms of consciousness. These distinctions are crucial for Hegel, who came to believe that the absolute can only be realized by passing through the different forms of consciousness which are comprehended in the self-consciousness of absolute knowledge or spirit (Geist).

Contemporary scholars like Robert Pippin and Robert Stern have debated whether Hegel’s position is to be regarded as a metaphysical or merely epistemological form of idealism, because it is not entirely clear whether Hegel regarded the distinctions that constitute the different forms of consciousness as merely the conditions necessary for understanding objects (Pippin) or whether they express fundamental commitments about the way things are (Stern). However, it is almost certainly true that Hegel’s idealism is both epistemological and metaphysical. Like Fichte and Schelling, Hegel sought to overcome the limits Kant’s transcendental idealism had placed on philosophy, in order to complete the idealist revolution he had begun. The German idealists agreed that this could only be done by tracing all the different parts of philosophy back to a single principle, whether that principle is the I (in Fichte and the early Schelling) or the absolute (in Hegel).

4. Moral and Political Philosophy

The moral and political philosophy of the German idealists is perhaps the most influential part of their legacy, but it is also one of the most controversial. Many appreciate the emphasis Kant placed on freedom and autonomy in both morality and politics; yet they reject Kant’s moral and political philosophy for its formalism. Fichte’s moral and political philosophy has only recently been studied in detail, but his popular and polemical writings have led some to see him as an extreme nationalist and, perhaps, a precursor to fascism. Hegel is, by some accounts, an apologist for the totalitarian “absolute state.” In what follows, a more even-handed assessment of their views and their merits is developed.

Kantian moral philosophy has been an important part of moral theory since the nineteenth century. Today, it is commonly associated with deontological moral theories, which emphasize duty and obligation, as well as constructivism, which is concerned with the procedures through which moral norms are constructed. Supporters of both approaches frequently refer to the categorical imperative and the different formulations of that imperative which are to be found in Kant’s Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals (1785) and the Critique of Practical Reason (1788). They often take the categorical imperative, or one of its formulations, as a general definition of the right or the good.

The categorical imperative served a slightly different purpose for Kant. In the Groundwork, Kant uses the categorical imperative to define the form of the good will. Kant thought moral philosophy was primarily concerned with the determination of the will. The categorical imperative shows that, in order to be good, the will must be determined according to a rule that is both universal and necessary. Any violation of this rule would result in a contradiction and, therefore, moral impossibility. The categorical imperative provides Kant with a valid procedure and a universal and necessary determination of what is morally obligatory.

Yet in order to determine the will, Kant thought human beings had to be free.  Because freedom cannot be proven in theoretical philosophy, however, Kant says that reason forces us to recognize the concept of freedom as a “fact” of pure practical reason. Kant thinks freedom is necessary for any practical philosophy, because the moral worth and merit of human beings depends on the way they determine their own wills. Without freedom, they would not be able to determine their own wills to the good and we could not hold them responsible for their actions. Thus freedom and autonomy are absolutely crucial for Kant’s understanding of moral philosophy. The political significance of autonomy becomes apparent in some of Kant’s late essays, where he supports a republican politics of freedom, equality, and the rule of law.

Kant’s moral philosophy affected Fichte profoundly, especially the Critique of Practical Reason. “I have been living in a new world ever since reading the Critique of Practical Reason,” Fichte reports, “propositions which I thought could never be overturned have been overturned for me. Things have been proven to me which I thought could never be proven, e.g., the concept of absolute freedom, the concept of duty, etc., and I feel all the happier for it” (Breazeale 1988, 357). His passion for Kant’s moral philosophy can be seen in the Aenesidemus review, where Fichte defends the “primacy” of practical reason over theoretical reason, which he takes to be the foundation of Kant’s “moral theology.”

Despite his admiration for Kant’s moral philosophy, Fichte thought he could go beyond Kant’s formalism. In his essay Concerning the Concept of Wissenschaftslehre, Fichte describes the second, practical part of his plan for Wissenschaftslehre, in which “new and thoroughly elaborated theories of the pleasant, the beautiful, the sublime, the free obedience of nature to its own laws, God, so-called common sense or the natural sense of truth” are laid out, but which also contains “new theories of natural law and morality, the principles of which are material as well as formal” (Breazeale 1988, 135). Unlike Kant, in other words, Fichte would not simply determine the form of the good will, but the ways in which moral and political principles are applied in action.

Fichte’s interest in the material principles of moral and political philosophy can be seen in his Foundations of Natural Right and System of Ethics. In both works, Fichte emphasizes the applicability of moral and political principles to action. But he also emphasizes the social context in which these principles are applied. While the I posits itself as well as the not-I, Fichte thinks the I must posit itself as an individual among other individuals, if it is to posit itself “as a rational being with self-consciousness.” The presence of others checks the freedom of the I, because the principles of morality and natural right both require that individual freedom cannot interfere with the freedom of other individuals. Thus the freedom of the I and the relations between individuals and members of the community are governed by the principles of morality and right, which may be applied to all their actions and interactions.

Hegel was also concerned about the formalism of Kant’s moral philosophy, but Hegel approached the problem in a slightly different way than Fichte. In the Phenomenology of Spirit, Hegel describes the breakdown of the “ethical life” (Sittlichkeit) of the community. Hegel understands ethical life as the original unity of social life. While he thinks the unity of ethical life precedes any understanding of the community as a free association of individuals, Hegel also thinks the unity of ethical life is destined to break down. As members of the community become conscious of themselves as individuals, through the conflicts that arise between family and city and between religious law and civil law, ethical life becomes more and more fragmented and the ties that bind the community become less and less immediate. This process is illustrated, in the Phenomenology, by Hegel’s famous – if elliptical – retelling of Sophocles’ Antigone.

Hegel provides a different account of ethical life in the Foundations of the Philosophy of Right. In this work, he contrasts ethical life with morality and abstract right. Abstract right is the name Hegel gives to the idea that individuals are the sole bearers of right. The problem with this view is that it abstracts right from the social and political context in which individuals exercise their rights and realize their freedom. Morality differs from abstract right, because morality recognizes the good as something universal rather than particular. Morality recognizes the “common good” of the community as something that transcends the individual; yet it defines the good through a purely formal system of obligations, which is, in the end, no less abstract than abstract right. Ethical life is not presented as the original unity of the habits and customs of the community, but, rather, as a dynamic system in which individuals, families, civil society, and the state come together to promote the realization of human freedom.

Traditional accounts of Hegel’s social and political philosophy have seen Hegel’s account of ethical life as an apology for the Prussian state. This is understandable, given the role the state plays in the final section of the Philosophy of Right on “World History.” Here Hegel says “self-consciousness finds in an organic development the actuality of its substantive knowing and willing” in the Germanic state (Wood 1991, 379-380). To see the state as the culmination of world history and the ultimate realization of human freedom is, however, to overlook several important factors, including Hegel’s personal commitments to political reform and personal freedom. These commitments are reflected in Hegel’s defense of freedom in the Philosophy of Right, as well as the role he thought the family and especially civil society played in ethical life.

5. Aesthetics

The German idealists’ interest in aesthetics distinguishes them from other modern systematic philosophers (Descartes, Leibniz, Wolff ) for whom aesthetics was a matter of secondary concern at best. And while there was, to be sure, considerable disagreement about the relationship between art, aesthetics, and philosophy among the German idealists, the terms of their disagreement continue to be debated in philosophy and the arts.

For most of his career, Kant regarded aesthetics as an empirical critique of taste. In lectures and notes from the 1770s, several of which were later incorporated into Kant’s Logic (1800), Kant denies that aesthetics can be a science. Kant changed his mind in 1787, when he told Reinhold he had discovered the a priori principles of the faculty of feeling pleasure and displeasure. Kant laid out these principles in the first part of the Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790), where he characterizes aesthetic judgment as a “reflective” judgment, based on “the consciousness of the merely formal purposiveness in the play of the cognitive powers of the subject with regard to the animation of its cognitive powers” (Guyer and Matthews 2000, 106-107). According to Kant, it is the free yet harmonious play of our cognitive faculties in aesthetic judgment that is the source of the feeling of pleasure that we associate with beauty.

Reinhold and Fichte had little to say about art and beauty, despite Fichte’s promise to deal with the subject in the second, practical part of his Wissenschaftslehre. Aesthetics was, however, of critical importance for Schelling, Hegel, and Hölderlin. In the Oldest Program for a System of German Idealism, they write that beauty is “the idea that unites everything” and “the highest act of reason” (Bernstein 2003, 186). Thus they insist that the “philosophy of spirit” must also be an “aesthetic” philosophy, uniting the sensible and the intellectual as well as the real and the ideal.

It was Schelling, rather than Hegel or Hölderlin, who did the most to formulate this “aesthetic” philosophy in the years following his move to Jena. In the System of Transcendental Idealism and Philosophy of Art, Schelling argues that the absolute is both revealed by and embodied in works of art. Art is, for Schelling, “the only true and eternal organ and document of philosophy” (Heath 1978, 231). Art is of  “paramount” importance to the philosopher, because it opens up “the holy of holies, where burns in eternal and original unity, as if in a single flame, that which is rent asunder in nature and history and that which, in life and action, no less than in thought, must forever fly apart” (Heath 1978, 231).

Hegel would later contest Schelling’s characterization of the artwork and its relation to philosophy in his Lectures on Fine Arts. According to Hegel, art is not the revelation and embodiment of philosophy, but an alienated form of self-consciousness. The greatest expression of spirit is not to be found in the work of art, as Schelling suggested, but in the “idea.” Beauty, which Hegel calls “the sensuous appearance of the idea,” is not an adequate expression of the absolute, precisely because it is a sensuous appearance. Nevertheless, Hegel acknowledges that the alienated and sensuous appearance of the idea can play an important role in the dialectical process through which we become conscious of the absolute in philosophy. He distinguishes three kinds of art, symbolic art, classical art, and romantic art, corresponding to three different stages in the development of our consciousness of the absolute, which express different aspects of the idea in different ways.

Hegel argues that the kind of art that corresponds to the first stage in the development of our understanding of spirit, symbolic art, fails to adequately represent the idea, but points to the idea as something beyond itself. This “beyond” cannot be captured by images, plastic forms, or words and therefore remains abstract for symbolic art. However, the art corresponding to the second stage in the development of our understanding of spirit, classical art, strives to reconcile the abstract and the concrete in an individual work. It aims to present a perfect, sensible expression of the idea and, for that reason, represents the “ideal” of beauty for Hegel. Yet the problem remains, inasmuch as the idea which is expressed by classical art is not, in itself, sensible. The sensible presentation of the idea remains external to the idea itself. Romantic art calls attention to this fact by emphasizing the sensuousness and individuality of the work. Unlike symbolic art, however, romantic art supposes that the idea can be discovered within and through the work of art. In effect, the work of art tries to reveal the truth of the idea in itself. Yet when the idea is grasped concretely, in itself, rather than through the work of art, we have achieved a philosophical understanding of the absolute, which does not require the supplement of sensible appearance. For this reason, Hegel speculated that the emergence of philosophical self-consciousness signaled the end of art. “The form of art,” he says, “has ceased to be the supreme need of spirit” (Knox 1964, 10).

Hegel’s thesis concerning the “end” of art has been widely debated and raises many important questions. What, for example, are we to make of developments in the arts that occurred “after” the end of art? What purpose might art continue to serve, if we have already achieved philosophical self-consciousness? And, perhaps most importantly, has philosophy really achieved absolute knowledge, which would render any “sensuous appearance” of the idea obsolete? These are important questions, but they are difficult to answer. Like Kant and Schelling, Hegel’s views on aesthetics were part of his philosophical system, and they served a specific purpose within that system. To question the end of art in Hegel is, for that reason, to question the entire system and the degree to which it presents a true account of the absolute. Yet that also is why aesthetics and the philosophy of art allow us important insight into Hegel’s thought and the thought of the German idealists more generally.

6. Reception and Influence

Fichte, Hegel, and Schelling ended their careers in the same chair in Berlin. Fichte spent his later years reformulating the Wissenschaftslehre in lectures and seminars, hoping to finally find an audience that understood him. Hegel, who was called to take Fichte’s chair upon his death, lectured on the history of philosophy, the philosophy of history, the philosophy of religion, and the philosophy of fine art (his lectures on these subjects have been no less influential than his published works). Hegel gained a considerable following among both conservatives and liberals in Berlin, who came to be known as “right” (or “old”) and “left” (or “young”) Hegelians. Schelling’s views seem to have changed the most between the turn of the century and his arrival in Berlin. The “positive” philosophy he articulated in his late works is no longer idealist, because Schelling no longer maintains that being and thinking are identical. Nor does the late Schelling think that thought can ground itself in its own activity. Instead, thought must find its ground in “the primordial kind of all being.”

Arthur Schopenhauer (1788-1860), Søren Kierkegaard (1813-1855), and Karl Marx (1818-1883) all witnessed the decline of German idealism in Berlin. Schopenhauer had studied with Schulze in Göttingen and attended Fichte’s lectures in Berlin, but he is not considered a German idealist by many historians of philosophy. Some, like Günter Zöller, have argued against this exclusion, suggesting that the first edition of The World as Will and Representation is, in fact, “the first completely execute post-Kantian philosophical system” (Ameriks 2000, 101). Whether or not this system is really idealist is, however, a matter of some dispute. Claims that Schopenhauer is not an idealist usually take as their starting point the second part of The World as Will and Representation, where Schopenhauer claims that the representations of the “pure subject of cognition” are grounded in the will and, ultimately, in the body.

It is easier to distinguish Kierkegaard and Marx from the German idealists than Schopenhauer, though Kierkegaard and Marx are perhaps as different from one another as they could possibly be. Kierkegaard studied with the late Schelling, but, like Jacobi, rejected reason and philosophy in the name of faith. Many of his works are elaborate parodies of the kind of reasoning to be found in the works of the German idealists, especially Hegel. Marx, along with another one of Schelling’s students, Friedrich Engels (1820-1895), came to deride idealism as the “German ideology.” Marx and Engels charged that idealism had never really broken with religion, that it comprehended the world through abstract, logical categories, and, finally, mistook mere ideas for real things. Marx and Engels promoted their own historical materialism as an alternative to the ideology of idealism.

There is a tendency to overemphasize figures like Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, and Marx in the history of philosophy in the nineteenth century, but this distorts our understanding of the developments taking place at the time. It was the rise of empirical methods in the natural sciences and historical-critical methods in the human sciences, as well as the growth of Neo-Kantianism and positivism that led to the eclipse of German idealism, not the blistering critiques of Schopenhauer, Kierkegaard, Marx, and Nietzsche. Neo-Kantianism, in particular, sought to leave behind the speculative excesses of German idealism and extract from Kant those ideas that were useful for the philosophy of the natural and human sciences. In the process, they established Neo-Kantianism as the dominant philosophical school in Germany at the end of the nineteenth century.

Despite its general decline, German idealism remained an important influence on the British idealism of F.H. Bradley (1846-1924) and Bernard Bosanquet (1848-1923) at the beginning of the twentieth century. The rejection of British idealism was one of common features of early analytic philosophy, though it would be wrong to suppose that Bertrand Russell (1872-1970), G.E. Moore (1873-1958), and others rejected idealism for purely philosophical reasons. The belief that German idealism was at least partly responsible for German nationalism and aggression was common among philosophers of Russell’s generation and only became stronger after World War I and World War II. The famous depiction of Hegel as an “enemy of liberty” and a “totalitarian” in The Open Society and its Enemies (1946) by Karl Popper (1902-1994) builds upon this view. And while it would be difficult to prove that any particular philosophy was responsible for German nationalism or the rise of fascism, it is true that the works of Fichte and Hegel were, like those of Nietzsche, favorite references for German nationalists and, later, the Nazis.

The works of the German idealists, especially Hegel, became important in France during the 1930s. Lectures on Hegel by Alexander Kojeve’s (1902-1968) influenced a generation of French intellectuals, including Georges Bataille (1897-1962), Jacques Lacan (1901-1981) and Jean-Paul Satre (1905-1980). Kojeve’s understanding of Hegel is idiosyncratic, but, together with the works of Jean Wahl (1888-1974), Alexandre Koyré (1892-1964), and Jean Hyppolite (1907-1968), his approach remains influential in continental European philosophy.  Objections to the anthropocentrism of German idealism can usually be traced back to this tradition and especially to Kojeve, who saw Hegel’s dialectic as a historical process through which the problems that define humanity are resolved. The end of this process is, for Kojeve, the end of history, which was popularized by Frances Fukayama (1952-) in The End of History and the Last Man (1992). Charges that German idealism is dogmatic, rationalist, foundationalist, and totalizing in its attempt to systematize, and ultimately an egocentric “philosophy of the subject,” which are also common in continental philosophy, merit more serious concern, given the emphasis Fichte, Schelling, and Hegel place on the “I” and the extent of their philosophical ambitions. Yet even these charges have been undermined in recent years by new historical scholarship and a greater understanding of the problems that actually motivated the German idealists.

There has been considerable interest in German idealism in the last twenty years, as hostility waned in analytic philosophy, traditional assumptions faded in continental philosophy, and bridges were built between the two approaches. Philosophers like Richard Bernstein and Richard Rorty, inspired by Wilfrid Sellars, may be credited with re-introducing Hegel to analytic philosophy as an alternative to classical empiricism. Robert Pippin later defended a non-metaphysical Hegel, which has been a subject of intense debate, but which has also made Hegel relevant to contemporary debates about realism and anti-realism. More recently, Robert Brandom has championed the “normative” conception of rationality that he finds in Kant and Hegel, and which suggests that concepts function as rules regulating judgment rather than mere representations. Some, like Catherine Malabou, have even attempted to apply the insights of the German idealists to contemporary neuroscience. Finally, it would be remiss not to mention the extraordinary historical-philosophical scholarship, in both German and English, that has been produced on German idealism in recent years. The literature listed in the bibliography has not only enriched our understanding of German idealism with new editions, translations, and commentaries, it has also expanded the horizons of philosophical scholarship by identifying new problems and new solutions to problems arising in different traditions and contexts.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Kant

i. German Editions of Kant’s Works

  • Weischedel. Wilhelm. ed. Kants Werke in sechs Bänden. Wiesbaden: lnsel Verlag, 1956-1962.
  • Kants Gesammalte Schriften, herausgegeben von der Preussischen Akademie der
  • Wissenschaften. Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1902.

ii. Cambridge Edition of the Works of Immanuel Kant in Translation

  • Bowman, Curtis, Guyer, Paul, and Rauscher, Frederick, trans. and Guyer, Paul, ed. Immanuel Kant: Notes and Fragments. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
  • Allison, Henry and Heath, Peter, eds. Immanuel Kant: Theoretical Philosophy After 1781. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2002.
  • Guyer, Paul and Matthews, Eric, trans. and eds. Immanuel Kant: Critique of the Power of Judgment. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
  • Arnulf Zweig, trans. and ed. Immanuel Kant: Correspondence. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
  • Guyer, Paul and Wood, Allen W. Immanuel Kant: Critique of Pure Reason. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
  • Heath, Peter and Schneewind, Jerome B., trans. and eds. Lectures on Ethics. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
  • Ameriks, Karl and Naragon, Steve, trans. and eds. Immanuel Kant: Lectures on Metaphysics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1997.
  • Gregor, Mary, trans. and ed. Immanuel Kant: Practical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
  • Wood, Allen W. and di Giovanni, George, trans. and eds. Immanuel Kant: Religion and Rational Theology. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
  • Walford, David and Meerbote, Ralf, trans. and eds. Immanuel Kant: Theoretical Philosophy, 1755-1770. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992.
  • Young, J. Michel, trans. and ed. Immanuel Kant: Lectures on Logic. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1992.

iii. Other English Translations of Kant’s Works

  • Kemp Smith, Norman, trans. The Critique of Pure Reason. London: Palgrave MacMillan, 2003.
  • Pluhar, Werner, trans. Critique of Judgment, Including the First Introduction. Indianapolis: Hackett, Publishing, 1987.
  • Allison, Henry E., trans. The Kant-Eberhard Controversy. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1973.

b. Fichte

i. German Editions of Fichte’s Works

  • Fichte, Immanuel Hermann, ed. Fichtes Werke. Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, 1971.
  • Lauth, Reinhard, Gliwitzky, Hans, and Jacob, Hans. eds. J.G. Fichte: Gesamtausgabe der Bayerischen Akademie der Wissenschaften. Stuttgart-Bad Cannstatt: Frommann-Holzboog Verlag, 1962.

ii. English Translations of Fichte’s Works

  • Green, Garrett, trans. Allen Wood, ed. Attempt at a Critique of All Revelation. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
  • Breazeale, Daniel and Zöller, Günter. The System of Ethics According to the principles of the Wissenschaftslehre. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
  • Neuhouser. Frederick and Baur, Michael. trans. and eds. Foundations of Natural Right. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
  • Breazeale, Daniel. trans. and ed. Introductions to the Wissenschaftslehre and Other Writings. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 1994.
  • Breazeale, Daniel. trans. and ed. Foundations of the Transcendental Philosophy (Wissenschaftslehre Nova Methodo, 1796-1799). Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1992.
  • Breazeale, Daniel. trans. and ed. Early Philosophical Writings. Ithaca: Cornell University Press, 1988.
  • Preuss, Peter, trans. The Vocation of Man. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 1987.
  • Heath. Peter and Lachs, John, trans. Science of Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1982.
  • Jones, R. F. and Turnbull, George Henry, trans. Addresses to the German Nation. New York: Harper & Row, 1968.

c. Hegel

i. German Editions of Hegel’s Works

  • Eva Moldenhauer and Karl Markus Michel, eds. Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel: Werke. Frankfurt am Main: Suhrkamp, 1971-1979.
  • Hoffmeister. Johannes, ed. Briefe von und an Hegel, Hamburg: Meiner, 1969.
  • Deutsche Forschungsgemeinschaft in Verbindung mit der Rheiniscb-westfalischen
  • Akademie der Wissenschaften, ed. Hegels Gesammelte Werke. Kritische Ausgabe. Hamburg: Meiner Verlag, 1968.

ii. English Translations of Hegel’s Works

1. Cambridge Hegel Translations
  • Di Giovanni, George, trans. and ed. The Science of Logic. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
  • Brinkmann, Klaus and Dahlstrom, Daniel O., trans. and ed. Encyclopaedia of the Philosophical Sciences in Basic Outline,  Part 1, Logic. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
  • Bowman, Brady and and Speight, Allen. Heidelberg Writings. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2009.
2. Other English Translations of Hegel’s Works
  • Nisbet, H.B., trans. Wood, Allen, ed. Elements of the Philosophy of Right. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. 1991.
  • Geraets, Theodore F., Harris, H.S., and Suchting, Wallis Arthur, trans. The Encylopedia Logic. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 1991.
  • Brown, Robert, ed. Lectures on the History of Philosophy. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1990.
  • Burbidge. John S., trans. The Jena System 1804/1805: Logic and Metaphysics. Montreal: McGill/Queen’s University Press, 1986.
  • Miller, A.V., trans. George, Michael and Vincent, Andrew, eds. The Philosophical Propadeutic. Oxford: Blackwell, 1986.
  • Hodgson, Peter and Brown, R. F., trans. Lectures on the Philosophy of Religion. Berkeley: University of California Press, 1984-1986.
  • Dobbins, John and Fuss, Peter, trans. Three Essays 1793-1795. South Bend: University of Notre Dame Press, 1984.
  • Cerf, Walter and Harris, H.S., trans. System of Ethical Life and First Philosophy of Spirit. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1979.
  • Petry, Michael John, trans. and ed. Hegels Philosophie des subjektiven Geistes/Hegel’s Philosophy of Subjective Spirit. Dordrecht: Riedel, 1978.
  • Miller, A.V. Phenomenology of Spirit. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1977.
  • Cerf, Walter and Harris, H.S., trans. The Difference Between Fichte’s and Schelling’s System of Philosophy. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1977.
  • Cerf, Walter and Harris, H.S., trans. Faith and Knowledge. Albany: State University of New York Press, 1977.
  • Nisbet, H.B., trans. Lectures on the Philosophy of World History: Introduction. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1975.
  • Wallace. William, trans. Hegel’s Philosophy of Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1971.
  • Miller, A.V., trans. Philosophy of Nature. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1970.
  • Miller, A.V., trans. Science of Logic. London: George Allen & Unwin, 1969.
  • Knox, T.M. trans. Hegel’s Aesthetics. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1964.

d. Schelling

i. German Editions of Schelling’s Works

  • Frank, Manfred and Kurz, Gerhard. eds. Materialien zu Schellings philosophischen Anfängen. Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, 1995.
  • Jacobs, Wilhelm G., Krings. Hermann, and Zeltner, Hermann, eds. F.W.J. von Schelling: Historisch-kritische Ausgabe. Stuttgart-Bad Cannstatt: Frommann-Holzboog, 1976-.
  • Fuhrmans, Horst, ed. Schelling: Briefe und Dokumente. Bonn: Bouvier, 1973·

ii. English Translations of Schelling’s Works

  • Love, Jeff and Schmitt, Johannes, trans. Philosophical Investigations into the Essence of Human Freedom. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2007.
  • Matthews, Bruce, trans. The Grounding of Positive Philosophy. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2007.
  • Richey, Mason and Zisselsberger, Markus, trans. Historical-Critical Introduction to the Philosophy of Mythology. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2007.
  • Peterson, Keith R., trans. and ed. First Outline of a System of the Philosophy of Nature. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2004.
  • Steinkamp, Fiona, trans. Clara, or On Nature’s Connection to the Spirit World. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2002.
  • Wirth, Jason M., Trans. The Ages of the World. Albany: State University of New York Press, 2000.
  • Bowie, Andrew, trans. On the History of Modern Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1994
  • Pfau, Thomas, trans. and ed. Idealism and the Endgame of Theory: Three Essays by F.W.J. Schelling. Albany: State University of New York Press, I994.
  • Stott, Douglas W., trans. The Philosophy of Art. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1989.
  • Gutmann, James, trans. Philosophical Inquiries into the Nature of Human Freedom. La Salle: Open Court, 1989.
  • Harris, Errol and Heath. Peter, trans. Ideas for a Philosophy of Nature. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
  • Vater, Michael G., trans. Bruno, or On the Natural and the Divine Principle of Things Albany: State University of New York Press, 1984.
  • Marti, Fritz, trans. and ed. The Unconditional in Human Knowledge: Four Early Essays. Lewisburg: Bucknell University Press, 1980.
  • Heath, Peter, trans. System of Transcendental Idealism. Charlottesville, VA: University Press of Virginia, 1978.
  • Motgan, E. S. and Guterman, Norbert, trans. On University Studies. Athens: Ohio University Press, 1966.

e. Editions and Translations of Other Primary Sources

i. Jacobi

  • Hammacher, Klaus and Jaeschke, eds. Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi: Werke. Hamburg: Meiner Verlag, 1998.
  • Di Giovanni, George, trans. and ed. Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi: The: Main Philosophical Writings and the Novel Allwill. Montreal: McGill/Queen’s University Press, 1994.
  • Klippen, Friedrich and von Roth, Friedrich, eds. Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi: Werke. Darmstadt: Wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft, 1968.

ii. Reinhold

  • Hebbeler, James, trans., and Ameriks, Karl, ed. Letters on the Kantian Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2005.
  • Fabbianelli, Faustino, ed. Beiträge zur Berichtigung bisheriger Missverständnis der Philosophen. Hamburg: Meiner Verlag, 2003.
  • Di Giovanni, George and Harris, H.S. Between Kant and Hegel: Texts in the Development of Post-Kantian Idealism. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2000.

iii. Hölderlin

  • Beissner, Friedrich, ed. Holderlin: Samtliche Werke, Grosser Stuttgarter Ausgabe. Stuttgart: Cotta, 1943-85.
  • Pfau, Thomas, trans. and ed. Essays and Letters on Theory, Albany: State University of New York Press, 1988.

iv. Kierkegaard, Søren

  • Cappelørn, N.J. et. al. Søren Kierkegaards Skrifter. Copenhagen: Gad, 1997.
  • Hong, Howard V. and Hong, Enda H., ed. Kierkegaard’s Writings. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1983-2009.

v. Marx

  • Pascal, Roy, ed.The German Ideology, New York: International Publishers, 1947.
  • Ryawnov, D., and Adoratskii, Vladimir Viktorovich, eds. Karl Marx und Friedrich Engels: Historisch-Kritisch Gesamtausgabe. Redin: Dietz Verlag, 1956.

vi. Schopenhauer

  • Janaway, Christopher and Norman, Judith and Welchman Alistair, trans. and eds. The World as Will and Representation. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2010.
  • Aquila, Richard and Carus, David, trans. The World as Will and Presentation. New York: Pearson Longman, 2008.
  • Payne, Eric F. and Zöller, Günter, trans. Prize Essay on the Freedom of the Will. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1999.
  • Payne. Eric F., trans. On the Fourfold Root of the Principle of Sufficient Reason. La Salle: Open Court, 1989.
  • Payne, Eric F., trans. The World as Will and Representation. New York: Dover, 1974.
  • Hübscher, Arthur, ed. Sammtliche Werke. Mannheirn: Brockhaus, 1988.

f. Other Works on German Idealism

  • Allison, Henry. Kant’s Transcendental Idealism (2nd Edition) New Haven: Yale University Press, 2004.
  • Allison, Henry. Idealism and Freedom. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
  • Ameriks, Karl, ed. The Cambridge Companion to German Idealism. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
  • Ameriks, Karl. Kant and the Fate of Autonomy: Problems in the Appropriation of the Critical Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2.000.
  • Avineri, Shlomo. Hegel’s Theory of the Modern State. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1972.
  • Baur, Michael and Dahlstrom, Daniel. eds. The Emergence of German Idealism. Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 1999.
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Author Information

Colin McQuillan
Email: cmcquillan@utk.edu
University of Tennessee Knoxville
U. S. A.

Nyāya

Nyāya (literally “rule or method of reasoning”) is a leading school of philosophy within the “Hindu umbrella”—those communities which saw themselves as the inheritors of the ancient Vedic civilization and allied cultural traditions. Epistemologically, Nyāya develops of a sophisticated precursor to contemporary reliabilism (particularly process reliabilism), centered on the notion of “knowledge-sources” (pramāṇa), and a conception of epistemic responsibility which allows for default, unreflective justification accorded to putatively veridical cognition. It also extensively studies the nature of reasoning in the attempt to map pathways which lead to veridical inferential cognition. Nyāya’s methods of analysis and argument resolution influenced much of classical Indian literary criticism, philosophical debate, and jurisprudence. Metaphysically, Nyāya defends a robust realism, including universals, selves, and substances, largely in debate with Buddhist anti-realists and flux-theorists. Nyāya thinkers were also India’s most sophisticated natural theologians. For at least a millennium, Nyāya honed a variety of arguments in support of a baseline theism in constant engagement with sophisticated philosophical atheists, most notably Buddhists and Mīmāṁsakas (Hindu Ritualists).

Nyāya’s prehistory is tied to ancient traditions of debate and rules of reasoning (vādaśāstra). The oldest extant Nyāya text is the Nyāya-sūtra attributed to Gautama (c. 200 C.E.). Throughout much of Nyāya’s formative period the philosophical development of the school took place through commentaries on the sūtras (with important exceptions including works of Jayanta, c. 875, Udayana, c. 975, and the somewhat heterodox Bhāsarvajña, c. 875). Leading commentators include Vātsyāyana (c. 450), Uddyotakara (c. 600) Vācaspati Miśra (c. 900) and Udayana. The school would enter its “new” phase (navya-nyāya) in the work of the eminent epistemologist Gaṅgeśa Upādhyāya (c. 1325). This article focuses on the older tradition of Nyāya, beginning with the sūtras, with occasional gestures toward developments within the new school.  Given the breadth of Nyāya thought, this discussion has to exclude some important topics for the sake of economy, such as aesthetics, philosophy of language, and theory of value. The article’s primary focus is on epistemology and metaphysics. There is a brief consideration of Nyāya’s philosophy of religion.

Table of Contents

  1. Epistemology
    1. Perception
      1. The Characteristics of Perception
      2. Extraordinary Perceptual States
      3. Introspection
    2. Inference
      1. The Characteristics of Inference
      2. The Structure of Inference
      3. Inferential Defeaters or Fallacies
      4. Suppositional Reasoning
    3. Analogical Reasoning
    4. Testimony
    5. Non-pramāṇa Epistemic Capacities
    6. General Theory of Knowledge
      1. A Causal Theory of Knowledge
      2. Internalist Constraints
      3. A Relational Theory of Cognition
      4. Response to Skepticism
  2. Metaphysics
    1. Substance
    2. Quality
    3. Action
    4. Universal
    5. Inherence
    6. Individuator
    7. Absence
    8. Causation
  3. Philosophy of Religion
  4. References and Further Reading
    1. Sanskrit Source Materials
    2. Primary Texts in English Translation
    3. Studies of Nyāya Epistemology, Metaphysics, and Philosophy of Religion in English
    4. General Studies

1. Epistemology

The Nyāya-sūtra opens with a list of its primary topics, sixteen items which may be grouped into the following four categories: epistemology, metaphysics, procedures and elements of inquiry, and debate theory. That Nyāya’s initial topic is epistemology (pramāṇas, “knowledge-sources”) is noteworthy. Both the sūtras and the commentarial tradition argue that epistemic success is central in the search for happiness, since we must understand the world properly should we desire to achieve the goods it offers.Vātsyāyana claims that while Nyāya’s metaphysical concerns overlap with other, more scripturally-based Hindu schools, what distinguishes Nyāya is a reflective concern with evidence, doubt and the objects of knowledge. He further defines Nyāya’s philosophical method as the “investigation of a subject by means of knowledge-sources” (NB 1.1.1). Importantly, the pramāṇas are not simply the means by which individuals attain veridical cognition. They are also the final court of appeals in philosophical dispute. Uddyotakara thus claims the best kind of demonstrative reasoning occurs when the pramāṇas are deployed in concert in order to establish a fact.

The four pramāṇas are perception, inference, analogical reasoning, and testimony. We will discuss them in order. Then, we will consider Nyāya’s theory of knowledge in general.

a. Perception (pratyakṣa)

i. The Characteristics of Perception

Nyāya-sūtra 1.1.4 defines perceptual cognition as follows.

A perceptual cognition arises by means of the connection between sense faculty and object, is not dependent on words, is non-deviating, and is determinate.

This sūtra provides four conditions which must be met for cognition to be perceptual. The first, that cognition arises from the connection between sense faculty and object, evinces Nyāya’s direct realism. It is such connection, the central feature of the causal chain which terminates in perceptual cognition, which fixes the intentionality of a token percept. Uddyotakara enumerates six kinds of connection (sannikarṣa) to account for the fact that that we perceive not only substances, but properties, absences, and so on: (i) conjunction (samyoga), the connection between a sense faculty and an object; (ii) inherence in what is conjoined (saṁyukta-samavāya), the connection between a sense faculty and a property-trope which inheres in an object; (iii) inherence in what inheres in what is conjoined (saṁyukta-samaveta-samavāya), the connection between a sense faculty and the universal which is instantiated in a property-trope; (iv) inherence (samavāya), the kind of connection which makes auditory perception possible; (v) inherence in what inheres (samaveta-samavāya), the connection between the auditory faculty and universals which inhere within sounds; (vi) qualifier-qualified relation (viśeṣya-viśeṣaṇa-bhāva), the connection which allows for the perception of inherence and absence in objects. In all cases, the perceptual cognition is born of connection between a sense faculty and an occurrent fact or object.

The second condition, that the cognition produced is not dependent on words, has a somewhat complicated interpretive history. Generally, Nyāya holds that ordinary perception involves concept deployment. Therefore, this restriction does not endorse a view held by the Buddhist Dignāga and his followers, that genuine perception is non-conceptual (kalpanā-apodha). Still, the meaning of avyapadeśya is disputed amongst Naiyāyikas. On one reading, this qualification serves the purpose of distinguishing between perceptually and testimonially generated cognitions. The latter also require information provided by the senses but further require the deployment of semantic and syntactic knowledge. An allied reading suggests that while involving the application of concepts, perception of an object is often causally prior to speech acts involving it.

The third, “non-deviating” condition blocks false cognitions, like the misperception that an oyster shell is a piece of silver, from the ranks of pramāṇa-born. This is tied to the Nyāya notion that pramāṇas are by definition inerrant, and that false cognitive presentations are not truly pramāṇas but pseudo-pramāṇas (pramāṇa-ābhāsa). Though we may mistakenly take a pseudo-pramāṇa, like the illusion of a person in the distance, to be the real thing, it is not. “Perception” and similar pramāṇa-terms have success grammar for Nyāya.

The fourth, “determinate” condition blocks cognitions which are merely doubtful from the ranks of the pramāṇa-born. Dubious cognitions, like that of a distant person at dusk, do not convey misleadingly false information, but being unclear, they do not properly apprehend the object in question. It could be a person or a post. As such, one neither correctly grasps its character nor falsely takes it to represent accurately a certain object. Later Naiyāyikas, most notably Vācaspati Miśra, read the qualifiers “notdependent on words” and “determinate” disjunctively, in order to say that perception may be non-propositional or propositional. However anachronistic this may be as an interpretation of the Nyāya-sūtra, this division is accepted by later Nyāya.

ii. Extraordinary Perceptual States

Nyāya admits of certain kinds of extraordinary perception in order to account for cognitive states that are perceptual in character, but distinct from those commonly experienced. They involve modes of sense-object connection other than the six kinds noted above. Later Nyāya (beginning at least with Jayanta) recognizes three kinds of extraordinary perception: (i) yogic perception, (ii) perception of a universal through an individual which instantiates it, and (iii) perception of an object’s properties as mediated by memory.

Yogic perception includes experiential states reported by contemplatives in deep mediation. Their cognitive objects (usually the deep self or God) are taken to be experienced in a direct and unmediated way, but generally without the operation of the external senses. Given their experiential character and their putative agreement with other sources of knowledge like scripture and inference, yogic experiences are prima facie taken to be veridical, produced by non-normal perception.

Perception of a universal through an individual which instantiates it is Nyāya’s response to the problem of induction. Nyāya holds that universals are perceptually experienced as instantiated in individuals (see the third of Uddyotakara’s six kinds of connection above). But the notion that we may have apprehension of all of the individuals which instantiate a universal, qua their being instantiations of the universal, is further accepted by Nyāya in order to explain how we attain to knowledge of vyāpti, or invariable relation between universals, which undergirds causal regularities of various sorts. Unless one’s experience of some particular smoke instance as conjoined with a fire instance allows him to experience all instances of smoke qua smoke as being conjoined with all instances of fire qua fire, through the natural tie between the universals smokiness and fieriness, inductive extrapolation would be impossible. Nyāya thus solves the problem of induction by appeal to extraordinary perception. This does not imply that we are always able to recognize such relations. It may take repeated experience for us to notice the ever-present connection. But when such recognition arises, it is due to perceptual experience, not an extrapolative projection of past experience.

Perception of the properties of an object mediated by memory involves the visual experience of unpresented properties of an object which is currently seen. Standard examples include seeing a piece of sandalwood as fragrant or seeing a piece of ice as cold. Here, there is a standard kind of sense object connection, but some of the phenomenal features of the experience, while veridical, are not generated by the ordinary connection. They are rather mediated by a special connection grounded in memory. What distinguishes this kind of perception from straightforward inference is that the property in question is experienced with a phenomenal character lacking in inference. This suggests that what may be considered inference for some may take the form of perception for others, depending on their familiarity with the conceptual connection between the properties in question.

iii. Introspection

Nyāya holds that while cognitions reveal or present their intentional objects, they rarely present themselves directly. When they are directly cognized, cognitions are grasped by other, apperceptive cognitions. As apperceptive awareness reveals a cognition along with its predication content or “objecthood” (that is, my cognition of a red truck is apperceptively cognized as having the predication content “red” and “truck-hood”), it is practically indefeasible. But, as Gaṅgeśa notes, this indefeasibility does transfer to the content of the original cognition (which is itself object of the apperceptive awareness). I may have mistaken a purple truck for a red truck, forgetting that my eyewear distorts certain colors. Apperception is subsumed by Nyāya into the category of perception. In this case, the operative sense faculty is the “inner organ” (manas) and the object is a cognition conceived of as a property of a self. Gaṅgeśa argues at length with a Prābhākara Mīmāṁsaka (a representative of another leading Hindu school), defending Nyāya’s version of apperception against the Mīmāṁsā view that each cognition itself has a component of reflectively self-awareness.

A few words on manas (the inner organ): NS 1.1.16 argues that the absence of simultaneous cognition from all of the senses indicates the presence of a faculty which governs selective attention. The manas is identified as this faculty, an insentient psychological apparatus which processes the information of the senses. A formulation of perception by the Vaiśeṣika school (Vaiśeṣika-sūtra 3.1.18), accepted by Nyāya, is that it normally consists in a chain of connection between four things: a self and its manas, the manas and a sense organ, and the sense organ and an object. Manas also is the faculty which governs mnemonic retrieval and, as noted above, apperceptive awareness of mental states. Selves, in the Nyāya view, are fundamentally loci of awareness, cognition, and mnemonic dispositions (saṁskāra). But just as they rely on the five senses to experience the world, they rely on manas for the functioning of memory and apperception.

To conclude, we may note that perception is commonly called the jyeṣṭapramāṇa (the “eldest” knowledge source) by Nyāya, since other pramāṇas depend on perceptual input, while perception operates directly on the objects of knowledge. Indeed, Gaṅgeśa suggests the following definition of a perceptual cognition: “a cognition that does not have another cognition as its proximate instrumental cause.” Inference, analogy, and testimony, on the other hand, depend on immediately prior cognitions to trigger their functioning. The normative status accorded to veridical perceptual cognition is primarily a matter of causation and intentionality (viṣayatā). If a cognition is caused by the appropriate causal chain, starting with the contact of a sense faculty and an external object (or, in the case of apperception, the internal organ and an immediately prior cognition), and the cognition produced has an “objecthood” or intentionality which accurately targets the object in question, the cognition is veridical and has the status prāmāṇya (pramāṇā-derived).

b. Inference (anumāna)

i. The Characteristics of Inference

Nyāya-sūtra 1.1.5 defines inference as follows.

[An inferential cognition] is preceded by that [perception], and is threefold: from cause to effect, from effect to cause or from that which is commonly seen.

This definition is somewhat elliptical. But it focuses on the fundamental character of inference: it is a cognition which follows from another cognition owing to their being conceptually connected in some way. Etymologically, anumāna means “after-cognizing”. Inference follows from an earlier cognition, “that” in the sūtra above. Vātsyāyana interprets “that” (tat) to refer to a perceptual cognition, and suggests that perceptual cognition precedes inference in two ways: (i) to engage in inference requires having perceptually established a fixed relationship between an inferential sign and the property to be inferred, and (ii) perceptual input triggers inference in that one must cognize the inferential sign as qualifying the locus of an inference. He provides a more explicit definition of inference as “a ‘later cognition’ of an object by means of cognition of its inferential sign” (NB 1.1.3).

Uddyotakara reasonably broadens the scope of “that” in NS 1.1.5 to refer to pramāṇa-produced cognitions of any kind which may trigger inference (NV 1.1.5). The meaning of reasoning from cause to effect and from effect to cause should be clear. Uddyotakara interprets reasoning from what is “commonly seen” as that which is grounded in non-causal correlations that have proven invariable. Vātsyāyana offers another reading: when the relationship between an inferential sign and the inferential target is not perceptible, the target may be inferred owing to the similarity of the unseen prover with something known. The classic example of this kind of inference is as follows: Desire, aversion, and knowledge are properties. Properties require substances which instantiate them. Therefore there is anunseen substance which instantiates desire, aversion, and knowledge: the inner self (NB 1.1.5). Though the connection between mental states like desire and the self which supports them is unseen, the similarity between mental states and other, commonly seen properties (like the color green) is enough to allow for the inference to a property-bearer.

The history of Nyāya’s logical theory is extensive. Here, we will note a few salient points and focus on inference as understood in the period most important to this study (the final great creative period of what is normally known as “Old Nyāya”). First, in Nyāya, logic is subsumed within epistemology, and therefore tends to have a strong informal and cognitive flavor, mapping paths of reasoning that generate veridical cognitions and noting the common ways that reasoning goes wrong. Fundamentally, one makes inferences for oneself. Formal proofs are meant to mirror the kind of reasoning that takes place internally, for didactic or polemical purposes. The first explicit recognition of this dual nature of inference is commonly attributed to the Buddhist Dignāga, who coined the terms svārthānumāna (inference for oneself) and parārthānumāna (inference for another). Such a division is implicit, however, in the Nyāya-sūtra’s distinction between inference as an individual’s source of knowledge (NS 1.1.5) and as a systematic method of proof meant to convince another (NS 1.1.32-39).

Second, inference is triggered by the recognition of a sign or mark, whose relationship with some other object (property or fact) has been firmly established. The primary cause of an inferential cognition is an immediately prior “subsumptive judgment” (parāmarśa) which grasps an inferential sign as qualifying an inferential subject (the locus of the inference), while recollecting the sign’s invariable concomitance with some other fact or object. The two fundamental requirements for inference are, therefore, awareness of pakṣadharmatā, the inferential mark’s qualifying the locus of the inference, and vyāpti, the sign’s invariable concomitance with the target property or probandum. A paradigmatic act of inference to oneself is: “There is fire on that mountain, since there is smoke on it,” which is supported by the awareness that fire is invariably concomitant with smoke. Naiyāyikas examine and standardize the conditions under which invariable concomitance (vyāpti) between a probans and a target fact is established.

Third, as logic’s function is to generate veridical cognition, Nyāya does not stress the distinction between soundness and validity in respect to the quality of an argument. Both formal fallacies and the inclusion of false premises lead to hetv-ābhāsa (“pseudo provers” or logical defeaters), since they engender false cognition.

ii. The Structure of Inference

Concerning inference for polemical or didactic purposes, Nyāya employs a formal five-step argument illustrated by the following stock example.

  1. There is fire on the hill (the pratijñā, thesis).
  2. Because there is smoke on the hill (the hetu, reason or probans).
  3. Wherever there is smoke, there is fire; like a kitchen hearth and unlike a lake (the udāharaṇa, illustration of concomitance).
  4. This hill is likewise smoky (the upanaya, application of the rule).
  5. Thus, there is fire on the hill (the nigamana, conclusion).

In practice, the five-membered “syllogism” is often truncated into three steps as follows.

A is qualified by S,
because it is qualified by T
(whatever is qualified by T is qualified by S) like (Tb&Sb).

Again, the stock example:

The hill is qualified by fieriness
because it is qualified by smokiness
(whatever is qualified by smokiness is qualified by fieriness) like a kitchen hearth and unlike a lake.

The basic components of the argument are:

  • the inferential subject (pakṣa), the locus of the inferential sign; the hill in our example. The general conditions for something to be taken up as a subject for inference, are that it be under dispute or currently unknown, with no reports from other knowledge sources available to definitively settle the issue.
  • the “prover” or inferential sign (hetu); smoke (more precisely, smokiness)
  • the probandum (sādhya), the property to be proved by the inference; fire (more precisely, fieriness)
  • the “pervasion” or concomitance (vyāpti) that grounds the inference, which is implicit in the step: “wherever there is smoke, there is fire
  • a corroborative instance (sapakṣa); a locus known to be qualified by both the prover (hetu) and the probandum (sādhya); this is a token of inductive support for the vyāpti; a kitchen hearth. There are also known negative examples, (vipakṣa) of something that lacks both the prover property and the probandum; where there is no fire, there is no smoke, like a lake. Obviously, an instantiation of the prover property in the vipakṣa class vitiates the argument.

This stock inference asserts that there is fire on the mountain (the mountain is qualified by the property of fieriness, Fm). Why?  Because the mountain is qualified by the property of smokiness, Sm. There is an implied concomitance which grounds the inference: “Whatever is qualified by smokiness is qualified by fieriness,” ∀x(Sx–>Fx). In the language of Nyāya, fire “pervades” smoke. This is an epistemic pervasion: we never find smoke instances without fire instances. As such, smoke is a prover property that allows us to infer the presence of fire. Finally, an example must be included in the syllogism to illustrate the inductive grounding which undergirds the invariable concomitance. In kitchen hearth k, fire is known to be concomitant with smoke, (Sk&Fk). In some instances, negative examples are used to indicate the vyāpti through contraposition. Wherever there is no fire there is no smoke, as illustrated in a lake, (~Fl& ~Sl).

Nyāya-sūtra 1.1.25 defines an example (dṛṣṭānta) as “something about which experts and laypersons have the same opinion (buddhi-sāmyam).” Vātsyāyana (NB Intro.; translation in Gangopadhyaya 1982: 5) elaborates:

Corroborative instance is an object of perception—an object about which the notions (buddhi) of the layman as well as the expert are not in conflict. . . It is also the basis of the application of nyāya (reasoning). By (showing) the contradiction of the dṛṣṭānta the position of the opponent can be declared as refuted. By the substantiation of the dṛṣṭānta, one’s own position is well-established. If the skeptic (nāstika) admits a corroborative instance, he has to surrender his skepticism. If he does not admit any, how can he silence his opponent?

Regarding agreement between laypersons and experts, the basic idea, of course, is that supporting examples should be non-controversial. A good illustration of this is found in Uddyotakara’s Nyāya-vārttika (2.1.16). Debating with a Buddhist interlocutor over the existence of property-bearing substances, he claims “there is no example whatever (na hi kaściddṛṣṭāntaḥ) . . . about which both parties agree (ubhaya-pakṣa-sampratipannaḥ).”

In another interpretation of the three kinds of inference in the sūtra, Uddyotakara introduces three kinds of argument: wholly-positive, wholly-negative, and positive-negative. Wholly-positive inference occurs when there are attested cases of sapakṣa but no vipakṣaknown. From a Buddhist perspective, the inference “whatever exists is momentary, like a cloud” would require this kind of inference, since there would be no available vipakṣato illustrate the non-presence of the prover. In cases where the property to be proven is entirely subsumed within the pakṣa, a wholly-negative form is employed. The vyāpti is contraposed, as in the following inference: “A living body has a self because it breathes. Whatever does not have a self does not breathe, like a pot.” Most inferences are in principle amenable to the positive-negative form, like “There is fire on that hill, since there is billowing smoke over it. Wherever there is smoke, there is fire, like a kitchen hearth, and unlike a lake.”

iii. Inferential Defeaters or Fallacies

Naiyāyikas provide various typologies of inferential fallacies and defeaters (hetv-ābāsa, “pseudo provers”). We may note five common kinds: (i) fallacies of deviation occur when the prover or inferential sign is not reliably correlated with the inferential target. To argue that “my mother must be visiting, since there is a Mazda parked outside” would involve the fallacy of deviation, since “Owning a Mazda” is a property that tracks not only my mother but many other drivers. It cannot, therefore, reliably indicate her presence. (ii) fallacies of contradiction occur when the prover in fact establishes a conclusion opposed to the thesis that someone defends. This would occur should someone argue that “Jones was not a kind man, since he gave his life for others,” as giving one’s life for others is an indicator of kindness or compassion. (iii) fallacies of unestablishment occur when a supposed prover is not actually the property of the inferential subject. Should someone argue “I know that your mother is in town, since I saw a Prius parked outside your home,” the prover is unestablished, since my mother does not in fact own a Prius. (iv) argumentsare rebutted, when their conclusions are undermined by information gleaned by more secure knowledge sources. Someone may argue that my friend must be out of town, since he hasn’t answered his phone all week. But if I just saw the friend in question at the local coffee shop, my perceptual knowledge rebuts his prover, invalidating it. Similarly, (v) arguments are counterbalanced when counterarguments of equal or greater force are put forth in support of an opposing conclusion. Disputant a argues that the inherent teleology of biological processes proves the existence of God. Disputant b argues that the existence of gratuitous evil proves that there is no God. Pending further philosophical work, argument b neutralizes the conclusion of argument a.

iv. Suppositional Reasoning

Tarka, suppositional or dialectical reasoning, is crucial to Nyāya’s philosophical program. Still, according to Vātsyāyana, it is not a full-fledged independent pramāṇa. Rather it is an “assistant to the pramāṇas” (pramāṇa-anugrahaka) (NB Introduction). Tarka is commonly employed as a form of reductio argument for the sake of judging competing claims or arguments, a reductio which depends not only on logical inconsistency, but on incoherence with deeply-held beliefs or norms. In the face of competing claims x and y about subject s, tarkais employed to show that x violates such norms, thereby shifting the presumptive weight to alternative y. Vātsyāyana (NB1.1.40) offers the example of competing claims about the nature of the self. Some say that the self is a product which comes to exist within time while others claim that it is unproduced and eternal. The Naiyāyika deploys tarkaby arguing that a consequence of the former view is that one’s initial life circumstances would not be determined by his karmic inheritance from previous lives, a severe violation of fundamental metaphysical positions held by almost every Indian school. As such, strong presumptive weight should be given to the latter view. This example illustrates the way in which considerations of negative coherence govern tarka’s deployment.

Vātsyāyana notes that the reason tarkais not an independent pramāṇa is that it does not independently establish the nature of the thing in question (anavadhāranāt). It provides consent (anujānāti) for one of two alternatives independently supported by apparent pramāṇas, by illustrating problems with the competing view. Uddyotakara (NV 1.1.1) adds that it is excluded from the ranks of pramāṇa because it does not provide definitive cognition (pramāṇamparicchedakaṁnatarkaḥ).

Later Naiyāyikas extol tarka as a means to test dubious inferential concomitances (vyāpti) by testing them against more fundamental holdings of various sorts. Tarka also has a crucial role in the management of philosophical doubt. Against the skeptic, Nyāya argues that doubt is not always reasonable. Tarka helps to distinguish legitimate doubt from mere contentiousness by illustrating which claims are better motivated and hence deserving of presumptive weight.

c. Analogical Reasoning (upamāna)

Nyāya-sūtra1.1.6 defines analogyas follows.

Analogy makes an object known by similarity with something already known.

Naiyāyikas commonly frame analogy as a means of vocabulary acquisition, and it has a severely restricted scope compared with the other pramāṇas. The standard example involves a person who is told that a water buffalo looks something like a cow and that such buffalo are present in a certain place in the countryside. Later, when out in the countryside, he recognizes that the thing he is seeing is similar to a cow, and therefore is a water buffalo. The cognition “That thing is a water buffalo,” born of the recollection of testimony regarding its similarity with a cow and the perception of such common features, is paradigmatically analogical. Though most of the other schools either reduce analogy to a more fundamental pramāṇaor conceive of it in very different terms (Mīmāṁsā conceives of it as the capacity by which we apprehend similarity itself), Nyāya contends that the cognition in question is sui generis analogical, though it incorporates information from other pramāṇas.

d. Testimony (śabda)

NS1.1.5 defines testimony as follows.

Testimony is the assertion of a qualified speaker.

The semantic range of āpta (“authority,” “credible person”) includes expertise, trustworthiness, and reliability. Vātsyāyana claims that an āpta possesses direct knowledge of something, and a willingness to convey such knowledge without distortion (NB 1.1.7). It is clear, though, that Nyāya does not require any kind of special expertise from such a speaker in normal situations. Nor does a hearer need positive evidence of trustworthiness. Mere absence of doubt in the asserter’s ability to speak authoritatively about the issue at hand is enough. Testimony is thus thought of as a transmission of information or content. A person attains an accurate cognition through some pramāṇatoken. In a properly functioning testimonial exchange, she bestows the information apprehended by the initial cognition to an epistemically responsible hearer. On such grounds, Uddyotakara notes that testimonial utterances may be divided into those whose contents are originally generated by perception or by inference. Jayanta likewise claims that the veridicality or non-veridicality of a testimonial cognition is dependent on the speaker’s knowledge of the content of her statement and her honesty in relating it.Vātsyāyana (NB 2.1.69) illustrates a levelheaded frankness about testimony’s importance, noting that “in accord with knowledge gained by testimony, people undertake their common affairs.” Uddyotakarasimilarlyrecognizes that testimony has the widest range of any source of knowledge, far outstripping what one may know from personal perception, inference or analogy.

e. Non-pramāṇa Epistemic Capacities

From the sūtra period, Nyāya recognizes a number of epistemic capacities which are nevertheless considered non-pramāṇa (NS 2.2.1-12). They are not considered independent pramāṇas for one of two reasons: (i) they are reducible to subspecies of other pramāṇas, or (ii) they do not produce the specific kind of cognitions which a pramāṇa must deliver. A core locus of debate amongst classical Indian thinkers is the nature and number of pramāṇas. Nyāya contends that the above four are the only irreducible sources of knowledge, which subsume all other kinds.

f. General Theory of Knowledge

i. A Causal Theory of Knowledge

Naiyāyikas speak of cognitive success in causal terms. “Pramāṇa” normally refers to a means or process by which veridical awareness-episodes (pramā) are generated, as seen above. Vātsyāyana glosses the meaning of pramāṇaas “that by which something is properly cognized (pramītyateanena)” (NB1.1.3).  Uddyotakara concurs: “what is spoken of as a pramāṇa? A pramāṇais the cause of a [veridical] cognition” (upalabdhi-hetupramāṇam) (NV1.1.1). Moreover, despite its focus on reflective consideration of belief and valid cognition, Nyāya argues that the simple,unreflective functioning of a pramāṇa like perception or testimony is enough to generate knowledge in the absence of countervailing evidence.

ii. Internalist Constraints

Nyāya does maintain an internalist constraint: Once doubt arises—by adversarial challenge, peer disagreement, inconsistency between differentcognitions, and so forth —a cognition must be validated in order to maintain the status of being “pramāṇa-produced.” Doubt triggers a second-order concern with reflective inquiry and certification. The sūtras state that “Where there is doubt, there must be ongoing examination” (NS 2.1.7). Uddyotakara therefore claims that doubt is an essential component of investigation (vicāraaṅga) (NV 1.1.23). Validation involves consciously reflecting on the etiology of a cognition to ensure that it is the product of a properly-functioning pramāṇa. It may also involve the deployment of other pramāṇasin the hopes for a convergence of knowledge-sources (pramāṇa-saṁplava) in support of the doubted cognition. In his opening comments on the Nyāya-sūtra, Vātsyāyana famously provides a pragmatic test (but not definition) of truth: cognitions which guide us to successful action are likely veridical.

iii. A Relational Theory of Cognition

Nyāya epistemologists speak of cognition (jñāna, buddhi, upalabdhi, pratyaya): generally immediate awareness states of what Nyāya understands to be a mind-independent external reality. In the case of apperception, one cognizesher own mental states. Ontologically, cognitions are considered properties (guṇas) of individual selves (ātmans). Memory dispositions, when triggered, generate cognition about the past. With a few exceptions, cognitions target things other than themselves.

For Nyāya, cognitions target their objects by means of a relation called “objecthood” (viṣayatā). Nyāya’s theory is thus not exactly representational, but relational. “Objecthood” minimally has a threefold structure (with the possibility of iteration) corresponding to three features of the external object in question: a portion of the cognition targets an object itself, a portion of the cognition targets a property of the object, and finally, a portion of the cognition targets the relationship between the object and its property. In cases of veridical cognition (pramā), the portion of cognition which targets a substantive and the portion which targets its property match up. Gaṅgeśa famously defines veridical cognition as “a cognitive state with predication content x about something in fact qualified by x” (Tattvacintāmaṇi, pramā-lakṣaṇa-vāda). Seeing a male human being as qualified by “man” would be a paradigm case of veridical cognition. Error is generally classified as a misfire of the property-scoping portion of cognition. In error, a substantive is indeed cognized, but the property which is targeted does not actually qualify the substantive in question. The cognition’s intentionality is bifurcated, so to speak, simultaneously scoping a substantive and a property which is in fact alien to it.

iv. Response to Skepticism

Nyāya is a staunchly anti-skeptical tradition of epistemology. While it does give an important role to doubt, which, as seen above, triggers reflection and philosophical review, it rejects the notion that doubt should be the starting place in philosophical reflection. Doubt itself should be motivated, as trust is a better default starting place in both ordinary life and philosophy. Pragmatically, Nyāya argues that the role of epistemology is to better hone our cognitive abilities in order to succeed in our life aims. But unrestricted doubt would undermine our ability to function on a basic level, and it therefore militates against the very point of epistemological inquiry. Theoretically, Nyāya argues that error and indeed doubt itself are conceptually parasitical on true cognition. Error and doubt only make sense against a background of true belief, and therefore reflection must start by taking putatively veridical cognition at face value. Allied to this is a strain of criticism that even the simple act of giving voice to skeptical arguments belays a philosopher’s dependence on knowledge sources, including the inductively-supported tie between words and their meanings, which a skeptic relies on to speak his case. Given that everyone, the skeptic included, relies on pramāṇas, they are to be given the lion’s share of default entitlement.

2. Metaphysics

Nyāya defends a realist and pluralist metaphysics of categories (padārthas, lit. “things denoted by words”), largely adapted, with some modifications, from its sister school Vaiśeṣika. The categories are substance, quality, action, universal, individuator, inherence and absence. They will be discussed individually below.

a. Substance (dravya), Including Self (ātman)

Substances are the bedrock of Nyāya/Vaiśeṣika metaphysics (hereafter, simply “Nyāya Metaphysics”), as other categories generally inhere within substances or are nested within properties that inhere within substances. Paradigmatic substances include the indestructible atoms of earth, water, air and fire; composite substances like pots and trees; inner “selves” (ātman) which are the eternal, reincarnating souls; and God, a unique ātman.

Naiyāyikas provide a number of arguments in support of a non-material self. A standard argument runs as follows: Things like desire, cognition, experiences of pleasure and pain and volition are qualities. All qualities inhere in substances. Therefore, there is a substance to which desire and the rest belong. This conclusion is then followed by an argument from elimination. None of the material elements like earth or water are the bearers of desire and the rest. Therefore, there must be a special, non-material substance, namely a self (see various commentaries on NS 1.1.10). This argument is bolstered by others meant to illustrate that the physical body, as a product of material elements cannot be the fundamental locus of conscious states.

Some of the richest debates in classical India take place between Nyāya and Buddhists over the reality of substances. The central concern of such debates is often the statusof individual selves—an important substance, to say the least. Famously, the Buddha declared that reality is “lacking a self” (anātman), and his followers develop a number of arguments which purport to illustrate this in two ways. (i) Diachronically: moment by moment, things are destroyed and new things arise, such that no substance (including selves) endures for longer than a moment. (ii) Synchronically: in a single moment, what we take to be wholes (including selves) are nothing more than heaps of micro-properties (illustrated by the famous chariot metaphor in The Questions of King Milinda.) The Buddhist position is that although there is no such thing as an enduring self, the need for moral continuity and other desiderata may be satisfied merely by the causal connections between events in a single causal stream which we refer to as a “person.”

Nyāya’s response is to defend the existence of substances generally and selves in particular. In defense of substances, it argues that composite substances have capacities beyond the mere collection of their parts (NS 2.1.35). Moreover, Nyāya argues that the Buddhist reduction, if carried out consistently, would lead to an absurdity. We can see composite substances, but we cannot seeentities like atoms, which exist below our perceptual threshold. But if substances are nothing but heaps of micro objects/properties, which themselves can be reduced, and so on, then we should not be able to perceive substances at all. Thus, there must be a unified identity for individual substances which undergirds their availability for perceptual experience (NS 2.1.36).

In defense of the diachronic existence of individual selves, Nyāya argues that our experience of recollection (“that is the very man I saw a week ago”) requires a locus of memory which spans the time between the initial experience and the re-experience of an object (NS 1.1.10 and allied commentaries). In this spirit, Uddyotakara, following Vātsyāyana, argues that if I am now a different self than the “me” of yesterday, I should not be able to recollect things which that “me” experienced, since one self is unable to recollect the content of another’s experience. In defense of the synchronic identity of selves, Nyāya argues that cross-modal recognition (“that thing I see is the same thing I am touching”) requires a single experiencer with the ability to synthesize data from various senses (NS 3.1.1-3). Early Nyāya’s arguments for the self find their apex in Udayana’s monograph Determining the Truth of the Self.

b. Quality

Qualities (guṇa), are property tropes which qualify substances. Unlike universals they are not repeatable. The red color of some particular fire hydrant is a quality. Like other instances of the color red it is inhered by the universal redness, but it is as particular as the hydrant which it qualifies. Qualities include color, number (which is thought to inhere in objects), spatial location, contact, disjunction, and so forth, along with qualities which are unique to selves, like desire, cognition, and karmic merit.

c. Action

Like qualities, actions (karma) inhere in substances and are non-repeatable tropes. But they have causal capacities which qualities lack, particularly the ability to engender conjunction and disjunction between substances.

d. Universal

Universals (sāmānya or jāti) inhere in substances (for examplepot-hood), qualities (redness) or motions (contractionhood). Naiyāyikas argue that universals are required to account for common experiences of a recurring character, for the functioning of language, andto undergird causal regularities in nature (which are held to be relations between universals). As its theory of universals is developed, Nyāya recognizes entities which are like universals, but which are, for theoretical reasons, excluded from their ranks (upādhi). Udayana would famously chart the reasons for such exclusion. These are: (i) A true universal must be capable of more than one instance. Spacehood would not be a true universal, as it can only have one instance. (ii) Two universals which have the same exact instances are in fact the same universal, simply under two designations. (iii) Should two apparent universals share an instance, while one is not entirely subsumed within the other, both are mere upādhis. This criterion, which is the most controversial of the “universal-blockers,” suggests that the operative notion of universal here is something akin to natural kinds. (iv) Any supposed universal that would, if accepted, lead to an infinite regress (for example universal-hood), is not accepted. (v) There is no universal for individuators (see below), as their ontic function is to introduce primitive differentiation. (vi) There is no universal for inherence (see below), as this would engender a vicious infinite regress: inherence would require further inherence between it and its universal “inherencehood”, and so on.

e. Inherence

Inherence is a relation which is central to Nyāya’s ontology, by which qualities, actions, universals, and individuators relate to substances, by which universals relate to qualities and actions, and by which wholes relate to their parts. In the first instance, the brown color of a cow inheres in the cow. In the second, the universal brownness inheres in the quality trope brown. In the third, my car, a substance, is a single entity, which inheres in its various parts. Thus, your touching just one part of my car is enough to justify the claim “you touched my car” simpliciter. Nyāya contends that inherence is a self-linking property. It does not rely on other instances of inherence in order to “glue” it to the two elements which it relates. Thus it seeks to rebut regress arguments of the type advanced by recently by F. H. Bradley and by the classical Vedāntin Śaṅkarācārya (c. 9th century C.E.) in classical India.

f. Individuator

Individuators are the finest-grained causes of ontological distinction. They are the means by which individual atoms within the basic kinds “earth”, “water”, and so forth, and by which individual selves are ultimately particularized. Individuators for Nyāya’s ontology may be conceived as roughly analogous to haecceities within Western philosophical discourse.

g. Absence

The ontological reality of absence, however attenuated, isaccepted by Nyāya in order to account for both linguistic practice involving negation and cognitive states which correctly ascertain non-existence of some kind.Vātsyāyana argues that the positive knowledge produced by a knowledge sourcegives immediate rise to knowledge of an absence insofar as one can reflect that if something was not made manifest at the time of the initial cognition (and provided that the thing in question is ordinarily cognizable), it was absent. Uddyotakara famously argues that negation is often perceptible: looking at my desk, I see the absence of a coffee mug, and such absence is “located” on the surface my desk. In this spirit, absence is generally thought of as a qualifier (viśeṣana) of some object or property, which is the qualificand (viśeṣya). The four basic kinds of absences accepted by Nyāya in its mature period are prior absence (of something before it is created), absence-by-destruction (of an object after it is destroyed), absolute absence (of something for some locus where it could never exist), and mutual absence (between two separately existing objects).

h. Causation

Naiyāyikas speak of a cause or causal condition as something which is necessarily antecedent to aspecific kind of effect without being “causally irrelevant”. Such causes are threefold. The (i) inherence cause, akin to a material cause, is the substratum out of which (or within which) an effect is made (the threads which together make up a cloth). The (ii) non-inherence cause includes properties of the inherence cause which influence the properties of the effect (the property of contact which inheres within the threads which make up a cloth). Finally, (iii), the instrumental/agential cause(s). This third category is a kind of catch-all which includes everything aside from the substratum and its properties. Central in this category are agents, their activities, and instruments used by then to produce effects. Out of the nexus of causal conditions which come together in the production of an effect, Naiyāyikas tend to speak of a most important factor as the trigger cause (for example the striking of a match against a rough surface which produces a lit match).

In order to weed out unnecessary or unimportant factors from the causal nexus which produces an effect, Nyāya includes the caveat that a proper cause must not be “causally irrelevant”. Causal irrelevance occurs in various ways. For example, something x which universally precedes a certain effect y, but whose relationship with the effect is mediated by some other factor z upon which it subsists is causally irrelevant. For example, a certain artist may create a unique kind of sculpture, and she is thus identified as a causal factor in its production. She may have certain properties (hair color, eye color, height) which also, by means of their subsisting in her, invariably precede the production of her sculptures. But since their participation in the causal event is derivative, they are deemed causally irrelevant and unworthy of being specified as causes.

3. Philosophy of Religion

Nyāya expressly conceives of itself as a rational defender of classical Hindu religious and theistic culture. Nyāya-sūtra begins by claiming that ascertainment of the ultimate good (niḥśreya) requires correct apprehension of reality, which gives rise to a sustained epistemological/metaphysical investigation of the kind the sūtras provide.Vātsyāyanaargues that as a discipline of inquiry, Nyāya is the support of all practices of legitimate dharma. Jayanta claims that amongst the various research programs in the umbrella of classical Vedic culture, Nyāya is of chief importance, since it aims to defend Vedic tradition and its manifold subdivisions of study from the attacks of rival, anti-Vedic philosophers. Though the Nyāya-sūtra overwhelmingly focuses on theoretical issues and not praxis, it nonetheless recommends that students of Nyāya engage in yogic practice (4.2.42) and defends the possibility of enlightenment (4.2.44-5).

From fairly early in its history, Nyāya specifically takes it upon itself to defend the existence of God (Īśvara). Nyāya primarily employs versions of the design inference. Paradigmatic arguments include:

Primordial matter, atoms and karma function when guided by a conscious agent because they are insentient (acetaṇatvāt) like an axe. As axes, due to insentience, operate only when directed by a sentient agent, so too do things like primordial nature, atoms and karma. Therefore, they too are directed by a cause possessed of intelligence. (Uddyotakara, NV 4.1.21)

Things like the earth have a maker as their cause, because they are products (kāryatvāt). (Udayana Nyāyakusumāñjali, Fifth Chapter)

With various formulations like the above, and extensive supporting arguments, Nyāya defends a version of the argument from design. Buddhist, Mīmāṁsā (and later, Jain) philosophers respond by charging Nyāya with violations of inferential boundaries: only by extrapolating far beyond the correlation between ordinary products and makers is Nyāya able to argue for a unique God-like maker of the world. A standard response, as seen in Vācaspati (NVT 4.1.21) is that even in straightforward general-to-particular inductive reasoning, we employ some degree of inference to the best explanation. This allows enough flexibility to infer new kinds of entities while appealing to correlations generated from ordinary experience.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Sanskrit Source Materials

  • JayantaBhaṭṭa. Nyāya-mañjarī. Critically Edited by Vidvan, K. S. Varadacarya.Vol 1. Mysore: Oriental Research Institute 1969.
  • JayantaBhaṭṭa. Nyāya-mañjarī. Critically Edited by Vidvan, K. S. Varadacarya.Vol 2. Mysore: Oriental Research Institute 1983.
  • Nyāya-Tarkatirtha, Taranatha and Amarendramohan Tarkatirtha, eds. Nyāyadarśanamwith Vātsyāyana’sBhāṣya [cited as NB above], Uddyotakara’s Vārttika[cited as NV], Vācaspati Miśra’s Tātparyaṭīkā [cited as NVT] & Viśvanātha’s Vṛtti. Calcutta: Munshiram Manoharlal 2003.
  • Udayana. Nyāyavārttikatātpāryaśuddhi of Udayanācārya. Edited by Anantalal Thakur. New Delhi: Indian Council of Philosophical Research.

b. Primary Texts in English Translation

  • Gangopadhyaya, Mrinalkanti, trans. Nyāya: Gautama’s Nyāya-sūtra with Vātsyāyana’s Commentary. Calcutta: Indian Studies 1982.
  • Iyer, S. R., Editor and Translator, Tarkabhāṣā of Keśava Miśra. Varanasi: Chaukhambha Orientalia, 1979.
  • JayantaBhaṭṭa. Nyāya-mañjarī. Translated by JanakiVallabhaBhattacaryya.Vol. 1. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass 1978.
  • Jha, Sir Ganganatha, trans. The Nyāya-sūtras of Gautama.Vols 1-4. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass 1999.
  • Phillips, Stephen and N. S. Ramanuja Tatacharya. Epistemology of Perception: Gaṅgeśa’s Tattvacintāmaṇi Jewel of Reflection on the Truth (About Epistemology), The Perception Chapter (pratyakṣa-khaṇḍa). New York: American Institute of Buddhist Studies 2004. [This also contains the Sanskrit text.]
  • Potter, Karl H., ed. Encyclopedia of Indian Philosophies.Vol. 2. Nyāya-Vaiśeṣika. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass 1977. [This volume contains summary translations and helpful historical and conceptual introductions to early Nyāya and its individual philosophers.]
  • Udayana. Ātmatattvaviveka. Translation and commentary by N. S. Dravid.  Shimla: Indian Institute of Advanced Study 1995. [This also contains the Sanskrit text.]
  • Udayana. Nyāyakusumāñjali. Translation and commentary by N. S. Dravid. New Delhi: Indian Council of Philosophical Research 1996. [This also contains the Sanskrit text.]

c. Studies of Nyāya Epistemology, Metaphysics, and Philosophy of Religion in English

  • Bhattacaryya, Gopikamohan. Studies in Nyāya-vaiśeṣika Theism. Calcutta: Sanskrit College 1961.
  • Chakrabarti, Kisor Kumar. Classical Indian Philosophy of Mind: The Nyāya Dualist Tradition. Albany: State University of New York Press 1999.
  • Chemparathy, George. An Indian Rational Theology: Introduction to Udayana’s Nyāyakusumāñjali. Publications of the De Nobili Research Library, Vol. 1. Vienna: Gerold& Co.; Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass 1972.
  • Ghokale, Pradeep P. Inference and Fallacies Discussed in Ancient Indian Logic (with special reference to Nyāya and Buddhism). Bibliotheca Indo-Buddhica Series, Sunil Gupta, ed.Delhi: Sri Satguru Publications 1992.
  • Halbfass, Wilhelm. On Being and What There Is: Classical Vaiśeṣika and the History of Indian Ontology. Albany: State University of New York Press 1992. [Though this text focuses on Vaiśeṣika, it is relevant given the great overlap between Nyāya and Vaiśeṣika in metaphysical theory.]
  • Matilal, B. K. Perception. Oxford: Clarendon Press: Oxford 1986.
  • Matilal, B. K. The Character of Logic in India. Albany: SUNY Press 1998.

d. General Studies

  • Ganeri, Jonardon. Philosophy in Classical India: The Proper Work of Reason. London and New York: Routledge 2001.
  • Matilal, B. K. Nyāya-Vaiśeṣika. A History of Indian Literature, Vol. 6, Fasc. 2. Edited by Jan Gonda. Weisbaden: Otto Harrassowitz 1977.
  • Mohanty, J.N. Classical Indian Philosophy. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc., 2000.
  • Phillips, Stephen. Classical Indian Metaphysics: Refutations of Realism and the Emergence of “New Logic.” Chicago: Open Court 1995.

Author Information

Matthew R. Dasti
Email: mdasti@bridgew.edu
Bridgewater State University
U. S. A.

Ordinary Language Philosophy

Ordinary Language philosophy, sometimes referred to as ‘Oxford’ philosophy, is a kind of ‘linguistic’ philosophy. Linguistic philosophy may be characterized as the view that a focus on language is key to both the content and method proper to the discipline of philosophy as a whole (and so is distinct from the Philosophy of Language). Linguistic philosophy includes both Ordinary Language philosophy and Logical Positivism, developed by the philosophers of the Vienna Circle (for more detail see Analytic Philosophy section 3). These two schools are inextricably linked historically and theoretically, and one of the keys to understanding Ordinary Language philosophy is, indeed, understanding the relationship it bears to Logical Positivism. Although Ordinary Language philosophy and Logical Positivism share the conviction that philosophical problems are ‘linguistic’ problems, and therefore that the method proper to philosophy is ‘linguistic analysis’, they differ vastly as to what such analysis amounts to, and what the aims of carrying it out are.

Ordinary Language philosophy is generally associated with the (later) views of Ludwig Wittgenstein, and with the work done by the philosophers of Oxford University between approximately 1945-1970. The origins of Ordinary Language philosophy reach back, however, much earlier than 1945 to work done at Cambridge University, usually marked as beginning in 1929 with the return of Wittgenstein, after some time away, to the Cambridge faculty. It is often noted that G. E. Moore was a great influence on the early development of Ordinary Language philosophy (though not an Ordinary Language philosopher himself), insofar as he initiated a focus on and interest in ‘commonsense’ views about reality. Major figures of Ordinary Language philosophy include (in the early phases) John Wisdom, Norman Malcolm, Alice Ambrose, Morris Lazerowitz, and (in the later phase) Gilbert Ryle, J. L. Austin and P. F. Strawson, among others. However, it is important to note that the Ordinary Language philosophical view was not developed as a unified theory, nor was it an organized program, as such. Indeed, the figures we now know as ‘Ordinary Language’ philosophers did not refer to themselves as such – it was originally a term of derision, used by its detractors. Ordinary Language philosophy is (besides an historical movement) foremost a methodology – one which is committed to the close and careful study of the uses of the expressions of language, especially the philosophically problematic ones. A commitment to this methodology as that which is proper to, and most fruitful for, the discipline of philosophy, is what unifies an assortment of otherwise diverse and independent views.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Cambridge
    1. Analysis and Formal Logic
    2. Logical Atomism
    3. Logical Positivism and Ideal Language
    4. Ordinary Language versus Ideal Language
  3. Ordinary Language Philosophy: Nothing is Hidden
    1. The Misuses of Language
    2. Philosophical Disputes and Linguistic Disputes
    3. Ordinary Language is Correct Language
    4. The Paradigm Case Argument
    5. A Use-Theory of Linguistic Meaning
  4. Oxford
    1. Ryle
    2. Austin
    3. Strawson
  5. The Demise of Ordinary Language Philosophy: Grice
  6. Contemporary Views
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. Analysis and Formal Logic
    2. Logical Atomism
    3. Logical Positivism and Ideal Language
    4. Early Ordinary Language Philosophy
    5. The Paradigm Case Argument
    6. Oxford Ordinary Language Philosophy
    7. Criticism of Ordinary Language Philosophy
    8. Contemporary views
    9. Historical and Other Commentaries

1. Introduction

For Ordinary Language philosophy, at issue is the use of the expressions of language, not expressions in and of themselves. So, at issue is not, for example, ordinary versus (say) technical words; nor is it a distinction based on the language used in various areas of discourse, for example academic, technical, scientific, or lay, slang or street discourses – ordinary uses of language occur in all discourses. It is sometimes the case that an expression has distinct uses within distinct discourses, for example, the expression ‘empty space’. This may have both a lay and a scientific use, and both uses may count as ordinary; as long as it is quite clear which discourse is in play, and thus which of the distinct uses of the expression is in play. Though connected, the difference in use of the expression in different discourses signals a difference in the sense with which it is used, on the Ordinary Language view. One use, say the use in physics, in which it refers to a vacuum, is distinct from its lay use, in which it refers rather more flexibly to, say, a room with no objects in it, or an expanse of land with no buildings or trees. However, on this view, one sense of the expression, though more precise than the other, would not do as a replacement of the other term; for the lay use of the term is perfectly adequate for the uses it is put to, and the meaning of the term in physics would not allow speakers to express what they mean in these other contexts.

Thus, the way to understand what is meant by the ‘ordinary use of language’ is to hold it in contrast, not with ‘technical’ use, but with ‘non-standard’ or ‘non-ordinary’ use, or uses that are not in accord with an expression’s ‘ordinary meaning’. Non-ordinary uses of language are thought to be behind much philosophical theorizing, according to Ordinary Language philosophy: particularly where a theory results in a view that conflicts with what might be ordinarily said of some situation. Such ‘philosophical’ uses of language, on this view, create the very philosophical problems they are employed to solve. This is often because, on the Ordinary Language view, they are not acknowledged as non-ordinary uses, and attempt to be passed-off as simply more precise (or ‘truer’) versions of the ordinary use of some expression – thus suggesting that the ordinary use of some expression is deficient in some way. But according to the Ordinary Language position, non-ordinary uses of expressions simply introduce new uses of expressions. Should criteria for their use be provided, according to the Ordinary Language philosopher, there is no reason to rule them out.

Methodologically, ‘attending to the ordinary uses of language’ is held in general to be in opposition to the philosophical project, begun by the Logical Atomists (for more detail on this movement, see below, and the article on Analytic Philosophy, section 2d.) and taken up and developed most enthusiastically by the Logical Positivists, of constructing an ‘ideal’ language. An ideal language is supposed to represent reality more precisely and perspicuously than ordinary language. Ordinary Language philosophy emerged in reaction against certain views surrounding this notion of an ideal language. The ‘Ideal Language’ doctrine (which reached maturity in Logical Positivism) sees ‘ordinary’ language as obstructing a clear view on reality – it is thought to be opaque, vague and misleading, and thus stands in need of reform (at least insofar as it is to deliver philosophical truth).

Contrary to this view, according to Ordinary Language philosophy, it is the attempt to construct an ideal language that leads to philosophical problems, since it involves the non-ordinary uses of language. The key view to be found in the metaphilosophy of the Ordinary Language philosophers is that ordinary language is perfectly well suited to its purposes, and stands in no need of reform – though it can always be supplemented, and is also in a constant state of evolution. On this line of thought, the observation of and attention to the ordinary uses of language will ‘dissolve’ (rather than ‘solve’) philosophical problems – that is, will show them to have not been genuine problems in the first place, but ‘misuses’ of language.

On the positive side, the analysis of the ordinary uses of language may actually lead to philosophical knowledge, according to at least some versions of the view. But, the caveat is, the knowledge proper to philosophy is knowledge (or, rather, improved understanding) of the meanings of the expressions we use (and thus, what we are prepared to count as being described by them), or knowledge of the ‘conceptual’ structures our use of language reflects (our ‘ways of thinking about and experiencing things’). Wittgenstein himself would have argued that this ‘knowledge’ is nothing new, that it was available to all of us all along – all we had to do was notice it through paying proper attention to language use. Later Ordinary Language philosophers such as Strawson, however, argued that this did count as new knowledge – for it made possible new understanding of our experience of reality. Hence, on this take, philosophy does not merely have a negative outcome (the ‘dissolution’ of philosophical problems), and Ordinary Language philosophy need not be understood as quietist or even nihilist as has been sometimes charged. It does, however, turn out to be a somewhat different project to that which it is traditionally conceived to be.

2. Cambridge

The genesis of Ordinary Language philosophy occurred in the work of Wittgenstein after his 1929 return to Cambridge. This period, roughly up to around 1945, represents the early period of Ordinary Language philosophy that we may characterize as ‘Wittgensteinian’. We shall examine these roots first, before turning to its later development at Oxford (which we will continue to call ‘Oxford’ philosophy for convenience) – development that saw significant evolution and variation in the view.

The Cambridge period may be characterized as ‘Wittgensteinian’ because the Ordinary Language philosophers of the time were close followers of Wittgenstein. Many were his pupils at Cambridge, or associates of those pupils who later traveled to other parts of the world transmitting Wittgenstein’s thought, including Ambrose, Lazerowitz, Malcolm, Gasking, Paul, Von Wright, Black, Findlay, Bouwsma and Anscombe to name a few. (See P. M. S. Hacker (1996) for a more detailed historical account, and biographical details, of the Cambridge and Oxford associates of Wittgenstein.) They cleaved closely to the views they believed they found in Wittgenstein’s work, much of which was distributed about Cambridge, and eventually Oxford, as manuscripts or lecture notes that were not published until some time later (for example The Blue and Brown Books (1958) and the seminal Philosophical Investigations (1953)).

These ‘Wittgensteinians’ developed and propounded certain ideas and views, and indeed arguments and theories that Wittgenstein himself may not have approved (nor did Wittgenstein himself ever accept any label for his work, let alone ‘Ordinary Language’ philosophy). The Wittgensteinians saw themselves as developing and extending Wittgenstein’s views, despite the fact that the key principle in Wittgenstein’s work (both earlier and later) was that philosophical ‘theses’, as such, cannot be stated. Wittgenstein steadfastly denied that his work amounted to a philosophical theory because, according to him, philosophy cannot ‘explain’ anything; it may only ‘describe’ what is anyway the case (Philosophical Investigations, section 126-128). The Wittgensteinians developed more explicit arguments that tried to explain and justify the method of appeal to ordinary language than did Wittgenstein. Nevertheless, it is possible to understand what they were doing as remaining faithful to the Wittgensteinian tenet that one cannot propound philosophical theses insofar as claims about meaning are not in themselves theses about meaning. Indeed, the view was that the appeal to the ordinary uses of language is an act of reminding us of how some term or expression is used anyway – to show its meaning rather than explain it.

The first stirrings of the Ordinary Language views emerged as a reaction against the prevailing Logical Atomist, and later, Logical Positivist views that had been initially (ironically) developed by Wittgenstein himself, and published in his Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus in 1921. In order to understand this reaction, we must take a brief look at the development of Ideal Language philosophy, which formed the background against which Ordinary Language philosophy arose.

a. Analysis and Formal Logic

Around the turn of the 20th century, in the earliest days of the development of Analytic philosophy, Russell and Moore (in particular) developed the methods of ‘analysis’ of problematic notions. These methods involved, roughly, ‘re-writing’ a philosophically problematic term or expression so as to render it ‘clearer’, or less problematic, in some sense. This itself involved a focus on language – or on the ‘proposition’ – as part of the methodology of philosophy, which was quite new at the time.

This new spirit of precision and rigor paid particular attention to Gottlob Frege’s groundbreaking work in formal logic (1879), which initiated the development of the truth-functional view of language. A logical system is truth-functional if all its sentential operators (words such as ‘and’, ‘or’, ‘not’ and ‘if…then’) are functions that take truth-values as arguments and yield truth-values as their output. The conception of a truth-functional language is deeply connected with that of the truth-conditional conception of meaning for natural language. On this view, the truth-condition of a sentence is its meaning – it is that in virtue of which an expression has a meaning – and the meaning of a compound sentence is determined by the meanings of its constituent parts, that is the words that compose it. This is known as the principle of compositionality (see Davidson’s Philosophy of Language, section 1a, i).

Although formal symbolic logic was developed initially in order to analyze and explore the structure of arguments, in particular the structure of ‘validity’, its success soon led many to see applications for it within the realm of natural language. Specifically, the thought began to emerge that the logic that was being captured in ever more sophisticated systems of symbolic logic was the structure that is either actually hidden beneath natural, ordinary language, or it is the structure which, if not present in ordinary language, ought to be. What emerges in connection with the development of the truth-functional and truth-conditional view of language is the idea that the surface form of propositions may not represent their ‘true’ (or truth-functional) logical form. Indeed, Russell’s ‘On Denoting’ in 1905, which proposed a thesis called the Theory of Descriptions, argues just that: that underlying the surface grammar of ordinary expressions was a distinct logical form. His method of the ‘logical analysis of language’, based on the attempt to ‘analyze’ (or ‘re-write’) the propositions of ordinary language into the propositions of an ideal language, became known as the ‘paradigm of philosophy’ (as described by Ramsey in his 1931, pp. 321).

Both Russell and Frege recognized that natural language did not always, on the surface at any rate, behave like symbolic logic. Its elementary propositions, for example, were not always determinately true or false; some were not truth-functional, or compositional, at all (such as those in ‘opaque contexts’ like “Mary believes she has a little lamb”) and so on. In ‘On Denoting’ Russell proposed that despite misleading surface appearances, many (ideally, all) of the propositions of ordinary language could nevertheless be rewritten as transparently truth-functional propositions (that is, those that can be the arguments of truth-functions, and whose values are determinately either true or false, as given by their truth-conditions). That is, he argued, they could be ‘analyzed’ in such a way as to reveal the true logical form of the proposition, which may be obscured beneath the surface grammatical form of the proposition.

The proposition famously treated to Russell’s logical analysis in ‘On Denoting’ is the following: “The present King of France is bald.” We do not know how to treat this proposition truth-functionally if there is no present King of France – it does not have a clear truth-value in this case. But all propositions that can be the arguments of truth-functions must be determinately either true or false. The surface grammar of the proposition appears to claim of some object X, that it is bald. Therefore, it would appear that the proposition is true or false depending on whether X is bald or not bald. But there is no X. Russell’s achievement lies in his analysis of this proposition in (roughly and non-symbolically) the following way, which rendered it truth-functional (such that the truth-value of the whole is a function of the truth-values of the parts) after all: instead of “The present King of France is bald,” we read (or analyze the proposition as) “There is one, and only one, object X such that X is the present King of France (and) X is bald.” Now the proposition is comprised of elementary propositions governed by an existential quantifier (plus a ‘connective’– the word ‘and’), which can now be treated perfectly truth-functionally, and can return a determinately true or false value. Since the elementary proposition that claims that there is such an X is straightforwardly false, then by the rules of the propositional calculus this renders the entire complex proposition straightforwardly false. This had the result that it was no longer necessary to agonize over whether something that does not exist can be bald or not!

b. Logical Atomism

To the view that logical analysis would reveal a ‘logically perfect’ truth-functional language that lurked beneath ordinary language (but was obscured by it), Russell added that the most elementary constituents of the true logical form of a proposition (‘logical atoms’) correspond with the most elementary constituents of reality. This combination of views constituted his Logical Atomism (for more detail see Analytic Philosophy, section 2d). According to Russell, the simple parts of propositions represent the simple parts of the world. And just as more complex propositions are built up out of simpler ones, so the complex facts and objects in reality are built up out of simpler ones (Russell 1918).

Thus, the notion of the ‘true logical form’ of propositions was not only thought to be useful for working out how arguments functioned, and whether they were valid, but for a wider metaphysical project of representing how the world really is. The essence of Russellian Logical Atomism is that once we analyze language into its true logical form, we can simply read off from it the ultimate ontological structure of reality. The basic assumption at work here, which formed the foundation for the Ideal Language view, is that the essential and fundamental purpose of language is to represent the world. Therefore, the more ‘perfect’, that is ‘ideal’, the language, the more accurately it represents the world. A logically perfect language is, on this line of thought, a literal mirror of metaphysical reality. Russell’s work encouraged the view that language is meaningful in virtue of this underlying representational and truth-functional nature.

The Ideal Language view gave weight to the growing suspicion that ordinary language actually obscured our access to reality, because it obscured true logical form. Perhaps, the thought went, ordinary language does not represent the world as it really is. For example, the notion of a non-existent entity, suggested in the proposition about ‘the present King of France’ was simply one which arose because of the misleading surface structure of ordinary language, which, when properly ‘analyzed’, revealed there was no true ontological commitment to such a paradoxical entity at all.

Wittgenstein, in his Tractatus, took these basic ideas of Logical Atomism to a more sophisticated level, but also provided the materials for the development of the views by the Logical Positivists. An ideal language, according to Wittgenstein, was understood to actually share a structure with metaphysical reality. On this view, between language and reality there was not mere correspondence of elements, but isomorphism of form – reality shares the ‘logical form’ of language, and is pictured in it. Wittgenstein’s version of Atomism became known as the ‘picture theory’ of language, and ultimately became the focus of the view he later rejected. A rather confounding part of Wittgenstein’s argument in the Tractatus is that although this picturing relation between reality and language exists, it cannot itself be represented, and nor therefore spoken of in language. Thus, according to Wittgenstein, the entire Tractatus attempts to say what cannot be said, and is therefore a form of ‘nonsense’ – once its lessons are absorbed, he advised, it must then be rejected, like a ladder to be kicked away once one has stepped up it to one’s destination (1921, section 6.54).

c. Logical Positivism and Ideal Language

The Vienna Circle, where the doctrine of Logical Positivism (or ‘Logical Empiricism’ as it was sometimes called) was developed, included philosophers such as Schlick, Waismann, Neurath, and Carnap, among others. (See Coffa 1991, chapter 13 for an authoritative history of this period in Vienna.) This group was primarily interested in the philosophy of science and epistemology. Unlike the Cambridge analysts, however, who merely thought metaphysics had to be done differently, that is more rigorously, the Logical Positivists thought it should not be done at all. They acquired this rejection of metaphysics from Wittgenstein’s Tractatus.

According to the Tractatus, properly meaningful propositions divided into two kinds only: ‘factual’ propositions which represented, or ‘pictured’, reality and the propositions of logic. The latter, although not meaningless, were nevertheless all tautologous – empty of empirical, factual content. The propositions that fell into neither of these classes – according to Wittgenstein, the propositions of his own Tractatus – were ‘meaningless’ nonsense because, he claimed, they tried to say what could not be said. The Positivists did not accept this part of Wittgenstein’s view however, that is that what defined ‘nonsense’ was trying to say what could not be said. What they did believe was that metaphysical (and other) propositions are nonsense because they cannot be confirmed – there exists no procedure by which they may be verified. For the Positivists, ‘pseudo-propositions’ are those which present themselves as if they were factual propositions, but which are, in fact, not. The proposition, for example, “All atomic propositions correspond to atomic facts” looks like a scientific, factual claim such as “All physical matter is composed of atoms.” But the propositions are not of the same order, according to the Positivists – the former is masquerading as a scientific proposition, but in fact, it is not the sort of proposition that we know how to confirm, or even test. The former has, according to the view, no ‘method of verification’.

Properly ‘empirical’ propositions are those, according to the Positivists, that are ‘about’ the world, they are ‘factual’, have ‘content’ and their truth-values are determined strictly by the way the world is; but most crucially, they can be confirmed or disconfirmed by empirical observation of the world (testing, experimenting, observing via instruments, and so forth). On the other hand, the ‘logical’ propositions, and any that could be reduced to logical propositions for example analytic propositions, were not ‘about’ anything: they determined the form of propositions and structured the body of the properly empirical propositions of science. The so-called ‘Empiricist Theory of Meaning’ is, thus, the view that ‘the meaning of a proposition is its method of verification’, and the so-called ‘Verification Principle’ is the doctrine that if a proposition cannot be empirically verified, and it is not, or is not reducible to, a logical proposition, it is therefore meaningless (see Carnap 1949, pp. 119).

Logical Positivism cemented the Ideal Language view insofar as it accepted all of the elements we have identified; the view that ordinary language is misleading, and that underlying the vagueness and opacity of ordinary language is a precise and perspicuous language that is truth-functional and truth-conditional. From these basic ideas emerged the notion that a meaningful language is meaningful in virtue of having a systematic, and thus formalizable syntactic and semantic structure, which, although it is often obscured in ordinary language, could be revealed with proper philosophical and logical analysis.

It is in opposition to this overall picture that Ordinary Language philosophy arose. Ideal language came to be seen as thoroughly misleading as to the true structure of reality. As Alice Ambrose (1950) noted, ideal language was by this time “…[condemned] as being seriously defective and failing to do what it is intended to do. [This view] gives rise to the idea that [ordinary] language is like a tailored suit that does not fit” (pp. 14-15). Contrary to this notion, according to Ambrose, ordinary language is the very paradigm of meaningfulness. Wittgenstein, for example, said in the Philosophical Investigations that,

On the one hand it is clear that every sentence in our language ‘is in order as it is’. That is to say, we are not striving after an ideal, as if our ordinary vague sentences had not yet got a quite unexceptionable sense, and a perfect language awaited construction by us. – On the other hand it seems clear that where there is sense there must be perfect order. – So there must be perfect order even in the vaguest sentence. (Section 98)

d. Ordinary Language versus Ideal Language

It is notable that, methodologically, Ideal and Ordinary Language philosophy both placed language at the center of philosophy, thus taking the so-called ‘linguistic turn’ (a term coined by Bergmann 1953, pp. 65) – which is to hold the rather more radical position that philosophical problems are (really) linguistic problems.

Certainly both the Ideal and Ordinary Language philosophers argued that philosophical problems arise because of the ‘misuses of language’, and in particular they were united against the metaphysical uses of language. Both complained and objected to what they called ‘pseudo-propositions’. Both saw such ‘misuses’ of language as the source of philosophical problems. But although the Positivists ruled out metaphysical (and many other non-empirically verifiable) uses of language as nonsense on the basis of the Verification Principle, the Ordinary Language philosophers objected to them as concealed non-ordinary uses of language – not to be ruled out, as such, so long as criteria for their use were provided.

The Positivists understood linguistic analysis as the weeding out of nonsense, such that a ‘logic of science’ could emerge (Carnap 1934). A ‘logic of science’ would be based on an ideal language – one which is of a perfectly perspicuous logical form, comprised exhaustively of factual propositions, logical propositions and nothing else. In such a language, philosophical problems would be eliminated because they could not even be formulated. On the other hand, for the Ordinary Language philosophers, the aim was to resolve philosophical confusion, but one could expect to achieve a kind of philosophical enlightenment, or certainly a greater understanding of ourselves and the world, in the process of such resolution: for philosophy is seen as an ongoing practice without an ultimate end-game.

Most strikingly, however, is the difference in the views about linguistic meaning between the Ideal and Ordinary Language philosophers. As we’ve seen, the Ideal language view maintains a truth-functional and representational theory of meaning. The Ordinary Language philosophers held, following Wittgenstein, a use-based theory (or just a ‘use-theory’) of meaning. The exact workings of such a theory have never been fully detailed, but we turn to examine what we can of it below (section 3a). Suffice it to say here that, for the Ordinary Language philosopher, no proposition falls into a class – say ‘empirical’, ‘logical’, ‘necessary’, ‘contingent’ or ‘analytic’ or ‘synthetic’ and so forth in and of itself. That is, it is not, on a use-theory of meaning, the content of a proposition that marks it as belonging to such categories, but the way it is used in the language. (For more on this aspect of a use-theory, see for example Malcolm 1940; 1951.)

3. Ordinary Language Philosophy: Nothing is Hidden

The Ordinary Language philosophers, did not, strictly speaking, ‘reject’ metaphysics (to deny the existence of a metaphysical realm is itself, notice, a metaphysical contention). Rather, they ‘objected’ to metaphysical theorizing for two reasons. Firstly, because they believed it distorted the ordinary use of language, and this distortion was itself a source of philosophical problems. Secondly, they argued that metaphysical theorizing was superfluous to our philosophical needs – metaphysics was, basically, thought to be beside the point. Both objections rested on the view that our ordinary perceptions of the world, and our ordinary use of language to talk about them, are all we need to observe in order to dissipate philosophical perplexity. On this view, metaphysics adds nothing, but poses the danger of distorting what the issues really are. This position rests on Wittgenstein’s insistence that ‘nothing is hidden’.

Wittgenstein’s view was that whatever philosophy does, it simply describes what is open to view to anyone. Philosophy is not, on this approach, a matter of theorizing about ‘how reality really is’ and then confirming such philosophical ‘facts’ – generally, not obvious to everyday experience – through special philosophical techniques, such as analysis. Philosophy is, thus, quite distinct from the empirical sciences – as the Positivists agreed. For Ordinary Language philosophy, however, the distinction did not rest on issues of verification, but on the view that philosophy is a practice rather than an accumulation of knowledge or the discovery of new, special philosophical facts. This runs contrary to the traditional, ‘metaphysical’ view that ‘reality’ is somehow hidden, or underlies the familiar, the everyday reality we experience and must be ‘revealed’ or ‘discovered’ by some special philosophical kind of study or analysis. On the contrary Wittgenstein claimed:

Philosophy simply puts everything before us, and neither explains nor deduces anything.  – Since everything lies open to view there is nothing to explain. (Section 126)

…For nothing is hidden. (Section 435)

Metaphysical theorizing requires that language be used in ways that it is not ordinarily used, according to Wittgenstein, and the task proper to philosophy is to simply remind us what the ordinary uses actually are:

…We must do away with all explanation, and description alone must take its place. And this description gets its light, that is to say its purpose, from the philosophical problems. These are, of course, not empirical problems; they are solved rather by looking into the workings of our language, and that in such a way as to make us recognise these workings; in despite of an urge to misunderstand them. The problems are solved, not by giving new information, but by arranging what we have always known. Philosophy is a battle against the bewitchment of our intelligence by means of language. (Section 109)

What we do is bring words back from their metaphysical to their everyday use. (Section 116)

The idea that philosophical problems could be dissolved by means of the observation of the ordinary uses of language was referred to, mostly derogatively, by its critics as ‘therapeutic positivism’ (see the critical papers by Farrell 1946a and 1946b). It is true that the notion of ‘philosophy as therapy’ is to be found in the texts of Wittgenstein (1953, Section 133) and particularly in Wisdom (1936; 1953). However, the idea of philosophy as therapy was not an idea that was taken too kindly by traditional philosophers. The method was referred to by Russell as “…procurement by theft of what one has failed to gain by honest toil” (quoted in Rorty 1992, pp. 3). This view of philosophy was marked as a kind of ‘quietism’ about the real philosophical problems (a stubborn refusal to address them), and even as a kind of ‘nihilism’ about the prospects of philosophy altogether (once ‘misuses’ of language have been revealed, philosophical problems would disappear). It was only later at Oxford that Ordinary Language philosophy was eventually able to shrug off the association with the view that philosophical perplexity is a ‘disease’ that needed to be ‘cured’.

In the following sections, four important aspects of early Ordinary Language philosophy are examined, along with some of the key objections.

a. The Misuses of Language

In examining the view that metaphysics leads to the distortion of the ordinary uses of language, the question must also be answered as to why this was supposed to be a negative thing – since that is not at all obvious. An account is required of what the Ordinary Language philosophers counted as ‘ordinary’ uses of language, as non-ordinary uses, and why the latter was thought to be the source of philosophical problems, rather than elements of their solution.

The question of what counts as ‘ordinary’ language has been a pivotal point of objection to Ordinary Language philosophy from its earliest days. Some attempts were made by Ryle to get clearer on the matter (see 1953; 1957; 1961). For example, he emphasized, as we noted in the introduction, that it is not words that are of interest, but their uses:

Hume’s question was not about the word ‘cause’; it was about the use of ‘cause’. It was just as much about the use of ‘Ursache’. For the use of ‘cause’ is the same as the use of ‘Ursache’, though ‘cause’ is not the same word as ‘Ursache’. (1953, pp. 28)

He emphasized that the issue was ‘the ordinary use of language’ and not ‘the use of ordinary language’. Malcolm described the notion of the ordinary use of some expression thus:

By an “ordinary expression” I mean an expression which has an ordinary use, i.e. which is ordinarily used to describe a certain sort of situation. By this I do not mean that the expression need be one that is frequently used. It need only be an expression which would be used… To be an ordinary expression it must have a commonly accepted use; it need not be the case that it is ever used. (1942a, pp. 16)

The uses of expressions in question here refer almost entirely to what would ordinarily be said of some situation or state of affairs; what we (language users) would ordinarily call it a case of. So, of interest are the states of affairs that come under philosophical dispute, for example cases which we would ordinarily call cases of, say ‘free-will’, cases of ‘seeing some object’, cases of ‘knowing something for certain’ and so forth. It was Malcolm who, in his 1942a paper, first pointed out that non-ordinary uses of expressions occur in philosophy most particularly when the philosophical thesis propounded ‘goes against ordinary language’ – that is, when what the philosophical thesis proposes to be the case is radically different from what we would ordinarily say about some case (1942a, pp. 8).

To illustrate, take the term ‘knowledge’. According to Malcolm, its use in epistemological skepticism is non-ordinary. If one uttered “I do not know if this is a desk before me,” a hearer may assume that what is meant is that the utterer is unsure about the object before her because, for example the light is bad, or she thinks it might be a dining table instead of a desk or something similar. Something like this would be the, let us say, ordinary use of the term ‘know’. By way of contrast, if the utterer meant, by the expression, ‘I do not know if this is a desk before me, because I do not know the truth of any material-object statement, or I do not know if any independent objects exist outside my mind’ – then, we might say this was a non-ordinary use of the term ‘know’. We have not established that the non-ordinary use is at any disadvantage as yet. However, since if the latter was what one meant when one uttered the original statement, then one would have to explain this use to a hearer (unless the philosophical use was established to be in play at an earlier moment) – that is, one would have to note that “I do not know if this is a desk before me” is being used in a different sense to the other (non-skeptical) one. On this basis, the claim is that the first use is ordinary and the second, non-ordinary. Minimally, the expressions have different uses, and thus different senses, on this argument.

It might be objected that the skeptical use is perfectly ordinary—say, among philosophers at least. However, this does not establish that the skeptical use is the ordinary use, because the skeptical use depends on the prior existence, and general acceptance, of the original use. That is, the skeptical claim about knowledge could not even be formulated if it were not assumed that everyone knew the ordinary meaning of the term ‘know’ – if this were not assumed, there would be no point in denying that we have ‘knowledge’ of material-object propositions. Indeed, Ryle noted his sense of this paradox quite early on:

…if the expressions under consideration [in philosophical arguments] are intelligently used, their employers must always know what they mean and do not need the aid or admonition of philosophers before they can understand what they are saying. And if their hearers understand what they are being told, they too are in no such perplexity that they need to have this meaning philosophically “analysed” or “clarified” for them. And, at least, the philosopher himself must know what the expressions mean, since otherwise, he could not know what it was that he was analysing. (1992, pp. 85)

Often, the ordinary use of some expression must be presupposed in order to formulate the philosophical position in which it is used non-ordinarily.

Nevertheless, challenges to the very idea of ordinary versus non-ordinary uses of language came from other quarters. In particular, a vigorous dispute arose over what the criteria were supposed to be to identify ordinary versus non-ordinary uses of language, and why a philosopher assumes herself to have any authority on this matter. For example, Benson Mates argued, in his ‘On the Verifiability of Statements about Ordinary Language’ (1958, 1964) just what the title suggests: how can any such claims be confirmed? This objection applies more seriously to the later Ordinary Language philosophical work, because that period focused on far more detailed analyses of the uses of expressions, and made rather more sweeping claims about ‘what we say’. Stanley Cavell (1958, 1964) responded to Mates that claims as to the ordinary uses of expressions are not empirically based, but are normative claims (that is, they are not, in general, claims about what people do say, but what they can say, or ought to say, within the bounds of the meaning of the expression in question). Cavell also argued that the philosopher, as a member of a linguistic community, was at least as qualified as any other member of that community to make claims about what is, or can be, ordinarily said and meant; although it is always possible that any member of the linguistic community may be wrong in such a claim. The debate has continued, however, with similar objections (to Mates’) raised by Fodor and Katz (1963, 1971), to which Henson (1965) has responded.

The reason this objection applies less-so to the early Ordinary Language philosophers is that, for the Wittgensteinians, claims as to what is ‘ordinarily said’ applied in much more general ways. It applied, for example, to ‘what would ordinarily be said of, for example, a situation’ – for example, as we noted, cases of what we ordinarily call ‘seeing x’, or ‘doing x of her own free-will’, or ‘knowing “x” for certain’ and so forth (these kinds of cases were later argued to be paradigm cases – see below, section 3d, for a discussion of this important argument within early Ordinary Language philosophy). The Wittgensteinians were originally making their points against the kind of skeptical metaphysical views which had currency in their own time; the kinds of theories which suggested such things as ‘we do not know the truth of any material-thing statements’, ‘we are acquainted, in perception, only with sense-data and not external, independent objects’, ‘no sensory experience can be known for certain’ and so on. In such cases there is no question that the ordinary thing to say is, for example “I am certain this is a desk before me,” and “I see the fire-engine” and “It is true that I know that this is a desk” and so forth. In fact, in such disputes it was generally agreed that there was a certain ordinary way of describing such and such a situation. This would be how a situation is identified, so that the metaphysician or skeptical philosopher could proceed to suggest that this way of describing things is false.

The objection that was directed equally at the Wittgensteinians and the Oxford Ordinary Language philosophers was in regard to what was claimed to count as ‘misuses’ of expressions, particularly philosophical ‘misuses’. In particular, it was objected that presumably such uses must be banned according to Ordinary Language philosophy (for example Rollins 1951). Sometimes, it was argued, the non-ordinary use of some expression is philosophically necessary since sometimes technical or more precise terms are needed.

In fact, it was never argued by the Ordinary Language philosophers that any term or use of an expression should be prohibited. The objection is not born out by the actual texts. It was not argued that non-ordinary uses of language in and of themselves were a cause of philosophical problems; the problem lay in, mostly implicitly, attempting to pass them off as ordinary uses. The non-ordinary use of some term or expression is not, merely, a more ‘technical’ or more ‘precise’ use of the term – it is to introduce, or even assume, a quite different meaning for the term. In this sense, a philosophical theory that uses some term or expression non-ordinarily is talking about something entirely different to whatever the term or expression talks about in its ordinary use. Malcolm, for example, argues that the problem with philosophical uses of language is that they are often introduced into discussion without being duly noted as non-ordinary uses. Take, for example, the metaphysical claim that the content of assertions about experiences of an independent realm of material objects can never be certain. The argument (see Malcolm 1942b) is that this is an implicit suggestion that we stop applying the term ‘certain’ to empirical propositions, and reserve it for the propositions of logic or mathematics (which can be exhaustively proven to be true). It is a covert suggestion about how to reform the use of the term ‘certain’. But the suggested use is a ‘misuse’ of language, on the Ordinary Language view (that is, applying the term ‘certain’ only to mathematical or logical propositions). Moreover, the argument presents itself as an argument about the facts concerning the phenomenon of certainty, thus failing to ‘own up’ to being a suggestion about the use of the term ‘certain’ – leaving the assumption that it uses the term according to its ordinary meaning misleadingly in place. The issue, according to Ordinary Language philosophy, is that the two uses of ‘certain’ are distinct and the philosopher’s sense cannot replace the ordinary sense – though it can be introduced independently and with its own criteria, if that can be provided. Malcolm says, for example:

…if it gives the philosopher pleasure always to substitute the expression “I see some sense-data of my wife” for the expression “I see my wife,” etc.and so forth, then he is at liberty thus to express himself, provided he warns people beforehand, so that they will understand him. (1942a, pp. 15)

In an argument Malcolm elsewhere (1951) deals with, he suggests that it is not a ‘correct’ use of language to say, “I feel hot, but I am not certain of it.” But this is not to suggest that the expression must be banned from philosophical theorizing, nor that it is not possible that it might, at some point, become a perfectly correct use of language. What is crucial is that, for any use newly introduced to a language, how that expression is to be used must be explained, that is, criteria for its use must be provided. He says:

We have never learned a usage for a sentence of the sort “I thought that I felt hot but it turned out that I was mistaken.” In such matters we do not call anything “turning out that I was mistaken.” If someone were to insist that it is quite possible that I were mistaken when I say that I feel hot, then I should say to him: Give me a use for those words! I am perfectly willing to utter them, provided that you tell me under what conditions I should say that I was or was not mistaken.  Those words are of no use to me at present. I do not know what to do with them…There is nothing we call “finding out whether I feel hot.” This we could term either a fact of logic or a fact of language. (1951, pp. 332)

Malcolm went so far as to suggest the laws of logic may well, one day, be different to what we accept now (1940, pp. 198), and that we may well reject some necessary statements, should we find a use for their negation, or for treating them as contingent (1940, pp. 201ff). Thus, the objection that, according to Ordinary Language philosophy, non-ordinary uses, or new, revised or technical uses of expressions are to be prohibited from philosophy is generally unfounded – though it is an interpretation of Ordinary Language philosophy that survives into the present day.

b. Philosophical Disputes and Linguistic Disputes

There was no lack of voluble objection to the claim that philosophical disputes are ‘really linguistic’ (or sometimes ‘really verbal’). Therefore, it is essential to understand the Ordinary Language philosophers’ reasons for holding it to be true (although the later Oxford philosophers were generally less committed to it in quite such a rigid form). One of the most explicit formulations of this view is, once again, to be found in Malcolm’s 1942a paper. Its rough outline is this: in certain philosophical disputes the empirical facts of the matter are not at issue – that is to say, the dispute is not based on any lack of access to the empirical facts, the kinds of fact we can, roughly, ‘observe’. If the dispute is not about the empirical facts according to Malcolm, then the only other thing that could be at issue is how some phenomenon is to be described – and that is a ‘linguistic’ issue. This is particularly true of metaphysical disputes, according to Malcolm, who presents as examples the following list of ‘metaphysical’ propositions’ (1942a, pp. 6):

1. There are no material things

2. Time is unreal

3. Space is unreal

4. No-one ever perceives a material thing

5. No material thing exists unperceived

6. All that one ever sees when he looks at a thing is part of his own brain

7. There are no other minds – my sensations are the only sensations that exist

8. We do not know for certain that there are any other minds

9. We do not know for certain that the world was not created five minutes ago

10. We do not know for certain the truth of any statement about material things

11. All empirical statements are hypotheses

12. A priori statements are rules of grammar

According to Malcolm, affirming or denying the truth of any one of these propositions is not affirming or denying a matter of fact, but rather, Malcolm claims, “…it is a dispute over what language shall be used to describe those facts” (1942a, pp. 9). On what basis does he make this claim? The obvious objection on behalf of the metaphysician is that she certainly is talking about ‘the facts’ here, namely the metaphysical facts, and not about language at all.

Malcolm argues thus: he imagines a dispute between Russell and Moore, as illustrated by the propositions noted above. He takes as an example Russell’s assertion that “All that one ever sees when one looks at a thing is part of one’s own brain”. This is the sort of proposition that would follow from the philosophical thesis that all we are acquainted with in perception is sense-data, and that we do not perceive independent, external objects directly (See Russell 1927, pp. 383 – see also Sense-Data). Malcolm casts Moore (unauthorized by Moore it should be noted) as replying to Russell: “This desk which both of us now see is most certainly not part of my brain, and, in fact, I have never seen a part of my own brain” (Malcolm 1942a, pp. 7). We are asked to notice that there is no disagreement, in Russell and Moore’s opposing propositions, about the empirical facts of the matter. The dispute is not that one of either Russell or Moore cannot see the desk properly, or is hallucinating, in disagreeing whether what is before them is, or is not, a desk. That is, Russell and Moore agree that the phenomenon they are talking about is the one that is ordinarily described by saying (for example) “I see before me a desk.”

Malcolm asserts that “Both the philosophical statement, and Moore’s reply to it are disguised linguistic statements” (1942a, pp. 13 – my italics). Malcolm’s claim that this kind of dispute is not ‘empirical’ has less to do with a Positivistically construed notion of ‘verifiability’, and more to do with the contrast such a dispute has with a kind of dispute that really is empirical, or ‘factual’ – in the ordinary sense, where getting a closer look, say, at something would resolve the issue. The argument that the dispute is ‘really linguistic’ rests on Malcolm’s claim that when a philosophical thesis denies the applicability of some ordinary use of language, it is not merely suggesting that, occasionally, when we make certain claims, what we say is false. According to Malcolm, when a philosophical thesis suggests (implicitly), for example, that we should withhold the term ‘certain’ from non-analytic (mathematical or logical) statements, the suggestion is not that it is merely false to say one is certain about a synthetic (material-thing) statement – but that it is logically impossible. Malcolm tries to support his contention by drawing attention to the features apparent in the sort of dispute that is really about ‘the facts’, and one that he regards as, rather, really linguistic:

In ordinary life everyone of us has known of particular cases in which a person has said that he knew for certain that some material-thing statement was true, but that it has turned out that he was mistaken. Someone may have said, for example, that he knew for certain by the smell that it was carrots that were cooking on the stove. But you had just previously lifted the cover and seen that it was turnips, not carrots. You are able to say, on empirical grounds, that in this particular case when the person said that he knew for certain that a material-thing statement was true, he was mistaken…It is an empirical fact that sometimes when people use statements of the form: “I know for certain that p”, where p is a material-thing statement, what they say is false. But when the philosopher asserts that we never know for certain any material-thing statements, he is not asserting this empirical fact…he is asserting that always…when any person says a thing of that sort his statement will be false. (1942a, pp. 11)

So, Malcolm proposes that, since their dispute is not empirical, or contingent, we ought to understand Russell as saying that “…it is really a more correct way of speaking to say that you see part of your brain than to say that you see [for example] a desk” and we have Moore saying that, on the contrary, “It is correct language to say that what we are doing now is seeing [a desk], and it is not correct language to say that what we are doing now is seeing parts of our brains” (1942a, pp. 9).

The obvious objection here is to the claim that the dispute is linguistic rather than about the phenomenon of, for example perception itself. For example, C. A. Campbell (1944) remarks that:

…it seems perfectly clear that what [these] arguments [such as the one’s mentioned by Malcolm] [are] concerned with is the proper understanding of the facts of the situation, and not with any problem of linguistics: and that there is a disagreement about language with the plain man only because there is a disagreement about the correct reading of the facts…The philosopher objects to such [ordinary] statements   only in the context of philosophical discourse where it is vital that our words should accurately describe the facts. (pp. 15)

This objection is further echoed in Morris Weitz (1947), responding to Malcolm’s Ordinary Language treatment of the propositions of epistemic skepticism, such as “no-material thing statement is known for certain”:

The first thing that needs to be pointed out is that philosophers who recommend the abolition of the prefix ‘it is certain that’ as applied to empirical statements do not suggest that the language of common sense is mistaken.  What they mean to say to common sense is that its language is alright provided that its interpretation of the facts is all right. But the interpretation is not all right; therefore, the articulation of the interpretation is mistaken, and needs revision. [Thus]…will we not, and more correctly say, common sense and its language are here in error and….incline a little with Broad to the view that common sense, at least on this issue, ought to go out and hang itself. (pp. 544-545)

A more contemporary version of this objection, which applies to the idea that philosophical disputes are about concepts and thoughts (rather than the ordinary uses of language) may be found in Williamson (2007). He argues that not all philosophy is (the equivalent of) ‘linguistic’, because philosophers may well study objects that have never (as yet) been thought or spoken about at all (‘elusive objects’). He says:

Suppose, just for the sake of argument, that there are no [such] elusive objects. That by itself would still not vindicate a restriction of philosophy to the conceptual, the realm of sense or thought. The practitioners of any discipline have thoughts and communicate them, but they are rarely studying those very thoughts: rather, they are studying what their thoughts are about. Most thoughts are not about thoughts. To make philosophy the study of thought is to insist that philosophers’ thoughts should be about thoughts. It is not obvious why philosophers should accept that restriction. (pp. 17-18)

The general gist of the objection was that philosophy is just as perfectly the study of facts as any other science, except what is under investigation are metaphysical rather than physical facts. There is no reason, on this objection, to understand metaphysical claims as claims about language. The early Ordinary Language philosophers did not formulate a complete response to this charge. Indeed, that the charge is still being raised demonstrates that it still has not been answered to the satisfaction of its critics. Some attempts were made to emphasize, for example, that an inquiry about how some X is to be described ought not be distinguished from an inquiry into the nature of X (for example Austin 1964; Cavell 1958, pp. 91; McDowell 1994, pp. 27) – given that we have no obviously independent way to study such ‘natures’. This appears not to have convinced those who disagree, however.

It was also part of a defence to this objection to appeal to the so-called ‘linguistic doctrine of necessity’. The terminology popular in the day is partly to blame for the general disdain of this view (which was only a ‘doctrine’ as such in the hands of the Positivists), as it sounds as though the claim is that necessary propositions, because they are ‘linguistic’, are not to be understood as being about the world and the way things are in it, but about words, or even about the ways words are used. This of course would have the result that necessary propositions turn out to be contingent propositions about language use, which was correctly recognised to be absurd (as noted in Malcolm 1940, pp. 190-191). This was rather more how the Positivists described the doctrine. For them, the thought in distinguishing ‘linguistic’ from ‘factual’ propositions was that the former are ‘rules of language’, and therefore truth-valueless, or ‘non-cognitive’. But on the Ordinary Language philosophers’ view, necessary propositions are not (disguised) assertions about the uses of words, they are ‘about’ the world just as all propositions are (and so are perfectly ‘cognitive’ bearers of truth-values). On the other hand, what makes them count as necessary, what justifies us in holding them to be so, is not any special metaphysical fact; only the ordinary empirical fact that this is how some of the propositions of language are used. (op.cit. 1940, pp. 192; 1942b) On this view, it is through linguistic practice that we establish the distinction between necessary and contingent propositions. We have met this idea already in some preliminary remarks about a use-theory of meaning (in section 2d above).

However, even on the more amenable use-based interpretation of the linguistic doctrine of necessity, metaphysicians still wish to insist that some necessities are, indeed, metaphysical, and not connected with the uses of propositions at all – for example, that nothing is both red and green all over, that a circle cannot be squared, and so forth. Thus, the objection persists that in philosophy what one is doing is inquiring into facts, that is, the nature of phenomena, the general structure and fundamental ontology of reality, and not at all the meanings of the expressions we use to describe them. Indeed, it seems to be the most prevalent and recurrent complaint against ‘linguistic’ philosophy, and it seems to be an argument in which neither side will be convinced by the other, and thus one that will probably go on indefinitely. At least one question that has not fully entered the debate is why a ‘linguistic’ problem is understood to be so philosophically inferior to a metaphysical one.

c. Ordinary Language is Correct Language

The contention ‘ordinary language is correct language’ forms the rationale, or justification, for the method of the appeal to ordinary language. This is a basic and fundamental tenet on which it is safe to say all Ordinary Language philosophers concur, more or less strongly. However, it has been often misunderstood, and the misunderstanding has unfortunately in part been attributable to the early Ordinary Language philosophers. The misunderstanding lies in conflating the notion of ‘correctness’ with the notion of ‘truth’. It appears that the Ordinary Language philosophers themselves did not always make this distinction clearly enough, nor did they always adhere to it, as we shall see below. We shall examine one formulation of the argument to the conclusion that ‘ordinary language is correct language’, and see that it need not be (as it very often has been) understood as a claim that what is said in the ordinary use of language must thereby be true (or its converse: that whatever is said in using language non-ordinarily must thereby be false).

The latter interpretation of Ordinary Language philosophy was, and is, widespread. For example, Chisholm, in 1951, devoted a paper to rejecting the claim that “Any philosophical statement which violates ordinary language is false” (pp. 175). The converse, that any statement which is in accord with ordinary language is true is a version of what came to be known as the ‘paradigm case argument’, which we shall examine in the following section.

Once again, the classic formulation of the argument to the conclusion that ‘ordinary language is correct’ is to be found in Malcolm’s 1942a paper. His argument is roughly this: not only are metaphysical philosophical disputes not based on any facts, but metaphysical claims are, generally, claims to necessary rather than ordinary, contingent truth (that is, a philosophical thesis does not claim that sometimes we cannot be certain of a material-thing statement, for that is perfectly true and we all know this; rather the philosophical thesis says that it is never the case that such statements are certain). We should note that it is at least debatable whether a metaphysical thesis might be presented as contingent (See article on Modal Illusions). Certainly for the most part, metaphysical theses are presented as necessary truths, as there are separate difficulties in doing otherwise. Malcolm’s argument is that these metaphysical theses, which contradict the ordinary uses of language, have the semantic consequence that the ordinary uses of expressions fail to express anything at all.

No metaphysician would argue for this explicitly. Indeed, most suggest that the ordinary expression they contest, or that is ultimately contested by their thesis, is ‘just wrong’, that is, merely false. The thought is that the folk get certain things wrong all the time and need to be corrected: the empirical sciences are the model here. But the analogy with science is misleading, since science only shows us that certain ways we describe things may turn out to be contingently false. But, if the metaphysically necessary propositions in question turn out to be true, that is, the ones that are inconsistent with ordinary language, the result is not that our ordinary ways of describing certain phenomena or situations turn out to be merely false. Rather, our ordinary uses of language would turn out to express that which is necessarily false – they would express, or try to express, that which is metaphysically impossible.

According to Malcolm, the implication that what is expressed in certain ordinary uses of language is necessarily false, or metaphysically impossible, renders those uses ‘self-contradictory’ (1942a, pp. 11). What he means is this: if it turns out that, say, the proposition “One never perceives a material object” is true, then because it is necessarily true, it is therefore impossible (for us) to perceive a material object. Therefore, material objects are (for us) imperceptible. So, to assert “I perceive a material object” is not merely to state a falsehood (like saying “The earth is flat”), but to state something like “I perceive something that is imperceptible.” If a metaphysical thesis is necessarily true, and it contradicts what would be said ordinarily, then the latter is necessarily false, and to assert a necessarily false proposition is to fail to assert anything at all. Failing to assert anything, in the utterance of an assertion, is to fail to use the language correctly – and this is the implicit upshot of some metaphysical theses.

On the contrary, Malcolm claims, such a misuse of language is impossible, because “The proposition that no ordinary expression is self-contradictory is a tautology” (pp. 16 – my italics). This is not to say that whatever is said using language ordinarily is thereby actually true. Malcolm insists that there are two ways one can ‘go wrong’ in saying something; one way is to be wrong about the facts, the second way is to use language incorrectly. And so he notes that it is perfectly possible to be using language correctly, and yet state something that is plainly false. But, on this view, one cannot be uttering self-contradictions and at the same time be saying something true or false for that matter. The assertion of contradictions, according to this view, has no use for us in our language (so far at least), and therefore they have no meaning (clearly, this is an aspect of the use-theory of meaning at work). On the other hand, according to Malcolm, to have a use just is to have a meaning. Thus, any expression that does have a use cannot also be ‘meaningless’ – or self-contradictory. ‘Correct’ language, therefore, is language that is or would be used, and is therefore meaningful, on this argument. Given the nature of our language, we do not, as a matter of fact, use self-contradictory expressions to describe situations (literally, sincerely and non-metaphorically that is) – although we do say such things as “It is and it is not,” but we do not say of such uses that one is contradicting oneself (see Malcolm 1942a, pp. 16 for more on uttering contradictions). He says:

The reason that no ordinary expression is self-contradictory is that a self-contradictory expression is an expression which would never be used to describe any sort of situation. It does not have a descriptive usage. An ordinary expression is an expression which would be used to describe a certain sort of situation; and since it would be used to describe a certain sort of situation, it does describe that sort of situation. A self-contradictory expression, on the contrary, describes nothing. (1942a, pp. 16)

It is on the basis of this argument that Malcolm claims that Moore, in the imagined dispute with Russell, actually refutes the philosophical propositions in question – merely by pointing out that they do ‘go against ordinary language’ (1942a, pp. 5). It is here that we get some insight into why it was assumed that Ordinary Language philosophy argued that anything said in the non-ordinary use of language must be false (and anything said in ordinary language must be true): Malcolm after all does say that what Moore says refutes the skeptical claims and shows the falsity of the proposition in question.

However, it must be kept in mind that what Malcolm is claiming to be true and false here are the linguistic versions of the dispute: he claims that Moore’s assertion that “It is a correct use of language to say that ‘I am certain this is a desk before me’” is true – he does not argue that Moore has proven there is a desk before him. Moreover, the philosophical proposition Moore has proven to be false is not “No material-thing statement is known for certain,” but the claim that “It is not a correct use of language to say ‘I am certain this is a desk before me’.” What Malcolm has argued, even if he himself did not make this entirely clear (and perhaps even deliberately equivocated on), is that certain claims about what is a correct (ordinary) use of language are true or false. His is not an argument with metaphysical results, and he has not shown, through Moore, that any version of skepticism is false. Indeed, the metaphysical thesis itself is beside the point. If the skeptic insists that, although it may be an incorrect use of language to say “I am not certain that this is a desk before me,” it may nevertheless be true, then the onus is on the skeptic to explain why it is that our ordinary claims to ‘know’ such and such are, therefore, not merely contingently false, but necessarily false. By Malcolm’s lights, this would amount to the skeptic claiming that this particular part of our use of language, that is, that involving some ordinary claims to ‘know’ such and such, is self-contradictory; yet, for Malcolm, as we have seen, this is not possible, because ordinary language is correct language. At any rate, in assessing the Ordinary Language argument, it is clear that the claim that philosophical propositions are incorrect uses of language and the claim that what they express is false ought not be conflated.

Although Malcolm has not refuted the skeptic, he nevertheless has demonstrated that there are some semantic difficulties in formulating the skeptical thesis in the first place – since it requires the non-ordinary use of language. This places additional, hitherto unacknowledged constraints on certain skeptical and metaphysical theses. Either the skeptic/metaphysician must acknowledge the non-ordinary use of the expression in question, or she must argue that we must reform our ordinary use. In the first case, she must then acknowledge that her thesis concerns something other than what we are ordinarily talking about when we use the term in question (for example ‘know’, ‘perceive’, ‘certain’, and so forth). In the second case, she must convince us that our ordinary use of the expression has, hitherto unbeknownst to us, been a misuse of language: we have, up till now, been asserting something that is necessarily false. Someone, in the imagined philosophical dispute, is failing to use language correctly, or failing to express anything in their description of some phenomenon. The dilemma the skeptic faces is that neither of theses two possibilities is a comfortable one for her to explain, although maintaining the truth of her thesis. This dilemma creates a situation for the skeptic that, although not refuting her directly, poses a possibly insurmountable challenge to meaningfully formulating her thesis.

d. The Paradigm Case Argument

The so-called ‘paradigm-case argument’ generated a good deal of debate (for example Watkins 1957; Richman 1961; Flew 1966; Hanfling 1990). It plays a significant role in Ordinary Language philosophy, because it tends to be interpreted as the mistaken view that Ordinary Language philosophy contends that what is said in ordinary language must be true. This is a prime example, as will be shown, of conflating the claim that ordinary language is correct with the claim that what is expressed in the ordinary use of some expression is true.

It was understood that the paradigm-case argument was an argument that shows that there must be (at least some) true instances, in the actual and not merely possible world, of anything that is said (referred to) in ordinary language. For example, Roderick Chisholm (1951) says “There are words in ordinary language, Malcolm believes, whose use implies that they have a denotation. That is to say, from the fact that they are used in ordinary language, we may infer that there is something to which they truly apply” (pp. 180). On this interpretation, certain metaphysical truths, indeed empirical truths, could be proven simply by the fact that we use a certain expression ordinarily. This seems clearly an absurd position to take, and does not, once again, appear to be supported by the texts.

Malcolm invokes what is now known as the paradigm-case argument by reference to one of the outcomes on the assumption that the philosophical claims he is examining are true. If we consider, say, the thesis that “No-one ever knows for certain the truth of any material-thing statement” to be true, then on that theory it turns out that an ordinary expression such as “I am certain there is a chair in this room” is never true, no matter how good our evidence for the claim is – indeed, regardless of the evidence. Malcolm casts the ‘Moorean’ reply to such a view, that “[On the contrary] both of us know for certain there are several chairs in this room, and how absurd it would be to suggest that we do not know it, but only believe it, or that it is highly probable but not really certain!” (1942a, pp. 12) Malcolm says,

What [Moore’s] reply does is give us a paradigm of absolute certainty, just as in the case previously discussed his reply gave us a paradigm of seeing something not a part of one’s brain. What his reply does is to appeal to our language-sense; to make us feel how queer and wrong it would be to say, when we sat in a room seeing and touching chairs, that we believed there were chairs but did not know it for certain, or that it was only highly probable that there were chairs… Moore’s refutation consists simply in pointing out that [the expression “know for certain”] has an application to empirical statements. (1942a, pp. 13)

Here, he says nothing to the effect that Moore has proven that it is true that there are in fact chairs and tables before us, and so forth. All Malcolm has claimed is that Moore has denied, indeed disproven, the suggestion that the term ‘certainty’ has no application to empirical statements. He has disproven that by invoking examples where it is manifestly the case that the term ‘certainty’ has been, and can be, ‘applied’. Nothing, notice, has been said as to whether there really are tables, chairs and cheese before us – unless, that is, we confuse ‘having an application’ with ‘having a reference’ or ‘having a true application’. But it is not necessary to interpret the claims this way. ‘Having an application’ means, as Malcolm argues, having a use in a given situation. Malcolm’s example in the quote above is a ‘paradigm of absolute certainty’, but not, notice, a proof of what it is that one is certain of. It is a ‘paradigm of absolute certainty’ because it is a prime example of the sort of situation, or context in which the term ‘certain’ applies – it is a paradigm of the term’s use: namely, in situations where we have very good (though not infallible) evidence, and no reason to think that our evidence is not of the highest quality. Indeed, on Malcolm’s view, a ‘paradigm case’ is an example of the ordinary use and hence the ordinary meaning of an expression.

The point of appealing to paradigm cases, then, is not to guarantee the truth of ordinary expressions, but to demonstrate that they have a use in the language. Thus, the paradigm-case argument is an effective move against any view that implies that some ordinary expression does not have a use, or application – for example that what we call ‘certain’ (well-evidenced non-mathematical statements) are not ‘really’ certain. That the ordinary use of expressions should be incorrect is, on Malcolm’s argument, as impossible as it would be for the rules of chess to be incorrect (and therefore that what we play is not ‘really’ chess).

e. A Use-Theory of Linguistic Meaning

The ‘use-theory’ of meaning, whose source is Wittgenstein and which was adopted by the Ordinary Language philosophers, objects to the idea that language could be treated like a calculus, or an ‘ideal language’. If language is like a calculus, then its ‘meanings’ could be specified, so that determinate truth-conditions could be paired with every expression of a language in advance of, and independently of, any particular use of a term or expression in a speech-act. Therefore, the observation of our actual uses of expressions in the huge variety of contexts and speech-acts we do and can use them in would be irrelevant to determining the meaning of expressions. On the contrary, for the Ordinary Language Philosopher, linguistic meaning may only be determined by the observation of the various uses of expressions in their actual ordinary uses, and it is not independent of these. Thus, Wittgenstein claimed that:

For a large class of cases – though not for all – in which we employ the word “meaning” it can be defined thus: the meaning of a word is its use in the language. (Section 43)

Does this mean that only sometimes ‘meaning is use’? The remark has been interpreted this way (for example Lycan 1999, pp. 99, fn 2). But it need not be. We need to notice that in the remark, Wittgenstein refers to ‘cases where we employ the word “meaning,”’ and not ‘cases of meaning’. The difference, it might be said, is that sometimes when we use the term ‘meaning’ we are not talking about linguistic meaning. That is, we may talk about for example “The meaning of her phone call,” in which case we are not going to be assisted by looking to the use of the word ‘phone call’ in the language. On the other hand, when we use the word ‘meaning’ as in “The meaning of ‘broiling’ is (such and such),” then looking to the use of the word ‘broiling’ in the language will help. Thus, an interpretation is possible in which the remark does not mean that only sometimes ‘meaning is use’. Rather, we can interpret it as claiming that linguistic meaning is to be found in language use.

At the most fundamental base of a use-theory, language is not representational – although it is sometimes (perhaps even almost always) used to represent. On the view, the ‘meaning’ of a term (or expression) is exhausted by its use: there is nothing further, nothing ‘over and above’, the use of an expression for its meaning to be.

A good many objections have been raised to this theory, which we cannot here examine in full. However, most appear to object to it because it apparently rules out the possibility of a systematic theory of meaning. If meaning-is-use, then the ideal language approach is out of the question, and determining linguistic meaning becomes an ad-hoc process. This thought has displeased many, as they have understood it to entail something of an end to the possibility of a philosophy of language per se. Dummett (1973), for example, has complained that:

…[although] the ‘philosophy of ordinary language’ was indeed a species of linguistic philosophy, [it was] one which was contrary to the spirit of Frege in two fundamental ways, namely in its dogmatic denial of the possibility of system, and in its treatment of natural language as immune from criticism. (pp. 683)

Soames (2003) goes on to echo the same complaint:

Rather than constructing general theories of meaning, philosophers were supposed to attend to subtle aspects of language use, and to show how misuse of certain words leads to philosophical perplexity and confusion. [Such a view] proved to be unstable… What is needed is some sort of systematic theory of what meaning is, and how it interacts with these other factors governing the use of language. (pp. xiv)

It was ultimately the re-introduction of the possibility of a systematic theory of meaning by Grice, later at Oxford (see section 5, below), that finally spelled the end for Ordinary Language philosophy.

4. Oxford

By the 1940s, the views of the later Wittgenstein, and the Wittgensteinians, had penetrated Oxford. There, philosophers took up the ideas of Wittgenstein, but they were much more critical and much more interested in developing their own views. The move now was to apply the principles to be found in Wittgenstein, and to show how they could actually contribute significantly to philosophy – rather than merely make philosophical problems ‘disappear’. ‘Oxford’ philosophy was still ‘linguistic’, but much less dogmatically so, much more flexible in its approach, much less interested in metaphilosophical justification for their views and rather more interested in applying their views to real, current, philosophical problems. The Oxford philosophers no longer treated all philosophical problems as mere ‘pseudo-problems’, nor even all of them as ‘linguistic’. But nevertheless they retained the view that philosophical uses of language can be a source of philosophical confusions and that the observation and study of ordinary language would help to resolve them. What was new, regarding Ordinary Language philosophy, was the rejection of Wittgenstein’s idea that there could be no proper ‘philosophical’ knowledge.

Austin famously remarked:

Certainly ordinary language has no claim to be the last word, if there is such a thing. It embodies, indeed, something better than the metaphysics of the Stone Age, namely… the inherited experience and acumen of many generations of men. But then, that acumen has been concentrated primarily upon the practical business of life. If a distinction works well for practical purposes in ordinary life (no mean feat, for even ordinary life is full of hard cases), it will not mark nothing: yet this is likely enough to be not the best way of arranging things if our interests are more extensive or intellectual than the ordinary… Certainly, then, ordinary language is not the last word: in principle it can everywhere be supplemented and improved upon and superseded. Only remember, it is the first word. (And forget, for once and for a while, that other curious question “Is it true?” May we?) (1956, pp. 185 and fn 2 in parentheses)

a. Ryle

Ryle emerged at Oxford as one of the most important figures in early 20th century analytic philosophy. Ryle, indeed, became a champion of ‘ordinary language’, writing, in his early career, a number of papers dealing with such issues as what counts as ‘ordinary’ language, what are the nature of ‘meanings’, and how the appeal to ordinary ways of describing things can help resolve philosophical problems (including his 1931, 1953, 1957, 1961). In particular, Ryle became famous for his treatment of mental phenomena in his Concept of Mind (1949). The book contains, overall, a ‘behaviorist’ analysis of mental phenomena that draws heavily on Wittgensteinian anti-Cartesianism – or anti-dualism (of ‘mind’ and ‘body’). On this view, the mind is not a kind of ‘gaseous’ but non-spatial, non-physical medium of thoughts, nor is it a kind of ‘theatre’ via which we observe our own experiences and sensations. Our mental life is not, according to Ryle, a private domain to which each individual has exclusive access. Our psychological language expresses our thoughts; it does not describe what is going on in the mind in the same way that physical language describes what is going on in the body, according to Ryle in this period.

The ‘Cartesian Myth’ of the mind – what Ryle calls the “Dogma of the Ghost in the Machine” (1949, pp. 15) – is perpetuated, according to Ryle, because philosophers commit what he calls a ‘category mistake’ in applying the language of the physical world to the psychological world (for example, talking about ‘events’ and ‘causes’ in the mind as we would talk of such things in the body). Contrary to this ‘myth’, according to Ryle, our access to our own thoughts and feelings are not, like our access to those of others, something we observe about ourselves (by looking ‘inward’ as opposed to ‘outward’). We do not observe our thoughts; we think them. What we call ‘beliefs’, ‘thoughts’, ‘knowledge’, ‘feelings’, and so forth are not special kinds of ‘occult’ objects ‘inside’ the mind. As regards ‘other minds’, psychological phenomena are available publicly in certain behaviors (which are not mere ‘signs’ of what is going on internally in others, but partially what constitutes what it is to attribute such things, for example, as ‘believing X’, ‘thinking about Y’, and so forth). Ryle arrives at these views through the analysis of the ordinary uses of psychological expressions, remarking:

I am not, for example, denying that there occur mental processes. Doing long division is a mental process and so is making a joke. But I am saying that the phrase ‘there occur mental processes’ does not mean the same thing as ‘there occur physical processes’, and, therefore it makes no sense to conjoin or disjoin the two. (1949, pp. 22)

The view Ryle promotes is that the expressions we use in attributing psychological states and the expressions we use in attributing physical states have quite distinct uses, and that when we see this aright, we see that it does not make sense to conflate them in claims such as ‘an intention in her mind caused her arm to rise’ (the sort of things one might expect on the ‘Ghost in the Machine’ theory). In everyday life, we know perfectly well, for example, what the criteria are in virtue of which we count a person as, for example, thinking, calculating, having raised an arm intentionally, and so forth. Puzzlement only arises, according to Ryle, when philosophers try to account for mental phenomena according to the ‘logic’ of the category of physical phenomena, for example, talking about the mystery of ‘mental causation’.

By highlighting the ordinary use of mental-phenomena expressions, and the ways in which we ordinarily ascribe them to people (for example, “She is thinking about home,” “I wish I had a cup-cake,” “He is adding up the bill,” and so on), Ryle shows that the philosophical problem of how mental phenomena can interact with physical phenomena is poorly formulated. The manner in which psychological terms are used in such philosophical problems, theories, and so forth, are not the same ways the terms are used in ordinary discourse. Using the terms in this way leads philosophers to conclude either that some form of dualism of mind and body or some form of physicalism is true (see Mental Causation for more on the traditional theories of mind). But observing our ordinary uses of psychological terms shows, Ryle argues, that as we mean them to describe ourselves and one another (and sometimes even when we apply psychological terms to non-people), mental phenomena need not be understood as ‘internal’ events that we observe, nor as reducible, in some sense, to mere brain-states.

b. Austin

Austin, at Oxford, first took up the issue of the so-called ‘sense-data’ theory, originally formulated by Russell (as we saw above). His Sense and Sensibilia (1962) (a pun on Jane Austen’s Sense and Sensibility) is a classic of ordinary language analysis. It contrasts the ordinary uses of the words ‘looks’, ‘seems’, ‘appears’ ‘perceives’, and so forth to the ways they are used in support of the sense-data theory. The argument for sense-data is, partially, based on the view that we are unable to distinguish between veridical experience and illusion. Therefore, the reasoning goes, all we can be sure of is what is common to both experiences, which is the ‘seeming to be such and such’ or sense-data. So, on the view, because it is possible that any experience may be an illusion, the only thing that is certain is the sense-data before the mind. Of this theory Austin says:

My general opinion about this doctrine is that it is a typically scholastic view, attributable…to an obsession with a few particular words, the uses of which are over-simplified, not really understood or carefully studied or correctly described…The fact is, as I shall try to make clear, that our ordinary words are much subtler in their uses, and mark many more distinctions, than philosophers have realized; and that the facts of perception…are much more diverse and complicated than has been allowed for. (1962, pp. 3)

Austin points out, among other things, that, as a matter of fact we do know the difference between a veridical and an illusory experience, and we speak of such experiences differently – the distinction between ‘veridical’ and ‘illusory’ has an established, and ordinary, use in language. For example, a stick placed in a glass of water appears to be bent, but we have criteria for describing the difference between this bent stick and a stick which is bent outside the glass. We say, “the stick looks bent” in the water, but we say, “the stick is bent” of the other. The availability of ways in language to mark the distinction between illusions and veridical experiences demonstrates, according to Austin, that the sense-data argument is invalid – because those terms, which have ordinary uses in language, are misused in the sense-data theory. For example, if the sense-data theory is true, then we are marking nothing in our experience when we distinguish between ‘veridical’ and ‘illusory’ experiences – those expressions have no real meaning (we are failing to express anything in their utterance). The same would follow, if the sense-data theory were correct, that our ordinary uses of cognate terms such as ‘appearing’, ‘looking’, ‘seeming’, and so forth, and also ‘finding out that X was not as it appeared to be’ have no application – since there would be no ‘real’ distinction, for us, between how things appear and how they really are. This conclusion, from which it follows that we should withdraw the terms ‘veridical’ and ‘illusory’ from use in language, is absurd – the distinction is marked in language and therefore exists (for example, between the way things ‘look’ and the way things ‘are’ – though we are not always infallible in our judgments). The question whether or not the distinction corresponds with a metaphysical reality (“But do sticks really exist,” and so forth), is a question about some other distinction – not the distinction we draw, in ordinary use, between ‘appears to be’ and ‘is’. And so, by attending to the ordinary uses of terms such as ‘veridical’ and ‘illusory’ and their cognates, Austin shows that the philosophical use of them in formulating the sense-data thesis is based on a misconstrual of their ordinary meanings.

Austin became a master of the observation of the uses of language. He noted nuanced differences in the ways words very close in meaning are used that many others missed. He showed that, even in its most ordinary uses, language is indeed a much finer, sensitive and precise instrument than had previously been acknowledged. Such observations belie the view that ordinary language is somehow deficient for the purposes of describing reality. Austin demonstrated, through his explorations, the flexibility of language, how subtle variations in meaning were possible, how delicate, sometimes, is the choice of a word for saying what one wants or needs to say. He called his method ‘linguistic phenomenology’ (1956, pp. 182). What his demonstrations of the fineness of grain of meaning, in very concrete and particular examples, showed was that philosophical uses of language take expressions out of their ordinary working environment, that is, everyday communicative discourse. Wittgenstein described this as ‘language going on holiday’ (1953, section 38). Such philosophical uses, Austin showed, treat expressions as rigid, one-dimensional, rather blunt instruments, with far less descriptive power than ordinary language: thus contradicting the view that the philosophical uses of language are more ‘accurate’ and ‘precise’.

Austin is also well known for his original work on what is now known as ‘speech-act’ theory, in his How to Do Things with Words (based on his William James Lectures delivered at Harvard in 1955, published as a monograph in 1962). Key to Austin’s achievement here was his development of the idea that the utterances of sentences in the use of language are not all of the same kind: not all utterances represent some aspect of the world (for example, not all utterances are assertions). Some, perhaps many, utterances involve executing actions. Austin’s example is the making of a promise. To utter “I promise to pay you back” is, on Austin’s analysis, to perform an act, that is to say, the very act of promising is carried out in uttering the sentence, rather than the sentence describing a state of affairs (that is, oneself in the state of promising). Austin developed an extensive taxonomy of the uses of language, establishing firmly the notion that language goes beyond simple representation, and has social and pragmatic dimensions that must be taken into account by any adequate theory of linguistic meaning.

c. Strawson

Strawson, who was a pupil of Grice, developed in his mature work a Kantian thesis aiming to uncover the most fundamental categories of thought. This project, which Strawson called a ‘descriptive metaphysics’, was to investigate what he called our ‘fundamental conceptual structure’. Strawson understood the philosophical project to require more than the appeal to ordinary language. He said,

Up to a point, the reliance upon a close examination of the actual use of words is the best, and indeed the only sure, way in philosophy. But the discriminations we can make, and the connexions we can establish, in this way are not general enough and not far-reaching enough to meet the full metaphysical demand for understanding. For when we ask how we use this or that expression, our answers, however revealing at a certain level, are apt to assume, and not to expose, those general elements of the structure that the metaphysician wants revealed. (1959, pp. 9-10)

The investigation of our conceptual structure had to involve more than the observation of our ordinary uses of language (which only assume that structure), but, nevertheless, the project, via transcendental argument, remained one of description of our ordinary ways of experiencing the world. Strawson’s view, contrary to the Wittgensteinian doctrine that philosophy is no more than descriptive of what is open to view to anyone, was that descriptive metaphysics involved the acquisition of genuinely new philosophical knowledge, and not merely the resolution of philosophical confusion. In this project, however, Strawson did not stray altogether too far from the Ordinary Language philosophical commitments (compare Strawson 1962, pp. 320), and his ‘linguistic’ philosophical credentials remained sound. Nevertheless, he believed that there was a deeper metaphysical reality concerning our conceptual structure that needed uncovering via a ‘descriptive metaphysics’. Strawson influenced the shift in philosophical interest from language to concepts – but the methodology and metaphilosophical rationale remained the same: the view that there is no route to a ‘metaphysical reality’ that is independent of our experience of it. Our experience of reality is, on this view, mediated by our particular conceptual structure, and a careful description of our ordinary experience – through the appeal to ordinary language – will help us to understand the nature of the conceptual structure.

Earlier in his career, Strawson criticized Russell’s revered Theory of Descriptions in his 1950 paper ‘On Referring’. Here Strawson objected that Russell failed to take into account the fact that not all uses of sentences make either true or false statements. If we distinguish ‘sentences’ and ‘statements’, indeed, we shall see that sentences are not always used to make statements. Sentences have many and varied uses, but are not, in and of themselves, true or false; what they are used to say may well be true or false (but there are also other uses than statement-making). Strawson argued that Russell had conflated meaning with, roughly, a truth-condition (or a reference). He said, on the contrary, that,

… the question whether a sentence or expression is significant or not has nothing whatever to do with the question of whether the sentence, uttered on a particular occasion, is, on that occasion, being used to make a true-or-false assertion or not, or of whether the expression is, on that occasion, being used to refer to, or mention, anything at all… the fact that [a sentence] is significant is the same as the fact that it can be correctly used to talk about something and that, in so using it, someone will be making a true or false assertion. (1950, pp. 172-173)

This position presaged a much more contemporary debate between those who hold that the meaning of a sentence remains invariant over contexts of use, and those who hold the contrary (see below, section 6).

In 1956, Strawson and his teacher, H. P. Grice, together published a paper that attacked Quine’s repudiation of the so-called ‘analytic-synthetic’ distinction. The repudiation is based on the idea that because the distinction has a use in the language, certainly in philosophy – but it is a distinction that is also marked outside of philosophy – then it has an inviolable place in language. They say, “…‘analytic’ and ‘synthetic’ have a more or less established [philosophical and ordinary] use; and this seems to suggest that it is absurd, even senseless, to say there is no such distinction” (1956, pp. 43). This is a classic example of the so-called ‘paradigm-case argument’. When Quine denies the analytic-synthetic distinction, it is to suggest that the distinction has no application. But that suggestion is demonstrably false, since we do apply the distinction (or more prosaic cognates of ‘analytic’, for example, ‘synonymous’ or ‘means the same as’, and so forth). Whether or not there is a metaphysical reality to which this distinction corresponds is quite superfluous to the reality that it is a distinction that has a use in the language, and its use alone justifies its being a perfectly meaningful one to make (1956, pp. 143).

5. The Demise of Ordinary Language Philosophy: Grice

It was ultimately Grice who came to introduce, at Oxford, some of the first ideas that marked the significant fall from grace of Ordinary Language philosophy. Other factors combined to contribute to the general demise of Ordinary Language philosophy, in particular the rise in popularity of formal semantics, but also a renewed pursuit of ‘naturalism’ in philosophy, aimed at drawing the discipline nearer, once again, to the sciences. In this climate, aspects of the ‘ideal language’ view emerged as dominant, mostly manifesting in a commitment to a truth-conditional view of meaning in the philosophy of language. Grice had a special place in this story because his work, as well as providing the argument which threw Ordinary Language philosophical principles into doubt, contributed to the development of a field of study that ultimately became the wellspring of those carrying on the legacy of the Ordinary Language philosophers in the 21st century; namely speech-act theory.

Grice’s version of ‘speech-act theory’ (see also section 4c of Philosophy of Language) included an ‘intention-based’ theory of communication. The basic principle of speech-act theory (as Austin, and Grice following him, developed it) is that language is not merely a system of symbols that represent things – the process of communication is a result of interaction between agents, and the pragmatic aspects of communication must be factored into any account of linguistic meaning. As Austin emphasized, language use is, in part, the performance of actions, as well as the representation of the world. In particular, for Grice, part of what matters, for a theory of language, is what the agent intends to communicate. One of the most important concepts introduced by Grice is that of conversational implicature (see the chapter entitled ‘Logic and Conversation’ in his 1989). The notion of conversational implicature suggests that part of what is communicated, in conversation, is communicated pragmatically rather than semantically. For example, take the following sentences:

(a) He took out his key and opened the door.

(b) Jones got married and had children.

(c) (looking in the refrigerator) “There is no beer.”

We might understand (a) to imply that he opened the door with the key he took out. But, the words alone do not strictly say this. Similarly, in (b), we might understand that Jones got married and had children in that order, and such that the two events are connected in the relevant way, and in (c), we generally understand the claim to be about the lack of beer in the fridge, not in the universe. In all of these examples, according to Grice, information is communicated, not by the semantics of the sentences alone, but by the pragmatic process he calls conversational implicature. (For more detail on Grice’s taxonomy of pragmatic processes, and also his views about the ‘maxims of conversation’, see Grice 1989.)

Pragmatic aspects of communication, according to Grice, must be distinguished from the strictly semantic aspects, and thus, according to him, meaning must not be confused with use. But this, on his view, is precisely what the Ordinary Language philosophers do, insofar as their ‘appeal to ordinary language’ is based on the view that meaning is determined by use (see the chapter entitled ‘Prolegomena’ in his 1989). Indeed, Grice here launches a detailed attack on many of the ‘ordinary language’ analyses put forward by, among others, Wittgenstein, Ryle, Austin, Malcolm and Strawson. In each case, Grice argues that where the Ordinary Language philosopher appeals to the use of the expression, especially in order to throw doubt on some other philosophical theory, what occurs is the failure to distinguish meaning (that is, ‘semantic content’ or ‘truth-conditions’) and use (that is, pragmatic aspects of communication such as implicature). Therefore, the argument that philosophical non-ordinary uses of expressions are a problem for metaphysical theses is itself at fault. (It should be noted that, this view notwithstanding, Grice remained more or less in agreement with the general view that ‘ordinary language is correct’ – compare Grice, the chapter entitled ‘Postwar Oxford Philosophy’ in his 1989.)

The general criticism, from Grice, is that the arguments of the Ordinary Language philosophers cannot be run on the basic semantics of expressions – they can apply only to the uses particular expressions are put to in specific examples. This complaint touches on the actual claims Ordinary Language philosophers have made about the use and meaning of certain expressions – in particular, claims as to when it would or would not ‘make sense’ to say “X,” or to use “X” in a certain way. To recall an example we are now familiar with – the term ‘know’ – Grice argued that, for example, when Malcolm contended that the skeptical use of ‘know’ is a misuse of that term, that this claim shows nothing relevant about the meaning of the term or the expressions in which it features. The oddness, for example, of applying the term ‘know’ in certain ways, for example, in “I feel pain, but I do not know for sure” is generated by the pragmatic features of that particular use, and is independent of the strictly semantic features.

Grice’s argument about distinguishing meaning and use appeals to the notion of the existence of an independent semantics of a language – that is, the idea that the expressions of a language have meanings which are both independent of, and invariant over, the wide variety of uses those expressions might figure in. Thus, on this view, a ‘philosophical’ and an ‘ordinary’ use of some expression do not differ in meaning – contrary to the claim of Ordinary Language philosophy. Thus, for example, an expression has an invariant semantic content even though, in its use, it may have a variety of conversational implicatures. However, the latter, on this view, are not part of the ‘meaning’ proper. Thus, observations about variations in the use of some expression will tell us nothing about its meaning.

The upshot of this argument is that the so-called ‘paradoxical’ statements attributed to classical metaphysical philosophy by the Ordinary Language philosophers may not be so paradoxical after all. Moreover, and perhaps more significantly, what this view made possible once again was the pursuit of a systematic theory of language. Use-theories could not, on the received view, be ‘systematic’ in the way required (broadly: computational). Indeed, Grice remarked, “My primary aim is… to determine how any such distinction between meaning and use is to be drawn, and where lie the limits of its philosophical utility. Any serious attempt to achieve this aim will, I think, involve a search for a systematic theory of language…” (1989, pp. 4).

The view that there ought to be possible a ‘systematic’ theory of language gained considerable ground on the passport given it by Grice. That is, if the distinction between meaning and use is correct, then a good deal of the linguistic phenomena pointed out by the Ordinary Language philosophers, and which was supposed to have ramifications for the meaning, and therefore correct use, of expressions can now be fully accounted for by a variety of ‘pragmatic’ aspects of communication. Therefore, the core, classical semantic theory for a language could continue to be pursued more or less independently of issues connected with language use; and pragmatics can generally be called upon to account for any linguistic phenomena that semantics cannot.

Of course, this argument depends on the ability of the Gricean to sufficiently identify something like the ‘literal meaning’ of a sentence (that which is to be designated the ‘semantic’ rather than the ‘pragmatic’ content of a speech-act); and in which it may occur independently of any particular conversational implicatures it is used to convey, on an occasion of use. Isolating such a literal, invariant meaning has, however, proven difficult. For example, Charles Travis (1996; 1999) has pointed out, a variety of ways that a sentence may be used quite literally, non-metaphorically, seriously and sincerely – and yet still express two distinct propositions, that is, have two distinct truth-conditions and thus fail to have an invariant semantic content. A classic ‘Travis-style’ example is a sentence such as “Pass me the red book.” Such a sentence could be used, quite literally, non-metaphorically, and so forth, to request someone to pass the book that has a red cover, and it can be used to request someone to pass the book which has only a red spine. What counts as ‘red’ in these cases is different: that is, a thing can be completely, or only partially, red to count in certain contexts. This difference in what is expressed cannot be classified as conversational implicature, so both propositions are properly semantically expressed. But Grice’s distinction is supposed to show how to isolate one semantic content, or proposition, or truth-condition per sentence. Hence the Gricean has a problem in accounting for a semantic-pragmatic distinction in the content of speech-acts – a distinction that is required for the argument against Ordinary Language philosophy to work

6. Contemporary Views

The remainder of the 20th century saw the rise of the general ‘ideal language’ approach, including a commitment to versions of truth-conditional theories of meaning, to a position of dominance. However, in recent years (the early 21st century), there has been something of a renaissance of the ideas originating in Ordinary Language philosophy. François Recanati (2004) remarked that,

Despite [that] early antagonism… semantics (the formal study of meaning and truth-conditions) and pragmatics (the study of language in use) are now conceived of as complementary disciplines, shedding light on different aspects of language… Instructed by Grice they systematically draw a distinction between what a given expression means, and what its use means or conveys in a particular context (or even in general). (pp. 2-3)

However, this appearance of co-operative reconciliation – that at least some kind of semantics-pragmatics interaction will provide a complete theory of language – is to a certain extent merely a façade of orthodoxy, which obscures somewhat more radical underlying views. A spectrum of positions now runs between radical extremes of how much of what we want to call ‘meaning’ is determined by semantics, and how much by pragmatics. The argument can roughly be described as a difference as to the degree of independence (from pragmatics) that we can ascribe to linguistic meaning. Some are of the view that at least a core of semantic content remains untouched by pragmatic effects. Others hold that all semantic content is ‘pragmatically saturated’. These positions carry on the legacies of Ideal and Ordinary Language philosophies respectively – now known as variations on ‘Literalism’ and ‘Contextualism’. (See Recanati 2004 for a clarifying description of the various views that now compose the debate.) The former position has also pitched itself as a semantic ‘minimalism’ or ‘invariantism’ (compare Cappelen and Lepore 2005; Borg 2004). Contextualism, the view that has its origins in Ordinary Language philosophy, has support from, for example, Recanati (2004) and Travis (who argues for the ‘occasion-sensitivity’ of meaning, see his 1996). Supporters of the notion of the context (or use)-sensitivity of meaning object to Grice’s original argument: that we really can cleave a distinctly semantic content from all other aspects of language use. Contextualists argue that it is difficult, perhaps impossible, to isolate a purely semantic core, untouched by pragmatic influences, for example a ‘literal’ meaning (compare Searle 1979; Recanati 2004).

Nevertheless, there have been highly successful efforts at devising theories which treat of many of the phenomena assumed to be pragmatic, but which nevertheless have been shown to have inextricably semantic effects. Examples of such phenomena include, for example, indexicality, quantifier domain restriction, seemingly relative or ‘scalar’ terms such as ‘tall’, ‘rich’ and so on. The theories in question aim at showing that such phenomena are after all perfectly formalizable aspects of a classical semantic account, and not merely pragmatic effects on meaning (a classic example of such work is to be found in Stanley and Gendler Szabo 2000 and King and Stanley 2005). Along these lines, the philosophy of language is well on its way (again) toward being based on a ‘systematic’ theory of meaning. Nevertheless, the ‘Homeric struggle’ Strawson described (2004, pp. 132) between two fundamentally opposing views about linguistic meaning continues.

 

7. References and Further Reading

a. Analysis and Formal Logic

  • Beaney, Michael. (Ed.). 1997. The Frege Reader. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Dummett, Michael. 1981 [1973]. Frege: Philosophy of Language. London: Duckworth.
  • Dummett, Michael. 1997 [1993]. The Seas of Language. London: Oxford University Press.
  • Frege, Gottlob. 1997 [1879]. “Begriffsschrift: Selections (Preface and Part I).” In M. Beaney, ed., The Frege Reader. Oxford: Blackwell, 47-78.
  • Frege, Gottlob. 1997 [1918]. “Thought.” In M. Beaney, ed., The Frege Reader. Oxford: Blackwell, 325-345.
  • Frege, Gottlob. 1997 [1891]. “Function and Concept.” In M. Beaney, ed., The Frege Reader. Oxford: Blackwell, 130-148.
  • Frege, Gottlob. 1997 [1892]. “On Sinn and Bedeutung.” In M. Beaney, ed., The Frege Reader. Oxford: Blackwell, 151-171.
  • Ramsey, Frank P. 1959 [1931]. “Philosophy.” In A. J. Ayer, ed., Logical Positivism. New York: The Free Press, 321-326.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1949 [1905]. “On Denoting.” In H. Feigl and W. Sellars, eds., Readings in Philosophical Analysis. New York: Appleton-Century-Crofts, 103-119.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1910. “Knowledge by Acquaintance and Knowledge by Description.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 11, 108-128.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1914. Our Knowledge of the External World. La Salle: Open Court.
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1995 [1921]. Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus, trans., D. F. Pears. London: Routledge.

b. Logical Atomism

  • Ayer, Alfred Jules. 1940. The Foundations of Empirical Knowledge. London: Macmillan.
  • Pears, David. 1972. Russell’s Logical Atomism. Illinois: Fontana Press.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1918-1919. “The Philosophy of Logical Atomism.” The Monist 28, 495-527; 29, 32-63, 190-222, 345-380.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1959 [1924]. “Logical Atomism.” In A. J. Ayer, ed., Logical Positivism. New York: The Free Press, 31-50.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1927. The Analysis of Matter. London: George Allen and Unwin.

c. Logical Positivism and Ideal Language

  • Ayer, Alfred Jules. (Ed.). 1959. Logical Positivism. New York: The Free Press.
    • A collection of seminal papers in Logical Positivism.
  • Bergmann, Gustav. 1992 [1953]. “Logical Positivism, Language, and the Reconstruction of Metaphysics.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 63-71.
  • Carnap, Rudolf. 1949. Truth and confirmation. In H. Feigl and W. Sellars, eds., Readings in Philosophical Analysis. New York: Appleton-Century-Crofts, 119-127.
    • Discusses the Ideal/Ordinary Language philosophical differences in detail.
  • Carnap, Rudolf. 1992 [1934]. “On the Character of Philosophic Problems.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 54-62.
  • Carnap, Rudolf. 1937. The Logical Syntax of Language, trans., A. Smeaton. London: Routledge.
  • Carnap, Rudolf. 1992 [1950]. “Empiricism, Semantics and Ontology.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 72-84.
  • Coffa, J. Alberto. 1991. The Semantic Tradition from Kant to Carnap. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Feigl, Herbert and Sellars, Wilfrid. (Eds.). 1949. Readings in Philosophical Analysis. New York: Appleton-Century-Crofts.
    • A collection of early papers in Logical Positivism.
  • Feigl, Herbert. 1949 [1943]. “Logical Empiricism.” In H. Feigl and W. Sellars, eds., Readings in Philosophical Analysis. New York: Appleton-Century-Crofts, 3-26.
  • Rorty, Richard. 1992 [1967]. “Introduction.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 1-39.
  • Schilpp, Paul Arthur. 1997 [1963]. The Philosophy of Rudolf Carnap. LaSalle: Open Court.
  • Schlick, Moritz. 1992 [1932]. “The Future of Philosophy.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 43-53.

d. Early Ordinary Language Philosophy

  • Ambrose, Alice. 1950. “The Problem of Linguistic Inadequacy.” In M. Black, ed., Philosophical Analysis. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall, 15-37.
  • Ambrose, Alice and Lazerowitz, Morris. 1985. Necessity and Language. London: Croom Helm.
  • Black, Max. (Ed.). 1950. Philosophical Analysis. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall.
  • Black, Max. (Ed.). 1954. Problems of Analysis. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Chappell, Vere Claiborne. (Ed.). 1964. Ordinary Language. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall.
    • Basic collection of essential Ordinary Language philosophical classics.
  • Caton, Charles Edwin. (Ed.). 1963. Philosophy and Ordinary Language. Urbana: University of Illinois Press.
  • Farrell, Brian. (1946a). An appraisal of therapeutic positivism I. Mind 55, 25-48.
  • Farrell, Brian. (1946b). An appraisal of therapeutic positivism II. Mind 55, 133-150.
  • Flew, Antony. (Ed.). 1951. Logic and Language. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Flew, Antony. (Ed.). 1953. Logic and Language, 2nd Series. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Flew, Antony. (Ed.). 1956. Essays in Conceptual Analysis. London: Macmillan.
  • Malcolm, Norman. 1964 [1942a]. “Moore and Ordinary Language.” In V. C. Chappell, ed., Ordinary Language. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall, 5-23.
  • Malcolm, Norman. 1942b. “Certainty and Empirical Statements.” Mind 52, 18-36.
  • Malcolm, Norman. 1940. “Are Necessary Propositions Really Verbal?” Mind 69, 189-203.
  • Malcolm, Norman. 1949. “Defending Common Sense.” Philosophical Review 58, 201- 220.
  • Malcolm, Norman. 1951. “Philosophy for Philosophers.” Philosophical Review 60, 329-340.
  • Rorty, Richard. (Ed.). 1992 [1967]. The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press.
    • A unique and seminal collection of essays on both the Ordinary Language and the Ideal Language views. Rorty’s introductions are well worth reading for their insightful comments on the issues involved. Has an enormous and comprehensive cross-referenced bibliography on the literature.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1992 [1931]. “Systematically Misleading Expressions.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 85-100.
  • Wisdom, John. 1936. “Philosophical Perplexity.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 37, 71-88.
  • Wisdom, John. 1953. Philosophy and Psycho-Analysis. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1965 [1958]. The Blue and Brown Books. New York: Harper and Row.
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig. 1994 [1953]. Philosophical Investigations, trans., G. E. M. Anscombe. Oxford: Blackwell.

e. The Paradigm Case Argument

  • Flew, Antony. 1957. “Farewell to the Paradigm-Case Argument: A Comment.” Analysis 18, 34-40.
  • Hanfling, Oswald. 1990. “What is Wrong with the paradigm-Case Argument?” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 99, 21-37.
  • Richman, Robert J. 1961. “On the Argument of the Paradigm Case.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 39, 75-81.
  • Watkins, John William Nevill. 1957. “Farewell to the Paradigm-Case Argument.” Analysis 18, 25-33.

f. Oxford Ordinary Language Philosophy

  • Austin, John Langshaw. 1962. How to Do Things With Words. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Austin, John Langshaw. 1964 [1956]. “A Plea for Excuses.” In V. C. Chappell, ed., Ordinary Language. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall, 41-63.
  • Austin, John Langshaw. 1962. Sense and Sensibilia, ed., G. J. Warnock. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Austin, John Langshaw. 1979. Philosophical Papers, eds., J. O. Urmson and G. J. Warnock. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Cavell, Stanley. 1964 [1958]. “Must We Mean What We Say?” In V. C. Chappell, ed., Ordinary Language. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall, 75-112.
  • Henson, Richard. 1965. “What We Say.” American Philosophical Quarterly 2, 52-62.
  • McDowell, John. 1994. Mind and World. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1949. The Concept of Mind. London: Hutchinson.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1964 [1953]. “Ordinary Language.” In V. C. Chappell, ed., Ordinary Language. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall, 24-40.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1963 [1957]. “The Theory of Meaning.” In C. Caton, ed., Philosophy and Ordinary Language. Urbana: University of Illinois Press, 128-153.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1961. “Use, Usage and Meaning.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volumes 35, 223-230.
  • Searle, John. (Ed.). 1971. The Philosophy of Language. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Collection of essays on the Oxford Ordinary Language approach.
  • Strawson, Peter Frederick and Grice, Herbert Paul. 1956. “In Defence of a Dogma.” Philosophical Review 65, 141-158.
  • Strawson, Peter Frederick. 1950. “On Referring.” Mind 59, 320-344.
  • Strawson, Peter Frederick. 1959. Individuals: An Essay in Descriptive Metaphysics. London: Methuen.
  • Strawson, Peter Frederick. 1952. Introduction to Logical Theory. London: Methuen.
  • Strawson, Peter Frederick. 2004 [1971]. Logico-Linguistic Papers. Aldershot: Ashgate.

g. Criticism of Ordinary Language Philosophy

  • Campbell, Chares Arthur. 1944. “Commonsense Propositions and Philosophical Paradoxes.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 45, 1-25.
  • Chisholm, Roderick. 1992 [1951]. “Philosophers and Ordinary Language.” In R. Rorty, ed., The Linguistic Turn. Chicago: The University of Chicago Press, 175-182.
  • Devitt, Michael and Sterelny, Kim. 1999. Language and Reality: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Language, 2nd ed. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Fodor, Jerry and Katz, Jerrold J. 1971 [1963]. “The Availability of What We Say.” In C. Lyas, ed., Philosophy and Linguistics. London: Macmillan, 190-203.
  • Grice Herbert Paul. 1989. Studies in the Way of Words. Cambridge: Harvard University Press.
  • Gellner, Ernest André. 1959. Words and Things: A Critical Account of Linguistic Philosophy and a Study in Ideology. London: Gollancz.
    • A hyperbolic criticism of linguistic philosophies.
  • Lewis, Hywel David. (Ed.). 1963. Clarity is not Enough: Essays in Criticism of Linguistic Philosophy. London: George Allen and Unwin.
    • Early collection of critical essays.
  • Mates, Benson. 1964 [1958]. “On the Verification of Ordinary Language.” In V. C. Chappell, ed., Ordinary Language. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall, 64-74.
  • Rollins, Calvin Dwight. 1951. “Ordinary Language and Procrustean Beds.” Mind 60, 223-232.
  • Tennessen, Herman. 1965. “Ordinary Language in Memoriam.” Inquiry 8, 225-248.
  • Weitz, Morris. 1947. “Philosophy and the Abuse of Language.” Journal of Philosophy 44, 533-546.
  • Williamson, Timothy. 2007. The Philosophy of Philosophy. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Woozley, Anthony Douglas. 1953. “Ordinary Language and Common Sense.” Mind 62, 301-312.

h. Contemporary views

  • Borg, Emma. 2004. Minimal Semantics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Pro-truth-conditional, invariant semantics for linguistic meaning.
  • Cappelen, Herman and Lepore, Ernie. 2005. Insensitive Semantics: A Defense of Semantic Minimalism and Speech Act Pluralism. Oxford: Blackwell.
    • Pro-truth-conditional, invariant semantics for linguistic meaning.
  • Gendler Szabó, Zoltán. (Ed.). 2005. Semantics versus Pragmatics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Excellent collection of essays targeting the Minimalist/Contextualist debate about linguistic meaning.
  • Hale, Bob and Wright, Crispin. (Eds.). 1997. A Companion to the Philosophy of Language. London: Routledge.
    • Good anthology of relevant essays.
  • King, Jeffrey and Stanley, Jason. 2005. “Semantics, Pragmatics and the Role of Semantic Content.” In Z. Gendler Szabó, ed., Semantics versus Pragmatics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 111-164.
  • Lycan, William. 1999. The Philosophy of Language: A Contemporary Introduction. New York: Routledge.
  • Recanati, Francois. 2004. Literal Meaning. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • Thorough discussion of the Minimalist/Contextualist debate, supportive of a moderately Contextualist view about linguistic meaning.
  • Searle, John. 1969. Speech Acts. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Searle, John. 1979 [1978]. “Literal Meaning.” In J. Searle, ed., Expression and Meaning. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 117-136.
  • Stanley, Jason and Gendler Szabó, Zoltán. 2000. “On Quantifier Domain Restriction.” Mind and Language 15, 219-261.
  • Travis, Charles. 1996. “Meaning’s Role in Truth.” Mind 100, 451-466.
    • A ‘radical’ Contextualist, and anti-Minimalist about linguistic meaning.
  • Travis, Charles. 1999. “Pragmatics.” In B. Hale and C. Wright, eds., A Companion to the Philosophy of Language. London: Routledge, 87-107.

i. Historical and Other Commentaries

  • Hacker, Peter Michael Stephan. 1996. Wittgenstein’s Place in Twentieth-Century Philosophy. Oxford: Blackwell.
    • Thorough historical account of early analytic philosophy, including detailed biographical information on philosophers – for example, who worked with whom, and who was whose pupils/teachers. Reads easily, as a first-hand account.
  • Hanfling, Oswald. (2000). Philosophy and Ordinary Language: The Bent and Genius of Our Tongue. London: Routledge.
    • One of the only modern defenses of Ordinary Language philosophy.
  • Klibansky, Raymond. (Ed.). 1958. Philosophy in the Mid-Century, Volume 2. Florence: La Nuova Italia.
  • Lyas, Colin. (Ed.). 1971. Philosophy and Linguistics. London: Macmillan.
    • Addresses the debate regarding ‘what we say’, and some Oxford Ordinary Language philosophical disputes.
  • Passmore, John Arthur. 1957. “Wittgenstein and Ordinary Language Philosophy.” In J. A. Passmore, A Hundred Years of Philosophy. London: Duckworth.
    • An early account of Ordinary Language philosophy, at a time when it was still in vogue.
  • Quinton, Anthony. 1958. “Linguistic Analysis.” In R. Klibansky, ed., Philosophy in the Mid-Century, Volume 2. Florence: La Nuova Italia.
    • Excellent bibliography.
  • Soames, Scott. 2003. Philosophical Analysis in the Twentieth Century, Volume 2: The Age of Meaning. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Urmson, James Opie. 1956. Philosophical Analysis: Its Development Between the Two World Wars. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Warnock, Geoffrey James. (Ed.). 1960. The Revolution in Philosophy. London: Macmillan.

 

Author Information

Sally Parker-Ryan
Email: sally.pr@sbcglobal.net
U. S. A.

Cornelius Castoriadis (1922—1997)

Cornelius Castoriadis was an important intellectual figure in France for many decades, beginning in the late-1940s. Trained in philosophy, Castoriadis also worked as a practicing economist and psychologist while authoring over twenty major works and numerous articles spanning many traditional philosophical subjects, including politics, economics, psychology, anthropology, and ontology. His oeuvre can be understood broadly as a reflection on the concept of creativity and its implications in various fields. Perhaps most importantly he warned of the dangerous political and ethical consequences of a contemporary world that has lost sight of autonomy, i.e. of the need to set limits or laws for oneself.

Influenced by his understanding and criticism of traditional philosophical figures such as the Ancient Greeks, German Idealists, Marx, and Heidegger, Castoriadis was also influenced by thinkers as diverse as Sigmund Freud, Max Weber, Maurice Merleau-Ponty, and Georg Cantor. He engaged in dynamic intellectual relationships with his fellow members of Socialisme ou Barbarie (including Claude Lefort and Jean-François Lyotard, among others) and later in life with leading figures in mathematics, biology, and other fields. He is remembered largely for his initial support for and subsequent break from Marxism, for his call for Western thought to embrace the reality of creativity, and finally for his defense of an ethics and politics based on “lucid” deliberation and social and individual autonomy. For Castoriadis the central question of philosophy and the source of philosophy’s importance is its capacity to break through society’s closure and ask what the relevant questions for humans ought to be.

Table of Contents

  1. Beginnings
    1. Youth in Greece and Arrival in France
    2. The Concept of Self-Management in the Early Writings
  2. The Break From Marxism
  3. Theoretical Developments
    1. The Creative Imagination
      1. Philosophical Background: Aristotle
      2. Philosophical Background: Kant
      3. Philosophical Background: Post-Kantian Philosophy
      4. Creation ex Nihilo
    2. Related Theoretical Concepts
      1. The Monad and the Social-Historical
      2. The Living Being and Its Proper World
      3. Magmas and Ensembles
  4. The Project of Autonomy
    1. Heteronomy and Autonomy
    2. Democracy in Ancient Greece
    3. Public, Private, and Agora
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Book-Length Collections of Castoriadis’s Work in English
    2. Secondary Readings (French and English)

1. Beginnings

a. Youth in Greece and Arrival in France

Cornelius Castoriadis was born to an ethnically Greek family living in Constantinople (Istanbul) in 1922. The year was one of the most tumultuous in modern Greek history. Following the First World War, lands granted to Greece at the expense of the Ottoman Empire by the victorious Entente powers were being claimed militarily by Turkish nationalists. As the defeat of the Greek army in the formerly Ottoman territories seemed imminent, Castoriadis’s father relocated the family to Athens, the home of Castoriadis’s mother, when Cornelius was a few months old. As a result, Castoriadis spent his youth in Athens where he discovered philosophy at the age of twelve or thirteen. He engaged in communist youth activities while in high school and later studied economics, political science, and law while resisting the Axis occupation of Greece during Second World War. His Trotskyist opposition group distanced itself from the pro-Stalinist opposition. During this time Castoriadis published his first academic writings on Max Weber’s methodology and led seminars on philosophers including Kant and Hegel. In 1945 he won and accepted a scholarship to write a philosophy dissertation at the Sorbonne in Paris, thus starting a wholly new stage in his life.

In Paris Castoriadis planned to write his dissertation on the impossibility of a closed, rationalist philosophical system. This plan took second stage, however, to his critical-political activities. He became active in the French branch of the Trotskyist party though he quickly criticized the group’s failure to take a stronger stance against Stalin. By 1947 Castoriadis developed his own criticism of the Soviets who, he argued, had only created a new brand of exploitation in Russia, i.e. bureaucratic exploitation (Castoriadis Reader 3). Discovering he shared similar views with recent acquaintance Claude Lefort, the two began to distance themselves altogether from the Trotskyist goal of party rule.

Castoriadis began two major vocations in 1948. First, he and Lefort co-founded the journal and political group Socialisme ou Barbarie (Socialism or Barbarism). They focused on criticizing both Soviet bureaucracy and capitalism and on developing ideas for other possible organizations of society. The group’s founding statement expressed an interest in a non-dogmatic yet still Marxist social critique. On the one hand, the traditional questions Marx raised about workers and social organization would remain important, while on the other hand any commitment to specific Marxist positions would remain conditional. Despite internal dissent and membership changes, the group remained partially intact from 1948 to 1966 with a peak involvement of a few dozen members and approximately 1,000 copies produced per issue of the group’s journal. Castoriadis’s leadership and writings helped establish him as an important figure in the political-intellectual field in Paris.

Second, in 1948 Castoriadis began working as an economist with the international Organization for European Economic Cooperation (OEEC). He would remain there until 1970, analyzing the short- and medium-term economic status of developed nations. His work with OEEC not only allowed him an income and the possibility of remaining in France until his eventual nationalization, but it also permitted him great insights into the economies of capitalist countries and into the functioning of a major bureaucratic organization. Following his employment with OEEC, Castoriadis worked during the 1970s as a psychoanalyst. He finally received an academic position at the École des Hautes Études en Sciences Sociales (EHESS) in Paris in 1979. He remained with EHESS until his death following heart surgery in 1997.

b. The Concept of Self-Management in the Early Writings

Reflecting on the Socialisme ou Barbarie group, Castoriadis considered one of his and the journal’s most important contributions to be the concept of workers’ self-management (Castoriadis Reader 1-17). While in his later writings the concept would develop into a theory of autonomy standing independently of the Marxist framework, during the journal years the theory of self-management served as a modification of or an alternative to Marx’s theory of class struggle.

In 1955’s “On the Content of Socialism” (Castoriadis Reader 40-105) Castoriadis, writing under a pseudonym in order to protect himself from deportation as an alien, defined the central conflict of society not in terms of the classical dichotomy between owners and workers but in terms of a conflict between directors and executants. (Notably, this distinction coincides with Aristotle’s definitions of master and slave in the Politics and with philosopher Simone Weil’s economic analysis from as early as 1933). Contemporary society, he argued, is split between a stratum of managers who direct workers, and a stratum of workers obedient to managers. Workers pass real-world information up to the managers; but they must then carry out the often nonsensical orders that are passed back down. For Castoriadis, in both Western and so-called “communist” countries (i.e. countries Castoriadis would have said embodied only a semblance of communism) managers are often uninformed about subordinate tasks, know little about interrelated fields of work, and nevertheless they still direct the immediate production process. Such a managerial apparatus, argued Castoriadis, leads to inefficiency, waste, and unnecessary conflict between aloof managers and servile workers.

The domination of society by the managerial apparatus can only be surpassed, argued Castoriadis, when workers take responsibility for organizing themselves. Workers must assume effective management of their own work situation in “full knowledge of the relevant facts.” This emphasis on the importance of knowledge implies that individuals should work cooperatively. They should form workers councils consisting of conditionally elected members. Those members, in a strict reversal of the bureaucratic managerial model, should convene frequently not in order to make decisions for workers but in order to express the decisions of the workers. They should then convey important information back to the workers for the purpose of helping workers make their own decisions. In this way, the workers’ council is not a managerial stratum. Rather, it helps convey information to workers for their purposes. While Castoriadis did support a centralized institution, or assembly of councils, capable of making rapid decisions when needed, such decisions, he argued, would be at all times reversible by the workers and their councils.

In the end, Castoriadis contrasted self-management with individualistic, negative libertarian, or anarchic ideals, i.e. the ideals idolized in capitalist countries. Such countries reject the role of workers councils but they then become heavily bureaucratized anyway. Castoriadis also contrasted self-management with the explicitly centralized, exploitative bureaucracies of the so-called communist countries. In both cases what currently blocks the emergence of self-management is the division between directors and executants. While some specialization of labor will always be necessary, what is damaging today is specifically the dominance of a class that is devoted only to the management of other people’s work.

2. The Break From Marxism

Like many anti-totalitarian leftists, Castoriadis initially tried to divorce the bad features of twentieth-century communism from the “true meaning” of Marxism. However, by the mid- to late-1950s he came to argue that a profound critique of existing communist countries also requires a critique of Marx’s philosophy. Capitalism, Marxism, and the Soviet experiment were all based in a common set of presuppositions.

Castoriadis’s analysis of the institutional structure of the Soviet Union, collected later in La Société Bureaucratique (Bureaucratic Society), suggested that the Soviet Union is dominated by a militaristic, bureaucratic institution that Castoriadis called total bureaucratic capitalism (TBC). This name implies that the principle of the social order in the USSR is truly an analogue—albeit a more centralized analogue—of the Western capitalist order, which Castoriadis called fragmented bureaucratic capitalism (FBC) (Castoriadis Reader 218-238). Castoriadis then argued that both TBC and FBC were rooted in a common “social imaginary.”

This social imaginary, common to TBC and FBC, was expressed as a desire for rational mastery over self and nature. Both capitalist thought and Marx assumed that capital has enormous, even total power over humanity. This assumption led to an excessive desire on both sides to control its supposed force. For this reason Marx’s followers aimed to create a totalitarian bureaucratic system that could theoretically gain “mastery over the master” (World in Fragments 32-43). Yet, according to Castoriadis’s analysis, the exploitation found in Western society was not solved by this system of control; it was instead rendered more total and crushing. The managerial, bureaucratic class became a unified, oppressive force in itself, pursuing its own interests against the people. Hence, Castoriadis concluded that the eventual efforts of the communist countries to gain rational mastery were not truly separable from Marx’s own, earlier philosophy. That philosophy itself had emerged from the common social imaginary that FBC and TBC share, namely the desire to gain total control of nature and history through controlling capital.

Castoriadis also developed more specific criticisms of Marx’s economic assumptions. Indeed, as early as 1959’s “Modern Capitalism and Revolution” (Political and Social Writings II 226-315) he attacked Marx’s method of treating workers as though they were cogs in the machine of capitalism. Marx, he argued, failed to consider the importance of the unplanned, contingent actions of the proletariat, actions powerful enough to save a company from mismanagement or to lead it into disaster. In other words, Marx’s analysis of capitalism was too deterministic. The creative decisions of workers are not strictly subject to capital’s laws. Rather, workers sustain or destroy capitalism itself through their own actions. As such, workers’ actions—singularly and collectively—can lead to changes in the very laws of the system.

As a result, Castoriadis found that Marx’s view of history was based in flawed assumptions. The actions of workers cannot be sufficiently explained by supposed laws of historical dialectic. Workers themselves could determine the law of history rather than being merely determined by history’s law. As such, the classical theory of capitalism’s inevitable collapse into socialism and then communism could not be sustained. While Castoriadis agreed with Marx (and praised Marx’s far-reaching analysis) that the history of capitalism is ridden with crises and so-called contradictions, he disagreed with Marx’s deduction of future historical developments from out of those events. The outcome of a capitalist crisis is in truth determined by how individuals and society take up those crises, not by any necessary, internal self-development of capitalism “itself.”

From out of this engagement with Marx, Castoriadis began to develop his own view of how autonomous society could arise. Autonomous society, he argued, is a creation of the singular individual and the collectivity. It cannot be sufficiently deduced or developed from tendencies, potentialities, impossibilities, or necessities contained within the current system. Whereas Marx interpreted the workers’ struggles for autonomy as part of the rational self-development of capitalism itself, Castoriadis, by contrast, emphasized the real contingency of the historical successes of democratic-emancipatory struggles. These struggles had preceded capitalism, were subdued within capitalism and the modern era of rational mastery, and are still present but also largely subdued in the contemporary age of FBC and TBC (World in Fragments 32-43). Castoriadis’s break with Marx is therefore his break with the desire to gain mastery over the supposedly all-powerful forces controlling humanity and history.

3. Theoretical Developments

Between the end of Socialisme ou Barbarie in 1966 and the publication of L’institution imaginaire de la société (The Imaginary Institution of Society) in 1975 the tenor and explicit subject matter of Castoriadis’s work changed noticeably. For the remainder of his life he engaged with a broader variety of disciplines, including psychoanalysis, biology, sociology, ecology, and mathematics. His specific views in each field were almost always linked to his general theory of the creative imagination—operating at both singular and collective levels—and to its implications for each discipline. Philosophy’s role, he argued, is to break through the closure of any instituted social imaginary in order to make possible a deliberative attitude about what humans ought actively to institute, i.e. about the very goals, ends, and capacities of society and individuals themselves. In this sense, Castoriadis’ ontology of creation makes possible his ethics and politics of autonomy (Section 4). In developing his theoretical concepts, Castoriadis never worked in a vacuum, as he contributed to several intellectual groups during this time, including the École Freudienne de Paris led by Jacques Lacan, the journal Textures (primarily philosophical), and the journal Libre (primarily political) with Claude Lefort.

a. The Creative Imagination

While the first division of L’institution imaginaire de la société offered a modified version of Castoriadis’ critique of Marx, the second division contained his full-scale theory of the creative imagination. He argued there that the imagination is not primarily a capacity to create visual images. Rather, it is the singular or collective capacity to create forms, i.e. the capacity to create the presentation or self-presentation of being itself. The theory of the creative imagination developed over many years through essays conversant with the Western intellectual tradition. In this section I will present his views as a dialogue with the figures to whom Castoriadis acknowledged a debt.

i. Philosophical Background: Aristotle

In 1978’s “The Discovery of the Imagination” (World in Fragments 213-245) Castoriadis distinguished what he called the radical imagination from the “traditional” view of the imagination. Aristotle’s traditional view, depicted in De Anima, treated the imagination as a faculty generating an image that accompanies sensations but typically distorts them. Since sensations themselves are always true according to Aristotle, the extra imaginary capacity (primarily serving to reproduce what the senses provided, to recombine past sensations into new images, or to supplement sensation confusingly) was treated mainly as an obfuscator of truth. Castoriadis argued that philosophy usually considered this account of imagination to reveal its basic power. Regardless of whether they attacked or praised it, philosophers tended to treat the imagination in this way as something that creates a kind of fantastical non-reality.

Despite this picture of the imagination as “negative,” Castoriadis argued that hidden deeper within the philosophical tradition was a discovery of a primary imagination that is not simply negative. Indeed, in De Anima 3.7-3.9 Aristotle argued that the primary imagination is a “condition for all thought.” For Castoriadis, this claim implies that there can be no grasp of reality without the primary imagination. It should be interpreted, Castoriadis argued, as a capacity for the very presentation of reality as such, a presentation required for any further understanding. In this way, the primary imagination precedes any re-presentation of reality.

Even so, Aristotle remained an ambiguous figure for Castoriadis. He had raised difficult problems for any account of imagination as strictly negative or re-presentational; but he also failed to draw out the full consequences of his discovery of the primary imagination. Most of his writings and most of traditional philosophy portray the imagination as mainly reproductive, negative, or obfuscatory.

ii. Philosophical Background: Kant

According to Castoriadis, Immanuel Kant rediscovered the importance of the imagination and gave philosophy a new awareness of its role (World in Fragments 246-272). In Critique of Pure Reason, Kant had allowed that the imagination is the capacity to present an object even without the presence of that object in sensible intuition. As such, he freed the imagination from the traditional role of merely following or accompanying the senses in an a posteriori function. For Kant, the imagination was already involved in the initial presentation of whatever may appear to the senses.

Like Aristotle, however, Kant was an ambiguous figure for Castoriadis. While Kant was aware of the imagination’s creativity and its vital role in presenting whatever can appear, he was also too quick to re-subordinate the imagination to the task of offering presentations that remain within the a priori, necessary, and stable structures (i.e. the categories and pure forms of intuition) inherent in the knowing mind. For example, while Kant allowed the imagination a role in a priori mathematical construction in intuition, he allowed that it works in this way only within the framework of the pre-established forms of intuitions themselves (that is, within the pre-set structures of space and of time). In short, the imagination remained bound to functioning in a pre-established field in Kant’s theoretical work (Castoriadis Reader 319-337). The same tendency, argued Castoriadis, found expression in Kant’s later work on the imagination in the Critique of Judgment (Philosophy, Politics, Autonomy 81-123).

Nevertheless, Castoriadis in some sense followed the Kantian view that an unknown X, other than the knowing subject, can “occasion” imaginary presentations. Castoriadis preferred, however, to invoke Fichte’s term Anstoß (shock) for the “encounter” with whatever occasions imaginary activity. With this shock, the imagination goes into operation generates a presentation for itself. It thereby brings something “other” into a relation with itself, forming the presentation of the other as what it is. While Fichte had suggested that the imagination in some sense gives itself this shock, Castoriadis denied that the question of the internality or externality of the shock was decidable. Thus he maintained that the imagination forms either itself or another something into a presentation by “leaning on” (Freud’s term is anaclasis) what is formable in whatever it forms. Something in what the imagination forms thus lends itself to formation by the imagination. While there can be no account of the nature of this formability without the imagination’s actual formation of the formable X, Castoriadis argued that his fact does not prove that there is nothing formable in itself, i.e. that there is nothing at all apart from the imagination’s activity.

Finally, Castoriadis took his Kant-inspired account even further. He argued that the imagination can in some cases create a presentation of reality by starting without any shock whatsoever. The imagination can create a presentation or form of reality without any conditioning shock (Castoriadis Reader 323-6). Thus, while there are inevitably some shocks for any psyche, the shock is not a necessary condition for the operation of the imagination.

Castoriadis argued that Kant had implicitly recognized the creativity of the imagination. Kant, however, tried hard to chain down the imagination to stable structures of thought and intuition. But Kant’s efforts in this direction merely indicated that he was deeply aware of a creativity that is not necessarily stable or bound to an a priori rule of operation. He recognized the primary imagination. Hence Kant, like Aristotle, is an ambiguous friend for Castoriadis.

iii. Philosophical Background: Post-Kantian Philosophy

Castoriadis’s response to Kant’s philosophy, at least in its negative aspects, is not entirely dissimilar to the responses given by post-Kantians such as the German Idealists, Nietzsche, and Heidegger. However, it differs in that it does not involve the monism implicit or explicit in modern idealism (Hegel) and materialism (Nietzsche, Marx). Indeed, perhaps more than any other thinker since Kant, and in opposition to the monistic tendencies of most of the post-Kantians, Castoriadis embraced the inevitability of the encounter with an “other.” There is no such thing as a singular substance existing radically alone; for each substance interacts with others. While Castoriadis’s views do at times overlap with the phenomenological tradition, his theory of radical creativity puts him at odds with the Heideggerian tradition. Castoriadis also diverged from the twentieth century “turn to language” in analytic philosophy (though he did develop a theory of signification in The Imaginary Institution of Society). More broadly, in contrast to prevalent cultural relativism of the twentieth century West, he instead expressed an absolute support for the project of moral and political autonomy (Section 4).

What is perhaps most vital for understanding Castoriadis’s creative imagination—what makes his project unique in contemporary philosophy—is that his analysis of creativity is not supposed to entail, by itself, a normative claim. Castoriadis does not assign a positive value to creativity as such. In fact, Castoriadis explicitly rejected the positive valuation of “the new for the sake of the new” (Post-Script on Insignificance 93-107). The endless search for the next thing or the newest idea in contemporary thought leads to a lack of understanding of the already established norms, and therefore to an unconscious redeployment of those norms. Even so, the radical creativity of the imagination does, in a different way, lead to value-theoretic considerations and, in particular, to a kind of politics. While value cannot be derived from being or creation, the very fact that being is creation leads to another question: What ought we create (or re-create), institute (or perpetuate), or set for ourselves as a project? How can we provide limits and institutions for ourselves so that we may effectively achieve and call into question what we understand to be good? As such, Castoriadis’s radical imagination might be said to “clear the way” for his politics and ethics (Section 4).

iv. Creation ex Nihilo

As the above dialogue with the philosophical tradition has already suggested, Castoriadis argued that being is creation. He described creation as an emergence of newness that, whether deliberate or unconscious, is itself not sufficiently determined by preceding historical conditions. He thus described creation as ex nihilo, or as stemming from nothing. Even so, he also insisted that creation is neither in nihilo nor cum nihilo (Castoriadis Reader 321, 404). In other words, while creation must be understood to emerge out of nothing, this creation always emerges within a set of historical or natural conditions. However, these conditions are not sufficient to account for the being of the new creation. Thus, even if there were (per impossible) a complete and exhaustive account of the conditions contextualizing any occasion of creation, neither the existence nor the specificity of the new creation could be fully understood as derived from those conditions. For example, we miss the radical, historical newness of the Greek social creation of “democracy” if we attempt to explain it simply in terms of what already existed in Athens at the time. The creation of democracy broke through the conditioning constraints of the existing social state of affairs. In this sense, Greek democracy was radically new.

Castoriadis repeatedly contrasted ex nihilo creation with production or deduction of consequences. First, production entails that a set of elements or materials is given, which givens are then molded or modified into a new product. Even notions of self-differentiation are really just notions of productivity in this sense, for they envision the new creation (call it X-prime) as emerging from the original X merely as a self-modification of that original X. Thus, the new “product” is treated not as an original itself but rather as a modified “version” of an original. This is not what Castoriadis means by a new creation. Second, in the case of deduction, he argued that a deductive theory of newness would mean only that there is some new conclusion that follows sufficiently from a set of factors as a result of there being a determinate rule or law of the deduction process itself (laws of inference, and so forth). Yet such deduction does not create or reveal something new qua new; rather, it involves an inference from premises to something different that is supposed to already exist because its existence follows from the premises. Thus, he argued, both production and deduction are beholden to theories of “difference” that really only explain the new as a derivative, a modified sameness, or an already-existing thing. Castoriadis contrasted these concepts sharply with creation ex nihilo.

Importantly, Castoriadis’s notion of creation is not equivalent to the epistemic notion of unpredictability, as he clarified in 1983’s “Time and Creation” (World in Fragments 374-401). A continuous emergence of something out of something else can still be fully unpredictable. Unpredictability might, for example, mean simply that not all of the relevant producers, factors, or laws of inference are known or knowable: An unpredictable event or phenomenon could still be determined by unknown factors. Unpredictability could be a function of the limitations of knowledge. Thus unpredictability is not equivalent to creation. While Castoriadis agreed that knowers are not, as far as we know, omniscient, he argued that with each creation there emerges something ontologically new, something that is not merely seemingly new “for us” due to some subjective lack of knowledge. Separating radical creation from the merely epistemic notion of unpredictability, Castoriadis defends the notion that creation brings about something genuinely new.

Further, Castoriadis argued that creation does not prevent deterministic accounts from, so to speak, sticking. Creation cannot be simply opposed to determinism; rather creation only excludes the idea that there could be a total inclusion of the various strata of beings (and creations) within “a single ultimate and elementary level” of determination (World in Fragments 393). Thus, Castoriadis did not deny that creations lend themselves to being understood in terms of continuous difference (production, deduction) or determination. Rather, a stratum of explicable difference always emerges as a result of the relationship of a creation to those conditions in and with (but not from) which it occurs. For example, while Greek democracy was a radically new social creation in history, this creation also at once re-instituted many of the conditions with and in which it emerged. Thus, resultant continuities and (mere) differences are evident between Greek democracy and the world existing prior to its emergence. This stratum of continuity and (mere) difference is somewhat explicable in terms of what is producible or deducible from already existing conditions or elements; but democracy is also something wholly original, something lacking complete continuity with what precedes.

Finally, Castoriadis’s terminology of the ex nihilo should not be confused with the theological sense of creation ex nihilo. Theological creation, he argued, is usually treated as “production” by God according to ideas or pre-existing potentialities, such as the nature or mind of God (Fenêtre sur le Chaos 160-164). A God who looks to ideas that always exist, whether those ideas are God’s own (Augustine) or eternal models not identical to god (Plato), is not thought of as genuinely creative in Castoriadis’s sense. Further, theology usually says the world’s creation is a completed affair. It might play itself out in interesting ways; but this “playing out” does not include the possibility of any radical newness. Thus, traditional solutions to the theodicy problem—whether they involve a God who continually creates the world according to general laws (Malebranche) or a God who creates pre-packaged monads (Leibniz)—always posit that God has a plan established in advance when he creates the world “once and for all.” At its most extreme point, therefore, theological creation is in fact coincident with the most radical necessitarianism (Spinoza). They both deny the radically new. Thus, Castoriadis joked that “spiritualists are the worst materialists” (Fenêtre sur le Chaos 161).

b. Related Theoretical Concepts

i. The Monad and the Social-Historical

In addition to the influence of philosophers, Castoriadis’s account of the imagination was most deeply influenced by his reading of Freud and his engagement with psychoanalysis. This interest became more marked during the years following the end of Socialisme ou Barbarie. At that time he became involved with the L’Ecole Freudienne de Paris (EFP) of Jacques Lacan and was also married for a time to psychoanalyst Piera Aulagnier.

In his interpretation of Freud, Castoriadis focused on the concept of Vorstellungen (representations), especially in the writings from 1915 (World in Fragments 253). He believed Freud’s search for the origins of representations led him closer to the idea of the primary imagination (Section 3.a.1) than did his explorations of the more famous concept of Phantasie (imagination). Castoriadis argued that Freud’s investigations led (implicitly but not explicitly) to the conclusion that for the human psyche there is no strictly mechanical apparatus converting bodily drives into psychical representations. In Castoriadis’s view Vorstellungen are created originally and cannot be accounted for strictly in terms of physical drives or states. Rather, there is an irreducible source of representations, which Castoriadis came to call the monad or the “monadic pole of the psyche.”

Castoriadis’s invocation of the term monad stems, first of all, from the Greek term for unity or aloneness. The term was most famously re-employed by Leibniz to describe the simple, invisible, and sole kind of metaphysical constituent of reality. Leibniz argued that nothing enters or leaves a monad, and yet monads have seemingly interactive experiences due to their pre-established coordination, created by God (i.e. the best possible world). For Leibniz, each monad reflects the state of the other monads and harmonizes with them while remaining independent. Invoking Leibniz’s metaphysics, Castoriadis retained the term but gave it a different sense and value. The monad, for Castoriadis, is not the sole kind of metaphysical constituent but neither is it unreal; rather, the monad is that aspect of the psyche that is incapable of accepting that it itself is not the sole kind of metaphysical constituent. As such, no monad actually remains entirely immanent to itself. All monads are inevitably fractured when the psyche encounters a radical otherness. Following the fragmentation the remnants of the monad desire to recover themselves into a now-impossible state of total aloneness. This “monadical” desire for aloneness has two effects. On the one hand, the monad’s desire for total self-enclosure leads the psyche to disregard the non-psychical sources of human function. The psyche begins to hate and despise the body, sometimes detrimentally. On the other hand, the monad’s desire for unity is not simply a negative thing since it leads the psyche to find unique ways to individuate itself. This individuation often occurs through the psyche’s adoption of social norms and identities. Adoption of norms or identities is not necessarily a bad thing, especially insofar as it can bring a certain measure of stability to the psyche. Castoriadis’s main point was rather that while the monadic pole of the psyche always tends toward radical aloneness, the broader psyche—of which the monad is only an aspect—is in fact capable of socialization, of adopting shared identities, and of having productive relations to others. The monadic pole, however, always fights against subsumption into social or physical norms or identities.

Ultimately Castoriadis felt a need to account for the monadic aspect of the psyche due to his experiences as an analyst interacting with patients. The monad, he suggests, is a necessary hypothesis we must posit if we are to describe the observable history of the patient subsequent to his or her fragmentation (Figures of the Thinkable 168). What follows fragmentation is a phase of life in which the psyche creates itself in relation to a specific social-historical situation and the collective conditions it faces. These collective conditions, or institutions, essentially “fabricate” the individual from out of the psyche as the psyche adopts them into its own identity.

For this reason Castoriadis’s psychoanalytic work leads directly into his political philosophy. For in the same way that psychical creativity as such is broader than, and precedes, the social-historical individuation of the psyche, so too is there a ground of any social formation. This ground, irreducible to individual psychic creativity, Castoriadis calls the anonymous collective. This trans-individual creativity yields as its effects the imaginary formations falling into our typical, narrower categories of “culture” or “society.” A psyche always forms itself through these instituted social offerings; but the social instituting power itself is what accounts in the first place for this instituted state of affairs. The instituted can always be rewritten by the instituting power, and thus a truly autonomous society explicitly acknowledges this instituting power and seeks lucidly to share in it (Section 4).

In this sense, Castoriadis insisted that various strata of creativity—for example, the psyche and the anonymous collective—are irreducible to each other and yet they are importantly interactive. He thus understood that psychoanalysis has a broader social role than is typically believed. In particular it can help the psyche break consciously and lucidly with the monadical desire for total self-enclosure. Castoriadis felt this task could help bring about a world where the singular psyche and the collectivity begin to acknowledge the duty to share in the deliberative activities of distinctively autonomous self-creation (Section 4).

ii. The Living Being and Its Proper World

In addition to his reflection on social and individual human creativity, Castoriadis’s view of “being as creation” led him to develop theories about non-human living beings. In “The State of the Subject Today” (World in Fragments 137-171) he considered in turn the living being, the psyche, the social individual, and finally human society, arguing that each is a distinct but interactive “stratum” of being. While a living being (for example, a human) is conditioned by its interaction with and dependency on other living beings such as cells, nevertheless no stratum of living beings (such as humanity) is reducible to any other stratum. Human life cannot be conceived accurately as merely an “expression” of cell life, for example. Each stratum involves a unique, original kind of living being, or “being for itself,” which leans on but is by no means determined by the other strata with which it interacts.

Beginning at the cellular level then, Castoriadis described the living being as creative of its own proper world as it leans on other beings and worlds which lend themselves. Castoriadis suggested, for example, that an individual dog is a participant in the species dog, in the sense that this dog creates for itself a world in common with other dogs. Nevertheless, while the “proper worlds” of the cells of this dog (or of other beings in its environment) are a condition of this dog and of this dog’s creation of a proper world shared with other dogs, these cells are not something out of which this dog sufficiently emerges or with which this dog’s life is always entirely consistent. Dog cells do not determine the proper world of a dog although they are conditions leaned upon by this dog as it creates its own proper world. While dog-life thus depends on cell-life, the stratum of life proper to dogs is a creation of dogs as they live with their conditioning cells. And, of course, cell life is also creative of a proper world for itself, i.e. a world only partially analogical with the life of the dog. As a result, each stratum of life is unique yet interactive.

On this level, Castoriadis conversed with Chilean biologist and proponent of the theory of autopoiesis Francisco Varela (for example, see “Life and Creation” in Post-Script on Insignificance). For Varela, and also for Humberto Maturana, auto-creation means that each living being creates for itself a world of closure. The living being is essentially dependent upon the living beings which condition it. Higher beings are expressions of the potentialities inherent in the lower constituents. Castoriadis followed Varela with respect to the self-creation of the living being and its proper world, arguing that nothing enters into the proper world of a living being without being transformed by it. However, for Castoriadis, auto-creation did not have to entail a kind of organizational closure. Some living beings are both radically creative of new, irreducible strata of life and merely lean on others for their creations; they are not simply expressions of those other strata. The creativity of a dog, for example, is thus irreducible to being the expression of the constituents of itself (e.g. cells) or the expression of its environment. Even the most basic stratum of natural life (which Castoriadis called the “first natural stratum”) is merely a condition for the emergence of other living beings; it is not something that decides, determines, or produces what those other strata are.

Thus, Castoriadis did not treat the creativity of the living being as simply a larger or smaller scale version of other living beings. The human creation of a proper world, for example, creatively breaks out of a closure relative to its supporting conditions (internal or environmental) and breaks continuity even with itself at times. Humans create a new stratum of being irreducible to the others. We are always intra- and inter-active with other strata; but the human psyche creates in ways that are not contained potentially in anterior states of other living beings or in its inherited conditions. Humans create a new, common, distinct stratum of life. Thus, Castoriadis argued from a biological standpoint that it is quite possible to affirm truly that “everything is interactive.” Yet he insisted that we cannot for that reason “simply say that everything interacts with everything […]” (Post-Script on Insignificance 67). All of what is proper to the human world interacts with some other strata, but only some of what is proper to the human world shares something in common with all other strata.

iii. Magmas and Ensembles

Castoriadis’s project has many aspects that allow it to be interpreted as a “theory of being” in the traditional sense. He developed two important theoretical concepts that underpin much of his ontological work beginning in the 1970s: magmas and ensembles. The former term was Castoriadis’s preferred name for indeterminate, or mixed, being. The latter, the French term for “sets,” is his term for determinate being (where being refers to either the singular or plural).

Castoriadis faced his greatest difficulties in describing magmas since he argued magmas exist and yet they are not comprehensible by traditional ontology because traditional ontology thinks that true being is strictly determinate. Traditional ontology says that what is indeterminate (Greek apeiron) is a more or less deficient being or a kind of non-being. That is, indeterminate being is at best conceived as existing only insofar as it is related to determinate being (Greek peras). Castoriadis’s task was to envision indeterminate being without thinking of it as merely existing relative to, or as a negation of, determinate being. As such, Castoriadis made a very cautious effort to “define” magmas (although he did not consider his task to be possible in this definitional form) in a way that did not define them as deficient modes of determinate being. In the 1983 text, “The Logic of Magmas and the Question of Autonomy” (Castoriadis Reader 290-318), he suggested several propositions:

M1: If M is a magma, one can mark, in M, an indefinite number of ensembles.

M2: If M is a magma, one can mark, in M, magmas other than M.

M3: If M is a magma, M cannot be partitioned into magmas.

M4: If M is a magma, every decomposition of M into ensembles leaves a magma as residue.

M5: What is not a magma is an ensemble or is nothing.

Here the central problem in thinking about magmas is the way that they appear as a great nexus wherein any magma is inseparable from any other magma. Magmas are thus something like mixtures of beings that involve no totally separate or discrete elements. Even so, other magmas, different from any particular magma that is being researched, can be “indicated” as existing within the magma being researched. For this reason, magmas are also not simply one sole entity. Yet they have no parts and always resist being confined to sets. In short, magmas are inherently indeterminate; while they are determinable in some ways, they are never wholly determinate.

As for his account of ensembles, or determinate being, Castoriadis argued that all traditional ontology—including Platonic forms, Aristotelian substance, Kantian categories, the Hegelian absolute, for example—assumes that being is essentially determinate. Such an ontology is, in Castoriadis’s terms, an ensemblist-identitarian, or ensidic, ontology. These ontologies always rely on certain operators of thinking, including traditional logical and mathematical principles such as the principle of identity, non-contradiction, the excluded third, and so forth. They assume that being consists of entirely discrete or separate elements neatly conforming to these principles. Ensidic thought therefore cannot grasp the notion that there would be anything genuinely other than determinate being.

As an example of ensidic thought, Castoriadis referred to set theory and its development. Cantor’s naïve set theory described a set as “any collection into a whole M of definite and separate objects m of our intuition or our thought.” He thus expressed explicitly what all later (non-naive or axiomatic) versions of set theory would maintain implicitly: the assumption that being is wholly determinate or consists of wholly determinate elements. When Cantor’s original set theory was shown to lead to paradoxes (such as Russell’s paradox), later axiomatic set theory did not call into question Cantor’s core pre-assumption that all being is determinate. Instead, it attempted to salvage Cantor’s determinacy assumption by wagering on being’s “conformability” to the determinacy assumption, all while searching for better ways to make that assumption consistent. Axiomatic set theory thus unquestioningly accepted Cantor’s original presupposition, even as it attempted to salvage set theory through axiomatics. Thus, set theory is a paradigmatic case of ensidic thought. Yet it is not unique in its assumption that being must be determinate. Everyday language, for example, already implicitly posits the separation and distinctness of beings. Set-theoretical ontology just re-confirms this bias of everyday language when it presumes that all being is determinate.

The problem with the assumption that all being must be determinate, or ensidic, Castoriadis argued, is not that there is in truth no stratum of determinate being whatsoever. Rather, there is such a stratum of wholly determinate being. The problem is that while this stratum is a condition for the emergence of other beings, it is merely a condition and not the sole constitutive principle of the other strata of being. The assumption that all being must be determinate leads ensidic logic to present some stratum of being (the first natural stratum of sheer determinacy) as if it were solely constitutive of each and every stratum of being (or each and every being). As such, a wholly ensidic ontology wrongly assumes that this de facto condition of determinacy is itself universally constitutive in principle of all possible beings. It falsely assumes that other strata simply conform to the ensidic strata (or stratum) of being. In reality, ensidic thought itself posits this stratum of being as primary, without the attendant awareness that this hypothesis is a hypothesis. Thus, traditional ontology, like everyday language, gravely mistakes the ensidic stratum itself for what being must be.

4. The Project of Autonomy

For Castoriadis, the psyche of each human is inevitably fragmented and cannot remain in a strictly monadic state. Further, as the ground of social-historical constellations of meaning, the creativity of the anonymous collective—i.e. the social instituting power—is irreducible to individual psychic creativity (Section 3.b.i). Thus, the question of genuine politics arises necessarily for humans because humans must create themselves as they exist in relation to others and in relation to society’s institutions (which often mediate relations with others). Therefore, the question of true political action is intimately linked to the question of which institutions we shall institute, internalize, and lean on in our creations. Hence, we must engage in lucid deliberation about what is good for humans and about which institutions help us achieve the good. This lucid deliberation separates genuine politics from demagoguery or cynical politics.

Importantly, genuine deliberation does not merely concern the means to achieving a goal we assume we already know (as Aristotle had supposed in Ethics that our goal of “happiness” is a given and we only need to deliberate about the means to happiness). Rather, we must deliberate about the ends themselves as well as the means. As such, political existence can never arrive at a total, final conclusion. Since no set model of action is given to us (for example, politics cannot be modeled on what is natural or ecological, in accordance with evolution, and so forth), genuine politics cannot assume that any given condition or state of life determines which laws it should lay down for itself and which practices it should support or sanction. Rather, for Castoriadis, genuine politics is a way of life in which humans give the laws to themselves as they constantly re-engage in deliberation about what is good. In short, genuine politics coincides with the question, and the ability of individuals and society to pose the question, What is a good society? Societies and individuals who can genuinely pose this question are capable of autonomy, transcending the closure of the traditions and social conditioning in which they emerge. This capacity for autonomy depends not only on the individuals and society who actually give limits and laws to themselves, but also on those institutions on which individuals and society lean when creating those laws.

a. Heteronomy and Autonomy

In 1989’s “Done and To Be Done,” (Castoriadis Reader 361-417) Castoriadis restated some of the political arguments he had developed since his tenure with Socialisme ou Barbarie. He argued that the problem of traditions covering over the reality of creation (Section 3) is not merely a theoretical error; it also immediately coincides with closure in political and moral reality. All societies are self-creative and yet most, he argued, are utterly incapable of calling into question their own established norms. In such societies, the instituted situation immediately coincides without remainder with what is good and valid in the minds of the people. Such a society, which does not or cannot question its own norms or considers its norms to be given by God, gods, nature, history, ancestors, and so forth, is heteronomous in opposition to autonomous societies.

Castoriadis argued that heteronomy results when nature, essence, or existence are understood to produce the law for the creative living being, for individuals, or for society. On the one hand, Castoriadis’s definition of heteronomy was not limited to, nor did it target, religious beliefs in any special sense. Castoriadis’s examples were at times examples of religious beliefs and at other times examples of closed, but not necessarily religious, societies. In this way, the distinction cuts across any supposed divide between sacred and secular, such that even the most seemingly enlightened and anti-religious materialism could be a dominant instituted imaginary in a largely heteronomous society. In such a society, humans are continuously regenerated in a systematic state of closure. The necessary condition for the project of autonomy is, thus, the breaking of such instituted radical closure, i.e. the rupture of heteronomy.

On the other hand, what is essential for Castoriadis’s positive account of autonomy is that there is no law of nature that is pre-set for the human. That is, there is no substance or rule determining what a human qua human must be or can be. However, this is not to say that the human is nothing at all: The creativity of the human means that humans “cannot not posit norms” (Castoriadis Reader 375). As such, humans can always pose and repose the question of norms and of what they are to be; we can always in principle break away from a heteronomous condition. The radical creativity of the psyche and collectivity is never obliterated by a society or a set of social institutions, even if autonomy is de facto absent. Nevertheless, it is possible for heteronomous societies and individuals to largely cover over this creativity of the human, to institute norms that cannot, in a de facto sense, be called into question.

As a result, Castoriadis did not identify creation (or self-creation) with the moral and political project of autonomy. Rather, even heteronomous societies create themselves and are self-constituting. Autonomy exists only when we create “the institutions which, by being internalized by individuals, must facilitate their accession to their individual autonomy and their effective participation in all forms of explicit power existing in society” (Castoriadis Reader 405). Autonomy thus means not only that tradition can be questioned—i.e. that the question of the good can be posed—but also that we continue to make it de facto possible for ourselves to continue to ask, What is good? The latter requires that we establish institutional supports for autonomy.

For Castoriadis there is therefore an exigency to embrace autonomy in a sense not limited to the liberal ideal of non-coercive, negative freedom wherein coercion as such is depicted as evil (albeit, a necessary evil). Castoriadis argued that the object of genuine politics is to build a people who are capable of positive self-limitation. This self-limitation is not limited to weak suggestiveness; rather, autonomy “can be more than and different from mere exhortation if it is embodied in the creation of free and responsible individuals” (Castoriadis Reader 405). Castoriadis argued, against the liberal ideal, that the elimination of coercion cannot be a sufficient political goal, even if it is often a good thing. Rather, autonomous societies go beyond the negative-liberty project of un-limiting people. Autonomous communities create ways of explicitly, lucidly, and deliberately limiting themselves by establishing institutions through which individuals form their own laws for themselves and will therefore be formed as critical, self-critical, and autonomous. Only such institutions can make autonomy “effective” in a de facto way.

Finally, in defining what he meant by “effective” autonomy, Castoriadis distinguished his view of autonomy from Kant’s. In the Kantian perspective, he argued, the possibility of autonomy involves the possibility of acting freely in accordance with the universal law, itself established once and for all, apart from the influence of any other heteronomous incentives. Castoriadis argued that Kantianism treats autonomy itself as a goal or as something that we want simply for itself. Echoing Hegel, Castoriadis argued that Kantian autonomy ends up as a purely formal issue or a desire for autonomy for itself alone. Castoriadis, like Kant, did not deny the importance of the pursuit of autonomy for itself, with the full knowledge that the law of one’s action is not given from elsewhere. However, he added that we do not desire autonomy only for itself but also in order to be able to make, to do, and to institute. The formal, Kantian autonomy must also be made factual. “The task of philosophy,” he argued, “is not only to raise the question quid juris; that is just the beginning. Its task is to elucidate how right becomes fact and fact right—which is the condition for its existence, and is itself one of the first manifestations thereof” (Castoriadis Reader 404). As such, effective autonomy means that the will for autonomy itself as an “end” must also be a will for the de facto “means” to autonomy, namely the will to establish the institutions on which autonomy leans.

b. Democracy in Ancient Greece

In 1983’s “The Greek Polis and the Creation of Democracy” (Philosophy, Politics, Autonomy 81-123) Castoriadis argued that institutions of autonomy have appeared twice in history: in Athens in the fifth century B.C.E. and in Western Europe during the Enlightenment. Neither example serves as a model for emulation today in institutions. If we recall that the existence of autonomous institutions is never a sufficient condition for autonomy, we realize that there can be no question of treating historical cases as models to emulate. Rather, what makes these cases important, for Castoriadis, is that they are examples where, within societies that have instituted a strict closure, the closure is nevertheless ruptured, opened, and the people reflectively and deliberatively institute a radically new nomos, or law, for themselves.

Societies, argued Castoriadis, tend to institute strict closure: “In nearly all of the cultures that we know of, it is not merely that what is valid for each one is its institutions and its own tradition, but, in addition, for each, the others are not valid” (Post-Script on Insignificance 93). However, Castoriadis argued that Greece—in grasping that other societies do not mirror a nature found everywhere, but are radically creative of their own, unique institutions—also thereby grasped themselves as self-creative of their own institutions. The Greeks broke with their own established social closure and instituted “lucid self-legislation.” The Greek discovery of social self-creation (i.e. the social instituting power) led to the partial realization (institution) of autonomy precisely because they both effectively imagined their potential universality with others as an end (formal autonomy) and yet also established some particular institutions as supports for autonomy’s effective realization. Even so, the Greek creation remained partial and its institutions were limited and narrow (for example, they excluded women). Castoriadis’s point was that the potential universality of their creation (radical criticism and self-criticism), which they understood to be their own creation, coincided with the democratic institutions established as supports for rendering autonomy effective. In the end, the Greeks inaugurated a tradition of radical criticism that is, for Castoriadis, always something with which autonomy—and philosophy—begins.

c. Public, Private, and Agora

Castoriadis did not shy from suggesting some specific institutional characteristics that autonomous societies embrace. While he cautioned that there can be no a priori or final decision about what autonomous society should be, he proposed in “Done and To Be Done” (Castoriadis Reader 361-417) a classical, three-pronged institutional arrangement of society’s strata. These strata are:

ekklésia—the public/public

oikos—the private/private

agora—the public/private

In defining these terms, Castoriadis insisted that the first necessary condition of an autonomous society is the rendering open of the public/public sphere, or ekklésia. The task is to make self-institution by individuals and society explicit through the public consideration of the works and projects that commit the collectivity and the individual. The ekklésia is not a sphere of bureaucratic management of individuals by social architects; quite the opposite, it entails the establishment of institutions for public knowledge production and lawmaking, thus making possible an intellectual space for individuals to know and question laws in an informed way. Such considerations that affect individuals cannot, however, be left to the private/private or the public/private spheres; they must be undertaken by the collectivity together in public. There seems to be no requirement that the ekklésia occupy what we commonly call a physical place; rather, the site for knowing, deliberating about, and questioning the law is any space that “belongs to all (ta koina).” What is important is that the ekklésia involves the collectivity in a public deliberation about the goals and means of society and individuals.

Second, Castoriadis argued that an autonomous society will render the private/private sphere, or oikos, inviolable and independent of the other spheres. Individuals, families, and homes create themselves with institutions. That is, private life, as it creates itself, leans on an instituted fabric of society, a fabric the very continuation of which must be the subject of deliberation in the ekklésia. This fabric includes the institutions for education, basic criminal law, and other society-wide conditions. Bureaucratic communism or socialism, insofar as they destroy individual personality and private life, are to be abolished through the ekklésia’s efforts to support the independence and distinctness of the private/private sphere.

Third, Castoriadis defended the independence of the public/private, mixed sphere, i.e. the agora. His defense of the term the Greeks used for their marketplace has nothing to do with any defense of so-called free enterprise (i.e. merely negative liberty to exploit workers). Rather, the agora is where individuals (and not a particular set of individuals, as was the case in Athens, where citizen males alone participated) can group themselves in relation to others for purposes that are not explicitly questions pertaining to the public/public sphere. The independence of the agora as a mixed sphere would eliminate the possibility of forced collectivization of goods or the need for the abolition of money forms, which are still useful in the agoric sphere. The agoric sphere provides a kind of buffer between the tyrannies of the wholly public or wholly private set of interests, thus supporting the ongoing institution of autonomy as a whole.

For Castoriadis, each of the three institutional strata should be treated as a proper sphere of its own. They should not be collapsed into one sphere. “Autonomous society,” he wrote, “can only be composed of autonomous individuals” (World in Fragments 416). The preservation of each stratum is vital. Yet, on the one hand, the statist and bureaucratic societies of the twentieth century, despite their intentions of establishing a genuine public sphere, constantly collapsed the potential universality of the public/public sphere into a massive, all-inclusive private/private stratum, i.e. into a manipulative, bureaucratic society. On the other hand, the Western liberal democracies were more properly oligarchic, totalitarian-capitalist societies that happen to exist in a somewhat more fragmented and less total form than their statist counterparts. They too tend to collapse the public/public into private, bureaucratic, capitalist corporations. They thereby generate people who do not know the law and therefore cannot question it or effectively institute new laws. Thus, autonomy—while always in principle possible for us—is nevertheless factually foreclosed across most of the world, even to this day.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Book-Length Collections of Castoriadis’s Work in English

  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. A Society Adrift: Interviews and Debates, 1974–1997. Trans. Helen Arnold. New York: Fordham University Press, 2010.
    • This text contains full articles of a largely political tenor as well as occasional writings and interviews.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Crossroads in the Labyrinth. Trans. Martin H. Ryle and Kate Soper. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1984.
    • This text contains several important essays; however, it includes only a few of the essays to be found in the six-volume French title.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Figures of the Thinkable. Trans. Helen Arnold. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2007.
    • This text contains a variety of important articles, including important theoretical pieces, such as “Remarks on Space and Number.”
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. On Plato’s Statesman. Trans. David Ames Curtis. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2002.
    • Castoriadis provides a close and critical reading of the Plato dialogue while engaging with other Greek thinkers and sources. (Also, these lectures are only part of a larger collection of Castoriadis’s course materials, which are slowly being published in French).
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Philosophy, Politics, Autonomy. Essays in Political Philosophy. Trans. and Ed. David Ames Curtis. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1991.
    • This text is the best single collection of Castoriadis’s political works.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Political and Social Writings, Volume 1: 1946–1955. From the Critique of Bureaucracy to the Positive Content of Socialism. Trans. and Ed. David Ames Curtis. Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press, 1988.
    • These volumes collect many of Castoriadis’s political writings, from occasional pieces to the full-scale, multi-part articles from Socialisme ou Barbarie.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Political and Social Writings, Volume 2: 1955–1960. From the Workers’ Struggle against Bureaucracy to Revolution in the Age of Modern Capitalism. Trans. and Ed. David Ames Curtis. Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press, 1988.
    • This text contains “Modern Capitalism and Revolution,” and, along with Vol. 3, tracks the break with Marxism.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Political and Social Writings, Volume 3: 1961–1979. Recommencing the Revolution: From Socialism to the Autonomous Society. Trans. and Ed. David Ames Curtis. Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press, 1993.
    • This text, along with Vol. 2, tracks Castoriadis during his break with Marxism.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. Post-Script on Insignificance: Dialogues with Cornelius Castoriadis. Trans. Gabriel Rockhill and John V. Garner. New York: Continuum Press, 2011.
    • This text contains dialogues with Octavio Paz, Alain Connes, Francisco Varela, and others. A helpful introduction by Rockhill clarifies many concepts and offers criticism of some of Castoriadis’s historiographical assumptions.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. The Castoriadis Reader. Trans. and Ed. David Ames Curtis. New York: Blackwell Publishing, 1997.
    • This text is the most comprehensive single collection of Castoriadis’s work.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. The Imaginary Institution of Society. Trans. Kathleen Blamey. Cambridge: MIT Press, 1987.
    • This text is Castoriadis’s most famous single work and the second half contains Castoriadis’s most sustained single piece of writing.
  • Castoriadis, Cornelius. World in Fragments. Writings on Politics, Society, Psychoanalysis, and the Imagination. Trans. David Ames Curtis. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1997.
    • This text contains a helpful introduction by Curtis focusing on Castoriadis’s engagement with the history of science. It is the most comprehensive collection other than the Castoriadis Reader.

b. Secondary Readings (French and English)

  • Adams, S. Castoriadis’s Ontology: Being and Creation. New York: Fordham University Press, 2011.
    • In addition to this full-scale study of Castoriadis that situates his work in the context of continental philosophy and twentieth-century social thought, Adams has published several strong articles, focusing especially on Castoriadis’s notion of physis and trans-human creativity.
  • Bachofen, B., Elbaz, S., and Poirier, N. Ed. Cornelius Castoriadis: Réinventer l’autonomie. Paris: Éditions du Sandre, 2008.
    • This French-language text contains essays by several thinkers, including Edgar Morin, that focus on autonomy and ontology.
  • Bernstein, J. Recovering the Ethical Life: Jürgen Habermas and the Future of Critical Theory. London: Psychology Press, 1995.
    • Bernstein’s text includes a thoughtful chapter on Habermas’ criticism of Castoriadis.
  • Busino, G. Ed. Autonomie et Autotransformation de la Société. La Philosophie Militante de Cornelius Castoriadis. Geneva: Droz, 1989.
    • This text is a multilingual collection of essays on Castoriadis.
  • Callinicos, A. Trotskyism. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1990.
    • In one chapter Callinicos argues that Castoriadis initiates volunteerism in order to save revolutionary possibilities.
  • Elliott, A. Critical Visions: New Directions in Social Theory. Oxford: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc., 2003.
    • Elliott’s work, this text and several others, contains frequent references to Castoriadis.
  • Habermas, J. The Philosophical Discourse of Modernity: Twelve Lectures. Trans. Thomas McCarthy. Oxford and Cambridge: Polity and Blackwell Press, 1987.
    • Habermas makes a normative critique, challenging Castoriadis’s ability to value one imaginary over another. He also famously charges that Castoriadis posits a kind of self-producing social demiurge.
  • Honneth, A. “Rescuing the Revolution with an Ontology: On Cornelius Castoriadis’s Theory of Society” Thesis Eleven. Trans. Gary Robinson, Vol. 14. 1986. 62-78.
    • Honneth more or less follows Habermas’ criticism.
  • Joas, H. “Institutionalization as a Creative Process: The Sociological Importance of Cornelius Castoriadis’ss Political Philosophy,” Pragmatism and Social Theory. Trans. Raymond Meyer. Chicago and London: University of Chicago Press, 1993. 154-171.
    • This article provides a helpful review of Castoriadis’s work on language and articulation.
  • Kalyvas, A. “The Politics of Autonomy and the Challenge of Deliberation: Castoriadis contra Habermas.” Thesis Eleven. Vol. 64. Feb. 2001. 1-19.
    • Kalyvas defends Castoriadis against Habermas-style criticism.
  • Kavoulakos, K. “The Relationship of Realism and Utopianism in the Theories of Democracy of Jurgen Habermas and Cornelius Castoriadis.” Society and Nature. Vol. 6. Aug. 1994. 69-97.
    • Kavoulakos has published several essays on Castoriadis’s work.
  • Klooger, J., Castoriadis: Psyche, Society, Autonomy, Boston: Brill, 2009.
    • Klooger provides a critical, informed, and thoughtful review of all aspects of Castoriadis’s work, focusing on the later material, including the implications of Castoriadis’s work for physics and ontology. Especially helpful is his critical discussion of Castoriadis’s too-relativistic comments on physics, which, he argues, make it seem as if Newtonian mechanics corresponds to a stratum of being that it describes better than relativity does.
  • Klymis, S. and Van Eynde, L. L’Imaginaire selon Castoriadis. Thèmes et Enjeux. Brussels: Facultés Universitaire Sain-Louis et Bruxelles, 2006.
    • This text is a collection of essays in French on a variety of themes in Castoriadis’s work.
  • Leibowitz, M. Beyond Capital. New York: St. Martin’s Press, 1992.
    • This text contains a full-scale defense of Marx, as opposed to Castoriadis-style objections, by suggesting that Capital is one side of a larger dialectical picture: Marx intended to write a companion work from the standpoint of workers, rather than merely from the perspective of capitalists.
  • Poirier, N. L’ontologie Politique de Castoriadis: Création et Institution. Paris: Éditions Payot et Rivage, 2011.
    • Poirier interrogates Castoriadis’s theory of democratic institutions with a view to their openness to creativity. The work also contains helpful discussions of Castoriadis in relation to Marx’s view of praxis and Lefort’s critique of totalitarianism.
  • Rorty, R. “Unger, Castoriadis, and the Romance of a National Future” Critique and Construction: A Symposium on Roberto Unger’s Politics. Eds. Robin W. Lovin and Michael J. Perry. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1990. 29-45.
    • Rorty positively assesses the break with Marxism and briefly defends Castoriadis contra Habermas.
  • Stavrakakis, Y. The Lacanian Left: Psychoanalysis, Theory, Politics. Albany: SUNY Press, 2007.
    • Stavrakakis reads Castoriadis from a Lacanian perspective and attempts to mediate their differences.
  • Thesis Eleven. “Cornelius Castoriadis” Special Issue. Vol. 49. May 1997.
    • This issue of the Australian journal contains several helpful assessments of Castoriadis’s work by a variety of thinkers.

Author Information

John V. Garner
Email: jgarner@westga.edu
The University of West Georgia
U. S. A.

G. E. M. Anscombe (1919—2001)

G.E.M. AnscombeElizabeth Anscombe, or Miss Anscombe as she was known, was an important twentieth century philosopher and one of the most important women philosophers of all time.  A committed Catholic, and translator of some of Ludwig Wittgenstein’s most important work, she was an influential and original thinker in the Catholic tradition and the Wittgensteinian manner. Although she worked in almost every area of philosophy, she is best known to philosophers today for her work on ethics and the philosophy of action. Outside of philosophy she is best known for her conservative views on sexual ethics, which have inspired a number of student organizations, calling themselves the Anscombe Society, promoting chastity and traditional marriage. She is also well known for her opposition to the use of atomic weapons at the end of World War II.

In ethics, her most important work is the paper “Modern Moral Philosophy.” Contemporary interest in virtue theory can be traced directly to this paper, which put forward three theses: that all the major British moral philosophers from Henry Sidgwick on were essentially the same (that is, consequentialists); that the concepts of moral obligation, the use of the word ought with a special moral sense, and related notions, are harmful and should be dropped; and that we should stop doing moral philosophy until we have an adequate philosophy of psychology.

Her work on action, found mostly in her short book Intention, was a step in the direction of such a philosophy.

Table of Contents

  1. Life
  2. The First Person
  3. Causation
  4. Intention
  5. Consequentialism
  6. Moral Obligation
  7. Military Ethics
  8. Sexual Ethics
  9. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Works
    2. Secondary Works

1. Life

Gertrude Elizabeth Margaret Ancombe was born on March 18, 1919, in Limerick, Ireland. Her parents, Allen Wells Anscombe and Gertrude Elizabeth Anscombe (née Thomas), were British but living in Ireland because her father was serving there as an officer in the British Army. When they returned to Britain he was a schoolteacher, teaching science at Dulwich College in London. Anscombe herself went to Sydenham High School, graduating in 1937. While there she became interested in Catholicism and converted while still a teenager.

She studied classics and philosophy at St. Hugh’s College, Oxford, graduating with a First Class Honors degree in 1941. Later that year she married the philosopher Peter Geach, whom she had met in her first year at Oxford after a mass at Blackfriars. They went on to have seven children.

After another year at St. Hugh’s as a research student she moved to Newnham College, Cambridge, where she had a Research Fellowship. At Cambridge she met Ludwig Wittgenstein and attended his lectures, continuing to do so even after she had moved back to Oxford, to take up a Research Fellowship at Somerville College in 1946. She later had a Teaching Fellowship there until 1970, when she became the Professor of Philosophy at Cambridge University. She remained there until she retired from teaching in 1986.

Wittgenstein died in 1951, having named Anscombe as one of three literary executors of his estate. Her English translation of his Philosophical Investigations was published in 1953.

In 1956, because of President Truman’s having authorized the bombings of Hiroshima and Nagasaki, she publicly, but unsuccessfully, opposed Oxford University’s granting him an honorary degree. This was the beginning of the most fruitful period of her career, perhaps because she was driven by a sense of outrage that a man who had deliberately authorized the bombing of non-combatants could be so honored. Her book-length study of the nature of intentional action was published the following year, followed by the critical “Modern Moral Philosophy” the year after that.

Her inaugural lecture at Cambridge University in 1971 on “Causality and Determination” is now also regarded as something of a classic, and refers back to some points made in Intention.

She died in Cambridge on  January 5, 2001.

2. The First Person

In a typically Wittgensteinian way, Anscombe argued that some metaphysical theses are the result of our being misled by grammar. Her work on the first person singular is a good example of this way of dealing with philosophical problems. In her essay “The First Person,” Anscombe argues that the word I is not typically used to refer to an object, and so it does not refer to a non-physical soul or mind, but neither does it refer to a physical body. The word I is not a name I call myself. It is not a name at all, even though it can appear to be one.

If there is some question about who broke a vase then it is possible to make a mistake about who it was, and to be mistaken even about oneself having done it. For instance, you might think that you nudged it, but come to realize (perhaps after watching a video recording) that, although you came close, it was actually someone else who knocked it over. When we refer to a person we can, then, misidentify the person in question. But if I think to myself “I wonder what’s happening?” then no such misidentification is possible. This cannot be because I refers to my body and my body is always easy for me to identify, because one can misidentify whose body it was that did this or that. Anscombe points out that one could be in state of sensory deprivation and so quite unaware of one’s body (not of the fact that one has a body, of course, but of the body itself—ex hypothesi one’s awareness of one’s body, in this case, is temporarily non-existent). If I refers to anything that cannot be misidentified, in such a way that no mistake or failure of reference is possible, then it seems that René Descartes was right and I can only refer to a non-physical thinking thing, the “thinking that thinks this thought” (Anscombe 1981b, p. 31), which might not be the same thinking as thought any previous thoughts. According to Anscombe this is an absurdity that shows that I cannot be a referring expression at all.

The reason why David Hume sought unsuccessfully for his self (finding instead only a bundle of impressions and ideas) is that there is indeed no self, no thing to which I refers, because I does not refer to anything (not even a bundle). This is why there can be no misidentification: there is no identification at all, so it cannot go wrong. In order to say whether I am standing or not, I do not need (in normal circumstances) to look. According to Anscombe this is because I does not refer to anything I might see (or sense in any other way). Knowledge of what one is doing, like knowledge of one’s opinions, is non-observational. If it referred to an object, therefore, the object in question would have to be one that could be identified without being observed by means of the senses. The only way to avoid Cartesian absurdity, therefore, as Anscombe sees it, is to deny that the first person singular refers to anything at all. It is a word with a use but no reference. Failure to appreciate this grammatical feature, she holds, is what leads into the metaphysical mire of Descartes, Hume, and others who have speculated about the identity of the self.

3. Causation

Like Wittgenstein, Anscombe was concerned about the culture around her. Her work on causation is an attack on a conception of causality that, she says, “helps to form a cast of mind which is characteristic of our whole culture,” (Anscombe, p. 133). In this essay she rejects the then (and perhaps still) dominant view, which comes from Hume, that the cause of some effect must either necessitate it or else be connected to it by some law.  She does not deny that events are caused, but she does want to insist that it is usually possible for things to go awry.  An arsonist might use enough gasoline to burn down a house without the house’s burning down being necessitated by this act.  Something might happen to spoil his plans. And what this something might be cannot be specified in advance or in general, because it might be all kinds of things.  This means that any causal law linking a cause C with an effect E will have to be of the form: If C then E, other things being equal.  Very often other things are not equal, which is why the movement of the planets is relatively easy to predict but the movements of animals, for instance, are impossible to predict.  It is impossible in practice because we never have enough information about the animal’s environment (a squirrel might run by, throwing the animal off its course), brain chemistry (we simply do not know exactly how brains work yet), and so on, but it might also be impossible even in theory, given the effects of events at the quantum level.  These can, after all, spill over into the level of visible objects, since, to give one of Anscombe’s own examples, a Geiger counter could be connected to a bomb so that the bomb went off at some impossible-to-determine time, depending on ionizing radiation.  The explosion would then be caused but not in a way that could, even in principle, be predicted.

Similarly, Anscombe argues, if I contract a disease after having been exposed to it, then it is easy to see what caused my getting sick. But if all I knew was that I had been exposed to the disease then quite possibly no one would be able to tell whether I would become sick. It is much easier to trace an effect back to its cause than it is to read off the supposedly inevitable effects of any potential cause. We can therefore know that one thing caused another without knowing any true law involving a necessary connection between events of one general type and events of another.

It is sometimes said that one cannot observe causation, because we observe events but not the necessity with which we believe them to be connected. Anscombe objects that we do observe drinking, vocalizing, cutting, and breaking, and that these all appear to be kinds of causation. If a cat drinks some milk then the cat’s action caused the milk to leave the saucer. If a tailor cuts some cloth then it seems entirely possible to see the causing of the cloth’s being divided. Anyone who denies this, Anscombe suggests, does so on the basis of a prejudice or philosophical theory about observation and causality. They do not, as they might think, believe in the theory because unbiased reflection on experience tells us that this kind of theory is true.

4. Intention

If every bit of human behavior were determined by causal laws, then it might seem that the difference between intended and unintended results of action could not possibly matter. For if determinism is true, some people think, then we are not free to act one way or another and assigning responsibility for actions makes no sense. In that case, it looks as though only consequences could matter. Anscombe rejects both determinism and consequentialism. Her book Intention aims to shed light on the concept of intention, and hence on (intentional) action, and the difference between intentional, rational action and non-rational behavior. Although not easy to understand, it has been enormously influential. Donald Davidson, for instance, has called it the most important philosophical work on action since Aristotle.

All manner of movements occur in the world, but only some are counted as the behavior of agents.  In turn, only some of this behavior is counted as action.  For instance, I might toss and turn in my sleep, and this would normally be reckoned as human behavior, but no one would think to ask me why I rolled over at some particular time or twitched my leg just so. In a sense these are not things that I did. My leg twitched, my body moved, but I really had no say in the matter and so would have no answer to a question about my reason for moving in these ways. I might be able to explain the cause, but I would be in no better a position than anyone else to do so, unless I happen to be some sort of expert on human physiology. Action is not like this: it does make sense to ask someone why they did what they did.  In asking such a question we are typically asking about their intention, that is, what did they take themselves to be doing and what was their purpose in doing it.  In a sense, then, questions about intention are questions about the meaning of actions.  This sets them apart from questions about causes, since I might not know what caused me to sleep so restlessly but I cannot be so ignorant of my intentions.  I could hypothesize that dehydration caused me to sleep badly, but if I get up to drink some water then it is no hypothesis on my part that I am heading to the kitchen to get something to drink.  Nor is it a prediction about what I expect to happen once I reach the kitchen.  It is a statement of fact about what I am doing right now: going to the kitchen to drink some water.  Other descriptions of my behavior might be equally true.  For instance, that I am putting one foot in front of the other, making the floorboards creak, and so on.  But the statement of my intention, of what I take myself to be doing, is likely to be the most illuminating for anyone who wants to understand what I am doing (which is closely related to the question of why I am doing it).  If I am failing to achieve my goal it might be even more helpful to know what that goal was, since it will not be so clearly visible as it is in the cases in which I do achieve it.

The “class of intentional actions is a sub-class,” according to Anscombe, of “the class of things known without observation,” (Anscombe 2000, p. 14). Intentional actions are ones done for some reason, actions about which it makes sense to ask “Why?” and expect an answer that is not merely causal but explains what significance the action was taken to have for the agent. The intention is not itself a cause because causes (for example, a brick’s striking a window) are distinct from their effects (for example, the window’s breaking), whereas intentional actions are not distinct from the intentions they embody. To see this point more clearly, imagine a climber who loses the will to live and so lets go of the rock and falls to his death. This was intentional, an act of suicide. Now imagine that he simply loses his grip and falls. This is unintentional and not suicide but a tragic accident. Now imagine that he has a momentary suicidal impulse. Shocked by this thought he loses concentration and lets go, falling to his death. This fall was caused by a thought of suicide, perhaps even by an intention to commit suicide, but it was an accident still, caused by a shock rather than carried out deliberately. So intentional actions are not behavior caused by intentions. The intention is a part or an aspect of the act, not a prior event that causes it.

An accidental fall will not be judged morally by anyone, but some people regard suicide as a sin. Similarly, in general, we tend to think of unintentional behavior as largely irrelevant to ethics, while intentional actions are precisely what ethics is often taken to be about. This is one reason why it matters what intention is and how intentional actions are understood. Another is that, since intentional actions are so closely linked to the question “Why?”, understanding intention helps us to understand what goes on around us. Generally people act for reasons, and these reasons have to do with what seems good to the agents in question. Not everything that seems good really is good, of course, but not just anything can even seem good. If someone’s reason for acting is to get all his green books up on a roof then, in knowing this reason, we gain no understanding of why he is behaving as he does. His behavior is as unintelligible as it would have been if we had not been told his reason. So the behavior of our fellow human beings is only intelligible if we can and do relate it to a certain limited range of ideas about what might be regarded as good. We can see here some of the connection that Anscombe believes to exist between metaphysical questions and ethical ones.

Perhaps this explains why intentions matter, but what are intentions? We might think of them as mental objects, states, or events that give rise to certain types of behavior, but Anscombe rejects this view. If an intention were a mental object or event that caused actions in roughly the way that a falling domino causes another domino to fall then it would appear to be quite possible to be ignorant of one’s own intentions. I might try to guess at or hypothesize about the intention that caused me to do this or that, but perhaps only some kind of brain scan would ever settle the matter. And perhaps we are wrong sometimes about our intentions, especially if we forget or have subconscious motivations. Nevertheless it seems implausible to suggest that we do not normally know exactly what our intentions are. We intend to go to the grocery store and, sure enough, that is precisely what we do.

Another problem with the idea that intentions are causes is that there seems to be no reason in theory why what acts as a cause in one person could not do so in another, but this does not appear to be the case with intentions. One cannot intend to do something of which one has no conception, but one could (at least in principle) be caused to do such a thing. An infant cannot intend to open the New York Stock Exchange but, if the opening is done by ringing a bell, then it can be caused to do it, either by moving the baby’s hand or by some chain of events within its brain. It might just on its own intend to ring the bell, but it would not be intending to open the day’s financial dealings. It has no idea that there are such things as financial dealings.

If we want to understand other people’s behavior, then, not only can we not look at the causes of their behavior (since, for one thing, we cannot see inside their brains) but trying to do so would be a mistake. We need to know what they take themselves to be doing, how they understand their actions. And this knowledge does not come from observation of their own behavior. We know without looking what it is that we take ourselves to be doing, what we are trying to achieve, and so on. In this sense we know what we are doing even if in fact something is going wrong and we are not getting done what we mean to be getting done. For instance, someone might intend to write Anscombe’s name on a chalkboard. Imagine that, unbeknownst to her, the board has recently been washed and no chalk will adhere to it. Without looking at what she is writing, she goes ahead and writes “Anscombe” on the board. Or so she thinks. In fact, nothing is being written. In a sense, then, she is not writing at all and if she thinks she is then she is wrong. On the other hand, she is doing something. And the best way to understand what this is would be to ask her and have her answer sincerely, “I am writing Anscombe on the board.” We would then understand why she is holding a piece of chalk and moving her hand in just that way. (If she were to say that she was trying to write Anscombe on the board this might be more accurate, but it would also be misleading. It would suggest that she knew the task would not be easy and was perhaps pushing the chalk harder than normal in order to try to get the chalk to stick to it. But she is not trying in this sense, any more than we ordinarily try to do the things we do. We just do them.) In this sense, then, we know what we are doing because we know our intentions, and we do not have to look and see what we are doing to have this knowledge.

It is possible to act badly because of having a bad intention, of course, but it is also possible, as the example of writing on a wet chalkboard shows, for action to go wrong because of errors in execution. This is part of the point of Anscombe’s famous shopping list example (see Anscombe 2000, p. 56).  A shopping list acts as a kind of expression of what I intend to buy, or of what someone else has asked me to buy. The only kind of mistake I can make in using it (assuming that the list itself is correct) is if I overlook or misread something on the list and thus fail to buy it. This is a mistake in execution. If there is a mismatch between what I buy and what is on the list, in other words, then I have done my shopping badly. It is not that there is some flaw in the list. On the other hand, if someone else follows me and writes down everything I buy, but his list does not match what I buy, then there is a flaw in his list. So his list can be wrong in a way that mine cannot be. If now instead of a list written on paper we think of a list in my head, then we can see that my knowledge of what I am to buy cannot be falsified by how the facts turn out (for example, that I forget to buy tomatoes). That was a mistake in execution, not in intention. Unlike the man following me, I know what I intend to do, know what I am doing, without having to observe my behavior.

5. Consequentialism

Because, as she sees it, actions can be bad and can be known to be bad without observing them or their results, Anscombe rejects a large class of theories about ethics. One of her main contributions to ethics is the introduction of the word consequentialism as a label for these theories, along with an account of their alleged shortcomings. Consequentialism is the denial that there is any significant moral difference between results of action that are brought about intentionally and those that are foreseen but not intended. It might be thought of as the theory that intention is unimportant in ethics. Anscombe seems to have opposed this kind of theory for several reasons, which we will explore below. The word consequentialism is often used as a kind of technical synonym for utilitarianism, but it was coined by Anscombe (in “Modern Moral Philosophy”) precisely to distinguish a certain kind of moral theory from utilitarianism.  She apparently believed that neither Jeremy Bentham nor John Stuart Mill had a coherent moral philosophy, since each relied heavily on what she regarded as a hopelessly simplistic notion of happiness or pleasure.

Her main objection to consequentialism is a moral one. If all that matters is results, then there is no limit to what we might do in order to achieve the best results possible. In order to save the lives of many of our soldiers we might, for instance, murder a bunch of children. This is basically what she believed had been done in Hiroshima and Nagasaki, and it is unthinkable from her moral perspective. Indeed, it would have been unthinkable from the point of view of all major moral philosophers, including utilitarian ones, before Sidgwick. At least so she believes. Why she thinks this is not entirely clear, but Mill has certainly appeared to be a rule-utilitarian to some people, and rule-utilitarians typically defend rules forbidding murder. Perhaps Anscombe read Mill in this kind of way (she does not say). Another possibility is that she regards consequentialism as so unacceptable that it would be uncharitable to read anyone as holding it if their views are at all ambiguous. Mill’s views are certainly open to a variety of interpretations. What is clear is that Anscombe regarded the utilitarianism of Bentham and Mill as fatally flawed because it advocates the greatest happiness of the greatest number without (in her view) adequately specifying what is meant by happiness and without realizing (in her view) that “the greatest happiness of the greatest number” makes no sense (see Anscombe 1981a, p. 129).  She does not fully explain why she thinks this to be the case, but people have wondered whether the concern is, or should be, with the best happiness or the most, and of living people or all living sentient creatures or all future sentient creatures or what, and how one might measure happiness at all. So she might have thought that utilitarianism simply does not name an identifiable theory at all.

Another problem with consequentialism is its ignoring of intention, without which we seemingly cannot make sense of human behavior. This means that, while we can indeed pass judgment on actions in a consequentialist way, we cannot consistently live as if consequentialism were true. We cannot, that is, live our whole lives as if intentions do not matter, even though we can pretend that they do not when deciding what to do or expressing approval or disapproval of actions. Consequentialists then are almost inevitably in bad faith. They pretend to believe what they cannot and do not in fact believe.

6. Moral Obligation

Before “Modern Moral Philosophy” was published, the main kind of ethical theory other than utilitarianism to which philosophers adhered was Kantian deontology, which, in its purest form, says that certain acts are forbidden or permissible, regardless of their consequences. Anscombe questions who or what might be supposed to do the forbidding or permitting in question.  Traditionally (as she sees it) the answer was God.  But many philosophers, even religious ones, do not want to import faith in God into their theories.  So what could be meant by a theory, conceived as independent of faith in God, according to which some acts are allowed or right or even obligatory while others are forbidden or wrong?  One cannot meaningfully obligate oneself, Anscombe believes, and the idea that something like society or the government is doing the allowing here is not what is wanted by people who theorize in this way.  Anscombe’s conclusion is that talk of moral obligation, moral duty, a special moral sense of the word ought, and so on, are in fact meaningless.

This is not to say that all talk of obligation and the rest should be dropped. Indeed, Anscombe writes that we ought not to try to drop such talk.  By this, of course, she means that it would be a bad idea to try to do so.  But by bad here she means that it would not be prudent or sensible.  She does not mean bad in some allegedly special or uniquely moral sense.

It is sometimes thought that Anscombe is saying that only religious believers are entitled to talk or think about moral obligation or what one morally ought to do. This is not the case. Her claim is rather that philosophers often use words such as morally ought in a way that makes no sense. She is not forbidding anything. She quite explicitly is not forbidding the use of the word ought. Nor would she forbid the use of the words morally ought in some situations. For instance, if a vegetarian tells you that you ought not to eat an underdone piece of chicken it might be unclear whether she is speaking about ethics or about food safety, and you might quite reasonably (in Anscombe’s view) ask whether she means ought in a moral sense or just the normal, prudential sense.

What Anscombe objects to is a secular use of religious concepts (not mere words). There is a religious tradition according to which certain kinds of action are commanded and others are forbidden by God. Within this tradition, the human race has an historical relationship with God, in which various promises have been made, covenants agreed to, and so on. It makes sense, therefore, to talk within this tradition of being bound or obliged to do this or that. It makes no sense, however, to think that one is equally bound in just the same way if this tradition is rejected or bracketed, set aside, for philosophical purposes. It is at best misleading, therefore, if anyone means to do philosophy in a religiously non-committal way but still asks what acts are forbidden, sinful, permissible, and so on. One problem with such language is that it seems to imply the very religious framework that is explicitly disavowed by the philosophers in question who use it.

Another is that it is so imprecise. For instance, if an atheist philosopher argues that abortion is permissible not only are we likely to be thrown by her religious-sounding choice of words, but we also do not know whether by permissible she means just, or likely to promote utility, or rational, or what. Anscombe’s argument is that such philosophers ought instead to use words such as just. This way we will have a much better idea what is being said. Judith Jarvis Thomson’s famous defense of abortion, for example, makes clear that she is talking about the justice of abortion, whether it violates the rights of the fetus, not whether it is callous or indecent, say. This is the kind of clarification that Anscombe recommends.

Sometimes, she adds, it will be immediately clear whether what is being said is true or false if we use more precise terms of moral evaluation such as just and unjust. Whether abortion is just is not immediately clear to many people, but the injustice of the judicial execution of those known to be innocent is clear. This is the example that Anscombe uses most often. The suggestion that deliberately killing tens of thousands of innocent non-combatants, including children, would be permissible is a vague one. The suggestion that it would be just is clearly false. The suggestion that it would be useful might be clearly true. If we used the more precise terms just and useful then we could at least see that the debate was between the relative importance of justice and utility. If we insist on using words such as permissible and wrong then we might fail to understand what is at issue. It is largely clarity that Anscombe urges philosophers to strive for.

Her rejection of both consequentialism and obligation-centered deontological ethical theories has been a major reason for the rise of virtue ethics. That being said, it is worth repeating that Anscombe does not reject all talk of moral obligation. For instance, if I make a promise or sign a contract then this brings certain obligations with it. In the case of promising, we might call this a moral obligation, to distinguish it from the kind of legal obligation that a contract might create. This kind of obligation is not absolute in the way that some people think the obligation not to commit murder is, however. Only the person who happens to have made a promise is obligated by it, for one thing. For another, promises can reasonably be ignored in exceptional circumstances. Thirdly, promising itself is a useful but not necessarily essential human practice. It is, Anscombe thinks, only against the background, or within the context, of this kind of practice that saying “I promise to do x” binds the speaker to do x. (In contrast, she regards murder as forbidden to all people in all circumstances.)

This relates to the easily misunderstood notion of what Anscombe calls brute facts. In her essay “On Brute Facts” she writes: “In relation to many descriptions of events or states of affairs which are asserted to hold, we can ask what the ‘brute facts’ were; and this will mean the facts which held, and in virtue of which, in a proper context, such-and-such a description is true or false, and which are more ‘brute’ than the alleged facts answering to that description” (Anscombe 1981a, p. 24). Take the state of affairs that, I assert, you owe me money. The brute facts in such a case would be the ones that make it true (if it is true) that you owe me money. For instance, my having given you money last week and your having promised to pay me back would be brute facts in this case. Anscombe is explicit that the context is relevant and that exceptional circumstances can always make a difference. It looks straightforward that if I loaned you money and you promised to pay it back then you owe me money, but you might not owe me anything if we were both clearly joking when the loan was made, or if I have died and left no family behind, or if the planet is about the be destroyed by meteors, or ….

So brute facts are, by definition, always brute relative to some description of an event or state of affairs. Brute here does not mean absolute as opposed to relative. Furthermore, while brute facts make descriptions true, they do so only other things being equal. Other things can fail to be equal in innumerable, unforeseeable ways, and so obligations of this kind can never be said to be absolute in the sense of being without exception. Nevertheless, in normal circumstances, if you have promised to do something then you really are obliged to do it, just as in chess bishops really do have to move diagonally (if at all) and, in the United States, cars really do have to drive on the right hand side of the road. These obligations are real and important even though the rules might be different (for example, in Great Britain cars drive on the left) and even though, in certain circumstances, they might be ignored (for example, you are rushing to a hospital and no other vehicles are on the road so no one cares what side you drive on, or the world is coming to an end so no one cares about anything much at all). Certain practices have rules and these rules oblige us to behave in certain ways, but a) exceptions can be made within the practices themselves, and b) there is no obligation (although there may be good reason) to engage in these practices in the first place. In this sense the obligation to keep a promise is not an absolute obligation.

This is not to say, however, that there are no absolutes in ethics. Certainly Anscombe believes that murder is never justified. If there is an obligation not to commit murder then it does not stem from our having chosen to engage in some human practice that forbids it. Anscombe might say that we must not murder because God has forbidden it. Or she might regard it as ruled out by considerations of justice. Or by a mystical perception of the value of human life. In “Murder and the Morality of Euthanasia” she writes that, “The prohibition [on murder] is so basic that it is difficult to answer the question as to why murder is intrinsically wrongful” (Anscombe 2005, p. 266). Her use of the word prohibition, however, suggests that she is thinking of murder as something forbidden by God. Given her thoughts on the notion of moral obligation, after all, we might surely ask who else might prohibit it? Whether this speculation about her meaning is right or not, she clearly does regard the intentional killing of the innocent as prohibited, and this is hugely relevant to her thinking about both the ethics of warfare and sexual ethics.

7. Military Ethics

Anscombe’s first philosophical publication was a pamphlet of which she was joint author (with Norman Daniel) protesting at the prospect of the Second World War in 1939. In her view this war was likely to be fought for unjust reasons and with unjust means.  According to her interpretation of the rules and of the statements of the relevant politicians, traditional rules of war would be broken by the British Government if it went to war with Germany.  This was not, of course, a reflection of Anscombe’s attitude toward Nazi Germany.  Some war against that country might have been justified, but not the war that she saw coming, with, for instance, its attacks on civilians.

She continued her support for traditional Christian thinking about military ethics after the war was over. Most notably, she led the protest against Oxford University’s decision to award an honorary degree to the man who ordered the use of atomic weapons against Japan, President Harry S. Truman. In her essay on “War and Murder,” she defends the so-called Doctrine of Double Effect and rejects pacifism.  Despite having such high standards that she opposed even the British fight against the Nazis, Anscombe stops short of all out pacifism because she thinks that one’s moral standards should be high but not too high.  Pacifism calls for no use of violence ever, no matter what, which is an ideal that many people can claim to respect but that very few can live with.  The result, as she sees it, is that they pay lip service to the ideal of pacifism, go to war anyway, and then see no reason to observe any restrictions whatever on how the war is fought.  In this way pacifism actually does harm.

The Doctrine of Double Effect points out that actions can be regarded as having two kinds of foreseen effects: the intended and the not intended (merely foreseen).  It allows actions that have bad foreseen effects so long as these are not intended, so long as the actions themselves are not forbidden, and so long as the likely good consequences of the action outweigh its likely bad consequences.  In any war we can foresee that innocent people will be killed in cases of friendly fire and collateral damage, for example.  And killing the innocent is often regarded as forbidden.  It does not follow, Anscombe argues, that we must be pacifists.  Causing some collateral damage does not make one a murderer as long as one is engaged in a just war, fighting justly, (intentionally) targeting only legitimate military targets, and not launching attacks whose effects are likely to be more bad than good.

Critics of the doctrine sometimes object that one can make an otherwise forbidden act all right by simply redescribing it in one’s mind. For instance, one might claim to be intending to lower enemy morale by destroying a city and merely to foresee that innocent people in the city would be killed. One thing that this ignores, however, is that an intention is not a mental act, like a kind of whispering under one’s breath. In normal circumstances, one does what one intends, so the intention is observable in the physical world. Referees can call intentional fouls without having to be mind-readers. Saying “oops” or “I think I’ll just stretch my leg” in one’s head as one trips an opponent does not make the foul less intentional. So this criticism seems to be misguided. (It is true, though, Anscombe notes, that some people do try to abuse the doctrine by treating intention in this misguided kind of way.)

Perhaps more serious is Jonathan Glover’s objection that blowing up a passenger ferry bound for Nazi-occupied territory with both innocent people and the means for making an atomic bomb on it would have to count as intentional murder, and therefore forbidden, even though the consequences of allowing the ferry to reach its destination might be disastrous (see his Humanity: A Moral History of the Twentieth Century, Yale University Press, 2001, p. 108). The temptation to think like a consequentialist in such cases is rather strong. Anscombe might reply, however, that the actual goal in this case is preventing the Nazis from acquiring atomic weapons. So the deaths of the passengers, though certainly foreseen, are really not what is intended. Hence the sinking of the ferry might well turn out to be permissible after all. Unlike the case of terror bombing, where the desired terror would not have been created without innocent deaths, the ferry could have been sunk without the loss of innocent life (if no one had been on it).

8. Sexual Ethics

Anscombe was a devout Catholic.  She opposed abortion, contraception, gay sex, and gay marriage.  Her view of abortion was not that it was murder but that it was either murder or something very nearly as bad as murder. (Whether it actually is murder depends on whether a fetus is a person or has a soul and, if so, at what stage, which Anscombe regarded as a technical question of little but academic interest.)  It is, she believed, the deliberate destruction of the beginning of a human life. Sex, the means of this beginning, is something that she regarded as naturally associated with shame. Not in the sense that people who have sex ought to be ashamed of themselves or feel guilty, but in the sense that it is the kind of thing that belongs to one’s private life. We would no more have sex casually than we would leave home naked casually. This is because we recognize, however dimly, that sex is, to put it bluntly, a big deal. And this is connected with the fact that sex is how babies are made, and the fact that the life of a baby is a big deal. These connections should not be taken as steps in a logical argument, however, as if we can know by reasoning straightforwardly from the value of human life that casual sex is wrong. In her essay “Contraception and Chastity,” Anscombe says that our knowledge that casual sex dishonors the body is a “mystical perception,” much like the perception that a dead human body is not something one should leave out with the trash (Anscombe 2008, p. 187). She says in this essay also that there is no such thing as casual sex and that everyone knows this. That is, there are no sexual acts that are not significant, and those who pretend otherwise become shallow. She does not claim to be able to prove this though.

Contraception is not quite the same as abortion, but it is bad in a related way, she thinks.  She distinguishes between two kinds of sexual intercourse: the kind that is intended to be non-procreative and the kind that is not so intended.  Any sexual act that never could lead to procreation, such as masturbation, is in the former category, and so is sex using contraception.  Sexual acts that could lead to procreation but that will not because at least one partner is naturally infertile fall in the latter category.  Acts of the first type are abuses of our generative organs, treating as mere vehicles of pleasure the very means to bring new life into the world.  Acts of the second type, on the other hand, are perfectly all right, so long as one does not make a point of only having sex when one knows that pregnancy is impossible, one does not get too addicted to sexual pleasure, and one has sex only within marriage as traditionally defined, so that any children will likely have a father and a mother to take care of them.

In her opinion, gay sex is wrong then in exactly the same way, and for the same reason, that masturbation is wrong.  It is a use of the sexual organs that can never lead to procreation, and thus a kind of insult to life itself.  Gay marriage is a union founded on an agreement to engage in this kind of activity, and is hence unacceptable.

Anscombe suggests that masturbators and gay people are bound to be unhappy, and critics have responded with examples of gay people who seem, on the contrary, to have flourished. This might be a point worth making, but it misses the central claim in her argument. This is that unnatural kinds of sex, those that embody an intention to have sex without the possibility of conception, fail to show the proper regard for life. The real problem this argument faces, whether one supports it or not, is the seemingly inescapable vagueness of the notion of proper regard. This vagueness exists within Anscombe’s beliefs about how much sex married couples should have. They should, she thinks, have some, but not too much. And she struggles to specify how much is too much. They should not be addicted to sex, she apparently thinks, but should “render the marriage debt” to one another (Anscombe 1981a, p. 92). One need not doubt that there is such a thing as proper respect for life, or for sex, in order to doubt how precisely one can make out what exactly falls within the limits of such regard and what does not.

As for gay marriage, similarly, Anscombe argues that only if a marriage is of the kind that could lead to children being brought into the world (that is, if it is a heterosexual marriage, even if one or both partners is known to be infertile) is its beginning an event worthy of ceremony. And, she implies, if its beginning is not an event worthy of ceremony then it is not a proper marriage. It is hard to see exactly how this kind of view can avoid regarding infertile marriages as somehow belonging to a second class. It is also hard to see how one could ever work out exactly which events are worthy of ceremony (and how much, and of what kind) in the first place. Some critics have argued that if Anscombe is right then this or that bad consequence would follow. The problem appears to be more that nothing at all follows with any clarity from her premises, whether one accepts them or not. This is not to say that Anscombe is wrong to believe that ceremony is in order at a wedding. What it is to say is that the perception that ceremony is in order is not the kind of perception that is readily testable or precisely measurable. In a word it is subjective or, as Anscombe sometimes puts it, mystical. When mystical perception is not universal it is hard to use it as the basis for arguments over controversial subjects.

9. References and Further Reading

Anscombe’s translations of, and commentaries on, works by Wittgenstein are certainly important, but will not be listed here. The same goes for her other work in the history of philosophy. The following bibliography is not intended to be comprehensive but rather is meant as an introductory guide.

a. Primary Works

  • Anscombe, G. E. M. Ethics, Religion and Politics: Collected Philosophical Papers Volume III. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1981a
    • Includes “Modern Moral Philosophy,” “On Brute Facts,” “War and Murder,” and “Mr Truman’s Degree.”
  • Anscombe, G. E. M. Faith in a Hard Ground: Essays on Religion, Philosophy and Ethics by G. E. M. Anscombe, edited by Mary Geach and Luke Gormally. Exeter, UK: Imprint Academic, 2008.
    • Includes the well known essay “Contraception and Chastity.”
  • Anscombe, G. E. M. Human Life, Action and Ethics: Essays by G. E. M. Anscombe, edited by Mary Geach and Luke Gormally. Exeter, UK: Imprint Academic, 2005.
    • Includes the essay “Does Oxford Moral Philosophy Corrupt Youth?”
  • Anscombe, G. E. M. Intention. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2000.
    • Extremely important for understanding contemporary philosophy of action and much of Anscombe’s work generally.
  • Anscombe, G. E. M. Metaphysics and the Philosophy of Mind: Collected Philosophical Papers Volume II. Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1981b.
    • A good place to start with Anscombe’s work in metaphysics. Includes “The First Person,” “Causality and Determination,” and a short essay on “Intention.”

b. Secondary Works

Some of Anscombe’s work, especially the essays dealing with sexual and military ethics, was written for a general audience. The rest of it, however, can be very hard going, even for professional philosophers. Useful secondary sources include:

  • Diamond, Cora and Jenny Teichman, eds. Intention and Intentionality: Essays in Honour of G. E. M. Anscombe. Brighton, UK: The Harvester Press, 1979.
    • Includes essays on the first person, intention, ethics (including both military and sexual ethics), and other issues addressed by Anscombe.
  • Ford, Anton, Jennifer Hornsby, and Frederick Stoutland, eds. Essays on Anscombe’s Intention. Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 2011.
  • O’Hear, Anthony, ed. Modern Moral Philosophy. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2004.
    • A collection of essays relating, sometimes indirectly, to Anscombe’s famous essay.
  • Richter, Duncan Anscombe’s Moral Philosophy Lanham, Maryland: Lexington Books, 2011.
    • An introduction to Anscombe’s theoretical and practical work in ethics.
  • Teichmann, Roger, ed. Logic, Cause and Action: Essays in Honour of Elizabeth Anscombe. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2000.
    • A short collection of essays on various aspects of Anscombe’s work.
  • Teichmann, Roger The Philosophy of Elizabeth Anscombe. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2008.
    • The only book length study of the whole of Anscombe’s work.

 

Author Information

Duncan Richter
Email: richterdj@vmi.edu
Virginia Military Institute
U. S. A.

The Sophists (Ancient Greek)

The sophists were itinerant professional teachers and intellectuals who frequented Athens and other Greek cities in the second half of the fifth century B.C.E. In return for a fee, the sophists offered young wealthy Greek men an education in aretē (virtue or excellence), thereby attaining wealth and fame while also arousing significant antipathy. Prior to the fifth century B.C.E., aretē was predominately associated with aristocratic warrior virtues such as courage and physical strength. In democratic Athens of the latter fifth century B.C.E., however, aretē was increasingly understood in terms of the ability to influence one’s fellow citizens in political gatherings through rhetorical persuasion; the sophistic education both grew out of and exploited this shift. The most famous representatives of the sophistic movement are Protagoras, Gorgias, Antiphon, Hippias, Prodicus and Thrasymachus.

The historical and philological difficulties confronting an interpretation of the sophists are significant. Only a handful of sophistic texts have survived and most of what we know of the sophists is drawn from second-hand testimony, fragments and the generally hostile depiction of them in Plato’s dialogues.

The philosophical problem of the nature of sophistry is arguably even more formidable. Due in large part to the influence of Plato and Aristotle, the term sophistry has come to signify the deliberate use of fallacious reasoning, intellectual charlatanism and moral unscrupulousness. It is, as the article explains, an oversimplification to think of the historical sophists in these terms because they made genuine and original contributions to Western thought. Plato and Aristotle nonetheless established their view of what constitutes legitimate philosophy in part by distinguishing their own activity – and that of Socrates – from the sophists. If one is so inclined, sophistry can thus be regarded, in a conceptual as well as historical sense, as the ‘other’ of philosophy.

Perhaps because of the interpretative difficulties mentioned above, the sophists have been many things to many people. For Hegel (1995/1840) the sophists were subjectivists whose sceptical reaction to the objective dogmatism of the presocratics was synthesised in the work of Plato and Aristotle. For the utilitarian English classicist George Grote (1904), the sophists were progressive thinkers who placed in question the prevailing morality of their time. More recent work by French theorists such as Jacques Derrida (1981) and Jean Francois-Lyotard (1985) suggests affinities between the sophists and postmodernism.

This article provides a broad overview of the sophists, and indicates some of the central philosophical issues raised by their work. Section 1 discusses the meaning of the term sophist. Section 2 surveys the individual contributions of the most famous sophists. Section 3 examines three themes that have often been taken as characteristic of sophistic thought: the distinction between nature and convention, relativism about knowledge and truth and the power of speech. Finally, section 4 analyses attempts by Plato and others to establish a clear demarcation between philosophy and sophistry.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. The Sophists
    1. Protagoras
    2. Gorgias
    3. Antiphon
    4. Hippias
    5. Prodicus
    6. Thrasymachus
  3. Major Themes of Sophistic Thought
    1. Nature and Convention
    2. Relativism
    3. Language and Reality
  4. The Distinction Between Philosophy and Sophistry
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources
    3. Other Reading

1. Introduction

The term sophist (sophistēs) derives from the Greek words for wisdom (sophia) and wise (sophos). Since Homer at least, these terms had a wide range of application, extending from practical know-how and prudence in public affairs to poetic ability and theoretical knowledge. Notably, the term sophia could be used to describe disingenuous cleverness long before the rise of the sophistic movement. Theognis, for example, writing in the sixth century B.C.E., counsels Cyrnos to accommodate his discourse to different companions, because such cleverness (sophiē) is superior to even a great excellence (Elegiac Poems, 1072, 213).

In the fifth century B.C.E. the term sophistēs was still broadly applied to ‘wise men’, including poets such as Homer and Hesiod, the Seven Sages, the Ionian ‘physicists’ and a variety of seers and prophets. The narrower use of the term to refer to professional teachers of virtue or excellence (aretē) became prevalent in the second half of the fifth century B.C.E., although this should not be taken to imply the presence of a clear distinction between philosophers, such as Socrates, and sophists, such as Protagoras, Gorgias and Prodicus. This much is evident from Aristophanes’ play The Clouds (423 B.C.E.), in which Socrates is depicted as a sophist and Prodicus praised for his wisdom.

Aristophanes’ play is a good starting point for understanding Athenian attitudes towards sophists. The Clouds depicts the tribulations of Strepsiades, an elderly Athenian citizen with significant debts. Deciding that the best way to discharge his debts is to defeat his creditors in court, he attends The Thinkery, an institute of higher education headed up by the sophist Socrates. When he fails to learn the art of speaking in The Thinkery, Strepsiades persuades his initially reluctant son, Pheidippides, to accompany him. Here they encounter two associates of Socrates, the Stronger and the Weaker Arguments, who represent lives of justice and self-discipline and injustice and self-indulgence respectively. On the basis of a popular vote, the Weaker Argument prevails and leads Pheidippides into The Thinkery for an education in how to make the weaker argument defeat the stronger. Strepsiades later revisits The Thinkery and finds that Socrates has turned his son into a pale and useless intellectual. When Pheidippides graduates, he subsequently prevails not only over Strepsiades’ creditors, but also beats his father and offers a persuasive rhetorical justification for the act. As Pheidippides prepares to beat his mother, Strepsiades’ indignation motivates him to lead a violent mob attack on The Thinkery.

Aristophanes’ depiction of Socrates the sophist is revealing on at least three levels. In the first instance, it demonstrates that the distinction between Socrates and his sophistic counterparts was far from clear to their contemporaries. Although Socrates did not charge fees and frequently asserted that all he knew was that he was ignorant of most matters, his association with the sophists reflects both the indeterminacy of the term sophist and the difficulty, at least for the everyday Athenian citizen, of distinguishing his methods from theirs. Secondly, Aristophanes’ depiction suggests that the sophistic education reflected a decline from the heroic Athens of earlier generations. Thirdly, the attribution to the sophists of intellectual deviousness and moral dubiousness predates Plato and Aristotle.

Hostility towards sophists was a significant factor in the decision of the Athenian dēmos to condemn Socrates to the death penalty for impiety. Anytus, who was one of Socrates’ accusers at his trial, was clearly unconcerned with details such as that the man he accused did not claim to teach aretē or extract fees for so doing. He is depicted by Plato as suggesting that sophists are the ruin of all those who come into contact with them and as advocating their expulsion from the city (Meno, 91c-92c). Equally as revealing, in terms of attitudes towards the sophists, is Socrates’ discussion with Hippocrates, a wealthy young Athenian keen to become a pupil of Protagoras (Protagoras, 312a). Hippocrates is so eager to meet Protagoras that he wakes Socrates in the early hours of the morning, yet later concedes that he himself would be ashamed to be known as a sophist by his fellow citizens.

Plato depicts Protagoras as well aware of the hostility and resentment engendered by his profession (Protagoras, 316c-e). It is not surprising, Protagoras suggests, that foreigners who profess to be wise and persuade the wealthy youth of powerful cities to forsake their family and friends and consort with them would arouse suspicion. Indeed, Protagoras claims that the sophistic art is an ancient one, but that sophists of old, including poets such as Homer, Hesiod and Simonides, prophets, seers and even physical trainers, deliberately did not adopt the name for fear of persecution. Protagoras says that while he has adopted a strategy of openly professing to be a sophist, he has taken other precautions – perhaps including his association with the Athenian general Pericles – in order to secure his safety.

The low standing of the sophists in Athenian public opinion does not stem from a single source. No doubt suspicion of intellectuals among the many was a factor. New money and democratic decision-making, however, also constituted a threat to the conservative Athenian aristocratic establishment. This threatening social change is reflected in the attitudes towards the concept of excellence or virtue (aretē) alluded to in the summary above. Whereas in the Homeric epics aretē generally denotes the strength and courage of a real man, in the second half of the fifth century B.C.E. it increasingly became associated with success in public affairs through rhetorical persuasion.

In the context of Athenian political life of the late fifth century B.C.E. the importance of skill in persuasive speech, or rhetoric, cannot be underestimated. The development of democracy made mastery of the spoken word not only a precondition of political success but also indispensable as a form of self-defence in the event that one was subject to a lawsuit. The sophists accordingly answered a growing need among the young and ambitious. Meno, an ambitious pupil of Gorgias, says that the aretē – and hence function – of a man is to rule over people, that is, manage his public affairs so as to benefit his friends and harm his enemies (73c-d). This is a long-standing ideal, but one best realised in democratic Athens through rhetoric. Rhetoric was thus the core of the sophistic education (Protagoras, 318e), even if most sophists professed to teach a broader range of subjects.

Suspicion towards the sophists was also informed by their departure from the aristocratic model of education (paideia). Since Homeric Greece, paideia had been the preoccupation of the ruling nobles and was based around a set of moral precepts befitting an aristocratic warrior class. The business model of the sophists presupposed that aretē could be taught to all free citizens, a claim that Protagoras implicitly defends in his great speech regarding the origins of justice. The sophists were thus a threat to the status quo because they made an indiscriminate promise – assuming capacity to pay fees – to provide the young and ambitious with the power to prevail in public life.

One could therefore loosely define sophists as paid teachers of aretē, where the latter is understood in terms of the capacity to attain and exercise political power through persuasive speech. This is only a starting point, however, and the broad and significant intellectual achievement of the sophists, which we will consider in the following two sections, has led some to ask whether it is possible or desirable to attribute them with a unique method or outlook that would serve as a unifying characteristic while also differentiating them from philosophers.

Scholarship in the nineteenth century and beyond has often fastened on method as a way of differentiating Socrates from the sophists. For Henry Sidgwick (1872, 288-307), for example, whereas Socrates employed a question-and-answer method in search of the truth, the sophists gave long epideictic or display speeches for the purposes of persuasion. It seems difficult to maintain a clear methodical differentiation on this basis, given that Gorgias and Protagoras both claimed proficiency in short speeches and that Socrates engages in long eloquent speeches – many in mythical form – throughout the Platonic dialogues. It is moreover simply misleading to say that the sophists were in all cases unconcerned with truth, as to assert the relativity of truth is itself to make a truth claim. A further consideration is that Socrates is guilty of fallacious reasoning in many of the Platonic dialogues, although this point is less relevant if we assume that Socrates’ logical errors are unintentional.

G.B. Kerferd (1981a) has proposed a more nuanced set of methodological criteria to differentiate Socrates from the sophists. According to Kerferd, the sophists employed eristic and antilogical methods of argument, whereas Socrates disdained the former and saw the latter as a necessary but incomplete step on the way towards dialectic. Plato uses the term eristic to denote the practice – it is not strictly speaking a method – of seeking victory in argument without regard for the truth. We find a representation of eristic techniques in Plato’s dialogue Euthydemus, where the brothers Euthydemus and Dionysiodorous deliberately use egregiously fallacious arguments for the purpose of contradicting and prevailing over their opponent. Antilogic is the method of proceeding from a given argument, usually that offered by an opponent, towards the establishment of a contrary or contradictory argument in such a way that the opponent must either abandon his first position or accept both positions. This method of argumentation was employed by most of the sophists, and examples are found in the works of Protagoras and Antiphon.

Kerferd’s claim that we can distinguish between philosophy and sophistry by appealing to dialectic remains problematic, however. In what are usually taken to be the “early” Platonic dialogues, we find Socrates’ employing a dialectical method of refutation referred to as the elenchus. As Nehamas has argued (1990), while the elenchus is distinguishable from eristic because of its concern with the truth, it is harder to differentiate from antilogic because its success is always dependent upon the capacity of interlocutors to defend themselves against refutation in a particular case. In Plato’s “middle” and “later” dialogues, on the other hand, according to Nehamas’ interpretation, Plato associates dialectic with knowledge of the forms, but this seemingly involves an epistemological and metaphysical commitment to a transcendent ontology that most philosophers, then and now, would be reluctant to uphold.

More recent attempts to explain what differentiates philosophy from sophistry have accordingly tended to focus on a difference in moral purpose or in terms of choices for different ways way of life, as Aristotle elegantly puts it (Metaphysics IV, 2, 1004b24-5). Section 4 will return to the question of whether this is the best way to think about the distinction between philosophy and sophistry. Before this, however, it is useful to sketch the biographies and interests of the most prominent sophists and also consider some common themes in their thought.

2. The Sophists

a. Protagoras

Protagoras of Abdera (c. 490-420 B.C.E.) was the most prominent member of the sophistic movement and Plato reports he was the first to charge fees using that title (Protagoras, 349a). Despite his animus towards the sophists, Plato depicts Protagoras as quite a sympathetic and dignified figure.

One of the more intriguing aspects of Protagoras’ life and work is his association with the great Athenian general and statesman Pericles (c. 495-429 B.C.E.). Pericles, who was the most influential statesman in Athens for more than 30 years, including the first two years of the Peloponnesian War, seems to have held a high regard for philosophers and sophists, and Protagoras in particular, entrusting him with the role of drafting laws for the Athenian foundation city of Thurii in 444 B.C.E.

From a philosophical perspective, Protagoras is most famous for his relativistic account of truth – in particular the claim that ‘man is the measure of all things’ – and his agnosticism concerning the Gods. The first topic will be discussed in section 3b. Protagoras’ agnosticism is famously articulated in the claim that ‘concerning the gods I am not in a position to know either that (or how) they are or that (or how) they are not, or what they are like in appearance; for there are many things that prevent knowledge, the obscurity of the matter and the brevity of human life’ (DK, 80B4). This seems to express a form of religious agnosticism not completely foreign to educated Athenian opinion. Despite this, according to tradition, Protagoras was convicted of impiety towards the end of his life. As a consequence, so the story goes, his books were burnt and he drowned at sea while departing Athens. It is perhaps significant in this context that Protagoras seems to have been the source of the sophistic claim to ‘make the weaker argument defeat the stronger’ parodied by Aristophanes.

Plato suggests that Protagoras sought to differ his educational offering from that of other sophists, such as Hippias, by concentrating upon instruction in aretē in the sense of political virtue rather than specialised studies such as astronomy and mathematics (Protagoras, 318e).

Apart from his works Truth and On the Gods, which deal with his relativistic account of truth and agnosticism respectively, Diogenes Laertius says that Protagoras wrote the following books: Antilogies, Art of Eristics, Imperative, On Ambition, On Incorrect Human Actions, On those in Hades, On Sciences, On Virtues, On Wrestling, On the Original State of Things and Trial over a Fee.

b. Gorgias

Gorgias of Leontini (c.485 – c.390 B.C.E.) is generally considered as a member of the sophistic movement, despite his disavowal of the capacity to teach aretē (Meno, 96c). The major focus of Gorgias was rhetoric and given the importance of persuasive speaking to the sophistic education, and his acceptance of fees, it is appropriate to consider him alongside other famous sophists for present purposes.

Gorgias visited Athens in 427 B.C.E. as the leader of an embassy from Leontini with the successful intention of persuading the Athenians to make an alliance against Syracuse. He travelled extensively around Greece, earning large sums of money by giving lessons in rhetoric and epideictic speeches.

Plato’s Gorgias depicts the rhetorician as something of a celebrity, who either does not have well thought out views on the implications of his expertise, or is reluctant to share them, and who denies his responsibility for the unjust use of rhetorical skill by errant students. Although Gorgias presents himself as moderately upstanding, the dramatic structure of Plato’s dialogue suggests that the defence of injustice by Polus and the appeal to the natural right of the stronger by Callicles are partly grounded in the conceptual presuppositions of Gorgianic rhetoric.

Gorgias’ original contribution to philosophy is sometimes disputed, but the fragments of his works On Not Being or Nature and Helen – discussed in detail in section 3c – feature intriguing claims concerning the power of rhetorical speech and a style of argumentation reminiscent of Parmenides and Zeno. Gorgias is also credited with other orations and encomia and a technical treatise on rhetoric titled At the Right Moment in Time.

c. Antiphon

The biographical details surrounding Antiphon the sophist (c. 470-411 B.C.) are unclear – one unresolved issue is whether he should be identified with Antiphon of Rhamnus (a statesman and teacher of rhetoric who was a member of the oligarchy which held power in Athens briefly in 411 B.C.E.). However, since the publication of fragments from his On Truth in the early twentieth century he has been regarded as a major representative of the sophistic movement.

On Truth, which features a range of positions and counterpositions on the relationship between nature and convention (see section 3a below), is sometimes considered an important text in the history of political thought because of its alleged advocacy of egalitarianism:

Those born of illustrious fathers we respect and honour, whereas those who come from an undistinguished house we neither respect nor honour. In this we behave like barbarians towards one another. For by nature we all equally, both barbarians and Greeks, have an entirely similar origin: for it is fitting to fulfil the natural satisfactions which are necessary to all men: all have the ability to fulfil these in the same way, and in all this none of us is different either as barbarian or as Greek; for we all breathe into the air with mouth and nostrils and we all eat with the hands (quoted in Untersteiner, 1954).

Whether this statement should be taken as expressing the actual views of Antiphon, or rather as part of an antilogical presentation of opposing views on justice remains an open question, as does whether such a position rules out the identification of Antiphon the sophist with the oligarchical Antiphon of Rhamnus.

d. Hippias

The exact dates for Hippias of Elis are unknown, but scholars generally assume that he lived during the same period as Protagoras. Whereas Plato’s depictions of Protagoras – and to a lesser extent Gorgias – indicate a modicum of respect, he presents Hippias as a comic figure who is obsessed with money, pompous and confused.

Hippias is best known for his polymathy (DK 86A14). His areas of expertise seem to have included astronomy, grammar, history, mathematics, music, poetry, prose, rhetoric, painting and sculpture. Like Gorgias and Prodicus, he served as an ambassador for his home city. His work as a historian, which included compiling lists of Olympic victors, was invaluable to Thucydides and subsequent historians as it allowed for a more precise dating of past events. In mathematics he is attributed with the discovery of a curve – the quadratrix – used to trisect an angle.

In terms of his philosophical contribution, Kerferd has suggested, on the basis of Plato’s Hippias Major (301d-302b), that Hippias advocated a theory that classes or kinds of thing are dependent on a being that traverses them. It is hard to make much sense of this alleged doctrine on the basis of available evidence. As suggested above, Plato depicts Hippias as philosophically shallow and unable to keep up with Socrates in dialectical discussion.

e. Prodicus

Prodicus of Ceos lived during roughly the same period as Protagoras and Hippias. He is best known for his subtle distinctions between the meanings of words. He is thought to have written a treatise titled On the Correctness of Names.

Plato gives an amusing account of Prodicus’ method in the following passage of the Protagoras:

Prodicus spoke up next: … ‘those who attend discussions such as this ought to listen impartially, but not equally, to both interlocutors. There is a distinction here. We ought to listen impartially but not divide our attention equally: More should go to the wiser speaker and less to the more unlearned … In this way our meeting would take a most attractive turn, for you, the speakers, would then most surely earn the respect, rather than the praise, of those listening to you. For respect is guilelessly inherent in the souls of listeners, but praise is all too often merely a deceitful verbal expression. And then, too, we, your audience, would be most cheered, but not pleased, for to be cheered is to learn something, to participate in some intellectual activity; but to be pleased has to do with eating or experiencing some other pleasure in the body’ (337a-c).

Prodicus’ epideictic speech, The Choice of Heracles, was singled out for praise by Xenophon (Memorabilia, II.1.21-34) and in addition to his private teaching he seems to have served as an ambassador for Ceos (the birthplace of Simonides) on several occasions.

Socrates, although perhaps with some degree of irony, was fond of calling himself a pupil of Prodicus (Protagoras, 341a; Meno, 96d).

f. Thrasymachus

Thrasymachus was a well-known rhetorician in Athens in the latter part of the fifth century B.C.E., but our only surviving record of his views is contained in Plato’s Cleitophon and Book One of The Republic. He is depicted as brash and aggressive, with views on the nature of justice that will be examined in section 3a.

3. Major Themes of Sophistic Thought

a. Nature and Convention

The distinction between physis (nature) and nomos (custom, law, convention) was a central theme in Greek thought in the second half of the fifth century B.C.E. and is especially important for understanding the work of the sophists. Before turning to sophistic considerations of these concepts and the distinction between them, it is worth sketching the meaning of the Greek terms.

Aristotle defines physis as ‘the substance of things which have in themselves as such a source of movement’ (Metaphysics, 1015a13-15). The term physis is closely connected with the Greek verb to grow (phuō) and the dynamic aspect of physis reflects the view that the nature of things is found in their origins and internal principles of change. Some of the Ionian thinkers now referred to as presocratics, including Thales and Heraclitus, used the term physis for reality as a whole, or at least its underlying material constituents, referring to the investigation of nature in this context as historia (inquiry) rather than philosophy.

The term nomos refers to a wide range of normative concepts extending from customs and conventions to positive law. It would be misleading to regard the term as referring only to arbitrary human conventions, as Heraclitus’ appeal to the distinction between human nomoi and the one divine nomos (DK 22B2 and 114) makes clear. Nonetheless, increased travel, as exemplified by the histories of Herodotus, led to a greater understanding of the wide array of customs, conventions and laws among communities in the ancient world. This recognition sets up the possibility of a dichotomy between what is unchanging and according to nature and what is merely a product of arbitrary human convention.

The dichotomy between physis and nomos seems to have been something of a commonplace of sophistic thought and was appealed to by Protagoras and Hippias among others. Perhaps the most instructive sophistic account of the distinction, however, is found in Antiphon’s fragment On Truth.

Antiphon applies the distinction to notions of justice and injustice, arguing that the majority of things which are considered just according to nomos are in direct conflict with nature and hence not truly or naturally just (DK 87 A44). The basic thrust of Antiphon’s argument is that laws and conventions are designed as a constraint upon our natural pursuit of pleasure. In a passage suggestive of the discussion on justice early in Plato’s Republic, Antiphon also asserts that one should employ justice to one’s advantage by regarding the laws as important when witnesses are present, but disregarding them when one can get away with it. Although these arguments may be construed as part of an antilogical exercise on nature and convention rather than prescriptions for a life of prudent immorality, they are consistent with views on the relation between human nature and justice suggested by Plato’s depiction of Callicles and Thrasymachus in the Gorgias and Republic respectively.

Callicles, a young Athenian aristocrat who may be a real historical figure or a creation of Plato’s imagination, was not a sophist; indeed he expresses disdain for them (Gorgias, 520a). His account of the relation between physis and nomos nonetheless owes a debt to sophistic thought. According to Callicles, Socrates’ arguments in favour of the claim that it is better to suffer injustice than to commit injustice trade on a deliberate ambiguity in the term justice. Callicles argues that conventional justice is a kind of slave morality imposed by the many to constrain the desires of the superior few. What is just according to nature, by contrast, is seen by observing animals in nature and relations between political communities where it can be seen that the strong prevail over the weak. Callicles himself takes this argument in the direction of a vulgar sensual hedonism motivated by the desire to have more than others (pleonexia), but sensual hedonism as such does not seem to be a necessary consequence of his account of natural justice.

Although the sophist Thrasymachus does not employ the physis/nomos distinction in Book One of the Republic, his account of justice (338d-354c) belongs within a similar conceptual framework. Like Callicles, Thrasymachus accuses Socrates of deliberate deception in his arguments, particularly in the claim the art of justice consists in a ruler looking after their subjects. According to Thrasymachus, we do better to think of the ruler/ruled relation in terms of a shepherd looking after his flock with a view to its eventual demise. Justice in conventional terms is simply a naive concern for the advantage of another. From another more natural perspective, justice is the rule of the stronger, insofar as rulers establish laws which persuade the multitude that it is just for them to obey what is to the advantage of the ruling few

An alternative, and more edifying, account of the relation between physis and nomos is found in Protagoras’ great speech (Protagoras, 320c-328d). According to Protagoras’ myth, man was originally set forth by the gods into a violent state of nature reminiscent of that later described by Hobbes. Our condition improved when Zeus bestowed us with shame and justice; these enabled us to develop the skill of politics and hence civilized communal relations and virtue. Apart from supporting his argument that aretē can be taught, this account suggests a defence of nomos on the grounds that nature by itself is insufficient for the flourishing of man considered as a political animal.

b. Relativism

The primary source on sophistic relativism about knowledge and/or truth is Protagoras’ famous ‘man is the measure’ statement. Interpretation of Protagoras’ thesis has always been a matter of controversy. Caution is needed in particular against the temptation to read modern epistemological concerns into Protagoras’ account and sophistic teaching on the relativity of truth more generally.

Protagoras measure thesis is as follows:

A human being is the measure of all things, of those things that are, that they are, and of those things that are not, that they are not (DK, 80B1).

There is near scholarly consensus that Protagoras is referring here to each human being as the measure of what is rather than ‘humankind’ as such, although the Greek term for ‘human’ –hōanthrōpos– certainly does not rule out the second interpretation. Plato’s Theaetetus (152a), however, suggests the first reading and I will assume its correctness here. On this reading we can regard Protagoras as asserting that if the wind, for example, feels (or seems) cold to me and feels (or seems) warm to you, then the wind is cold for me and is warm for you.

Another interpretative issue concerns whether we should construe Protagoras’ statement as primarily ontological or epistemological in intent. Scholarship by Kahn, Owen and Kerferd among others suggests that, while the Greeks lacked a clear distinction between existential and predicative uses of ‘to be’, they tended to treat existential uses as short for predicative uses.

Having sketched some of the interpretative difficulties surrounding Protagoras’ statement, we are still left with at least three possible readings (Kerferd, 1981a, 86). Protagoras could be asserting that (i) there is no mind-independent wind at all, but merely private subjective winds (ii) there is a wind that exists independently of my perception of it, but it is in itself neither cold nor warm as these qualities are private (iii) there is a wind that exists independently of my perception of it and this is both cold and warm insofar as two qualities can inhere in the same mind-independent ‘entity’.

All three interpretations are live options, with (i) perhaps the least plausible. Whatever the exact import of Protagoras’ relativism, however, the following passage from the Theaetetus suggests that it was also extended to the political and ethical realm:

Whatever in any particular city is considered just and admirable is just and admirable in that city, for so long as the convention remains in place (167c).

One difficulty this passage raises is that while Protagoras asserted that all beliefs are equally true, he also maintained that some are superior to others because they are more subjectively fulfilling for those who hold them. Protagoras thus seems to want it both ways, insofar as he removes an objective criterion of truth while also asserting that some subjective states are better than others. His appeal to better and worse beliefs could, however, be taken to refer to the persuasiveness and pleasure induced by certain beliefs and speeches rather than their objective truth.

The other major source for sophistic relativism is the Dissoi Logoi, an undated and anonymous example of Protagorean antilogic. In the Dissoi Logoi we find competing arguments on five theses, including whether the good and the bad are the same or different, and a series of examples of the relativity of different cultural practices and laws. Overall the Dissoi Logoi can be taken to uphold not only the relativity of truth but also what Barney (2006, 89) has called the variability thesis: whatever is good in some qualified way is also bad in another respect and the same is the case for a wide range of contrary predicates.

c. Language and Reality

Understandably given their educational program, the sophists placed great emphasis upon the power of speech (logos). Logos is a notoriously difficult term to translate and can refer to thought and that about which we speak and think as well as rational speech or language. The sophists were interested in particular with the role of human discourse in the shaping of reality. Rhetoric was the centrepiece of the curriculum, but literary interpretation of the work of poets was also a staple of sophistic education. Some philosophical implications of the sophistic concern with speech are considered in section 4, but in the current section it is instructive to concentrate on Gorgias’ account of the power of rhetorical logos.

The extant fragments attributed to the historical Gorgias indicate not only scepticism towards essential being and our epistemic access to this putative realm, but an assertion of the omnipotence of persuasive logos to make the natural and practical world conform to human desires. Reporting upon Gorgias’ speech About the Nonexistent or on Nature, Sextus says that the rhetorician, while adopting a different approach from that of Protagoras, also eliminated the criterion (DK, 82B3). The elimination of the criterion refers to the rejection of a standard that would enable us to distinguish clearly between knowledge and opinion about being and nature. Whereas Protagoras asserted that man is the measure of all things, Gorgias concentrated upon the status of truth about being and nature as a discursive construction.

About the Nonexistent or on Nature transgresses the injunction of Parmenides that one cannot say of what is that it is not. Employing a series of conditional arguments in the manner of Zeno, Gorgias asserts that nothing exists, that if it did exist it could not be apprehended, and if it was apprehended it could not be articulated in logos. The elaborate parody displays the paradoxical character of attempts to disclose the true nature of beings through logos:

For that by which we reveal is logos, but logos is not substances and existing things. Therefore we do not reveal existing things to our comrades, but logos, which is something other than substances (DK, 82B3)

Even if knowledge of beings was possible, its transmission in logos would always be distorted by the rift between substances and our apprehension and communication of them. Gorgias also suggests, even more provocatively, that insofar as speech is the medium by which humans articulate their experience of the world, logos is not evocative of the external, but rather the external is what reveals logos. An understanding of logos about nature as constitutive rather than descriptive here supports the assertion of the omnipotence of rhetorical expertise. Gorgias’ account suggests there is no knowledge of nature sub specie aeternitatis and our grasp of reality is always mediated by discursive interpretations, which, in turn, implies that truth cannot be separated from human interests and power claims.

In the Encomium to Helen Gorgias refers to logos as a powerful master (DK, 82B11). If humans had knowledge of the past, present or future they would not be compelled to adopt unpredictable opinion as their counsellor. The endless contention of astronomers, politicians and philosophers is taken to demonstrate that no logos is definitive. Human ignorance about non-existent truth can thus be exploited by rhetorical persuasion insofar as humans desire the illusion of certainty imparted by the spoken word:

The effect of logos upon the condition of the soul is comparable to the power of drugs over the nature of bodies. For just as different drugs dispel different secretions from the body, and some bring an end to disease and others to life, so also in the case of logoi, some distress, others delight, some cause fear, others make hearers bold, and some drug and bewitch the soul with a kind of evil persuasion (DK, 82B11).

All who have persuaded people, Gorgias says, do so by moulding a false logos. While other forms of power require force, logos makes all its willing slave.

This account of the relation between persuasive speech, knowledge, opinion and reality is broadly consistent with Plato’s depiction of the rhetorician in the Gorgias. Both Protagoras’ relativism and Gorgias’ account of the omnipotence of logos are suggestive of what we moderns might call a deflationary epistemic anti-realism.

4. The Distinction Between Philosophy and Sophistry

The distinction between philosophy and sophistry is in itself a difficult philosophical problem. This closing section examines the attempt of Plato to establish a clear line of demarcation between philosophy and sophistry.

As alluded to above, the terms ‘philosopher’ and ‘sophist’ were disputed in the fifth and fourth century B.C.E., the subject of contention between rival schools of thought. Histories of philosophy tend to begin with the Ionian ‘physicist’ Thales, but the presocratics referred to the activity they were engaged in as historia (inquiry) rather than philosophia and although it may have some validity as a historical projection, the notion that philosophy begins with Thales derives from the mid nineteenth century. It was Plato who first clearly and consistently refers to the activity of philosophia and much of what he has to say is best understood in terms of an explicit or implicit contrast with the rival schools of the sophists and Isocrates (who also claimed the title philosophia for his rhetorical educational program).

The related questions as to what a sophist is and how we can distinguish the philosopher from the sophist were taken very seriously by Plato. He also acknowledges the difficulty inherent in the pursuit of these questions and it is perhaps revealing that the dialogue dedicated to the task, Sophist, culminates in a discussion about the being of non-being. Socrates converses with sophists in Euthydemus, Hippias Major, Hippias Minor, Gorgias, Protagoras and the Republic and discusses sophists at length in the Apology, Sophist, Statesman and Theaetetus. It can thus be argued that the search for the sophist and distinction between philosophy and sophistry are not only central themes in the Platonic dialogues, but constitutive of the very idea and practice of philosophy, at least in its original sense as articulated by Plato.

This point has been recognised by recent poststructuralist thinkers such as Jacques Derrida and Jean Francois-Lyotard in the context of their project to place in question central presuppositions of the Western philosophical tradition deriving from Plato. Derrida attacks the interminable trial prosecuted by Plato against the sophists with a view to exhuming ‘the conceptual monuments marking out the battle lines between philosophy and sophistry’ (1981, 106). Lyotard views the sophists as in possession of unique insight into the sense in which discourses about what is just cannot transcend the realm of opinion and pragmatic language games (1985, 73-83).

The prospects for establishing a clear methodological divide between philosophy and sophistry are poor. Apart from the considerations mentioned in section 1, it would be misleading to say that the sophists were unconcerned with truth or genuine theoretical investigation and Socrates is clearly guilty of fallacious reasoning in many of the Platonic dialogues. In the Sophist, in fact, Plato implies that the Socratic technique of dialectical refutation represents a kind of ‘noble sophistry’ (Sophist, 231b).

This in large part explains why contemporary scholarship on the distinction between philosophy and sophistry has tended to focus on a difference in moral character. Nehamas, for example, has argued that ‘Socrates did not differ from the sophists in method but in overall purpose’ (1990, 13).  Nehamas relates this overall purpose to the Socratic elenchus, suggesting that Socrates’ disavowal of knowledge and of the capacity to teach aretē distances him from the sophists. However, this way of demarcating Socrates’ practice from that of his sophistic counterparts, Nehamas argues, cannot justify the later Platonic distinction between philosophy and sophistry, insofar as Plato forfeited the right to uphold the distinction once he developed a substantive philosophical teaching, that is, the theory of forms.

There is no doubt much truth in the claim that Plato and Aristotle depict the philosopher as pursuing a different way of life than the sophist, but to say that Plato defines the philosopher either through a difference in moral purpose, as in the case of Socrates, or a metaphysical presumption regarding the existence of transcendent forms, as in his later work, does not in itself adequately characterise Plato’s critique of his sophistic contemporaries. Once we attend to Plato’s own treatment of the distinction between philosophy and sophistry two themes quickly become clear: the mercenary character of the sophists and their overestimation of the power of speech. For Plato, at least, these two aspects of the sophistic education tell us something about the persona of the sophist as the embodiment of a distinctive attitude towards knowledge.

The fact that the sophists taught for profit may not seem objectionable to modern readers; most present-day university professors would be reluctant to teach pro bono. It is clearly a major issue for Plato, however. Plato can barely mention the sophists without contemptuous reference to the mercenary aspect of their trade: particularly revealing examples of Plato’s disdain for sophistic money-making and avarice are found at Apology 19d, Euthydemus 304b-c, Hippias Major 282b-e, Protagoras 312c-d and Sophist 222d-224d, and this is not an exhaustive list. Part of the issue here is no doubt Plato’s commitment to a way of life dedicated to knowledge and contemplation. It is significant that students in the Academy, arguably the first higher education institution, were not required to pay fees. This is only part of the story, however.

A good starting point is to consider the etymology of the term philosophia as suggested by the Phaedrus and Symposium. After completing his palinode in the Phaedrus, Socrates expresses the hope that he never be deprived of his ‘erotic’ art. Whereas the speechwriter Lysias presents erōs (desire, love) as an unseemly waste of expenditure (Phaedrus, 257a), in his later speech Socrates demonstrates how erōs impels the soul to rise towards the forms. The followers of Zeus, or philosophy, Socrates suggests, educate the object of their erōs to imitate and partake in the ways of the God. Similarly, in the Symposium, Socrates refers to an exception to his ignorance. Approving of the suggestion by Phaedrus that the drinking party eulogise erōs, Socrates states that ta erōtika (the erotic things) are the only subject concerning which he would claim to possess rigorous knowledge (Symposium, 177 d-e). When it is his turn to deliver a speech, Socrates laments his incapacity to compete with the Gorgias-influenced rhetoric of Agathon before delivering Diotima’s lessons on erōs, represented as a daimonion or semi-divine intermediary between the mortal and the divine. Erōs is thus presented as analogous to philosophy in its etymological sense, a striving after wisdom or completion that can only be temporarily fulfilled in this life by contemplation of the forms of the beautiful and the good (204a-b). The philosopher is someone who strives after wisdom – a friend or lover of wisdom – not someone who possesses wisdom as a finished product, as the sophists claimed to do and as their name suggests.

Plato’s emphasis upon philosophy as an ‘erotic’ activity of striving for wisdom, rather than as a finished state of completed wisdom, largely explains his distaste for sophistic money-making. The sophists, according to Plato, considered knowledge to be a ready-made product that could be sold without discrimination to all comers. The Theages, a Socratic dialogue whose authorship some scholars have disputed, but which expresses sentiments consistent with other Platonic dialogues, makes this point with particular clarity. The farmer Demodokos has brought his son, Theages, who is desirous of wisdom, to Socrates. As Socrates questions his potential pupil regarding what sort of wisdom he seeks, it becomes evident that Theages seeks power in the city and influence over other men. Since Theages is looking for political wisdom, Socrates refers him to the statesmen and the sophists. Disavowing his ability to compete with the expertise of Gorgias and Prodicus in this respect, Socrates nonetheless admits his knowledge of the erotic things, a subject about which he claims to know more than any man who has come before or indeed any of those to come (Theages, 128b). In response to the suggestion that he study with a sophist, Theages reveals his intention to become a pupil of Socrates. Perhaps reluctant to take on an unpromising pupil, Socrates insists that he must follow the commands of his daimonion, which will determine whether those associating with him are capable of making any progress (Theages, 129c). The dialogue ends with an agreement that all parties make trial of the daimonion to see whether it permits of the association.

One need only follow the suggestion of the Symposium that erōs is a daimonion to see that Socratic education, as presented by Plato, is concomitant with a kind of ‘erotic’ concern with the beautiful and the good, considered as natural in contrast to the purely conventional. Whereas the sophists accept pupils indiscriminately, provided they have the money to pay, Socrates is oriented by his desire to cultivate the beautiful and the good in promising natures. In short, the difference between Socrates and his sophistic contemporaries, as Xenophon suggests, is the difference between a lover and a prostitute. The sophists, for Xenophon’s Socrates, are prostitutes of wisdom because they sell their wares to anyone with the capacity to pay (Memorabilia, I.6.13). This – somewhat paradoxically – accounts for Socrates’ shamelessness in comparison with his sophistic contemporaries, his preparedness to follow the argument wherever it leads. By contrast, Protagoras and Gorgias are shown, in the dialogues that bear their names, as vulnerable to the conventional opinions of the paying fathers of their pupils, a weakness contributing to their refutation. The sophists are thus characterised by Plato as subordinating the pursuit of truth to worldly success, in a way that perhaps calls to mind the activities of contemporary advertising executives or management consultants.

The overestimation of the power of human speech is the other theme that emerges clearly from Plato’s (and Aristotle’s) critique of the sophists. In the Sophist, Plato says that dialectic – division and collection according to kinds – is the knowledge possessed by the free man or philosopher (Sophist, 253c). Here Plato reintroduces the difference between true and false rhetoric, alluded to in the Phaedrus, according to which the former presupposes the capacity to see the one in the many (Phaedrus, 266b). Plato’s claim is that the capacity to divide and synthesise in accordance with one form is required for the true expertise of logos. Whatever else one makes of Plato’s account of our knowledge of the forms, it clearly involves the apprehension of a higher level of being than sensory perception and speech. The philosopher, then, considers rational speech as oriented by a genuine understanding of being or nature. The sophist, by contrast, is said by Plato to occupy the realm of falsity, exploiting the difficulty of dialectic by producing discursive semblances, or phantasms, of true being (Sophist, 234c). The sophist uses the power of persuasive speech to construct or create images of the world and is thus a kind of ‘enchanter’ and imitator.

This aspect of Plato’s critique of sophistry seems particularly apposite in regard to Gorgias’ rhetoric, both as found in the Platonic dialogue and the extant fragments attributed to the historical Gorgias. In response to Socratic questioning, Gorgias asserts that rhetoric is an all-comprehending power that holds under itself all of the other activities and occupations (Gorgias, 456a). He later claims that it is concerned with the greatest good for man, namely those speeches that allow one to attain freedom and rule over others, especially, but not exclusively, in political settings (452d). As suggested above, in the context of Athenian public life the capacity to persuade was a precondition of political success. For present purposes, however, the key point is that freedom and rule over others are both forms of power: respectively power in the sense of liberty or capacity to do something, which suggests the absence of relevant constraints, and power in the sense of dominion over others. Gorgias is suggesting that rhetoric, as the expertise of persuasive speech, is the source of power in a quite comprehensive sense and that power is ‘the good’. What we have here is an assertion of the omnipotence of speech, at the very least in relation to the determination of human affairs.

The Socratic position, as becomes clear later in the discussion with Polus (466d-e), and is also suggested in Meno (88c-d) and Euthydemus (281d-e), is that power without knowledge of the good is not genuinely good. Without such knowledge not only ‘external’ goods, such as wealth and health, not only the areas of expertise that enable one to attain such so-called goods, but the very capacity to attain them is either of no value or harmful. This in large part explains the so-called Socratic paradox that virtue is knowledge.

Plato’s critique of the sophists’ overestimation of the power of speech should not be conflated with his commitment to the theory of the forms. For Plato, the sophist reduces thinking to a kind of making: by asserting the omnipotence of human speech the sophist pays insufficient regard to the natural limits upon human knowledge and our status as seekers rather than possessors of knowledge (Sophist, 233d). This critique of the sophists does perhaps require a minimal commitment to a distinction between appearance and reality, but it is an oversimplification to suggest that Plato’s distinction between philosophy and sophistry rests upon a substantive metaphysical theory, in large part because our knowledge of the forms for Plato is itself inherently ethical. Plato, like his Socrates, differentiates the philosopher from the sophist primarily through the virtues of the philosopher’s soul (McKoy, 2008). Socrates is an embodiment of the moral virtues, but love of the forms also has consequences for the philosopher’s character.

There is a further ethical and political aspect to the Platonic and Aristotelian critique of the sophists’ overestimation of the power of speech. In Book Ten of Nicomachean Ethics, Aristotle suggests that the sophists tended to reduce politics to rhetoric (1181a12-15) and overemphasised the role that could be played by rational persuasion in the political realm. Part of Aristotle’s point is that there is an element to living well that transcends speech. As Hadot eloquently puts it, citing Greek and Roman sources, ‘traditionally people who developed an apparently philosophical discourse without trying to live their lives in accordance with their discourse, and without their discourse emanating from their life experience, were called sophists’ (2004, 174).

The testimony of Xenophon, a Greek general and man of action, is instructive here. In his treatise on hunting, (Cynēgeticus, 13.1-9), Xenophon commends Socratic over sophistic education in aretē, not only on the grounds that the sophists hunt the young and rich and are deceptive, but also because they are men of words rather than action. The importance of consistency between one’s words and actions if one is to be truly virtuous is a commonplace of Greek thought, and this is one important respect in which the sophists, at least from the Platonic-Aristotelian perspective, fell short.

One might think that a denial of Plato’s demarcation between philosophy and sophistry remains well-motivated simply because the historical sophists made genuine contributions to philosophy. But this does not entail the illegitimacy of Plato’s distinction. Once we recognise that Plato is pointing primarily to a fundamental ethical orientation relating to the respective personas of the philosopher and sophist, rather than a methodological or purely theoretical distinction, the tension dissolves. This is not to deny that the ethical orientation of the sophist is likely to lead to a certain kind of philosophising, namely one which attempts to master nature, human and external, rather than understand it as it is.

Sophistry for Socrates, Plato and Aristotle represents a choice for a certain way of life, embodied in a particular attitude towards knowledge which views it as a finished product to be transmitted to all comers. Plato’s distinction between philosophy and sophistry is not simply an arbitrary viewpoint in a dispute over naming rights, but is rather based upon a fundamental difference in ethical orientation. Neither is this orientation reducible to concern with truth or the cogency of one’s theoretical constructs, although it is not unrelated to these. Where the philosopher differs from the sophist is in terms of the choice for a way of life that is oriented by the pursuit of knowledge as a good in itself while remaining cognisant of the necessarily provisional nature of this pursuit.

5. References and Further Reading

Translations are from the Cooper collected works edition of Plato and the Sprague edition of the sophists unless otherwise indicated. The reference list below is restricted to a few basic sources; readers interested to learn more about the sophists are advised to consult the excellent overviews by Barney (2006) and Kerferd (1981a) for a more comprehensive list of secondary literature.

a. Primary Sources

  • Aristophanes, Clouds, K.J. Dover (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press. 1970.
  • Barnes, J. (ed.). 1984. The Complete Works of Aristotle, New Jersey: Princeton University Press.
  • Diels, H. 1951. Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker. Berlin: Weidman.
  • Cooper, J.M. (ed.). 1997. Plato: Complete Works. Indianopolis: Hackett.
  • Hudson-Williams. T. 1910. Theognis: Elegies and other elegies included in the Theognideansylloge. London: G.Bell.
  • Phillips, A.A. and Willcock, M.M (eds.). 1999. Xenophon &Arrian, On hunting (Kynēgetikos). Warminster: Aris& Phillips.
  • Sprague, R. 1972. The Older Sophists. South Carolina: University of South Carolina Press.
  • Xenophon, Memorabilia, trans. A.L. Bonnette, Ithaca: Cornell University Press. 1994.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Barney, R. 2006. ‘The Sophistic Movement’, in M.L. Gill and P. Pellegrin (eds.), A Companion to Ancient Philosophy, 77-97. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Gibert, J. 2003. ‘The Sophists.’ In C. Shields (ed.), The Blackwell Guide to Ancient Philosophy, 27-50. Oxford, Blackwell.
  • Guthrie, W.K.C. 1971. The Sophists. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Kerferd, G.B. 1981a. The Sophistic Movement. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Kerferd, G.B. 1981b. The Sophists and their Legacy. Wiesbaden: Steiner.
  • Sidgwick, H. 1872. ‘The Sophists’.Journal of Philology 4, 289.
  • Untersteiner, M. 1954. The Sophists.trans. K. Freeman. Oxford: Basil Blackwell.

c. Other Reading

  • Adkins, A. 1960.Merit and Responsibility. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Benardete, S. 1991. The Rhetoric of Morality and Philosophy. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Bett, R. 1989. ‘The Sophists and Relativism.’Phronesis 34, 139-69.
  • Bett, R. 2002. ‘Is There a Sophistic Ethics?’ Ancient Philosophy, 22, 235-62.
  • Derrida, J. 1981. Dissemination, trans. B. Johnson. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Grote, G. 1904. A History of Greece vol.7. London: John Murray.
  • Hadot, P. 2004. What is Ancient Philosophy? Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Harrison, E.L. 1964. ‘Was Gorgias a Sophist?’ Phoenix vol. 18.3.
  • Hegel, G.W.F. 1995. Lectures on the History of Philosophy, trans. E.S. Haldane, Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press (original work published 1840).
  • Irwin, T.H. 1995. ‘Plato’s Objections to the Sophists’. In C.A. Powell (ed.), The Greek World, 568-87. London: Routledge.
  • Jarratt, S. 1991. Rereading the Sophists. Carbondale: Southern Illinois Press.
  • Kahn, Charles. 1983. ‘Drama and Dialectic in Plato’s Gorgias’ in Julia Annas (ed.) Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy vol. 1. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Kennedy, G. 1963. The Art of Persuasion in Ancient Greece, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • Lyotard, J.F. and Thébaud, J-L. 1985.  Just Gaming, trans. W. Godzich. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • McCoy, M. 2008. Plato on the Rhetoric of Philosophers and Sophists.Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Nehamas, A. 1990. ‘Eristic, Antilogic, Sophistic, Dialectic: Plato’s Demarcation of Philosophy from Sophistry’. History of Philosophy Quarterly, 7, 3-16.
  • Wardy, Robert. 1996. The Birth of Rhetoric: Gorgias, Plato and their successors. London: Routledge.

 

Author Information

George Duke
Email: george.duke@deakin.edu.au
Deakin University
Australia

Wang Chong (Wang Ch’ung) (25—100 C.E.)

Wang Chong (Wang Ch’ung) was an early Chinese philosopher who wrote during the Eastern Han dynasty. He is often interpreted as offering a materialist and skeptical philosophical system.  Wang’s essays on physics, astronomy, ethics, methodology, and criticism are collected in the Lunheng (“Balanced Discussions”), the work for which he is mainly known.  Largely self-taught, Wang demonstrates an encyclopedic knowledge of history and science in his work, and it was primarily as an encyclopedic resource that Wang’s Lunheng was read and preserved in later Chinese history.  The essays of the Lunheng focus on criticism of common views on all areas of philosophy and physics, and on appraisal of traditional philosophical texts.  Although much of Wang’s work is critical, he also develops positive views on a number of important topics, including methodology, the spontaneous workings of heaven and earth, and the concepts of qi (vital essence), ming (destiny), and xing (behavioral characteristics).  Although Wang’s influence was minimal during and immediately after his lifetime and for many years afterward (until a brief period of interest in the late 11th and 12th centuries), there was a resurgence of interest in his work in the 19th and 20th centuries both in China and the West, following the ascendance of scientific materialism in modern thought.  Interest in Wang was generated in this period by (in the West) studies in early Chinese science by figures such as Joseph Needham and Alfred Forke, and (in China) first by the critical movements in the late Qing and later the rise to dominance of the materialist Marxist thought of the Communist Party, which praised and elevated Wang’s thought for its opposition to superstition, materialism, and skepticism.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Works
  2. Textual Issues and Literary Style
  3. Purpose and Method
    1. On “Creation and Transmission”
    2. Truth/Reality (shi)
  4. Critical Thought
    1. Specific Criticisms of Philosophers
      1. Confucius
      2. Han Feizi
    2. Ghosts, the Supernatural, and Other Superstitions
      1. Ghosts
      2. Talent and Success
  5. Physics and Metaphysics
    1. Qi (Vital Essence/Fluid)
    2. Tian (Heaven)
    3. Astronomy and Physics
      1. Celestial Objects
      2. Heaven and Earth
  6. Ethics
    1. Ming (Destiny)
    2. Xing (Characteristics)
  7. Influence
    1. Influences and Place in Han Dynasty Thought
    2. Later Influence
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Life and Works

Wang Chong was born in the year 27 C.E. (according to his autobiography), in the village of Shangyu in Kuaiji Commandery (modern day Shaoxing, Zhejiang province) along the eastern coast of China.  His birth came in the third year of the reign of the first Eastern Han emperor Guangwu, who restored the Han Dynasty after defeating Wang Mang, the man who had seized power from the Western (or Early) Han and established the short lived “Xin” (New) Dynasty (9-23 C.E.). According to Wang in his autobiographical essay (contained in Lunheng), his family, reaching back to his grandfather Wang Fan (whose son Wang Song was Wang Chong’s father), was comprised of lower class troublemakers, even though it had more respectable origins, with Wang Fan’s father having been a landowner.  Because of their status and behavior, Wang Chong’s family moved a number of times, finally settling in Kuaiji.

In his autobiographical chapter, Wang speaks of his youth being one of straitened circumstances.  He was, however, still able to get an education by reading books while sitting around the stalls of booksellers, and in this way gained an encyclopedic knowledge of history, philosophy, and religion, as evidenced in Lunheng.  Based on the breadth of his knowledge, Wang Chong was (if his claims are taken seriously) one of the greatest autodidacts of early Chinese history.  His self-taught style is evidenced by the uncommon (some might claim awkward) literary style of his writings, which Wang defends in the autobiographical essay contained in Lunheng.

Wang rose to the position of Officer of Merit (gong shi) in Kuaiji, but held this position only briefly, his contrarian spirit no doubt making important enemies for him which led to the demise of his career.  This experience further disenchanted Wang with “common morals and beliefs,” and he went into retirement to write a number of works challenging these common views.  According to Wang, he was inspired to write “On Government” (Zhengwu) to remedy the perceived inadequacy of the imperial government (likely that of Emperor Ming but possibly that of Emperor Zhang), reinvigorating those engaged in governing.  His “Censures on Common Morals” (Jisu jieyi) was written in response to a number of “friends” who supported him while he had position quickly abandoning him once he lost his post.  Wang briefly held another position after this period, as an officer to Dong Qin, the inspector of Yang province, which he eventually resigned.

Also written during this period was “Macrobiotics” (Yangxing shu).  The work for which Wang Chong is known today (and his only extant work), Lunheng (“Balanced Discourses”) is likely a compilation of Wang’s works from this period, composed between 70 and 80 B.C.E., including parts of the above-mentioned works.  Timoteus Pokora and Michael Loewe suggest that Lunheng may initially have been a distinct work containing specifically critical philosophical essays (numbers 16-30 of the present Lunheng) that was later expanded to include Wang’s other extant writings to form a compilation under the same name.  They also suggest the biographical essay of Lunheng (Zi ji) may have been written by someone other than Wang (as its style and reference to Wang suggest).  The received version of Lunheng is based on Yang Wenchang’s 1045 C.E. edition.

In the later part of his life, again reclusive, Wang was requested at the court of the Emperor Zhang (Liu Da, 5th son of the Emperor Ming), on the recommendation of Wang’s friend Xie Yiwu, but declined the invitation on grounds of illness.  This (which must have happened before Zhang’s death in 88 C.E.) is the last account of the events of Wang Chong’s life before his death around 100 C.E.  A memorial was erected to Wang Chong (claiming to mark his tomb) in 1855 and again in 1981 after the original memorial’s destruction, that stands today in Shangyu.

2. Textual Issues and Literary Style

To a reader of Lunheng, it can appear that Wang sometimes contradicts himself, claiming one thing about a certain concept (such as qi, tian, or xing) in one essay that he rejects in another essay.  It should not be assumed on this basis, however, that Wang is inconsistent in his usage of key terms or confused about the concepts he discusses.  Lunheng should be seen as a kind of “collected works” of Wang Chong.  The various essays of the Lunheng are not ordered according to date of construction (it seems to be instead organized by theme), nor is any date noted anywhere in the text.  As a result, there is no way of knowing which essays were written at which points in Wang’s life, which essays were revised from earlier versions, based on alternative copies, and so forth.  Intellectual development and change, however, can be assumed throughout Wang’s career, and that some of the essays of Lunheng are more representative of Wang’s mature thought, and some of them his early thought.  This assumption cannot, of course, undermine or explain away all apparent inconsistency in Wang’s discussions (there is the possibility that he did in fact contradict himself or offer unclear or in some sense confused ideas), nor can it be certain which of the essays in the Lunheng represent which stage of Wang’s intellectual development. But it can be safely assumed that at least some of the inconsistency is due to the nature of the composition of Lunheng.
According to Wang himself, his style is deliberately simple and avoids “flowery language” which often perpetuates “empty” sayings (xu yan).  He argues at length in his essay Dui zuo that simple language and style (like his own) is essential for the project of searching for truth (shi), and that he purposefully says things in a simple and straightforward manner.

3. Purpose and Method

a. On “Creation and Transmission”

Wang is concerned to defend himself against charges of innovation, which was a major controversy in the Han dynasty, arising from the claims of Confucius (almost universally regarded as a sage or the highest sage) that he does not create (zuo), but merely transmits (shu) the ideas of the ancient sages.  This was taken as normative, such that it was read as an injunction for people not to create and instead merely to transmit.  To create was seen as arrogant and taken as tantamount to likening oneself to the sages or claiming superiority over them, which was seen as an unforgivable intellectual error.  A common criticism of literary works in Wang’s own time was to dismiss them on the grounds that they were “creations” (zuo), and thus arrogant and false attempts at innovation and self-aggrandizement by their authors.  Doubtlessly this charge was brought against Wang’s own work, because he feels the need to counter these charges in various essays in Lunheng, most directly and extensively in the essay Dui zuo (“Responses Concerning Creation”)

There, he argues that his work is not a creation, but is rather a “discussion” (lun), in which he considers the claims and arguments of other literary works and subjects them to questions and challenges in order to discover what in them is true, useful, or otherwise acceptable.  A creation, he argues, is something wholly new, and as such there are very few creations.  Almost no literary text counts as a creation, except for the very first invention of written language, as no literary work can wholly be independent and free from influence of the linguistic forms and thought of previous generations.  He further argues that even if his work could be considered a “creation”, it would still not be problematic.  Literary works ought to be appraised not on their faithfulness or lack thereof to the tradition or the views of the ancients, but instead on their truthfulness, usefulness, and correspondence to reality.  If a literary work is full of empty words and falsehoods, it should be rejected, even if conforming to tradition.  Likewise, if a literary work offers truths, it should be accepted, whether it is an innovation or not.  The ancients were not perfect—they were human, were ignorant of a great many things, and had the same tendencies to make mistakes and accept falsehoods that contemporaries do.  If things are merely accepted on the basis of their arising from tradition and the beliefs of the ancients (and conversely reject things not conforming with this standard), posterity is bound to simply perpetuate the mistakes inevitably made by the ancients, and accept the same falsehoods they did.

Wang is not, however, simply a contrarian or iconoclast.  He does think that there are a great many truths that can be learned from the ancients, and that  their teachings should not be rejected completely.  They should, however, be appraised using the methods he suggests of questioning and challenging (wen nan), in order to discover what is acceptable in these teachings.

Much of Wang’s critical material is devoted to various questions to and challenges of the writings and teachings of received and traditional works, as well as common (su) views and folk beliefs.  It is this aspect of Wang’s thought that has received most attention since the resurgence of interest in his work in the late 19th century in China and the west.  Because of this emphasis, Wang has often been labeled a “skeptic” (more common in early work on him than today).  This label, however, is somewhat misleading, given that Wang, as shown in below sections, had quite robust positive positions in metaphysics, ethics, and physical thought.  Wang saw his critical project as in the service of his positive project of obtaining the truth in general.

b. Truth/Reality (shi)

According to Wang his work aims at what he sees as the proper pursuit of literary and philosophical work in general, attainment of or discovery of truth, or reality (shi), and avoidance of falsity/empty words (xu, xu yan).  His method for discovery of truth largely consists in appraising the existing teachings and arguments of other philosophers, scholars, and schools, subjecting them to tests he describes as “questioning” (nan) and “challenging” (wen), standards that Wang in some places seems to take as interchangeable and other places he takes as distinct tools that operate differently.
One of the central features of true (shi) words, according to Wang, is that they are not flowery or ornate (hua), but direct and to the point.  Among other things, the term shi connotes the quality of concreteness.  Flowery or ornate words, on the other hand, are always to some extent empty.  Truth is only captured in simple and efficient language.  Thus, anything overly stylized is in some way an exaggeration, whether a major exaggeration (like words expressing the existence of supernatural beings such as ghosts) or a relatively minor one (attributing sagehood to a person who has merely done some good act).  The express purpose of Wang’s writing is based in appraisal.  Wang says, in the Dui zuo chapter:

“The Lunheng uses precise language and detailed discussion, to reveal and explain the doubts of this generation of common people, to bring to light through debate right and wrong patterns (shi fei zhi li), and to help those who come later clearly see the difference between what is the case and what is not the case.” (Lunheng, Dui zuo pian 84.364.10-11)

4. Critical Thought

a. Specific Criticisms of Philosophers

Although Wang subjects the writings of various philosophers to his questions and challenges in various parts of the Lunheng, his criticisms of two particular philosophers, Confucius and Han Feizi, are representative of his general critical view and method concerning received texts and teachings.

i. Confucius

Wang challenges Confucius on a number of points in the essay Wen kong (“Questioning Confucius”), most of these surrounding various inconsistencies and eccentricities in the Analects.  Although he accepts Confucius as a sage, Wang argues that Confucius did not always know what he was talking about, could be rash, cryptic, irritable, and uncharitable.  All of these features affected Confucius’ teachings, and thus what he says cannot be automatically trusted since they are the words of a sage.  For Wang, there is much in the Analects – for example, passages that reflect the influence of Mengzi or Mencius, which Wang saw as having corrupted the transmission of Confucius’ thought – and ought to be rejected.

ii. Han Feizi

Wang is far less positive about Han Feizi.  In the beginning of his essay Fei han (“Against Han Fei”), he says that he completely rejects Han Feizi’s views, on the basis of what he sees as a basic contradiction between his political theory and his action.  Han Feizi argues that scholars (specifically ru or Confucian scholars) are useless, that they drain the resources of the state while contributing nothing to the maintenance of state power.  For this reason, Han Feizi concludes they ought not to be employed by the state.  Wang points out in this essay that Han Feizi himself is a scholar, and certainly takes his own advice and views to be of benefit to the state.  If so, his claim of the uselessness of scholars is incorrect.  Alternatively, if he is right about the uselessness of scholars, it follows that his own teachings must be useless, and therefore false.  In the rest of the essay, Wang constructs an argument against Han Feizi in defense of the place of virtue and imitation of the sages, which the ru scholars are employed to teach.

b. Ghosts, the Supernatural, and Other Superstitions

In addition to his challenges to specific philosophers and texts, Wang criticizes a number of things he calls “common” or “vulgar” (su) beliefs, traditions, and superstitions, often concerning things such as the existence and agency of supernatural entities such as ghosts, deities, mythical creatures such as dragons, and Heaven itself as a sentient agent.  Among the views he is concerned to dispatch is the view that these supernatural entities have the power to reward and punish people for their actions, which is entrenched in Han society.
Wang attacks a great number of “common” beliefs throughout the Lunheng, including (but not limited to): the view that Heaven rewards and punishes people for their behavior, the view that natural and weather events such as thunder and lightning or earthquakes represent the anger (or other emotion) of Heaven or some other supernatural agent; the view the that the mental states of the ruler (happiness, anger, beneficence and so forth) have some physical effect on the land or weather (such that it is warm outside when the ruler is happy and cold when he’s angry); the view that people in the days of the ancients (not only the sages) were of greater moral ability and had more robust physical statures than contemporary people; and the view that a person’s virtue and talent is linked to (has a causal role in) his professional success and personal fortune.  Wang’s positions against ghosts and against the causal link between talent and success serve as good examples of this aspect of his critical thought.

i. Ghosts

Wang offers a number of arguments against what he sees as the “common” and superstitious belief in ghosts and other paranormal entities.  Perhaps his most sustained (and humorous) consideration of the difficulties with common beliefs about the existence and activities of ghosts comes in his essay Lun si (“Discussion Concerning Death”), in which he presents a number of fatal objections to the ghost hypothesis.
The following are three examples of arguments Wang gives against the common belief in ghosts and their ability to interact with living persons in Lun si:

(1) Argument from physical shape:  The death of a person is the result of the body losing the animating qi (vital essence), and once the qi is separated from the body, the body decays.  All will admit to this.  If this is so, however, and the person’s qi is still existent, how can this qi itself manifest in the form of a physical shape?  It is not a body, it is qi.  But when one sees a ghost, one sees a body.  But if the person has died, they no longer have a body, so where could they get another one?  They cannot take over another living body, which will already possess its own qi.  Thus, the view that people when they die become ghosts is nonsensical.

(2) Argument from population:  If people become ghosts when they die, there should be more ghost sightings than living people, as the number of people who have lived in the past and died is far greater than the number of people now living.  This is not true — ghost “sightings” are rare.  Thus it cannot be that people when they die become ghosts.

(3) Argument from ghostly efficacy:  If a living person is harmed, this person will immediately go to a magistrate and bring a case against the party who harmed them.  If it were the case that people become ghosts when they die and can interact with living humans, every ghostly murder victim would be seen going to a magistrate, telling him the name of the killer and the means of murder, leading him to the body, and so forth.  This is never witnessed (ever).

ii. Talent and Success

Wang is concerned with arguing against the generally accepted view that success is proportionate to talent or virtue and that long life is proportionate to goodness.  Instead, Wang argues, a person’s success and fortune is tied to his destiny (ming), and the length of one’s life is tied to the amount and quality of qi one receives (spontaneously) at birth.  The common view, Wang claims, concerning success is that talent and virtue are determining factors for success, and that one can thus know whether a person is talented and/or virtuous by observing the person’s fortunes.  The high-ranking and powerful are clearly talented and virtuous, while the poor and rejected must lack talent and virtue.
Wang takes aim at this view in a number of essays in Lunheng (one gets the feeling that the special vitriol directed at this particular view is not unrelated to Wang’s own failure to achieve high office and the attendant perceptions or claims about his level of talent).  There are plenty of examples from history, Wang argues, that demonstrate a disconnect between talent and success.  The example of the sage himself, Confucius, suggests a problem with the common view.  No one was more talented than Confucius, Wang argues, yet his career was the very definition of failure.  It often happens that the vicious, duplicitous, and scheming person can rise to great heights in political (or other) power, while a person of genius or moral excellence fails to obtain position at all.  Luck is a greater factor in one’s success than talent.  The possible reasons for the rise of a vicious or untalented person are many.  Sometimes rulers are incompetent, lack time to reflect on their appointments, and are attracted to some irrelevant quality in a person, and so on.

5. Physics and Metaphysics

a. Qi (Vital Essence/Fluid)

Wang’s views of nature and events in the world are grounded in an explanatory system in which all changes are due to the spontaneous movement of qi (vital essence/fluid).  This qi is given forth by tian (heaven), and gives things their unique character.  Wang discusses many different types of qi, and the term is used to discuss such a wide-ranging number of phenomena that it becomes problematic to try to define just what the concept of qi is such that it is narrow enough to capture all of the phenomena Wang discusses.
He attributes all motion, causation, and even human character to qi, with different types of qi responsible for different kinds of event or character.  Tian creates qi, but not in an active and willful manner.  Rather, it is better to think of qi as emanating from tian.  In a number of places, Wang talks of the creation of things by tian as analogous to the creation of new persons through the mixing of sperm and egg (the male and female physical qi), in order to emphasize its spontaneity, or generation without intent or will.
Qi is at the center of Wang’s understanding of creative activity in the world.  He refers to qi to explain every non-agent based phenomenon he considers–such diverse events as the generation of a human, seasonal and temperature changes, physical health and length of life (although he ties this to ming in a way discussed below), and the creation and destruction or transformation of objects in general.  Qi, for Wang, seems to have a general as well as specific meanings, in general referring to a causally efficacious agent of change in entities in the world, and in specific referring to a particular causal qi, such as the (presumably physical) qi of the male and female that results in procreation when mixed together (Alfred Forke intuitively translates this as ‘fluid’), or the psychic qi causing behavioral dispositions (xing).
Qi emanates from or is created by tian (Heaven), although this creation should not be seen as agent creation.  Tian, as described below, creates spontaneously (ziran), and without intention.  Such creation is the paradigm of natural action, creation, destruction, and change, according to Wang.  Even humans, in some sense (described below) are determined in their physical and mental states and behaviors by causal features which happen spontaneously.  Wang is not altogether comfortable with the picture of the cosmos that seems to subsume human action fully in mechanistic nature, and in his account of human character and behavior he attempts to make room for human will or intention in his mechanistic scheme.  In his Ziran essay, he claims that what distinguishes humans from mere mechanistic puppets (ou ren) is the human possession of spontaneous nature/characteristics (xing ziran).  This seems to show Wang thinks of human agency as, in itself, spontaneous.  At the same time, the spontaneous nature of human agency cannot be the same spontaneity evident in the activity of heaven (tian), which should not, according to Wang, be thought of in terms of agency.

b. Tian (Heaven)

Wang argues against a number of “common” views concerning natural events that take such events to be directed by tian, as a divine agent, in response to human actions.  Wang rejects the agency of tian, instead seeing it naturalistically, as a principle generating qi spontaneously and without intention.  Causal efficacy is involved here without will or intention.  Tian has neither eyes nor mouth, hands nor feet (and presumably without a mind).
As is common of concepts in the Lunheng, there is more concentration on what tian is not than what exactly it is.  It is not exactly clear whether Wang thinks of tian as a constructive principle, the cosmos itself, the physical and distant source of qi, or something else completely.  All that he is explicit about is that tian is naturalistic, works spontaneously, and is unlike humans.
Since tian is not a divine agent, and cannot act intentionally, it cannot be the case, contrary the “common” view, that tian can reward people for virtuous action and punish them for vice.  The view of tian as rewarding and punishing agent is the one Wang is most concerned with overturning, and thus most of his explicit discussion of tian in Lunheng is focused on developing arguments against this view.  His specific arguments tend to fall into two categories:  argument from lack of efficacy and argument from lack of tools.
Regarding lack of efficacy, if tian can reward and punish as the common view claims, why can’t tian simply install proper or excellent rulers who will ensure things are done correctly, rather than allowing bad rulers to come to power who then have to be subsequently punished?  In addition, the claim that tian punishes people through seemingly natural events such as striking them by lightning and leaving etchings resembling words describing crimes they are guilty of on their forehead must be false.  Why would tian not be more efficient in its punishment?  And why would it not etch the character on the punished person’s head such that it was clearly legible, and thus could serve as a clear example for others?
Regarding lack of tools, tian has neither mouth nor eyes, neither arms nor legs.  How can tian thus create things willfully, constructing them along human lines?  A sign of things that are created spontaneously (ziran) and without willful intent is that they happen without construction, like a human created in the womb upon a mixture of the physical fluids (qi) of a male and female.  In nature, things are created thus, rather than constructed with arms and tools, so how can it be said that  tian willfully creates?  Wang argues that tian is identifiable neither with a body nor with air (both of which are advanced by some). If tian does have a body, it must be very distant from humans, there are no signs for it (Wang offers the seemingly arbitrary “enormous” number of 60,000 li distant).  Surely, if it is this distant, it cannot interact with mankind or be aware of even mankind’s most explicit actions, let alone secret desires and motivations.
In addition to arguing for the implausibility of the divine agency reading of tian, Wang offers an explanation of the psychology which seems all too willing to see agency as rampant in the natural world.  He argues that because people engaged in corrupting action, it was necessary (for rulers) to institute laws, punishments, incitements to proper action, and rewards.  This was attributed to tian rather than to the ruler, who presumably had an interest in fostering a general belief that an omniscient and completely unconquerable divine entity is responsible for enforcing what amounts to the ruler’s laws, rather than the all too human, and thus vulnerable, ruler himself.

c. Astronomy and Physics

Wang’s positions on astronomy and physics were, following his metaphysical positions, naturalistic (with respect to the dominant views of his day), and Wang rejected a number of popular positions on the workings of the sun, planets, and stars.  The following are some representative examples of his views in this area.

i. Celestial Objects

Wang challenges the views he attributes to the ru scholars concerning the origin and movements of the sun.  They claim, according to Wang, that the sun emerges from and descends into the darkness of the yin physical qi, so that the sun literally “goes out” when it sets, subsumed in the yin.  Wang argues that it is not the case that the sun goes out or becomes dark, just as a fire does not become obscured by the darkness when night falls.
Wang argues that the movements of the sun and the moon are connected to the movements of the stars and planets in general, noticing the regularities in the motions of the sun and moon, and their correlation with other movements and placements in the heavens (movement through the zodiac, the planets along the ecliptic, and so forth).  This makes the sun and moon different from the clouds, for example, which move completely independently from the motions of the stars and planets.
The sun, according to Wang, is of the nature of fire, and also has the principle of motion, due to its qi, which is similar to that of the moon and the planets, which are also in motion, while Earth is stationary.  Concerning solar eclipses, Wang’s position is that the sun eclipses spontaneously, arguing against the view that such eclipses are caused by the moon.
While a number of Wang’s views on celestial objects and motion are opposed to our current understandings, his position on the geometry of celestial objects sounds much more modern.  Wang argues that the sun, moon, planets, and stars are not circular even though they appear to be so.  That they appear so is due to their distance.

ii. Heaven and Earth

Heaven (tian) and Earth (di), according to Wang, began small and through time expanded to their current size, via spontaneous growth.  Because of this, Heaven must be far distant from humans (Wang offers a distance of 60,000 li), and for this reason, among others, cannot be said to interact with human beings.
Concerning climate, Wang’s view is that the elements influence the temperature in different areas, and that in the southern regions fire is dominant, while in the northern regions water is dominant.  Heat is caused by proximity to fire, which explains why the southern regions are warmer than the northern, while proximity to water causes things to become cold, which accounts for the lower temperatures in the north.
Wang’s views concerning the source of rain is surprisingly close to our contemporary understanding, and Wang seems to have had some understanding of the water cycle.

6. Ethics

a. Ming (Destiny)

Ming, according to Wang, is the primary determinant of the outcome of a person’s life.  Whether one is successful in one’s career, one has a difficult or easy life full of catastrophes or fortunate turns, whether one is ill or in good health, dies young or in ripe old age–all of this is due to the quality and type of one’s ming.  There are different ming, according to Wang, concerning different aspects of human life.  Thus, there is a ming governing one’s fortunes, a ming governing the length of one’s life, and a ming concerning the welfare of the state, for example.  Wang sees ming not as a metaphysical entity in itself or a power, but as something like a higher-level concept, based on lower-level individuating features ensuring a certain destiny, most often qi.  The fact that there can be different ming might be understood then as flagging the fact that there are different lower-level properties contributing to or somehow responsible for the ming of the entity in question with respect to the property in question (fortune, length of life, talent, and so forth).
This allows Wang to construe ming in a naturalistically respectable way while countenancing its existence and disagreeing with the “common” view of ming as decreed by a divine heavenly agent.  Examples can be seen in the essay Ming yi.  One’s destiny (concerning all aspects) is given by Heaven (spontaneously, rather than consciously), and insofar as this is a natural quality, the destiny of a person regarding different aspects can be revealed in features of their bodies and actions.  The ming concerning length of life, for example, can be seen by examining the physical features of a person.  Some people are sallow, weakly, and frail, and this is an indication that their ming commits them to a (relatively) short life.  Alternatively, those who appear fit and strong can be seen to have a ming allowing them long and healthy lives.
The obvious problem arises here, of course, that it is often the case that the frail live deep into old age and the strong die young.  In fact, in cases of deaths in war, it will generally only be the strong and fit who are killed, and the frail (who stay home rather than fighting) who are spared.  How can this be squared with Wang’s conception of ming?  Wang argues that there are often competing ming, and that one ming might overcome another.  A key example this is the ming of the state.  The ming of the state trumps the ming of the individual, for reasons Wang is not completely clear about.  Some things he says suggests that the view is that the state is a larger, more important, and integrated entity of which the individual is simply a part, and its ming therefore overcomes that of the individual.  A state at war or in chaos, for example, will be one in which young, robust, and strong individuals will often meet their deaths earlier than their individual ming (the one governing their length of life) would otherwise determine.  The ming of the state, or other ming, that is, can interfere with or make irrelevant the individual ming.
To further explain this, in addition to discussing the different entities and aspects ming can attach to, Wang discusses three different types of ming in Ming yi: zheng (regular), sui (contingent), and zao (incidental).  Although he first seems to define these types of ming in such a way as to suggest that they are essentially modal, later in the essay he connects them to specific qualities of outcome, such that one with a regular ming will enjoy a long life and fortune, while one with incidental ming will have a short and likely miserable life, encountering a multitude of misfortunes.  The different types of ming can overcome one another, just as the ming of the state overcomes that of the individual.  Thus, a contingent ming can cancel an incidental ming and vice versa.  Wang is less than fully clear on how this works.  Although he does leave room for willful human activity to change outcomes in one’s life (contingent ming), sometimes the natural features of a situation are so strong that they cannot be overcome by effort or incident.  One example Wang uses is of the doctor being unable to save a person whose allotted life span is up, no matter how hard he may try or how skilled a doctor he may be.

b. Xing (Characteristics)

While Wang’s use of the term xing is broader than the specifically ethical use (he uses it to refer to physical as well as behavioral characteristics), his interesting and more philosophically relevant use of this term is an ethical one.  When he discusses xing as a concept, Wang seems concerned with its ethical aspects.  Wang explains character, like all other phenomena, as being based on the quantity and quality of qi possessed by the individual.  The individual’s destiny (ming) is also a relevant factor in determining character.  In some places, Wang connects these concepts by holding ming to be the determining factor of what kind and how much qi one receives from Heaven, while in other places he seems to make qi the more fundamental concept in connection with character, and takes one’s type of ming to be based in the type or amount of qi one is born with, and completely independent of characteristics (xing). Thus, one born with abundant and strong qi thereby is destined to live a long life, barring circumstantial events that might cut this life short (such as natural disasters, wars, and so forth. connected to the destiny [ming] of the state or the earth, which can supersede individual destiny).  In a number of chapters, Wang argues that one can have a lofty character and at the same time an unfortunate or calamitous destiny.  Observable facts prove this, Wang claims, as there are many talented and virtuous scholars who live lives of suffering and failure and reach early deaths, while untalented and vicious scholars achieve the heights of fame, fortune, and prosperity.  The same is true of rulers and states–there is no causal connection between virtuous rule and ordered or harmonious society, despite the claims of ru scholars.  This is due in part to the lack of connection between the character of a ruler and his destiny.  If a virtuous king has a calamitous destiny, he will be ignored and non-influential, thus his virtue will not translate to the harmonious functioning of society.  Because, according to Wang, destiny is accorded spontaneously, virtue is impotent to transform it. (Zhi chao)
Human action is only in part due to agency, according to Wang, and behavior is determined to a large extent by the situation in society and the world in general.  Moral conduct, for example, is not (fully) attributable to a person’s substantial characteristics (zhi xing), according to Wang, but is mostly dependent on whether or not there is sufficient food, which in turn depends on whether or not there is drought or flooding, and the general state of the climate and land.  Wang claims that when food is sufficient, people will act consistently with ritual and appropriateness (li yi), and the society will be peaceful and orderly.

7. Influence

a. Influences and Place in Han Dynasty Thought

Rafe de Crespigny argues that Wang may have been influenced by Huan Tan, and thereby the Old Text school, thus making sense of his attack on New Text Confucians (although this is mainly speculative).  Wang’s views on qi, tian, ming, and so forth. are clearly influenced by earlier Han and pre-Han thinkers.  Wang claims influence by Confucius, Mencius, Yang Xiong, Dong Zhongshu, as well as Daoist figures such Laozi, although all of these figures are targets of Wang’s criticisms in various places in Lunheng as well.  Interestingly, some of the same stories and accounts of these thinkers Wang uses in some essays to prove their sagehood are used in other essays to undermine their authority or criticize their views more generally.  If Lunheng is taken as unitary and generally representative (assuming that Wang’s views of these philosophers did not change over time), it has to be concluded that he had an ambivalent reaction to these philosophers, seeing them as in some ways exemplary and praiseworthy, while still having (in some cases fatally undermining) flaws.  Indeed, one of Wang’s positions is that later generations should not make the mistake he sees ru scholars making concerning the sages of the past, in assuming that everything they said or taught can be taken as true or even useful, or assuming that everything they did was virtuous or otherwise proper.  Probably for this reason, among others, Wang’s own influence in the Han itself was negligible.

b. Later Influence

Although Wang’s influence in his own time and directly after was almost negligible, and his Lunheng survived mainly because of its perceived interest as an almost encyclopedic collection of historical, mythological, and literary material from early China, Wang’s work did undergo a surge of interest in the modern period, beginning with Qing scholars in the 19th century, who wrote a number of commentaries on the Lunheng, including Yu Yue, Sun Yirang, Yang Shoujing, Liu Bansui, and later Huang Hui.  The resurgence of interest in Wang Chong’s work was likely due to the critical spirit bubbling in the late Qing and into the Republican period, and was maintained through the period of the rise of Marxist materialism.  The critical and seemingly anti-traditional character of Wang’s thought proved amenable to modern thinkers from the late Qing through today.  Since the late 19th century, there have been a number of commentaries and interpretive studies on Wang Chong’s work, mainly in Chinese, Japanese, and Korean scholarship.  Wang’s work was basically unknown in the West until the late 19th century, and since then there has been some level of interest in and scholarship on Wang’s work, mainly historical and philological, and (to a lesser extent) philosophical.

8. References and Further Reading

The amount of work on Wang Chong in English is limited, and much of what does exist is either translation (Forke), or secondary work dealing with Han thought more generally (Loewe, Czikszentmihalyi).  The following list focuses mainly on English language scholarship, but also includes important Chinese works.  Those with facility in the Chinese language are encouraged to start with the more extensive Chinese sources (Zhou, Liu).

  • Chan, Wing-tsit. A Sourcebook in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton University Press, 1969.
  • Czikszentmihalyi, Mark. Readings in Han Chinese Thought. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2006.
  • De Crespigny, Rafe. A Biographical Dictionary of Later Han to the Three Kingdoms (23-220 AD). Brill, 2007.
  • Forke, Alfred. Lun Heng: Philosophical and Miscellaneous Essays of Wang Ch’ung (Part I and II). Second Edition.  New York: Paragon Book Gallery, 1962.
  • Lin Lixue, Wang Chong.  Taipei: Sanmin Shuju, 1991.
  • Liu Jinming, Wang Chong zhexue de zai faxian (The Rediscovery of Wang Chong’s Philosophy).  Taipei: Wenjin Chubanshe, 2006.
  • Loewe, Michael. Early Chinese Texts: A Biographical Guide. Berkeley: Institute of East Asian Studies, 1994.
  • Loewe, Michael. Faith, Myth, and Reason in Han China. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2005
  • Makeham, John. Name and Actuality in Early Chinese Thought. Albany: SUNY Press, 1994.
  • McLeod, Alexus. “A Reappraisal of Wang Chong’s Critical Method Through the Wenkong Chapter.” Journal of Chinese Philosophy, 34:4 (2007).
  • McLeod, Alexus . “Pluralism About Truth in Early Chinese Philosophy: A Reflection on Wang Chong’s Approach.” Comparative Philosophy, 2:1 (2011).
  • Needham, Joseph. Science and Civilization in Early China, Vol. 3.  Cambridge University Press, 1959.
  • Nylan, Michael. “Han Classicists Writing About Their Own Tradition.” Philosophy East and West, 47:2 (1997).
  • Puett, Michael.  “Listening to Sages: Divinations, Omens, and the Rhetoric of Antiquity in Wang Chong’s Lunheng.” Oriens Extremis, 45 (2005-2006): 271-281.
  • Zhou Guidian, Xu shi zhi bian: Wang Chong Zhexue de zong zhi (The Distinction Between Truth and Falsity: The Purpose of Wang Chong’s Philosophy).  Beijing: Renmin Chubanshe, 1994
  • Zufferey, Nicolas, Wang Chong (27-97?): Connaissance, politique et verite en Chine ancienne. Bern: Peter Lang, 1995.

 

Author Information

Alexus McLeod
Email: gmcleod1@udayton.edu
University of Dayton
U. S. A.

Gaudapada (c. 500 C.E.)

http://commons.wikimedia.org/wiki/File%3AShri_Gaudapadacharya_Statue.jpgGauḍapāda is one of the early and most reputed philosophers of the Vedānta school in the Indian system of thought, who is believed to have lived roughly during 500 C.E. In the spiritual lineage, Gauḍapāda is regarded as the grand preceptor of Śaṅkaracarya [8th c. C.E.], the systematizer of Advaita Vedānta. Gauḍapāda is best known for his analytical exposition on the tenets of Advaita Vedānta that provided a firm ontological grounding to Vedānta philosophy. Gauḍapāda’s expository interpretation of the Upaniṣadic literature in the light of logical reasoning is a critical apparatus of epistemological exposition in the Advaita tradition.

According to Gauḍapāda’s thesis, the ultimate ontological reality is the pure consciousness, which is bereft of attributes and intentionality. The world of duality is nothing but a vibration of the mind (manodṛśya or manaspandita). The pluralistic world is imagined by the mind (saṁkalpa) and this false projection is sponsored by the illusory factor called māyā. The origination of the individual soul, which experiences the world of duality, is figurative. The finitude of the individuality of the soul is caused due to nescience (avidyā), while in reality its nature is identical with the ultimate soul – pure consciousness. The knowledge of non-difference between the individual and the supreme soul alone leads to liberation.

Gauḍapāda’s influence has probably been most far-reaching in the development of Advaita Vedānta through the ages. He is well-known for his conception of ‘contact-less contemplation’ (asparśa yoga) a key soteriological notion of Advaita Vedānta. More famous is his doctrine of non-origination (ajāti-vāda), with which he establishes the eternality and non-duality of consciousness. The philosophy of Gauḍapāda may be characterized as absolute non-dualism and establishes this doctrine both by the method of affirmation and negation (adhyāropa and apavāda). He explains the doctrine of advaita-vāda using illustrations such as “quenching of fire-brand” (alātaśānti) and the phantasmagoric city (gandharva-nagara) to systematically expound the falsity of the world.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Works of Gauḍapāda
  2. An Overview of Gauḍapāda’s Māṇdūkya kārikā
  3. Gauḍapāda’s Onto-theology
  4. Metaphysics
    1. Theory of Non-origination (ajāti vāda)
    2. Contact-less Contemplation (asparśa yoga)
  5. Phenomenology of Consciousness – Quenching of Fire-brand alāta śānti
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary References
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Works of Gauḍapāda

 

Within the Advaita tradition, Gauḍapāda is regarded as the disciple of the legendary sage śukha and is the teacher of Govinda bhagavadpāda, who is śaṅkarācārya’s direct preceptor. śaṅkara, in his works, exhibits extreme reverence to Gauḍapāda. Gauḍapāda is referred to by the terms sampradāyavit – knower of the tradition, paramaguru – grand preceptor, ‘vddha ācārya’ – ancient preceptor, and so on. All that is known about Gauḍapāda is mostly derived from his name. The term ‘Gauḍa’, according to some scholars, indicates his geographical origin, which is the region of Bengal. Alternatively, we find some references to Gauḍapāda by the term ‘Gauācārya’ – a compound word which means the ‘teacher of the Gauḍa’. Here again the term ‘Gauḍa’ clearly denotes a place and is not a proper name. Also, Sureśvarācārya (a direct disciple of śaṅkara), in his work Naikarmya Siddhi IV.44, refers him as ‘Gaua. From a 13th century prolific glossator, ānandagiri, we gather that Gauḍapāda spent some time in Badrikāśrama absorbed in deep meditation. Another legend about Gauḍapāda, narrated by a 17th c. advaitin, informs us that there was a place near a river Hīraravati in Kurukshetra (the northern region of today’s Bengal), a place where some Gauḍa people lived. According to this note, the term ‘Gaua’ connotes a specific ethnic group belonging to a particular geographical origin. It was in this place the ācārya was absorbed in meditation and hence the name Gauḍapādācārya. Apart from these abstract conjectures on the life of Gauḍapāda, his dates are also not clearly established. From the references from the Buddhist writers who cite Gauḍapāda as the source of substantial evidence, some scholars attempt to give a rough idea on Gauḍapāda’s date. Vidhushekhara Bhattacarya and T. M. P. Mahadevan bring to our notice that three Buddhist writers, namely, Bhavaviveka, Santaraksita and Kamalasila have cited Gauḍapada’s kārikā-s in their works. Karl Potter suggests that Bhavaviveka is the younger contemporary of Dharmapala, who according to early Chinese travel accounts seems to have flourished during 5th c. C.E From this information we may fix Gauḍapada’s date not later than 5th c. C.E. A few other scholars fix Gauḍapāda’s date in accordance to śaṅkara’s date, which then would push his date further to 6th c. C.E. Some other scholars bring to our notice that Gauḍapāda himself cites some Buddhist views of Nāgārjuna and Asanga, with which we could fix the upper limit to 4th c. C.E.

All the scholars agree that Gauḍapāda’s most prominent work, is his metrical commentary on the Mādūkya Upaniad called the Mādūkya kārikā. It is otherwise called Gauḍapādīya or Gauḍapāda kārika. Thanga Swamy and Tandalam Narayana Swamy Iyer indicate that there is a commentary on the Nsimha Uttara Tāpini Upaniad authored by Gauḍapāda. A commentary (bhāya) on the Sāmkhya kārikā of īśvara Krsna is attributed to Gauḍapāda. There is yet another commentary – a vtti on the Uttara gīta is also attributed to Gauḍapāda. In the tantric tradition, works like the Durgāsaptasati, Subhagodaya stuti and śri Vidyāratna Sūtra’s authorship is ascribed to Gauḍapāda. These works are supposedly on the śri Vidyā tradition.  Some scholars maintain that there are multiple Gauḍapāda-s who belong to different times and places while the Mādūkya kārikā is the only work of Gauḍapāda who is śaṅkara’s grand preceptor.

2. An Overview of Gauḍapāda’s Māṇdūkya kārikā

 

A kārikā is usually a crisp condensation of a subject matter or an explication of a specific doctrinal position. The Mādūkya kārikā is a metrical commentary on the Mādūkya Upaniad, which belongs to the Atharva Veda.  The Gauḍapāda kārikā seems to be a collection of terse aphorisms consolidated under different topics of Advaita Vedānta. The kārikā is pedagogically instructive in its tone. Traditionally, the Mādūkya kārikā is regarded as an exhaustive manual for the fundamentals of Advaita Vedānta and hence called Upadeśa grantha. Gauḍapāda’s kārikā has 215 verses distributed in four chapters. The relation between the Mādūkya Upaniad and the kārikā-s remains abstract. The four chapters are namely, a. āgama prakaraa – the chapter regarding the scriptures consisting of 29 verses b. Vaitathya prakaraa – the chapter regarding illusion consisting of 38 verses c. advaita prakaraa – the chapter on non-duality constituting 48 verses and d. alātaśanti prakaraa – the chapter on the fire-brand comprising of 100 verses. There are some traditional views, which consider the 29 verses in the first chapter of the kārikā as the Upanisad itself. The main purport of these four chapters of the kārikā is to delineate the quintessence of Vedāntic content as commenced in the Upanisad. The first chapter is an exposition of the Upanisadic content mainly to describe the nature of the absolute ontological being. Expounding upon the states of psycho-physical experiences (waking, dream and profound sleep) as primary constituents of metempsychic existence, the kārikā discusses various positions on the theories of creation. Based on the Upanisadic cohort, the kārikā, in this chapter, attempts to initiate the Advaitic position that the template of creation is temporally apparent and ultimately unreal. The second chapter of the kārikā proposes to logically establish the theory of illusion. The rationality of the third chapter of the kārikā is to firmly establish the position of non-duality (advaita) by the method of methodical assertion and negation (adhyāropa and apavāda). Finally, the objective of the fourth chapter mainly seeks to explicate the notion of the ‘contactless yoga’ (asparśa) to assert the theory of non-origination (ajāti) of the eternal soul as expounded in the third chapter. The refutation of the creation theories remains to be the prime focus of all the four chapters.

There is an intense controversy in modern scholarship over the correct interpretation of the philosophy and the structure of Mādūkya kārikā. Vidhushekhara Bhattacarya advocates that the four chapters do not constitute a unitary text of the Mādūkya kārikā. According to Bhattacarya, the four chapters of the Mādūkya kārikā are four independent treatises and were later consolidated into one title called āgamaśāstra. He also observes that the first chapter of the Mādūkya kārikā does not systematically expound the prose content of the Mādūkya Upaniad and this led Bhattacarya to conclude that the first chapter of the kārikā predates the  Upaniadic content.  Owing to copious references to ‘Buddha’ in the fourth chapter (IV.19, 42,80, 88, 98, 99) and for the claim that the term ‘alātaśānti’ is a peculiar to Buddhists, Bhattacarya advocates that Mādūkya kārikā is more inclined to Buddhist philosophy than to Vedānta. However, Richard King in his detailed analysis on the date and authorship of the text rejects the Bhattacarya’s hypothesis, while he arrives at a conclusion that the final or the fourth chapter (the alātaśanti prakaraa) is a later text composed perhaps for a different audience by some other author who is heavily influenced by Gauḍapāda. According to King, the fourth chapter profusely adopts Buddhist terminologies especially from the Mādhyamaka and the Yogācāra philosophical traditions. Richard King also shows that the prominent Advaitins (beginning from 8th to 17th C.E) completely omit any reference to the fourth chapter in their respective works. King also contends that the first three chapters of the Mādūkya kārikā were linked by the śaṅkarite tradition by the 8th century of the Common Era and was eventually attributed to the author who bore the title ‘Gaua’.

3. Gauḍapāda’s Onto-theology

 

The sacred syllable OM, also known as praava is regarded as the absolute being. Gauḍapāda suggests that the structure of the sacred syllable has linguistic connections to, and homologically implies, onto-theological connotations. The kārikā of the āgama prakaraa begins with the appraisal of the method of contemplation of the praava. Gauḍapāda regards OM as the sound from which the entire creation springs forth. OM is the root for all speech. Gauḍapāda suggests that the sonic praava is discerned with its four fold linguistic measures (mātra-s) representing the gradational states of consciousness. The four mātra-s are  a, u, m & the OM. According to the phonetic rules of Sanksrit, the first two mātra-s, ‘a’ & ‘u’ combine to render a diphthong ‘o’ resulting in the sonic OM. Each of these phonetic elements is homologous to the states of experience of the individual soul. The sound ‘a’ of the praava represents the waking state (jāgrat), which Gauḍapāda calls the all pervasive, external, universal consciousness known by the term ‘āpti’. In this state, the individual soul bears the name viśva – who is the enjoyer of the gross objects (sthūla bhuk). Secondly, the phonetic element ‘u’ represents the dream state in which the individual soul becomes the enjoyer of the internal objects (antaprajña) and is called the sūkma bhuk. In this state the soul bears the name ‘taijasa’. Gauḍapāda refers to the nature state of the internal consciousness by the term ‘utkara’ meaning ecstasy. The third state is of profound sleep (suupti) and is represented by the sound ‘m’. The individual soul in profound sleep is the enjoyer of bliss (ānanda bhuk). The profound sleep, as Gauḍapāda describes, is a state of intense consciousness in its causal state in which the gross and subtle state of objective experiences get dissolved (laya). Finally, the fourth state is known as the turīya and is absolutely transcendental to all the phenomenal states of apparent realities. The fourth state  is measureless (amātra) and is devoid of all attributes whatsoever. This turīya, as Gauḍapāda conveys, is non-dual (advaita), the reality of Lord-hood (īśāna), the seer of everything (sarva dk). It is in this state, as Gauḍapāda in kārikā I.17 points out, all the phenomenal realities of the world would cease (prapañcopaśamam) to have any existence. All the dualities are merely sponsored by the indiscernible factor of māyā and in reality they do not exist at all.

Gauḍapāda identifies this fourth state of the absolute attributeless Being – the praṇava and the phonetic components of praṇava with the state of individual experience relegated in different gradations of consciousness. The realization of turīya as the attributeless consciousness is the real awakening from the state of profound sleep. The awakening is accomplished by contemplating on the praṇava and this is called the praṇava yoga. Apophatically, the praṇava  yoga is the final salvific process and Gauḍapāda considers it to be an onto-soteriological guarantee for the emancipation of the individual soul.

4. Metaphysics

a. Theory of Non-origination (ajāti vāda)

The fulcrum of Gauḍapāda’s philosophy of non-duality is the theory of non-origination known as the  ajāti vāda in Sanskrit. The theory of non-origination is constructed on the fundamental premise that ‘nothing is ever born, nothing is created whatsoever and there is no transactional reality at any rate’. The phenomenal reality is figurative and is imagined upon the Self  by its own magical power called māyā. In the second and the third chapter of the kārikā, Gauḍapāda discusses this theory in detail. Gauḍapāda primarily adopts the logical method of superimposition and subsequent negation (adyāropa-apavāda) to establish the concept of non-origination of the Self. The Self is the only non-dual reality and whatever exists apart from that reality is logically reduced as unreal and is subsequently negated to absolute non-existence.

The doctrine of ajāti vāda – the theory of non-origination aims at dismantling all the theories of creation in order to suggest that there is no creation that has ever occurred. Gauḍapāda’s logical postulation is that when the Self is the only reality that remains eternal, whatever it is that seems to exist apart from the non-dual self must be unreal and hence non-existent. Gauḍapāda in the kārikā I.17 maintains the premise that ‘if the world ever existed then it would at some point cease to exist. But since the Self alone is the eternal existence, the phenomenal world is known to be absolute non-existence only’. Gauḍapāda also points out that the creation has no purpose in any metaphysical sense. Creation cannot serve the purpose of any experience to the divine Being since the Upaniṣadic import insists that the ultimate being is ever-accomplished and it transcends all phenomenal relations. Secondly, purpose of creation cannot be taken as the God’s sport or the divine play (līla) since it is an unwelcome position to suppose that the cosmogenically omnipotent God has some desire to be accomplished.

Gauḍapāda introduces the concept of non-origination in the vaitathya prakaraṇa where he aims to prove the falsity of the phenomenal world. He maintains that the existence of conventional mundane reality of the material world is an apparatus or the means (upāya) to apprehend the absolute non-dual being. In kārikā II.31, Gauḍapāda points out that the existence of the world is false; just as a city that exists in the sky (gandharva nagara), so does the whole universe upon the Self. Likewise, the modifications of material reality in terms of creation, subsistence and dissolution are merely imagined upon the Self. Gauḍapāda also uses the illustration of dream to posit that just as the dream vanishes to non-existence once the individual returns to the waking state; so does the world cease to exist once the reality of the absolute is known. Gauḍapāda insists on the point that there exists neither the dream nor the waking and hence the universe never existed at all upon the unborn Self. Gauḍapāda also uses the analogy of rope-snake in this context. The kārikā II.17 states that ‘as a rope whose nature has not been well known is imagined in the dark like a snake, so also is the pattern of duality imagined being manifested from the unborn Self’. The final illustration that Gauḍapāda employs can be noted from the kārikā III.8 that says ‘Just as the sky is seen by the ignorant young boys as being covered by the dust etc., so does the Self in being associated with the impurities of mundane transformations’ (yathā bālāna gagana malina malai). Origination (jāti) is a magical projection (vivarta) of the Self and is operative only through māyā (sato hi māyayā janma – GK.III.27.) The Self that is bereft of any transformation in terms of origination and so forth, by its own innate nature is self-established (svastha), tranquil (śānta), self-effulgent (sakd vibhāta), nameless and formless (anāmaka, arūpaka).

b. Contact-less Contemplation (asparśa yoga)

 

The third chapter of Mādūkya kārikā, introduces the notion of ‘contact-less contemplation’ (asparśa yoga). According to Gauḍapāda, asparśa yoga is a transcendental mental state in which the mind is stripped from all desires and afflictions. Sparśa in Sanskrit means contact. In this context, it is the contact with the sense organs that results in the identification of Self with the non-Self causing bondage. Asparśa is the counter state in which there no contact with the sense organs (sarva abhilāpa vigatah; sarva cintā samutthita III.37) and the function of the mind in material sense is nullified. The ephemeral realities in multitude names and forms, those that are movable and immovable and so on, are perceived only by the mind (manodṛśya) causing desires, disappointments, pleasure, pain and so on. Once the mind is nullified, the duality does not exist. When mind is pure, the Self dwells in the supra-sensible state of tranquillity. Gauḍapāda, in the kārikā IV.2, offers salutations to the transcendental state of asparśa stating that this yogic state is free from all mundane relations in the nature of highest bliss, free from any dispute or doubt and that which is well established in the Vedic scriptures. ‘Those who perceive the contact of the consciousness with the external objects, may as well see footmarks in the open space’ (kārikā IV.28). Control of mind, according to Gauḍapāda, is the key to accomplish this state of asparśa. The mind when under complete control (manonigraha) through the ability to discriminate between the eternal Self and the ephemeral non-Self, in Gauḍapāda’s opinion, is equated with the nature of mind in the state of profound sleep. Gauḍapāda calls this state of non-mind ‘amanībhāva’.

5. Phenomenology of Consciousness – Quenching of Fire-brand alāta śānti

 

The Advaita philosophy holds the position that the consciousness is attributed with the functionality of perception only with regard to the waking state wherein the objectivity is merely projected and thus appears in various names and forms. This figurative intentionality of consciousness is merely a mental simulation caused by the apparent conjugation of Self and the non-self. The objectivity provided by the mind attributes the intentionality to the consciousness. Thus consciousness acquires varied degrees of functionality in terms of intentional acts such as perception, memory, imagination and the like. In reality, however, suspending the objective world constituting the universals and particulars, the phenomenological residuum is the pure supra-Consciousness that does not stand in any causal relation with the objective entities; nor does it have any intentionality and hence is apodictically transcendental.  Though the consciousness is the substratum for all cognitive experiences that precipitate out of subject-object interactions, it in ‘actuality’ remains untouched by any of these transactions.

Gauḍapāda uses the simile called ‘fire-circle’ (alāta cakra) in order to explain the onto-phenomenology of consciousness. When a stick with a fire tip is waved (alāta spandita) during the night, it forms different appearances in accordance to the movement of the fire-brand and so does the vibration of the consciousness that appears to exist in terms of known, knower and the like, (grahaa-grāhaka) in accordance to the nature of limiting adjuncts (kārikā IV.47). Just as the same fire-brand when not in motion is free from all appearances, the consciousness too when not vibrated remains in its true intrinsic nature is free from all names and forms. Gauḍapāda insists that, even when the fire-brand is in motion the appearances that seem to exist do not come from anywhere and they do not go anywhere. Appearances do not originate from the fire-brand and they do not dissolve into it. There is no causal relation between the resultant products of appearances with the seeming cause. Similarly, the entire universe that exist in pairs of dualities are not products of consciousness and nor is the consciousness a product of the physical universe. The existence of cause-effect result, according to Gauḍapāda , is a mental pre-occupation (phala-āveśa) which is a mere projection (phala-udbhavah). In the domain of ignorance these mental pre-suppositions manifest as multi-fold appearances, which is purely due to concealment (samvtya – samvaraa) of the nature of absolute self as pure consciousness.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary References

  • Gauḍapāda, ‘sagauapāda māūkya kārikā atharvavedīya māūkyopaniad: with śaṅkarācārya’s bhāya & ānandagiri’s tīka’, Ed. by Vinaya Ganesa Apte, Anandasrama Press, 1936.
  • Gauḍapāda, ‘Sākhya kārikā: commentary of Gauḍapāda – Iśvara ka’, Mainkar Tryambak Govind, Poona Oriental Book Agency, 1964.
  • Gauḍapāda, ‘māūkya kārikā’, Swami Gambhirananda Trans., Ramakrishna Mutt, Trichur, 1987.
  • śaṅkarācārya, ‘Prasthāna traya bhāya: māūkya kārikā bhāya’, Vol.II, V.Panoli Trans., Mathrubhumi Grandhavedi Publication, Calicut, 2006.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Mahadevan T.M.P, ‘Gauḍapāda: A study in early Vedānta’, University of Madras, Madras, 1960.
  • Vidhushekhara Bhattacarya, ‘āgamaśāstra of Gauḍapāda’, University of Calcutta, Calcutta, 1943.
  • Douglas Fox, ‘Dispelling Illusion: Gauḍapāda’s Alātaśānti with an introduction’, SUNY, New York, 1993.
  • Colin A. Cole, ‘A Study of Gauḍapāda’s māūkya kārikā’, Motilal Banarsidass, Delhi, 2004.
  • Natalia Isayeva, ‘From Early Vedānta to Kashmir Shaivism: Gauḍapāda, Bhathari & Abhinavagupta’, SUNY, New York, 1995.
  • Richard King, ‘Early Advaita Vedānta and Buddhism’, SUNY, New York, 1995.

 

Author Information

Devanathan Jagannathan
University of Toronto
Canada

Wuxing (Wu-hsing)

The Chinese term wuxing (wu-hsing, “five processes” or “five phases”) refers to a fivefold conceptual scheme that is found throughout traditional Chinese thought.  These five phases are wood (mu), fire (huo), earth (tu), metal (jin), and water (shui); they are regarded as dynamic, interdependent modes or aspects of the universe’s ongoing existence and development.    Although this fivefold scheme resembles ancient Greek discourse about the four elements, these Chinese “phases” are seen as ever-changing material forces, while the Greek elements typically are regarded as unchanging building blocks of matter.  Prior to the Han dynasty, wuxing functioned less as a school of thought and more as a way of describing natural processes hidden from ordinary view.  During the period of the Han dynasty (202 B.C.E.-220 C.E.), wuxing thought became a distinct philosophical tradition (jia, “family” or “school”).  Since that time, the wuxing system has been applied to the explanation of natural phenomena and extended to the description of aesthetic principles, historical events, political structures, and social norms, among other things.  Cosmology, morality, and medicine remain the chief arenas of wuxing thought, but virtually every aspect of Chinese life has been touched by it.  As such, wuxing has come to be inseparable from Chineseness itself and belongs to no single stream of classical Chinese philosophy.

Table of Contents

  1. Meanings of Wuxing
  2. Origins of Wuxing
  3. Wuxing Before the Han Dynasty
  4. Wuxing During the Han Dynasty and After
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Meanings of Wuxing

When seeking to understand the wuxing system, we encounter multiple uses of this term in pre-Han and Han sources that may signal the need for more than one translation from Chinese into any differing target language.  We may ask, are we speaking about five elements, five phases, five movements, five actions, or something altogether different?  The truth is that, depending on the use and context, any one of these might be an appropriate translation.

It has become routine in recent decades to insist that, in its cosmological uses, wuxing should be rendered into English as “five phases” rather than “five elements”, and to make a deliberate distinction between the role of these five in Chinese cosmology and the notion of the four elements in Greek thought, according to which the Greek notions of earth, air, fire, water are generally thought to represent actual fixed material substances.  Sometimes wuxing has been translated into English as “five elements”, but when we actually watch the work that xing does in the Chinese language, it is used to describe movement (e.g. walking), alteration, changing states of being, permutations or metamorphoses.  To back translate, then, the Chinese conception of “element” is quite different from the Western one, in that it does not imply a fixed substantial essence that remains unchanged and constitutes the discrete difference between one object and all others. Whereas the four elements in Western Greek thought were understood as the basic building blocks of matter, the Chinese, by contrast, viewed objects as ever-changing and moving forces or energies of five sorts.  These five phases work interactively and have identifiable correlations that instantiate both objects and natural processes as we know them.

2. Origins of Wuxing

Although not developed into its present form until the Han dynasty, the origins of wuxing extend far back into the earliest records of Chinese intellectual history.  In the Shang dynasty (1600-1046 B.C.E.), oracle bone inscriptions (used in divination rituals to predict and discern outcomes in nature and human affairs) rely on the number five.  Typically, this is the pattern of four around a center, where the four represent the cardinal directions expressed in the territories around the central area in which the ruler resides and from which he governs.  But this pattern of five is not yet any comprehensive theory or cosmology, and there is no evidence of belief that some five phases or elements interpenetrate and mutually influence each other correlatively.  However, there are already, in very rough form, associations of the territories with directions, colors, spirits, and proper rituals that are suggestive of the later correlational developments in Han wuxing thought.  For example, in the West an ox of a certain color must be sacrificed at a specified time of a year in order to insure an auspicious future.  Accordingly, even in the Shang there is fragmentary evidence that the number five is of explanatory significance, and there is some preliminary correlative association between territories, colors, rituals, and deities.

3. Wuxing Before the Han Dynasty

Between the Shang and Han dynasties, a number of texts were compiled that collectively shed light on the development of what became wuxing thought.  Chief among these are some of the “Five Classics” alleged to have been written during the Zhou dynasty (1045-256 B.C.E.) and later enshrined as the earliest Confucian canon, although portions of some or all of these texts may well reflect the concerns and contexts of later rather than earlier periods: Shijing (Classic of Poetry), Shujing (Classic of History), Liji (Record of Ritual), Yijing (Classic of Changes), and Chunqiu (Spring and Autumn Annals) with its commentary, Zuozhuan (Chronicles of Zuo).  Despite the uncertain dating, it can be assumed that these texts contain a substantial amount of material that is traceable to the pre-Qin (pre-221 B.C.E.) period and even reaching back to Confucius’s era or before.

In Zuo Zhuan’s record on the 27th year of the reign of Duke Xiang (590-573 B.C.E.), the text says: “Heaven has produced the five elements which supply humankind’s requirements, and the people use them all.  Not one of them can be dispensed with.”  Although English translations of this passage usually say “five elements” and we would expect the Chinese text to say wuxing, actually the text uses wu cai (“five materials” as in “raw materials”).  Accordingly, we may have here good evidence for the antiquity of this passage, because there is no reformatting of the passage to use the character xing as later scholars (who edited these texts into their final form) interested in fostering the wuxing cosmology might have been presumed to have done.  The text is saying that life depends on the ability of the people to understand and use the five raw materials of reality, but it is probably not drawing any significant distinction between xing and cai.

In the 7th year of the reign of Duke Wen (626-609 B.C.E.), the text says: “Water, fire, metal, wood, earth, and grains are called the six natural resources (or treasures) (liu fu).”  The character fu is used for the treasures of nature; the natural resources for life.  This list of six such resources contains the wuxing as we see them in later works, but with the addition of the grains.  Again, we might infer that the text may record authentically pre-Han material and it may reflect rather accurately the fact that the pattern of five as the number of elements had not yet been firmly established in the time of the Zuo Zhuan.

In its remarks on Duke Zhao, 1st year, the Zuo Zhuan says Heaven generates the five tastes (wu wei – sour, sweet, salty, bitter and acrid), five colors (wu se – green, yellow, black, red, and white), and five sounds (wu sheng – corresponding to the Western musical tones mi, so, do, re, and la).  In the passage on Duke Zhao’s 25th year, tastes, colors, and sounds are a result of the wuxing. The wuxing are understood as expressions of Heaven’s patterns (jing), and the character for patterns is the same one later used for the qi (vital energy) meridian lines in the body traced by practitioners of traditional Chinese medicine, suggesting that the wuxing are to Heaven as the qi meridians are to our bodies.

The Zuo Zhuan does not provide an account of correlation and intermingling of the five elements such as we see in later works.  Instead, it puts forward a teaching about five officials (wu guan) who exercise their will in order to arrange the xing into phenomenal reality.  In the material on the Duke of Zhao’s 29th year, the striking question is posed, “Why are there no more dragons?”  The answer provided for the absence of dragons is that each element is directed by its own official, but if the official neglects his task or the persons on earth distort or mismanage the five elements which are the patterns of earth, animals that depend on the order of these patterns will hide and stop reproducing correctly.  The species will disappear.  These officials are presented as spirits or deities which require veneration and offerings to be made to them.  The text gives the name of each official and the element over which he has charge.

The Shujing is a collection of documentary materials related to the ancient history of China.  The fragments that survive are a mixture of myth and history.  The earliest five chapters reach back to the legendary sage emperors Yao and Shun (c. 2400 B.C.E.?), and the last 32 chapters cover the period of the Zhou dynasty down to Duke Mu of Qin (r. 660-621 B.C.E.).  In this work, the chapter entitled Hong Fan (“Comprehensive Order” or “The Order of Everything”) provides an account of how society should follow the patterns of Earth and Heaven.  The first of the nine sections of this chapter is devoted to the wuxing system, indicating that it must be understood before the remaining eight sections can be grasped.  The chapter is constructed in the style of a dialogue between Wu Wang and a sage.  Wu states that he knows human society and that government and relationships must follow the patterns of Heaven, but he wonders how to fully grasp these patterns.  The sage tells him that whenever the wuxing are in disorder, the constant norms of Heaven will disappear and chaos will follow.

We notice now that human behavior can contribute to the harmonious operation of nature, or disrupt it causing chaos and disorder. The moral patterns for humanity and those of the natural cosmos are all interconnected and correlated.  For the first time, each of the elements has its nature more fully explained: water moistens and descends (run xia); fire burns and ascends (yan shang); wood bends and straightens (qu zhi); metal yields and changes (cong ge); earth receives and gives (jia se), such as through seeds and crops.  While fire and water are presented as opposites, wood and metal are not.  Perhaps more interestingly, we notice the correlational mechanisms of the system becoming more obvious.  The five elements are tied to the five tastes: that which moistens and descends produces saltiness; that which burns and ascends produces bitterness; that which bends and straightens produces sourness; that which yields and changes produces pungency; that which seeds and gives crops produces sweetness.  The five elements are correlated to the five ways or powers of a human being: appearance, speech, sight, hearing, and thinking.

Hong Fan does not spell out how the correlations work, only that they exist.  Likewise, in sections two and eight of this chapter, the five elements and the five conducts (also called wuxing) are related.  The sections say that if humans do not behave in the proper manner, they throw the five elements out of harmonious operation, illness and weakness arise in the body and disorder shows up in nature and the human world of history.  But the chapter does not make a direct correlation to explain how an individual element produces an action, as it does when commenting on the five tastes.  Still, the obvious point of a chapter entitled “The Order of Everything” is that a ruler who is not able to order these processes will throw all things into chaos, and even the rains will not come on time.

In Liji, the number of five-set processes of arrangement and change is sixty-two.  These are used as explanations for matters including not only politics, family, and medicine, but colors, seasons, plants, planets, and rituals for performing various actions.  Consider that in wearing ritual vestments of green and eating from vessels of wood (not metal), the sovereign could promote the powers of spring because the associations of the wuxing with various correlates sometimes make some sense (wood, green, spring; or fire, red, summer).

Later, during the Warring States period (403-221 B.C.E.), there is evidence of intellectual activity that explicitly concerned wuxing thought as a comprehensive system.  According to the Records of the Historian by Sima Qian (145–90 B.C.E.), beginning in the reign of King Wei (358–320 B.C.E.) and continuing during the reign of King Xuan (319–309 B.C.E.), an intellectual exchange was fostered by convening scholars in the capital city of Linzi next to the Ji Gate, which gave its name to what became known as the Jixia Academy.  Figures named as master teachers in this place include Zou Yan (305–240 B.C.E.), who is considered the systematizer of wuxing cosmology; Zhuang Zhou (Zhuangzi, c. 365–290 B.C.E.), an early Daoist thinker; and both Mengzi (“Mencius,” c. 372–289 B.C.E.) and Xunzi (Hsün-tzu, c. 310-220 B.C.E.), who are among the first interpreters of Confucius’s thought.  If all this is taken as accurate, it is possible that the careers of Mengzi, Zhuang Zhou and Zou Yan could have overlapped at Jixia, and Xunzi might have been there at the same time as a young student before later returning as a master himself.  We are likely on safe ground in concluding that wuxing thought was a subject of the exchanges and debates of figures at Jixia.  There are passages even in the so-called “Inner Chapters” of the Zhuangzi which seem to have wuxing cosmological assumptions underlying them (for example, chapters 2, 6, and 7).

Xunzi is very critical of wuxing explanations and the teachers who are using “ancient lore” to “concoct their new theory” called wuxing.  He calls the theory perverse and bizarre and characterizes it as obscure and impenetrable nonsense.  He is particularly critical of the stream of Confucian thought, found in the tradition of Mengzi, which has appropriated these ideas but is oblivious to where it all goes wildly wrong (Xunzi 16/6/10; Ames and Hall, pp. 137-38).  Xunzi is not making a distinction between wuxing as a cosmological theory and wuxing as a moral doctrine, evidence of which may be seen in the Wuxing pian (Five Modes of Proper Conduct), a text discovered in the tomb of “the tutor of the Eastern palace” at Guodian in China’s Hubei province in 1993, which dates to 300 B.C.E..  Despite Xunzi’s criticims, a wuxing system was growing and extending itself from cosmology to morality, aesthetics, medicine, and so forth.

4. Wuxing During the Han Dynasty and After

During the Han dynasty, one of the most fundamental texts containing material on wuxing theory was the Huainanzi (The Masters of Huainan, 139 B.C.E.).  This text says: “The natural qualities of Heaven and Earth do not exceed five.  The sage is able to use wuxing correctly in order to govern without waste.”  The Huainanzi shows the move to standardize the number five.  It continues to draw out the correlations between wuxing in cosmology and morality, and it extends the medical implications of the system.  Sages who know what to do with the wuxing are able to rule the country, heal patients, and manage the transformations of life and longevity.  It seems that this text conflates Daoist notions of immortals (xian) with those who possess the skill necessary to master the five elements.

Han thinkers used the system to account for an ordered sequence or cycle of change.  For example, in the “mutual production” (xiangsheng) series, wood produced fire, fire produced earth, earth produced metal, metal produced water, and water produced wood.  In the “mutual conquest” (xiangke) series, wood conquered earth, metal conquered wood, fire conquered metal, water conquered fire, and earth conquered water.  If a ruling dynasty’s emblem was water, one might anticipate it being overcome by a dynasty whose emblem was earth.  This schema was appropriated as the Han was thought to rule under the red phase of fire, and their most formidable revolutionary challengers employed this ideology in constructing their movement and its symbols, such as the rebel movement known as the Yellow Turbans (184 C.E.), which attempted to exploit the ideas that red would be conquered by yellow and fire by water.

Although most of its ideas are already evident in the Huainanzi,  the Chunqiu fanlu (Luxuriant Dew of the Spring and Autumn Annals) traditionally ascribed to Dong Zhongshu (179-104 B.C.E.), is a sustained effort to incorporate the wuxing system into Confucian thought, even connecting it to the Confucian five relationships of filiality.  This application was continued in the work of Yang Xiong (53 B.C.E.-18 C.E.), whose text Tai Xuan (The Supreme Mystery, c. 2 B.C.E.) represents an example of Confucian syncretism and appropriation of the wuxing cosmology.  In Baihu tongyi (Comprehensive Discussions in White Tiger Hall, c. 80 C.E.), the record of state-sponsored debates held in 58 C.E., the following explanation for the way a mature son should remain with his parents while a daughter should leave home is given:  “The son not leaving his parents models himself on what?  He models himself on fire that does not depart from wood.  The daughter leaving her parents models herself on what?  She models herself on water which by flowing departs from metal.”

Not all Confucian thinkers accepted the wuxing cosmology or its extended explanatory devices, however.  Wang Chong (27-100 C.E.) was a critic of the theory in its broadest forms, and of the application of it in the realms of natural and physical phenomena, morality, and political history.  In his Critical Essays (Lunheng), he used argument, sarcasm, and what we would call empirical evidence, to criticize the work of Dong Zhongshu and attempt to debunk the evidential basis for the wuxing system.

By the first century B.C.E., Huangdi Neijing (The Yellow Emperor’s Inner Classic), arguably the most significant of the classical Chinese documents on wuxing as related to medicine, attained its final form.  It most likely developed in a lineage of teachers associated with what is now called Huang-Lao (“Yellow Emperor-Laozi”) Daoism, which also influenced portions of the Zhuangzi.  The work has two parts.  The first is the Suwen (Basic Questions), devoted to the wuxing foundation of Chinese medicine and the diagnostic methods for ailments, and the second is the Lingshu (Spiritual Pivots), which is largely concerned with very technical and thorough explanations of acupuncture.  Lingshu 24 has the Yellow Emperor say that the qi energy meridians of the body (jing mai) are divided according to the wuxing and these lines convey energy to the five organs (wu zang) of the body.  The Suwen relies largely on the “mutual conquest” series as the preferred explanatory language for medical ailments and their remedies.  In thinking of the wuxing system related to the body, we must always remember that, in traditional Chinese thought, the body is a microcosm of the universe that recapitulates the patterns of the macrocosm (i.e. Heaven and Earth).  A disease considered energetic or fiery could be overcome by a medicine correlated with cooling associated with water.  Likewise, since wood xing suffuses throughout the spleen and also gives rise to sour flavor, then eating sour foods will increase the wood internally and strengthen the spleen.  Wood is also correlated with the color blue-green, the spring season, the direction east, and the musical note jue (Western mi), and can be increased or conquered based on these correlations.

Medical understandings of wuxing have been applied to non-philosophical arenas, such as astrology.  Chinese astrology relies heavily upon wuxing notions.  Each astrological or zodiac sign is ruled by one or more of the five elements and its yin or yang energies.  According to the lore of Chinese astrology, the signs and energies we are born under impact our entire lives and our personalities.  For example, being born under the wood sign means one is influenced by yang energy.  Such a person is said to be strong and self-reliant.  He is associated with the East, the astrological signs of the Tiger, Rabbit, and Dragon, and the spring season; his health is governed by the condition of his liver and gallbladder; and he both favors and prospers under the colors blue and green.  Similar explanations and prognostications are given for the other four of the five xing as well.

Both military and literary texts in traditional China have incorporated the wuxing system.  The Liu Tao (Six Strategies, also known as Tai Gong’s Six Strategies [for conducting war]), is a well-known tactical manual of ancient China.  It asserts that, by knowing the enemy’s posture with respect to wuxing, one can then, through the “mutual conquest” series, know how to select the attacking phase to defeat him.  Novels such as Xiyou ji (Journey to the West, 16th century C.E.) present main characters in five-phase terms, and the structure of Hong Lou Meng (Dream of the Red Chamber, 18th century C.E.) may be described in terms of wuxing, as Andrew Plaks has shown.

Beyond the world of Chinese texts, traditional Chinese visual arts have embraced wuxing, including the style of painting known by that very name.  This style is a synthesis of traditional landscape painting with wuxing cosmology.  Wuxing painting has a total of five brush strokes, five movements, and five types of composition, each corresponding to the five elements.  The goal of such painting is to create an image harmoniously balanced, often depicting a landscape, but even when not doing so, nevertheless playing on the connection between objects or directions and wuxing.

As wuxing thought has continued to become ever more labyrinthine, the five elements have been incorporated into many arenas of Chinese life, from the way space is arranged (fengshui) to the art of cooking (sweets, sours, bitters, etc).  Having become a distinct philosophical tradition (jia, “family” or “school”) during the Han, wuxing gradually developed into a conceptual device that is used to explain not only cosmology, morality, and medicine, but virtually every aspect of Chinese life and thought.  As such, wuxing has come to be inseparable from Chineseness itself and belongs to no single stream of classical Chinese philosophy.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Ames, Roger T. and David L. Hall, trans.  Focusing the Familiar: A Translation and Philosophical Interpretation of the Zhongyong. Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 2001.
  • Bodde, Derk.  Chinese Thought, Society, and Science: The Intellectual and Social Background of Science and Technology in Pre-Modern China.  Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press, 1991.
  • Graham, A.C.  Yin-Yang and the Nature of Correlative Thinking.  IEAP Occasional Paper and Monograph Series, No. 6. Singapore: Institute of East Asian Philosophies, 1986.
  • Henderson, John.  “Wuxing (Wu-hsing): Five Phases” in Antonio S. Cua, ed. Encyclopedia of Chinese Philosophy. New York: Routledge, 2003, 786-88.
  • Major, John S., et. al., trans.  The Huainanzi: A Guide to the Theory and Practice of Government in Early Han China. New York: Columbia University Press, 2010.
  • Needham, Joseph.  Science and Civilisation in China. Vol. 2, History of Scientific Thought. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1956.
  • Plaks, Andrew H.  Archetype and Allegory in the Dream of the Red Chamber. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1976.
  • Porkert, Manfred.  The Theoretical Foundations of Chinese Medicine; Systems of Correspondence. East Asian Science Series, Vol. 3. Cambridge: MIT Press, 1974.
  • Rochat de la Vallee, Elisabeth.  Wuxing: The Five Elements in Classical Chinese Texts.  London: Monkey Press, 2009.

 

Author Information

Ronnie Littlejohn
Email: ronnie.littlejohn@belmont.edu
Belmont University
U. S. A.

Feminism and Race in the United States

This article traces the history of U.S. mainstream feminist thought from an essentialist notion of womanhood based on the normative model of middle-class white women’s experiences, to a recognition that women are, in fact, quite diverse and see themselves differently. It begins with the question of the social construction of gender and the mainstream feminist assumption that ‘woman’ means middle class white woman. The challenge to this assumption is then posed by women of color, poor women, immigrants, lesbians and women in the ’third world.” Section Three presents the various forms of inclusion of black women within mainstream feminist frameworks. Following that is a discussion on the construction of whiteness, the privileges that race afford white women, and feminist strategies to overcome racism within mainstream feminism. Section Five reviews the struggles of Latina and Asian American women, the specific questions of identity they confront, and how these relate to mainstream feminism. Section Six discusses the challenges posed to U.S. mainstream feminism by third world feminists.

Feminists in the U.S. have worked arduously to address the question of difference among women, together with what unites women in common contexts of struggle.  The focus on difference, as well as identity, however, often overlooks the actual lives of many women of color who struggle not so much with how to disabuse themselves of a certain identity, but with how to establish one in the first place.  Concentrating on identity and difference, either by working to obliterate or represent it, also tends to the neglect of power relations that establish, hold apart, and bring together such differences in the first place.

This article further explores how sexism and racism are structural problems endemic to American culture. As such, they need to be addressed systematically, along with class and all other systems of domination. The structural aspect is evident in the ease by which biological racism morphs into cultural racism, spawning condescending and racist attitudes toward third world women, and a blindness of “first world” complicity in third world oppressions. As Audre Lorde has made clear, “the master’s tools will never dismantle the master’s house.” The conclusion explores how feminists unite to struggle against systems of domination and exploitation, and work to give up privileges bequeathed by these systems, admittedly an uncomfortable proposition for those benefiting from power, to dismantle the “master’s house” and the multitude of oppressions that it sustains.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Are All Women the Same?
  3. Mainstream Feminism and African American Women in the United States
  4. White Privilege and the Question of Racism in U.S. Mainstream Feminism
  5. Chicana/Latina and Asian American Women and U.S. Mainstream Feminism
  6. Third World Feminisms and Mainstream Feminism in the U.S.
  7. Conclusion: “There is No Hierarchy of Oppressions”
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

The question of difference has been central to U.S. feminism since the inception of a women’s movement in the United States.  When Sojourner Truth, a black woman, walked into the predominately white Women’s Convention in Akron, Ohio in 1851, three years after the first Women’s Rights Convention in Seneca Falls, New York, jaws dropped. Not a sound could be heard.  Truth was an imposing woman.  She stood almost 6 feet tall and bore the scars of brutal beatings, the sale of her children, and the loss of her own parents while she was sold off into slavery.  Surrounded by affluent, educated white women and their gentlemen supporters, her presence at first stirred fear, but eventually gave rise to awe. The white women at the conference didn’t want to muddy their struggle and demands for women’s rights with the uncomfortable subject of race and the rights of colored folk, despite their debt to Fredrick Douglass’ efforts to keep the controversial issue of women’s suffrage central at the first Convention in Seneca Falls. Yet, when Truth rose to enter into the conversation, her words, collected under the title “Ain’t I a Woman,” not only drew strong admiration, but presaged what would come to be the fundamental question of Western feminism: What exactly is a woman?

In the speech titled “Ain’t I a Woman,” Truth reveals the contradictions inherent to the use and meaning of the term woman, and exposes the political, economic, and cultural assumptions underlying its use.  Taking the platform at the Convention in Ohio, she spoke out against the declarations of several men. They believed that women were to refrain from strenuous work, both physical and mental, so to better fulfill their “womanly nature.” But Truth knew nothing of this so-called nature that they espoused and engendered. What she knew was toil and work as arduous as any man could endure.

That man over there says that women need to be helped into carriages, and lifted over ditches, and to have the best place everywhere. Nobody ever helps me into carriages, or over mud-puddles, or gives me any best place! And ain’t I a woman?  Look at me! Look at my arm! I have plowed, and planted, and have gathered into barns, and no man could head me! And ain’t I a woman? I could work as much, and eat as much as man – when I could get it – and bear the lash as well! And ain’t I a woman? I have borne thirteen children and seen most all sold off to slavery, and when I cried out with a mother’s grief, none but Jesus heard me! And ain’t I a woman?   (Truth, 2009).

Almost one hundred years later, Truth’s questioning can be heard in Simone de Beauvoir’s challenge to claims that the meaning of womanhood is self-evident.  In her groundbreaking and canonical work The Second Sex (1949, 1st English trans., 1953), Beauvoir set the course for the subsequent study of the “woman question” in the West by putting the issue of gender into focus. Responding to male discontentment that French women were losing their femininity and were not as “womanly” as they believed Russian women to be, Beauvoir wondered if one is born a woman or whether, in fact, one must become a woman through various socialization and indoctrination processes. This critical perspective led her to challenge the usefulness of the category of woman altogether and to ask whether it was, in fact, helpful as a term representing all the experiences of the so-called members of the “second sex.”  Perhaps nothing better illustrates Beauvoir’s concerns regarding the legitimacy and effectiveness of the category of “woman” than the development of white, U.S. mainstream feminist thought in relation to challenges posed by women of color, the poor, lesbians, immigrants, and women from “third world” nations.   In making their voices heard, these marginalized women expanded feminist thinking by showing that ideologies of womanhood had just as much to do with race, class, and sexuality, as they had to do with sex.

2. Are All Women the Same?

Feminists in the U.S. have set out to identify, expose, and subvert the longstanding gender stereotypes that have been used to dominate and subordinate women.  Central to any theory of feminism, then, is how terms like “woman,” “female,” and “feminine” are construed or misconstrued.  The pioneer women in the U.S. suffragist movement spoke of and fought for women’s rights, using the term woman to signify all women.  What they failed to recognize was that their notion of womanhood was modeled on the experiences and problems of a small percentage of females who, like them, were almost exclusively white, middle-class, and relatively well-educated.  However, the assumption that middle-class white women’s experiences represented all women’s experiences was not only made by the early Suffragists, but continued to shape the ideal of womanhood well into the second wave of the American feminist movement and beyond.

In The Problem That Has No Name, a book that helped usher in the second wave of feminism in the U.S., Betty Friedan exposed the hidden frustrations of women who had bought into the “mystique of feminine fulfillment” (2001:24). Trading in their career ambitions for the promised bliss of marriage, motherhood, and domesticity, many women instead found themselves trapped and isolated behind white picket fences in what Friedan described as the “housewife’s syndrome.”  But, what Friedan also failed to recognize was that this syndrome affected only a certain minority of women— namely, those who were white, middle-class, and often highly educated, like herself.   She did not realize that the binary and complimentary gender divisions she assumed, woman as breadmaker and man as breadwinner, were built upon a racialized patriarchy that excluded women of color, the poor, and immigrants from this “mystique of femininity.”   It was these women who would be called upon to leave their children and homes to care for the children and homes of the white women who had successfully “liberated” themselves from domesticity to voluntarily enter into the work force.

Discounting the lives of women of color by assuming that the experiences of white women were representative of the lives of all women, Friedan imagines a unity among women’s experiences that simply does not exist.  According to bell hooks, this ideal of gender solidarity is built upon an assumption of sameness that is supported by the idea that there exists a common oppression of patriarchy around which women must rally.  “The idea of ‘common oppression’ was a false and corrupt platform disguising and mystifying the true nature of women’s varied and complex social reality” (1984:44). This complexity is especially disclosed in the lives of women of color who must contend with multiple and overlapping forms of oppressions–including oppression by white women, who fail to acknowledge the different struggles confronting women who are not like them.

Mainstream feminist thought continues to grapple with the interrelations between gender and race, as well as class, colonialism, imperialism, and issues of sexual orientation in what might arguably be called a third wave of feminism in the U.S..  More importantly, the critiques of women who have suffered the most from sexist societies — women of color, the poor, third world women — are now at the forefront of a contemporary, progressive feminist politics.  Thus, to understand the current contours of mainstream feminist thought in the U.S. and the question of race, one must look at how feminist theory and practice have addressed differences among women, and the specific ways that differences within women’s lives have shaped their relationships to mainstream U.S. feminism.

3. Mainstream Feminism and African American Women in the United States

Feminist theorists have addressed the relationship of race and feminism in at least two different ways. One approach is to view race as integral to gender and explore the ways in which gender identity is constructed in relation to race, and how racial identity is equally constructed in relation to gender.  The other follows a method whereby the voices of women of color are added to the conventional curriculum in a sort of separate but equal manner. This latter approach has been called the “additive” approach. Because it simply adds the voices of those historically excluded from the mainstream feminist canon, but does not examine the constitution of these voices within the contexts of power that have given rise to them, it carries the risk of essentializing gender and race, or assuming these categories to be fixed and timeless.

With respect to the former, Jacquelyn Dowd Hal highlights the interconnections of race and gender in her discussion of lynching. Hal shows that lynching was not only used to enforce labor contracts, maintain racial etiquette and the socio-economic status quo, but was also effective in re-inscribing gender roles among whites. White men cast themselves as protectors of white women, sheltering them from the presumed threat of black male sexual prowess, while simultaneously securing white women’s adherence to ideals of chastity and femininity (Brooks-Higginbootham, 1989: 132).  These ideals were further re-inscribed by white women in their perceptions and accusations regarding black male sexuality.  Ida B. Wells had made the same observation, arguing that white men maintained their ownership over white women’s bodies by using them as the terrain for lynching black males (Carby, 1986: 309). It comes as little surprise, then, that by joining anti-lynching campaigns white women were not only defending black males, but simultaneously reacting against Southern chivalry and their roles as fragile sex objects (Brooks-Higginbootham, 1989: 133).

The more popular approach to the question of race and feminism, however, seems to have been the “additive” approach.  In “Toward a Black Feminist Criticism” (1977), Barbara Smith embarks on a journey that she states no man or woman has gone on before: documenting black women’s experience and culture while providing black women with a resource for reading about their lives. “It is galling that ostensible feminists and acknowledged lesbians have been so blinded to the implications of any womanhood that is not white womanhood and that they have yet to struggle with the deep racism in themselves that is at the source of this blindness” (Carby, 1992: 158).  Smith believes that it is necessary both to retrieve the writings of black women and to place them before black feminist literary critics who are able to interpret these writers experiences.  She argues that black women writers share a singular tradition of styles, themes and aesthetics that are rooted in a shared culture of oppression.  Furthermore, she believes that these themes are expressed in a uniquely black woman’s language that is accessible only to black feminist literary critics who simply need turn inwards, or towards their own lived experiences, in order to decipher the messages told by black women writers (Carby, 1992:164). With her novel idea of an “identity politics,” Smith went on to form the black lesbian feminist Combahee River Collective in Boston.

“The Combahee River Collective Statement” (1986), along with This Bridge Called My Back, Writings by Radical Women of Color, published two years earlier, gave voice to women of color and served as the primary texts from which white women and women of color would draw in discussions of race and gender.  In the Combahee Statement, the Collective explained their need to organize and come together as black women into a movement for black women. “We realize that the only people who care enough about us to work consistently for our liberation is us.  Our politics evolve from a healthy love for ourselves, our sisters, and our community, which allows us to continue our struggle and our work” (1995: 21-22). Black-only movements worked to raise the self-esteem of black women and address specific problems confronting all black people. Angela Davis also describes how, despite the sexist and heterosexist elements of the Black Nationalist Movement, it gave her a framework within which to understand herself as beautiful and valuable. In addition, Black Nationalism also served to counter racist images of African-Americans by providing positive images of Africa.  “I was able to construct a psychological space within which I could ‘feel good about myself.’ I could celebrate my body (especially my nappy hair, which I always attacked with a hot comb in ritualistic seclusion), my musical proclivities and my suppressed speech patterns, among other things…This distanced me from the white people around me while simultaneously rendering controllable the distance I had always felt from them” (1992:319).

Patricia Hill Collins invokes the notion of a shared black women’s language and highlights a common tradition that reaches back to the idea of an “African consciousness.” However, she cautions against carving out a uniquely black female voice, or category of experience, for fear of sliding into an essentialist perspective which may, ultimately, be counterproductive. She recognizes that identifying a black feminist thought problematically assumes that “being Black and/or female generates certain experiences that automatically determine the variants of a Black and/or feminist consciousness” (1991:21). Still, Collins maintains that black women have certain perspectives that arise out of a shared experience, along with a different relation to knowledge production that give rise to a uniquely “black feminist standpoint” (1991:21-22).

Collins draws on the mainstream feminist strategy of “standpoint theory” that Nancy Hartsock helped develop out of Karl Marx’s insight that the material conditions of existence structure one’s lived experiences,. A standpoint theory argues that the place from which one stands influences the perspective or view that one has of the world; and, further, that those who are most oppressed are able to provide a broader and clearer perspective on the whole of society and societal relations (Hartsock, 1999).  Collins believes that any black feminist standpoint must take into account white domination, the concomitant struggle for self-definition, and the Afrocentric worldview that helps blacks cope with racial domination. This Afrocentricism, Collins claims, existed prior to,and is independent of, racial oppression. Moreover, it has given rise to traditions of storytelling and narrative that value concrete, lived experience, as well as black women’s community and sisterhood (1991:206, 212). Collins’ version of standpoint feminism, therefore, focuses on concrete lived experiences that have their roots in African oral traditions, black families, churches, and other black organizations.

But even the idea of this mitigated account of an essential black female identity does not sit well with many black women. For example, Hazel Carby sees the idea of black feminist criticism, as well as any notion of a specifically black feminist consciousness, as a problem and not a solution. She traces this problem to the processes whereby one finds academic legitimation by aiming to fit into certain allotted slots that are open for discussions of racial and gender identity within mainstream curricula.  Carby advocates the need to examine racism and sexism not as trans-historical and essentialist categories, but as historical practices which are enmeshed with evolving sets of social, political, and economic practices that function to maintain power in a given context and society (1989:18).  Any emphasis on the elaboration of standpoint theory, Carby claims, sanctions the segregation and ghettoization of race and gender, while simultaneously positing white women as a normative standard (1992:193 ).

Moreover, Carby believes that this supplemental approach, which consists simply in adding the experiences and writings of women of color to the established mainstream feminist canon, will not solve the problems of “exclusion” from mainstream feminism, but will instead further reify differences.  Joan Scott echoes these remarks and cautions women against relying on an uncritical deployment of experience to tell their stories.  By assuming experience to be self-evident and transparent, one naturalizes difference and leaves unexamined the constitutive mechanisms according to which people’s experiences have been historically constructed by relational webs of power and multiple oppressions (1991: 25-26).   These mechanisms are structural and institutional. They are therefore more difficult to identify and eradicate. To adequately address the root causes of racism in the feminist movement, women must therefore acknowledge that any attempt to universalize their experiences colludes, not only with ideologies of white womanhood, but also with the dominant and privileged white male norms.  The prominence given to white women’s experience, Carby points out, is no accident. “White women are made visible because they are the women that white men see” (1986: 302). Taking into account the historical and political contexts that define gender reveals the racial constructions that structure both the lives of whites and people of color.

Many black women, especially those excluded from the earlier Suffragist movement, went even further and drew an explicit link between imperialism, racism, and patriarchy. This link was cemented at the 1893 World’s Columbian Exposition in Chicago, where a group of black women who had thought they were there to represent the lives of American women, were instead made part of exhibits featuring “exotic” peoples, which further fed into racist stereotypes and fears (Carby, 1986).  Subsequently, these women came to recognize the need to form their own national organizations.  In 1896, a number of black women’s groups merged into the National Association of Colored Women (NACW), headed by Josephine Ruffin and Mary Church Terrell. Its members included Harriet Tubman, Frances E.W. Harper, and Ida Bell Wells-Barnett. Harper and Anna J Cooper, the fourth African American woman to earn a Doctorate in the U.S., saw an inseparable link between imperialism, domestic racial oppression, and unrestrained patriarchal power. Cooper writes in A Voice from the South: By A Woman from the South (1892):

“Whence came this apotheosis of greed and cruelty? Whence this sneaking admiration we all have for bullies and prizefighters?  Whence the self-congratulation of ‘dominant’ races, as if ‘dominant’ meant ‘righteous’ and carried with it a title to inherit the earth? Whence the scorn of so-called weak or unwarlike races and individuals, and the very comfortable assurance that it is their manifest destiny to be wiped out as vermin before the advancing civilization?” (Carby, 1986:305).

Cooper’s observations came 40 years after Arthur de Gobineau declared in The Inequality of Races, that, indeed, Africans were “incapable of civilization” because they did not have the drive or ambition to conquer their neighbors, but rather lived “side by side in complete independence of each other” (Bernasconi, 2000:47). It was this conquering drive that Gobineau argued marked European civilization as advanced in contrast to the backwardness of Africans, who practiced living in harmonious co-existence with their neighbors.

In recognition of the advantages that race has conferred upon white women, many feminists have embarked upon analyses of race and gender that moves towards an acknowledgment of white privilege and racial injustice. Feminists have also worked to develop strategies for addressing white racism and identifying power differentials between women, between men, and among white women and men of color.

4. White Privilege and the Question of Racism in U.S. Mainstream Feminism

In 1988, inspired by the model of how men gain advantage from women’s disadvantage, Peggy McIntosh began to document some of the ways in which white women have benefited from racism.  Having observed how men were taught not to recognize their male privilege, McIntosh explored some of the unconscious avenues that allow white women not to recognize their “unearned skin privilege” (2008:63). “[W]hites are taught to think of their lives as morally neutral, normative, and average, and also ideal, so that when we work to benefit others, this work is seen as work that will allow ‘them’ to be more like ‘us’” (2008:63). Positioning whites as the norm is seen by Anna Stubblefield as pivotal to securing the superiority of whites. “The ideology of white supremacy is that whiteness sets the standard—whiteness is normative—such that anything that is symbolic of or associated with blackness is therefore deviant”  (2005:74).

McIntosh describes how she was taught to view racism as prejudice or bigotry, and to subscribe discriminatory acts of cruelty to isolated individuals, rather than to acknowledge “invisible systems conferring racial domination on my group from birth” (2008:68). She lists the unearned advantages that come from being a member of the dominant group, such as the comfort that comes from being in situations that reflect the worldview, values, and ideals of whites. White privilege ranges from the confidence white parents have that their children will receive educational materials highlighting the accomplishments and contributions of their race, to not attributing acts of injustice to racial prejudices, and not having to stand as a representative for one’s particular racial group. Marilyn Frye further discusses the privilege that whites have to define or determine how others will see them. More specifically, she contrasts the images and ideals that whites have of themselves with the ways in which they are viewed by men and women of color to underscore the disparity in perceptions (2001:85).  Because whites are taught that they are moral, honest, and fair, they believe that they alone are capable of and responsible for teaching others about what is right and wrong. This confidence is built upon a body of established Western principles, codes, and rules that presume to guarantee the correctness of their moral judgments. However, these self-descriptions of the dominant racial group are not shared by the majority of people of color who view many whites as behaving arbitrarily, or in a self-serving, violent, and often oppressive ways.

In “The Whiteness Question” (2005), Linda Alcoff argues that the key to overcoming racism lies in a confrontation with the “psychic processes of identity formation[.]”  Tracing the origins of whiteness to domination and exploitation, Alcoff asserts that “whiteness” is inseparable from the subjection, denigration, objectification, and repudiation of those who are perceived as non-white. “The very genealogy of whiteness was entwined from the beginning with a racial hierarchy, which can be found in every major cultural narrative from Christopher Columbus to Manifest Destiny to the Space Race and the Computer Revolution”  (2005). Before the concept of race originated in the 16th century, various populations of people identified and structured their communities in varieties of ways that did not include reference to skin color.  The origins of the category of race are, indeed, the origins of European expansion and oppression against Africans, Asians, indigenous peoples in the Americas and Australia, and even Muslims.  According to G.W.F. Hegel, it is only Europeans, or, more precisely, Christians who are able to attain the highest level of reason and spirituality by distancing themselves from the “absolute” through rationality.   Africans are not able to actualize these higher mental and spiritual faculties because they fetishize the absolute by objectifying it in relics that they then toss away when their fetish fails to come to their aid.  Muslims too, while successful at raising God above the level of the sensuous, are nevertheless unable to bring God back down to earth and unite the universal with the concrete, and therefore are unable to attain self-conscious reason (Bernasconi, 2000).

Alcoff, therefore, concludes that white collective self-esteem and identity are rooted in forms of white supremacy. Thus, to break free from racist ideology may not be such an easy task for whites, as it threatens the very foundations of their pride and self-love. This threat arises from the acknowledgement that historical achievements, and the legacy of cultural resources from which a white identity is drawn, are steeped in practices of racial oppression and domination. Consequently, relinquishing racism means not only giving up the actual privileges and benefits that are associated with being white, but may involve shunning one’s ties to a cultural history upon which white personal esteem and sense of self are grounded.  Feelings of hysteria, shame, and anxiety often accompany this break.  Yet, belonging to a history is crucial to one’s esteem and identity. Alcoff, therefore, suggests a form of “white double consciousness” that moves from a recognition of practices of domination, exploitation, and discrimination to “a newly awakened memory of the many white traitors to white privilege who have struggled to contribute to the building of an inclusive human community. The Michelangelos stand beside the Christopher Columbuses, and Michael Moores next to the Pat Buchanans” (2005).

The interrelationship between white identity and white supremacy has lead some anti-racist whites, most notably Noel Ignatiev, to go further and to call for the overall abolition of the white race: “Treason to whiteness is loyalty to humanity” (1997). Marilyn Frye similarly advocates a disassociation from “whiteness” by calling for whites to opt out of the club she calls “whiteliness” (2001: 85). The very conditions for disclaiming whiteness, a disclaiming of identity that some women of color point out is possible only for whites, rests in the understanding that race is something socially constructed.  Frye explains that being white “is like being a member of a political party, or a club, or a fraternity—or being a Methodist or a Mormon” (2001:85).

The possibility of relinquishing “whiteliness,” therefore, involves a recognition of its contingency, and depends upon the repudiation of practices that arise from enacting, embodying and animating whiteness. Transforming consciousness is one step toward eliminating whiteliness.  However, Frye and McIntosh are clearly aware that reflection and reorientation address only a fraction of the problems associated with race, since most of these are stubbornly structural and institutional. Still, Linda Gordon fears that a failure to begin addressing these difficult problems merely contributes towards legitimating more of the same—whites talking only about themselves (1991).

Sarita Srivastava is similarly unhappy with the direction that discussions of race have taken insofar as they tend toward white self-examination and constructions of whiteness. When analysis of race and racism occurs in feminist organizations, the emphasis, she finds, often falls on white guilt rather than organizational change. This results in self-centered strategies by whites to correct their moral self-image, an image that sustains inequalities, and, Srivastava argues, is rooted in the very foundations of feminism, imperialism, and nationalism that are the target of change.(2005: 36). Rather than work directly to alter the order of racial oppression, white women instead strive to empathize with the victims. Empathy serves to underscore white women’s “goodness,” and transforms the essentially socio-political nature of the problem to a more personal one. This practice further reinforces decades of racist and colonialist practices by validating white women’s moral authority and their belief that they have somehow been entrusted with the responsibility to educate and liberate those less civilized (2005: 44). Thus, Srivastava argues that white women fail to genuinely confront their own racism by focusing on their guilt and, in doing so, maintain power inequities.  She quotes a woman of color’s frustration over white women’s refusal to look at their racism during political discussions on the topic of race.  “The indignant response, anger, the rage that turns to tears, the foot stomping, temper tantrum, which are very typical responses [to being called racist]. Every single organization that I have been in, every single one. So I realized that it wasn’t about me…after awhile [laughter]” (2005: 42-43).

Alcoff further shows how white feminists distance themselves from a serious critique of racism by focusing on behavior modification, rather than challenging oppressive institutional structures and calling for wealth redistribution.  In her analysis of Judith Katz’s White Awareness: Handbook for Anti-Racism Training (Katz 1978), Alcoff describes Katz’s depiction of how she came to terms with the depth of her own racism as a painful, demoralizing process that threatened her self-trust.  While Katz warns against wallowing in white guilt, she nonetheless links anti-racism to psychological liberation while, at the same time, distancing herself from the workings and mechanisms of racist practices that are endemic to the culture. The focus on difference and overcoming of difference, either by obliterating or representing it, tends to neglect the power relations that establish, hold apart, and bring together such differences in the first place. Concentrating on identity and difference also overlooks the actual lives of many women of color who struggle, not so much with how to disabuse themselves of a certain identity, but, to the contrary, with how to establish an identity in the first place.

5. Chicana/Latina and Asian American Women and U.S. Mainstream Feminism

Struggling to negotiate and come to terms with an identity, many women of color are not as eager as white women to give up their racial or ethnic distinctiveness. “To be oppressed,” Norma Alarcon explains, “means to be disenabled not only from grasping an ‘identity’, but also from reclaiming it” (1995:364).  Moreover, specific histories of oppressions have positioned women differently with regard to gender roles and the family.  Cherrie Moraga describes how Latina women’s relationships to ideals of gender and motherhood have been uniquely shaped by colonization. Accompanying European expansion and colonization, was the concomitant threat of genocide. The fear of extinction strengthened the commitment to traditional family ideals and roles, such as encouraging women to be pregnant and assuming males at the head of the household.  “At all costs, la familia must be preserved…We believe the more severely we protect the sex roles with the family, the stronger we will be as a unity in opposition to the anglo threat” (1995:181). Consequently, Moraga explains, Latina feminists’ relation to gender roles and the structure of the family confront a very particular kind of resistance.  While mainstream feminists are challenging traditional sex roles of men and women, some Latina feminists, due to their certain histories of colonization, seek to preserve these roles.  Thus, Latina women’s concerns are often foreign to, and often in direct opposition to, mainstream white feminists who seek to abolish or overcome conventional forms of gender identity, especially within the family.

U.S. immigration policies and discriminatory practices against Asian Americans have also sometimes lead to the embracing of gender ideals among Asian American women that are in opposition to the ideals of many white feminists in the U.S..  Ester Ngan-Ling Chow shows how racism, colonialism, and imperialism have worked to position Asian American women differently toward Asian American men, feminism, and Westernization.  Addressing the apparent lack of feminist consciousness and activism in Asian American women, she attributes this deficit to ethnic pride and solidarity with Asian American men to end racial discrimination against Asians in the U.S..  Asian American men, for example, often view Asian American women’s engagement with mainstream U.S. feminism as a threat to the Asian American community.  Chow also points to specific Asiatic values of obedience, filial duty, loyalty, fatalism, and self-control that encourage forms of submissiveness among Asian American women that are incompatible with American values of individualism and self-assertiveness.  The force of traditional Asian values contributes to the particularity of Asian American women’s struggles, and work to distance their struggle from the concerns of the mainstream, white feminist movement. These differences, among others, are why Chow states: “The development of feminist consciousness for Asian American women cannot be judged or understood through the experience of White women” (1991:266).

Yen Le Espiritu further discusses the complexities surrounding the intersections of race, class, and gender confronting Asian American women.  Regrettably, some Asian American women find themselves victims of the discrimination faced by Asian American men.  Among other things, Espiritu writes, racial ideology defines Asian American men as feminine and weak—a rendering that incidentally works to confirm the notion that manhood is white.  Frustrated also by the higher value placed on Asian American women’s employability, some Asian American men try to assert their power by physically abusing the women and children in their lives.  Breathing humor into these problems of physical abuse, Espiritu draws upon a joke that gets a laugh from both men and women. “When we get on the plane to go back to Laos, the first thing we will do is beat up the women!’” (Espiritu, 1997: 136). Despite the discriminations Asian American women endure within their community, they too often find it difficult to juggle between the desire to expose male privilege, and the desire to unite with men in their shared struggle against prejudice and discrimination.

Gloria Anzaldua describes the particular ways that a feminist consciousness is developed by Latina women who many times find themselves struggling to arrive at a positive image of themselves.  She explains how an internalization of racism and colonialist mentality has given rise to shame, self-hatred, and abuse of other Latina women in various communities. Self-hatred and the hatred one has towards others like oneself are further ignited by jostling for the limited positions of superiority that are open to women of color.  Here is where ethnic and cultural identity begin to be conflated with race and purported biological distinctions.  In the early phases of colonialism, European colonizers flexed their powers overtly in order to destroy the fabric, legal codes, cultural systems, mannerisms, language and habits of the colonized under the guise of civilizing the “savage natives.”  Slowly, local inhabitants internalized Western values, attitudes, and ways of life, including racialized thinking that resulted in a desire for some Latin Americans to become more white and reject their indigenous cultures.  “Like them we try to impose our version of ‘the ways things should be’, we try to impose one’s self on the Other by making her the recipient of one’s negative elements, usually the same elements that the Anglo projected on us” (1995: 143).

More graphically, Anzaldua alludes to how the “forced cultural penetration” of rape has, so to speak, inseminated white values into the bodies of women of color (1995:143). A Latina woman with lighter skin who does not speak the language of her ancestors is often held suspect by other Latina women and cast out of the community.  Anzaldua attributes this exclusionary practice to an “internalized whiteness that desperately wants boundary lines (this part of me is Mexican, this Indian)[.]” (1995: 143). In opposition to the Enlightenment fantasy of a uniform and self-contained subject, Anzaldua introduces the concept of “mestiza consciousness,” a consciousness of the Borderlands that captures the multiplicity and plurality of Latina consciousness. “From this racial, ideological, cultural and biological cross-pollinization, an ‘alien’ consciousness is presently in the making—a new mestiza consciousness, una conciencia de mujer” (2008: 870). Writing primarily in English but peppering her discussion of mestiza consciousness with phrases in Spanish, Anzaldua puts the non-Spanish reader in an uncomfortable position, paralleling the discomfort felt by many immigrants who are confronted with a language they don’t understand.  In this way, Anzaldua describes and invokes an appreciation of the inner conflict that those straddling two or more cultures, languages, and value systems experience.  She provides a provocative illustration of warring cultures that produce in their subjects a “psychic restlessness” (2008).

The notion of a splintered personality brought on by a collision of cultures is also addressed by Alcoff, who proposes a positive reconstruction of mixed race identities whereby one finds comfort in ambiguity and a contentment with living the “gap” (2000:160). “I never reach shore: I never wholly occupy either the Angla or the Latina identity.  Paradoxically, in white society I feel my Latinness, in Latin society I feel my whiteness, as that which is left out, an invisible present, sometimes as intrusive as an elephant in the room and sometimes more as a pulled thread that alters the design of my fabricated self” (2000:160).

Maria Lugones gives a phenomenological description of what it is like to shift between identities as a person of mixed race or a hyphenated identity.  When voluntarily embraced, she calls this practice of shifting identities “world traveling.”  “Those of us who are ‘world’- travelers have the distinct experience of being different in different ‘worlds’ and ourselves in them” (1995: 396). Lugones’ concept of world traveling arose out of her awareness of the different levels of comfort she experiences in embodying different identities in distinct worlds. In some worlds, Lugones observes she is more playful and not overly concerned with how others view her. However, while inhabiting a world in which her identity is constructed negatively, or strictly on the basis of her ethnicity, she finds she is less playful and may even begin to animate self-defeating stereotypes.

Shifting in and out of various worlds, Lugones advocates a strategy whereby women attempt to empathize with each other by trying to stand in one another’s shoes. Laurence Thomas, to the contrary, warns against such a strategy that asks people who are so differently positioned within society to try to identify with each other’s experiences. Instead, he introduces the model of “moral deference”: “the act of listening that is preliminary to bearing witness to another’s moral pain, but without bearing witness to it” (1986: 377). In this stance, the one suffering has the platform and the one listening, who does not inhabit the same socially constituted identity, cedes the platform by recognizing the incommensurability of his or her experience of the other’s pains and struggles. It is this respect – rooted in an acknowledgment of the irreducibility of lived experience—that is at the heart of Third World Women’s appeal to Western Feminists.

6. Third World Feminisms and Mainstream Feminism in the U.S.

Significantly, the concerns raised by women of color in the U.S. are almost identically replayed by third world women, in what might be called a shift from biological to cultural racism.  However, instead of fighting against a cultural norm of white womanhood, third world feminists are fighting to assert their difference in opposition to a monolithic and dominant notion of Western feminism that is increasingly gaining legitimacy by controlling how women in the third world are represented.

Chandra Talpade Mohanty raises awareness of the impact of Western Scholarship on third world women “in a context of a world system dominated by the West[.]” (1991:53).  She encourages Western feminist scholarship to situate itself within the current Western hegemony over the production, publication, distribution, and consumption of information, and to examine its role within this context (1991:55).   In her analysis of the representations of third world women in nine texts in the Zed Press “Women in the Third World” series, Mohanty finds that in almost all these texts women are monolithically represented as victims of an unchanging patriarchy. These representations uproot women from their lived situations and the practices that shape, and are shaped by them. “The crucial point that is forgotten is that women are produced through these very relations as well as being implicated in forming these relations” (1991:59).

When women’s lives and struggles are not historically and locally situated, they are robbed of their political agency.  Those, then, writing about third world women “become the true ‘subjects’ of this counterhistory” (1991:71).  Western scholarship must, therefore, recognize the ethnocentric universalism it assumes in encoding and representing all third world women as victims of an ahistorical and decontextualized notion of patriarchy that results in a homogenous notion of the oppressed third world women. Only when feminist thinkers examine their role within Western dominations can genuine progress be made.

Uma Narayan highlights the facticity of women’s historical situations in her exposition of the particularities that women in the third world confront in participating in a feminist movement.  Because of the histories of colonialism and imperialism, suspicions against feminist movements as possible instruments of colonial domination surround attempts made by women to organize for change. Specifically, Narayan explores how the term Westernization is used to silence critiques by third world feminists regarding the status and treatment of women in their communities.  Ironically, it is Western educated and assimilated men in the third world that are spearheading these attacks against third world feminists by accusing them of disrespecting their culture and embracing Western values and customs. Narayan rejects the implication that feminism is foreign to the third world, noting that historical and political circumstances that raise awareness of women’s oppression give rise to a feminist consciousness that is organic to third world women’s lives.

Minoo Moallem locates a “feminist imperialism” in Western women’s desire to  enlighten third world women to the civilizing project of the West, wherein first world women become the norm and third world women get constructed as a singular, non-Western other (2006).   Elora Shehabuddin identifies a feminist imperialism in Western women’s attempt to position themselves as the saviors of Muslim women, thereby ignoring women’s voices fighting to make change within the Muslim world  “In presenting change in the Muslim world as possible only with the intervention from the United States—either by force through the violent eradication of oppressive Muslim men or the less dramatic support of ‘moderate’ Muslim groups and individuals—these writers foreclose the possibility of change from within Muslim societies” (2011: 121).

Ignoring the racism inherent in colonialist narratives documenting the oppression of Muslim women by Muslim men, Shehabuddin points out, Western feminists are content to draw on stories of abuse by a few vocal “Muslim escapees” as representative of the victimization of all Muslim women.  What seems to be the primary concern of these Western feminists is not the actual lives of women in the Muslim world, but the assertion of their own moral authority, exercised in presumably righting the sexism in the Islamic world.   In this way, Western feminists repeat and redirect their racism and condescension toward Muslim women and third world women in general, while conveniently avoiding the sexism and oppression in their own backyards.  The remedy to cultural racism is an acknowledgement of it and a commitment to displace Eurocentricism by actually listening to women’s experiences, and engaging women in the hopes of opening up a dialogue.  Shehabuddin writes: “In the end, the only way to find out ‘what Muslim women want’ is to listen to them, not by assuming their needs and concerns are self-evident because they identify as Muslims and not by taking a small group of vocal, articulate individuals—whose opinions on issues like Israel and the war on terror are more acceptable—as the representative and authentic voices” (2011: 132).

7. Conclusion: “There is No Hierarchy of Oppressions”

The history of U.S. feminist thought has evolved from an essentialist notion of womanhood based on the normative model of middle-class white women’s experiences to a recognition that women are, in fact, quite diverse and see themselves differently. “The real problem of feminism,” states Elizabeth Spellman, “is how it has confused the condition of one group of women with the condition of all women” (1988:15 ). In assuming that the experiences of middle-class white women represented the lives of all women, a false unity and solidarity among women was presupposed. Taking account of the multiple and overlapping forms of oppression that many women, especially women of color and third world women must negotiate, reveals the complexity and diversity of women’s lives.  Women of color in the U.S., for example, not only define themselves in a struggle against white men and men of color, but also in resistance to white women.  The same holds for third world women who find themselves fighting against the omission of their experiences and the overarching assumptions made by “first world” feminists regarding their needs and the forms of subordination they confront.  Moving away from a monolithic notion of woman, U.S. feminist theory and practice engages difference by focusing on context-specific positionings of women in relation to other constantly changing categories. But some women worry that without a commonality uniting women the power to make changes will be lost.

To address the complexity of the multitude of oppressions confronting women, Mohanty suggests a model based on “imagined communities of women” organized by “the way we think about race, class, and gender—the political links we choose to make among and between struggles” (1991:4). In these communities, political alliances are formed not by a person’s race or sex, but on the basis of “common contexts of struggle against specific exploitative structures[.]” (1991:7) Today, U.S. mainstream feminism is engaged with recognizing diversity and forming cross-cultural coalitions against injustices. The recognition of difference, however, is not complete without a further commitment to making institutional change.

Like sexism, racism is a problem that is structural and endemic to American culture and needs to be addressed systematically, along with class and all other systems of domination.  As Robert Bernasconi notes, “Personal attitudes are not the main source of the problem and they cannot provide the solution” (2005: 20).  The structural aspect is evident in the ease by which biological racism morphs into cultural racism, spawning condescending and racist attitudes toward third world women and a blindness of first world complicity in various forms of third world oppressions.  Indeed, as Audre Lorde has made clear, “the master’s tools will never dismantle the master’s house.”   However, by waging struggles against systems of domination and exploitation and assuming responsibility to actively give up the privileges bequeathed by these systems, admittedly an uncomfortable proposition, U.S. feminists embark upon dismantling the master’s house and the multitude of oppressions that it sustains.

Still, a change in personal attitudes does go a long way. When mainstream feminists recognize the interconnections between gender, race, nationalism and class, Espiritu writes, “then they can better work with, and not for, women (and men) of color” (Espiritu, 1997: 140).  In sum, feminists in the U.S. have worked arduously to address the question of difference among women, as well as what unites women in common contexts of struggle.   In the early twentieth century, Emma Goldman wrote of the significance of recognizing and respecting differences, while at the same time working together in spite of these differences to challenge institutional inequalities that prevent individuals from living together in a free society.  Goldman laid out a vision for a way forward that goes beyond the mere tolerance of difference when she said: “The problem that confronts us today and which the nearest future is to solve, is how to be one’s self and yet in oneness with the others, to feel deeply with all human beings and still retain one’s own characteristic qualities” (1973: 509).

8. References and Further Reading

  • Alarcon, N.,  “The Theoretical Subject(s) of This Bridge Called My Back and Anglo-American Feminism” in Making Face, Making Soul/Haciendo Caras: Creative and Critical Perspectives by Feminists of Color, (ed.) Anzaldua, G., Aunt Lute Books, 1995.
  • Alcoff, L., “Chapter 9: The Whiteness Question”  Linda Martin-Alcoff, 2005.
  • Alcoff, L., The Idea of Race, (eds.) Bernasconi, R. and Lott,T., Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2000.
  • Anzaldua, G., “La Conciencia de la Mestiza/Towards a New Consciousness,” in The Feminist Philosophy Reader, (eds.) Bailey, A. and Cuomo, C., New York: McGraw Hill, 2008.
  • Anzaldua, G., “En Rapport, In Opposition: Cobrando cuentas a las neustras,” in Making Face, Making Soul/Haciendo Caras: Creative and Critical Perspectives by Feminists of Color, (ed.) Anzaldua, G., Aunt Lute Books, 1995.
  • Bernasconi, R. “Waking up White and in Memphis” in White on White/Black on Black (ed.) Yancy, G., Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc., 2005.
  • Brooks-Higginbotham, E., “The Problem of Race in Women’s History,” in Coming to Terms: Feminism, Theory, Politics, (ed.) Weed, E., New York: Routledge, 1989.
  • Carby, H., “On the Threshold of Woman’s Era: Lynching, Empire, and Sexuality in Black Feminist Theory,” in Race, Writing and Difference, (ed) Gates, H.L, University of Chicago Press: Chicago, 1986.
  • Carby, H., “The Multicultural Wars,” in Black Popular Culture, (ed.) Dent, G., Bay Press: Washington, 1992.
  • Carby, H. Reconstructing Womanhood: The Emergence of the Afro-American Woman Novelist, U.S.A: Oxford University Press, 1989
  • Collins, P.H., Black Feminist Thought, New York: Routledge, 1991.
  • Combahee River Collective, “A Black Feminist Statement The Combahee River Collective” in Words of Fire: An Anthology of African-American Feminist Thought, (ed) Guy-Sheftall, B., New Press, 1995.
  • Davis, A., “Black Nationalism: The Sixties and the Nineties,” in Black Popular Culture, (ed.) Dent, G., Bay Press: Washington, 1992.
  • Espiritu, Yen Le, “Race, Class and Gender in Asian America” in Making More Waves: New Writings by Asian American Women, eds. Elaine H. Kim, Lilia V. Villanueva, and Asian Women United of California, Beacon Press Books: Boston, 1997.
  • Friedan, B. The Feminine Mystique, New York: Dell Publishing Inc., 1974.
  • Frye, M., “White Woman Feminist 1983-1992,” in Race and Racism, (ed.), B. Boxill, U.S.A: Oxford University Press, 2001.
  • de Gobineau, A., “The Inequality of Human Races,” in The Idea of Race (eds.) Bernasconi, R. and Lott, Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2000.
  • Goldman, E. “The Tragedy of Woman’s Emancipation,” in The Feminist Papers: From Adams to de Beauvoir, (ed.) Ross, A. S., Boston: Northeastern University Press, 1973.
  • Gordon, L., “On Difference,” Genders 10, Spring 1991.
  • Grande, S., “Whitestream Feminism and the Colonialist Project: A Review of Contemporary Feminist Pedagogy and Praxis,” Educational Theory, Summer 2003,Volume 53, Number 3.
  • Hartsock, Nancy, The Feminist Standpoint Revisited, And Other Essays (Basic Books, 1999), pp. 105-133.
  • Hooks, b., Feminist Theory: From Margin to Center, Boston: South End Press, 1984.
  • Ignatiev, N., “The Point Is Not To Interpret Whiteness But To Abolish It” in Race Traitor, ed. Noel Ignatiev, 1997.
  • Lorde, A. “The Master’s Tools Will Never Dismantle the Master’s House,” in This Bridge Called My Back: Writings by Radical Women of Color, (eds.) Moraga, C. and Anzaldua, Kitchen Table- Women of Color Press, 1984.
  • Lorde, A. “There is No Hierarchy of Oppressions,” Illvox, May 12, 2008.
  • Lugones, M. “Playfulness, ‘World’-Travelling, and Loving Perception” in Making Face, Making Soul/Haciendo Caras: Creative and Critical Perspectives by Feminists of Color, (ed.) Anzaldua, G., Aunt Lute Books, 1995.
  • McIntosh, P., “White Privilege and Male Privlege,” in The Feminist Philosophy Reader, (eds.) Bailey, A. and Cuomo, C., New York: McGraw Hill, 2008.
  • Moallem, M., “Feminist Scholarship and the Internationalization of Women’s Studies,” Feminist Studies 32, no. 2 (Summer 2006) 334
  • Mohanty, C. “Introduction: Cartographies of Struggle: Third World Feminism and the Politics of Feminism” in Third World Women and the Politics of Feminism, (eds.) Mohanty, C., Russo, A., Torres, L., Indiana University Press, 1991.
  • Mohanty, C., “Under Western Eyes: Feminist Scholarship and Colonial Discourses” in Third World Women and the Politics of Feminism, (eds.) Mohanty, C., Russo, A., Torres, L. (eds.) Indiana University Press, 1991.
  • Moraga, C., “From a Long Line of Vendidas: Chicanas and Feminism” in Making Face, Making Soul/Haciendo Caras: Creative and Critical Perspectives by Feminists of Color, (ed.) Anzaldua, G., Aunt Lute Books, 1995.
  • Narayan, U., “Contesting Cultures: ‘Westernization,’ Respect for Cultures and Third-World Feminists,” in The Second Wave: A Reader in Feminist Theory, (ed.) Nicholson, L., New York:Routledge,1997.
  • Ngan Ling Chow, E., “The Development of Feminist Consciousness Among Asian American Women,” in The Social Construction of Gender, (eds.) Lorber, J. and Farrel, S. Sage Publications, 1991.
  • Scott, J., “The Evidence of Experience,” Critical Inquiry 17, 4 (Summer 1991)
  • Shehabuddin, E., “Gender and the Figure of the ‘Moderate Muslim’: Feminism in the Twenty-first Century,’ in Judith Butler and Elizabeth Weed, eds. The Question of Gender: Joan W. Scott’s Critical Feminism (Indiana University Press, 2011).
  • Spelman, E., Inessential Woman: Problems of Exclusion in Feminist Thought, Beacon Press: Boston, 1988.
  • Srivastava, S., “You’re calling me a racist? The Moral and Emotional Regulation of Antiracism and Feminism,” Signs the Journal of Women in Culture and Society, 2005, vol 31, no. 1  (30, 44, 42-43)
  • Stubblefield, A., “Meditations on Postsupremacist Philosophy” in White on White/Black on Black, G. Yancy (ed.), New York: Rowman &Littlefield, 2005.
  • Thomas, L., Moral Deference, 1998.
  • Truth, S., “Ain’t I A Woman? December 1851,” Internet Modern History Sourcebook, (ed.) Paul Halsal (March 2009).

 

Author Information

Sharin N. Elkholy
Email: elkholys@uhd.edu
University of Houston – Downtown
U. S. A.

Marsilio Ficino (1433—1499)

FicinoMarsilio Ficino was a Florentine philosopher, translator, and commentator, largely responsible for the revival of Plato and Platonism in the Renaissance. He has been widely recognized by historians of philosophy for his defense of the immortality of the soul, as well as for his translations of Plato, Plotinus, and the Hermetic corpus from Greek to Latin. Ficino is considered the most important advocate of Platonism in the Renaissance, and his philosophical writings and translations are thought to have made a significant contribution to the development of early modern philosophies.

The Platonic Theology is Ficino’s most original and systematic philosophical treatise. It is a lengthy and encyclopedic defense of the immortality of the soul against what he considered the growing threats of Epicureanism and Averroism. While arguing for immortality, Ficino articulates those positions that are most characteristic of his philosophy. He first provides his own restructuring of the Neoplatonic hierarchy of being. This metaphysical structure is used to ensure the dignity and immortality of the soul by situating it at a privileged midpoint between God and prime matter. However, this hierarchy also has negative consequences for the qualitative character of human existence on account of the soul’s proximity to matter. Finally, the Platonic Theology lays down the basic principles of Ficino’s animistic natural philosophy, according to which a World Soul is imminent in the material world, imparting motion, life, and order.

In addition to the Platonic Theology, Ficino also composed extensive commentaries on Plato and Plotinus, wrote a practical medical treatise, and carried on a voluminous correspondence with contemporaries across Europe. There are noteworthy elements in his writings that are less traditional and orthodox by some contemporary philosophical standards. For example, he was deeply influenced by the Hermetic tradition, and describes a species of knowledge, or natural magic, that draws down the intellectual and moral virtues of the heavens to the terrestrial world. Ficino also endorses an ancient theological tradition that included, to name a few, Hermes Trismegistus, Pythagoras, and Orpheus among its ranks. He held that this pagan tradition espoused a pious philosophy that in fact presaged and confirmed Christianity.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. The Platonic Academy of Florence
  3. The Ancient Theology and Pious Philosophy
  4. Platonic Theology
    1. Metaphysics
    2. Epistemology
    3. The Dignity of Humanity and the Human Condition
    4. The Immortality of the Soul
  5. Ethics and Love
  6. Legacy
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Biography

Marsilio Ficino was born in Figline, not far from Florence, in 1433. He was the son of a physician, and Cosimo de’Medici—one of the richest and most powerful patrons of the fifteenth century—was among his father’s patients. While the precise details of his early life and education remain largely unclear to us today, it can safely be said that he studied Scholastic philosophy and medicine at the University of Florence, and that he was exposed to the burgeoning educational movement of Italian Humanism. Ficino’s earliest philosophical writings are largely Scholastic in their consideration of metaphysical, logical, and natural philosophical questions. In particular, Thomas Aquinas had a strong influence on significant aspects of his early thought, and this influence is thought to have persisted in his later philosophical writings.

The biographical contours of Ficino’s early life become clearer in the 1450s. He lectured on Plato’s Philebus; he also taught for a short time at the university in Florence, and privately as a tutor. As a young man Ficino fell under the influence of the Roman poet Lucretius. A manuscript copy of his didactic Epicurean poem, On the Nature of Things, was rediscovered in a monastery in 1417. After its recovery the poem was copied, disseminated, and eventually found its way into print and vernacular languages. Ficino was among the first generation of philosophers with direct access to the actual text of On the Nature of Things, which is thought to have played an important role in the development of early modern philosophy and science. During the late 1450s, Ficino composed a short commentary on Lucretius, the first since antiquity, as well as a treatise on pleasure. In this treatise he praises the Epicurean definition of pleasure as the removal of pain from the body and disturbance from the soul, and argues that Epicureanism is superior to the vulgar hedonism of someone like Aristippus. Ficino suggests that he experienced an intellectual or spiritual crisis during this time, and as a result ultimately rejected Epicurus and Lucretius as incompatible with deeply held philosophical and religious commitments. In a letter, Ficino reports that he burned his youthful commentary on Lucretius. Despite this Epicurus and Lucretius left an enduring stamp on Ficino’s thought that is visible in the mature philosophical writings, and historians of Renaissance philosophy are still assessing this influence today.

During the 1450s Ficino began to study Greek. In time, his knowledge of classical Greek culminated in one of his most lasting philosophical and scholarly achievements and contributions—his translation of Plato’s complete works into Latin. In 1462, Cosimo de’Medici commissioned Ficino to translate a manuscript copy of Plato’s extant writings. Around the same time, Cosimo also gave him the proceeds from a small property, as well as a villa in Careggi, not far from Florence. The conditions of the 1460s provided Ficino with the perfect opportunity to fully dedicate himself to translating Plato’s complete writings into Latin. His edition marked the first time that Plato’s extant corpus was translated into a Western language. Ficino’s work on Plato, however, was quickly interrupted when Cosimo requested that he also translate the Corpus Hermeticum into Latin. At the time, the Hermetic corpus was believed by many to be an ancient collection of theological writings that contained sacred wisdom. It was, however, written in the early years of Christianity. In 1464, Ficino read his translations of Plato’s dialogues to Cosimo as the aging patron lay dying.

In the late 1460s, after completing his translation of Plato, Ficino started working on his Platonic Theology: On the Immortality of the Soul. This book was finished in 1474, but it did not find its way into print until 1482. The Platonic Theology is Ficino’s longest and most systematic philosophical work. In 1473, he was ordained a priest, and after completing his Platonic Theology, dedicated himself primarily to translation, commentary, and correspondence. During this time Ficino also wrote the bulk of his commentaries on Plato’s dialogues. The last two decades of Ficino’s life were especially productive. In the 1480s, he translated the Enneads of the second-century Neoplatonist Plotinus, and also wrote commentaries on them. An edition of Plotinus was published in 1492. During this time Ficino completed his Three Books on Life, a medical and astrological treatise. After its 1489 publication it became one of his most popular and influential books. The third book presents Ficino’s theory of natural magic, which has since become the definitive Renaissance consideration of the subject.

Throughout his life Ficino carried on a steady correspondence with philosophers, poets, and politicians across Europe. This choice of philosophical expression shows the influence that Humanism had on him. In many letters, Ficino clarifies his understanding of certain Platonic concepts, such as poetic furor; but on a whole his correspondence is not strictly philosophical in nature, at least not by academic standards today. Even so, it contains information that is central to an accurate appreciation of his thought. Ficino conceived of philosophy as a way of life that purified and prepared those who practice it correctly for a life well lived. Ficino’s correspondence contains a good deal of practical advice, and he is often found giving counsel on how to cope with the deaths of children, spouses, and friends, or on how to extend one’s life; he also lends sundry medical advice, and even discusses the astrological placement of planets that contribute to one’s character traits. The letters serve both to clarify the content of his philosophy, as well as to shed a different light on what he perceived his role to be as a philosopher and an advocate of Platonism. These sources teach us that Ficino did not define philosophy narrowly. Instead, he saw himself as a doctor of sorts that was concerned with questions that concerned the health of bodies, minds, and souls. This practical concern is clearly displayed in his correspondence, and his Three Books on Life. Ficino edited and published his correspondence in 1494. He died in 1499.

2. The Platonic Academy of Florence

In the fourteenth century, the poet and Humanist Francesco Petrarch praised Plato as the prince of philosophers. In so doing, Petrarch turned to Plato as an antidote to Scholastic Aristotelianism, which at the time dominated the medieval university curriculum. During the Middle Ages the bulk of Plato’s dialogues—except for the Phaedo, Meno, and parts of the Parmenides and Timaeus—were inaccessible to Western philosophers because they were not available in Latin. Consequently, knowledge of Plato’s philosophy at this time was largely indirect and incomplete. Following Petrarch’s lead, early fifteenth-century Humanists (such as Leonardo Bruni) saw the importance of studying classical Greek, and they translated, among other things, a handful of Plato’s dialogues into Latin.

Ficino’s translation represents the fulfillment of these early Humanist aspirations for a Latin edition of Plato. It is difficult to overstate the significance of this achievement, or the impact that it had on the development of early modern philosophies. His Latin translation of Plato enriched the sources available to philosophers in the West, and thereby changed the form and content of philosophy. Ficino largely finished his translation of Plato’s complete works in the 1460s, but they did not appear in print until 1484. The first edition included Ficino’s short descriptions or summaries of what he considered the key arguments of the dialogues; a 1494 edition was expanded to include his lengthy commentaries on Plato’s Symposium, Philebus, Phaedrus, Timaeus, Parmenides, Sophist, and Republic Book VIII. Eventually Ficino’s commentary on the Symposium—an unorthodox dialogue itself loosely inspired by the original—became one of his most popular and influential treatments of Plato. In it he identified Plato’s theory of love with Christian love, and argued that the proper love of another person is in fact preparation for the love of God. He invented the phrase Platonic love, and his interpretation was especially influential in the sixteenth century. His Timaeus commentary is significant because it represents the first consideration of the dialogue in its entirety since antiquity; medieval philosophers only had access to roughly half of the dialogue, and Calcidius’ commentary was necessarily truncated. Ficino’s translations of Plato’s complete works went through many printings and were used by philosophers and scholars for centuries. They continue to be recognized for their precision and fidelity to the original Greek.

Through his translations and commentaries, as well as his Platonic Theology, Ficino played a central role in the Renaissance revival of Platonism. In the second half of the fifteenth century, he stood at the center of a group of intellectuals that were drawn specifically to Plato and Platonism, and more generally to classical antiquity. As a result of his advocacy, historians of Renaissance philosophy for a long time thought that Ficino founded and headed a formal Platonic Academy in Florence that was inspired by Plato’s school in ancient Athens. However, the precise nature of Florence’s Academy remains unclear today, and some are skeptical that any such academy ever really existed. It seems unlikely that Ficino headed a formal educational institution in any real sense. More plausible is the hypothesis that Ficino’s occasional reference to the revival of Plato’s academy in Florence actually designated the presence of a manuscript copy of Plato’s dialogues in Florence, to Plato’s teachings and philosophy, and his own efforts to revive Plato in Florence through his translations and commentaries. Whether or not Ficino actually headed a Platonic Academy in Florence, he was nonetheless instrumental as an advocate of Platonism during the Renaissance.

3. The Ancient Theology and Pious Philosophy

Ficino’s philosophy is indebted to a wide variety of philosophical sources and traditions. Although his thought is eclectic, he does not generally seek to bring distinct and apparently incompatible views into accord or harmony with one another. His work is generally a blend of traditional philosophies, both ancient and medieval, and ideas that are drawn from the less-orthodox Neoplatonic and Hermetic traditions. The influences of Platonism, Neoplatonism, and Scholasticism are particularly prominent.

Like many of his contemporaries, Ficino believed that Hermes Trismegistus was an ancient Egyptian theologian and philosopher of sacred and divine wisdom. In the preface to his translation of the Corpus Hermeticum, Ficino explains that Hermes “foresaw the ruin of the old religion, the rise of the new faith, [and] the coming of Christ.”  In fact, Ficino believed in a single ancient theological tradition (prisca theologia) that stretched back to Hermes in ancient Egypt and included Pythagoras, Orpheus, Philolaus, and Plato, to name a few, among its ranks. This ancient tradition, he argues, espoused a pious philosophy (pia philosophia) in which religious and philosophical truths coincide. The advent of Christianity brought about the fullest and clearest expression of this pious philosophy, though vestiges of it can be found much earlier. Over the course of the history of philosophy, according to Ficino, the fortune of the pious philosophy has waxed and waned, and there are periods during which it is hardly present at all. He considered Plato an especially effective advocate of the pious philosophy; in the preface to the Platonic Theology, he explains that no matter what subject Plato discusses “he quickly brings it round, and in a spirit of utmost piety, to the contemplation and worship of God.”

4. Platonic Theology

The Platonic Theology is Marsilio Ficino’s philosophical magnum opus. Its overall aim is to defend the immortality of the soul, and to this end Ficino avails himself of a wide variety of arguments. For Ficino, this question is at the heart of human self-interest and well-being. In the first chapter, he argues that if human beings were merely mortal, then there would be “no animal more miserable than man.”  Ficino’s core argument is that the natural human desire for immortality must be vindicated by an afterlife. Were it not, this desire would be empty, vain, and this would call into question both the perfection of nature and God’s wisdom and goodness.

While arguing for the soul’s immortality Ficino elaborates on many of those positions and arguments that are distinctive of his philosophy. He presents and defends the basic principles of his metaphysics. While he is deeply indebted to earlier metaphysical traditions, especially the Neoplatonic and Scholastic traditions, elements of these traditions are generally adapted to his own philosophical aims and purposes. Ficino also presents his case for the inherent dignity of humanity. This defense depends in large part on his own restructuring of the Neoplatonic hierarchy of being, according to which the soul is located centrally between God and matter. The soul’s metaphysical position also ensures its immortality. Ficino argues that the soul’s troubled psychological condition is an unfortunate side effect of this hierarchy. He detects a disconnect between the soul’s divinity and the sundry demands and problems that the body causes for it. While the soul is immortal and occupied a privileged place on the great chain of being, its psychological condition is one of exile, longing, and confusion regarding its own nature. Finally, Ficino argues for his vitalistic natural philosophy according to which matter requires the presence of something incorporeal—namely soul—for it to be substantial and real.

The Platonic Theology is a rich and challenging book. Its structure and content may produce confusion and frustration in some contemporary readers. There is an overarching logical structure to the book, but Ficino chooses not to clearly state many of his central assumptions and themes, and the route he takes to his conclusions can often appear circuitous. Ficino frequently utilizes metaphysical and epistemological assumptions, but he does not in every case define or defend them. This is not to say, however, that his views are merely asserted or that his reasoning is flawed in some significant way. Many of his assumptions are generally embedded in earlier philosophical traditions, and thus his views and arguments have to be placed in the proper historical context in order to be appreciated for their rigor and coherence. Ficino thought that philosophy done properly required an ongoing conversation with ancient philosophies. A familiarity with earlier philosophies is therefore necessary in order to fully appreciate and assess the arguments of the Platonic Theology.

a. Metaphysics

Ficino’s metaphysics is a blend of elements drawn from Platonism, Neoplatonism, and medieval Scholasticism. Broadly speaking, he maintains a Platonic division between the intelligible and sensible realms or between being and becoming. Throughout the Platonic Theology, he is found employing the hylomorphic terminology of the Scholastics in his detailed analysis of the nature of things. Ficino embraces and uses the metaphysical hierarchy developed by the Neoplatonist Plotinus, according to which the progressive levels of being emanate from a single source.

In the preface, Ficino explains that a central aim of the Platonic Theology is to demonstrate to materialist philosophers that matter is less real than those incorporeal entities (such as souls and forms) that transcend the senses. To accomplish this aim Ficino relies primarily on Plato’s dialogues, because in his estimation they most successfully demote the reality of the material world, while at the same time grounding and elevating the metaphysical priority of souls and forms. Furthermore, he believes that Platonism provides the most solid philosophical foundation for Christianity. Throughout the Platonic Theology, Ficino embraces the metaphysical distinction, prominent in Plato’s dialogues, between being and becoming or between the intelligible and sensible realms. He argues that the former is more real than the latter, and is therefore more worthy of our enduring attention, devotion, and study. Along these lines he maintains that forms are the perfect archetypes of all material things and exist unchangeably in the divine mind. They are in fact the genuine cause of the sensible qualities and properties of the material world. By contrast, the world of matter is shadowy and deceptive. It engenders confusion and imprisons the minds of many people.

Ficino’s metaphysics is overwhelmingly Platonic. But his theory of material substances is indebted to Scholasticism for many of its most salient features. While Ficino’s philosophy is clearly otherworldly—in the sense that he maintains the existence and metaphysical priority of realities apart from the material world—this does not prevent him from speculating about the metaphysics of matter and body in the early books of the Platonic Theology. In fact, he believes that doing so is in keeping with the broader aims of the book. By and large, Ficino analyzes material substances along traditional hylomorphic lines, according to which they are constituted by three principles: matter, form, and privation. Matter functions as the passive substrate of the forms that are active in making something what it is, and privation is what a substance can potentially become. The matter of a thing is relative to the level of organization under consideration; the matter of a statue is marble, but the marble itself is not without its own form and matter. When all qualities, both substantial and accidental, are stripped from a substance there is at bottom a single formless prime matter that is one and the same for all things. He holds that prime matter exists in a chaotic and confused state of potency. For Ficino, it is something that is ontologically basic and epistemically impenetrable. It is therefore difficult, if not impossible, to say anything directly about it other than that it must exist as the substratum of form. Here Ficino is echoing Plotinus who compared understanding matter to the eye seeing darkness.

Even though Ficino employs the basic terms of the Scholastics, he makes significant modifications to this framework. These changes are consistent with his broader philosophical commitments and the overall objectives of the Platonic Theology. First, it is noteworthy that he embraces a theory of seminal reasons, according to which seeds are spread throughout matter, and are the cause of things coming to be at appointed times. Unlike the Scholastics, Ficino judges that the qualities or properties of material things are protean, not self-sufficient, unstable, and parasitic on incorporeal forms for any reality and causal efficacy in the world of matter. Here his underlying Platonism becomes apparent. Ficino says that material forms are corrupted and contaminated when they are embedded in the “bosom” of matter. He poetically describes material qualities as “mere shadows that come and go like the reflections of lofty trees in a rushing stream”  (I.III.15). Ficino sees the basic elements of the world as existing in a constant and chaotic state of change, and he holds that whatever stability they exhibit is on account of their cause, that is, their incorporeal archetypes. According to Ficino, this is not merely true of the elements, but of all qualities of material things across the board, both those that are substantial and those that are accidental. In this way, Ficino traces back all of the qualities of this world to something eternal and incorporeal as their cause, and this is the basic unit of reality for him. He accepts a metaphysical principle that there is a first in each genus (primum) that is the fullest and most perfect expression of any particular species quality. It does not include anything that does not properly belong to that genus. The first in each genus is ultimately the cause of every particular expression of that quality. Ficino, therefore, demotes the reality of material forms or qualities while at the same time buttressing the reality of incorporeal forms. Although he analyzes material substances along hylomorphic lines, he at the same time alters this framework in an effort to ground his Platonic metaphysics, and ultimately the immortality of the soul.

There are prominent Neoplatonic elements at the core of Ficino’s metaphysics. He inherited from Plotinus a particular approach to metaphysics that is a hierarchical superstructure, with distinct levels or hypostases, all of which draw their being from an overflowing singular source. The source of all being is the One for Plotinus and God for Ficino. He considers all being to be a progressive emanation from the divine, and although each hypostasis is distinct, what is above serves as a dynamic bridge to what is below. Everything in Ficino’s cosmos has its own unique place and degree of perfection, beginning with God at the summit and descending through the celestial spheres, angels, and souls, all the way down to the elements of the terrestrial sphere. In it there is nothing that is vain or superfluous, and Ficino thinks that everything is drawn to its good or end by a natural appetite.

Ficino generally recognizes five distinct levels of reality. But he at times changes the precise arrangement and structure of the hypostases of this hierarchy. At the top of the hierarchy is God, which is the source of all being and perfection. The first hypostasis that God produces is angelic mind. It contains the archetypes and forms of all things in a timeless and immutable state. These forms are the essences of all possible entities, and they are responsible for the qualities and properties of material things. Next in this progression comes the rational soul, which imparts motion and vitality to the cosmos. Ficino posits a World Soul (anima mundi) that is immanent in all of nature, and individual souls that animate sundry entities in the world, including the celestial spheres, living creatures, and even the elements. Mind is eternal and unmoving; soul is likewise eternal, but differs because it is in a perpetual state of motion. Soul stands at the metaphysical node or bond between what is above and below; while it is drawn to forms and the divine above, it is responsible for the governance of what comes below. Beneath rational soul is the hypostasis of quality, which is representative of the material forms found in nature. The patterns of qualities are grounded in the second hypostasis, mind; the source of its motion and alteration comes from soul. Finally, the hierarchy of being is extinguished with the lowest level of reality—body or corporeal matter. Ficino defines body as matter that is extended in length, breadth, and depth. It functions as the bearer of qualities, but contributes nothing of its own to the nature of things.

Even though Ficino generally marks a distinction between being and becoming, or between the incorporeal and corporeal, he is no simple dualist. His view of soul, and the role that it plays in the material world, is fundamentally different from, for example, the strict dualism of the seventeenth-century philosopher René Descartes. Matter and soul are entirely distinct from one another, according to Descartes, and these two basic substances share no qualities in common. In his treatise on physics, The World, Descartes distinguishes himself from earlier approaches to natural philosophy when he explains that he uses the word “nature” to “signify matter itself,” and not “some goddess or any other sort of imaginary power” (AT XI 37). According to Descartes, a natural philosopher does not need to appeal to anything other than matter in order to properly explain the natural world. On the contrary, according to Ficino, the material world is not something that can be adequately explained by turning to matter and motion alone; nature is an active power that suffuses matter and provides it with its life, activity, and order. On this account, nature is a dynamic force operating on material things from within, and this is the proper or genuine cause of things changing, as well as their generation and corruption. Soul, therefore, has a paramount role to play in Ficino’s natural philosophy.

Like Plato and his Neoplatonic interpreters, Ficino makes competing claims about the relative goodness of the material world. In his Timaeus, Plato argues that the sensible world is on a whole good and beautiful because it is modeled on eternal forms. In other dialogues, such as the Phaedo and Republic, the sensible world is a shadowy and deceptive prison. Plotinus recognizes this tension in Plato and comments on it in his Enneads. Ficino inherits this ambiguity about the goodness of the world, even if negative appraisals are more frequent and prominent in the Platonic Theology than positive ones. Like Plato, Ficino asserts that the creator is a benevolent and wise architect, and that these qualities are reflected in God’s creation; however, he also maintains that the world of matter is shadowy, evil, and to some degree unreal. Furthermore, Ficino blames matter and body for the mind’s tendency to be confused and deceived about what is real and good. On a whole, therefore, Ficino’s overall assessment of the material world—at least as far as the human condition is concerned—is negative.

In his metaphysics, Ficino is not drawn to austere and desert-like frameworks, and he was not reductionistic in his thinking. As such, he belongs to a tradition of metaphysicians, including the seventeenth-century Platonist G. W. Leibniz, that embrace a rich and expansive ontology. Ficino lays out a tapestry of entities that comprise the world. In nature alone he countenances the existence of matter, qualities, and a cavalcade of souls, including a World Soul, that impart motion and vital powers to all aspects of the material world. Ficino claims that nature is in fact replete with souls; there are souls that belong to the elements, to non-human animals, as well as a soul that is responsible for the growth of rocks and trees from the earth’s surface.

b. Epistemology

In the Platonic Theology, Ficino does not address epistemological issues as directly or with the same degree of frequency as he does metaphysical ones. Nonetheless, the broad contours of a view can be sketched by paying close attention to the occasional discussion of the origin, nature, and value of knowledge. Throughout this work Ficino makes scattered remarks about the mind’s capabilities, what exactly it apprehends when it knows, and the effect that knowledge has on those who possess it. Generally these comments arise when Ficino is either discussing the nature and powers of the human mind and distinguishing them from the body, or when he speculates about the divine mind and draws a comparison with finite minds.

Ficino holds that knowledge is rooted in forms, not matter. However, the metaphysics of matter described above has certain implications for what exactly stands as the object of knowledge. He argues that the degradation of forms in matter requires that the mind grasps something other than sensible forms when it knows. If it did not, he argues, then knowledge would not be stable and fixed; instead, it would vary and change as the qualities of material things do. Rather, when the mind knows it apprehends intelligible forms, and not the sensible forms that include the individual traits that are distinctive of particular objects. These forms are stable and unchanging, and as such Ficino claims that they produce stable and unchanging knowledge.

Knowledge does not, according to Ficino, come about in stages, or as a result of a gradual process. The mind does not take gradual steps and build upon its experiences to arrive at universals. On the contrary, he describes knowledge as coming about in an instantaneous flash, and not in a progressive or abstractive manner. Ficino claims that philosophical reflection on the nature of things prepares and purifies the mind of falsehood until it is ready to receive the clarity of truth. This arrival is simple and immediate. Ficino explains that “speculative virtue does not proceed stage by stage from one part of itself to another, but blazes forth wholly and suddenly” (VIII.III.6). Ficino even holds that intelligible forms are distinct from, and discontinuous with, sensible forms, even if our experience of particular material things can be the root cause of the mind’s coming to know something. Furthermore, he makes some interesting suggestions about the existence of primary truths that contain other truths within them, and he claims that the knowledge of one primary truth can elicit knowledge of others. While Ficino mentions that such primary truths exist, he does not elaborate as to what exactly these truths are or what one would look like.

There are several Platonic epistemic themes that are prominent in the Platonic Theology. Ficino maintains that the mind is nourished by truth, and he sees it as edifying of the overall condition of the human soul. He also claims that there is much to recommend the Platonic doctrine of reminiscence, even if he rejects the transmigration of souls as heretical. Also, his description of learning calls to mind Plato’s Theaetetus, where Socrates describes himself as a midwife of sorts. In this vein, Ficino holds that the mind already has within itself the intelligible forms that it will, if it is diligent, come to know, or remember. These forms exist latently in the mind, and learning is a process of drawing out from the mind what is, in a certain sense, already there.

c. The Dignity of Humanity and the Human Condition

The metaphysical hierarchy outlined in the above section on metaphysics has significant philosophical consequences for both the dignity of the rational soul, and the qualitative character of the human condition. Ficino argues that the soul’s location on the chain of being lends to it a privileged position on the hierarchy of being, and is therefore responsible for its dignity and uniqueness. In different contexts Ficino changes the precise structure of this pentadic hierarchy, but the soul’s centrality is a consistent theme. This is an alteration of Plotinus’ original hierarchy and ensures the soul’s dignity and immortality. The soul is situated at the precise center of the hierarchy standing midway between God above and matter below. Ficino explains the structure of his metaphysics in the following way:

We would do well to call soul the third and middle essence, as the Platonists do, because it is the mean for all and the third from both directions. If you descend from God, you will find soul at the third level down; or at the third level up, if you ascend from body.

In the same chapter he continues:

But the third essence set between them is such that it cleaves to the higher while not abandoning the lower; and in it, therefore the higher and the lower are linked together… So by a natural instinct it ascends to the higher and descends to the lower. In ascending it does not abandon the things below it; in descending, it does not relinquish the things above it. (III.II.1-2)

The soul is the “fitting knot” or “node” that binds the upper half of the hierarchy with the lower. On account of its place in the hierarchy, Ficino explains that the soul is at one and the same time drawn to what is above, as well as responsible for the governance of nature below. Further, Ficino thinks that it shares some properties in common with what is above and below, and as a result it is perfectly well-suited to serve as the bridge between the upper and the lower halves of the hierarchy. The soul is eternal and immortal because it shares in divinity above. It also suffuses all of nature and lends to its motion and vitality. Ficino sees the soul as charged with the governance of the material world, and is intimately responsible for its potential well-being. This is a unique and privileged metaphysical role for it. He argues that the soul is not connected to any distinct part of the body, but communicates its life-giving power throughout.

The soul’s centrality in the great chain of being ensures its dignity and immortality. However, it is also responsible for its wretchedness and depravity. The soul’s proximity to the body has a negative effect on its ability to truly appreciate its own nature and immortality. Individual souls are by and large overwhelmed with the governance of their bodies, and the material world assaults them with violent motions and sensations. As a result the soul may fail to recognize its own nature and divinity. The conditions of embodiment also frustrate its search for truth. Metaphysically speaking, it functions as the node between the upper and the lower, but in practice it is wedded so tightly with matter that it naturally, Ficino believes, comes to the conclusion that it is not distinct from it. This is the cause of the common sense materialism that most people uncritically accept, and that says something is not real unless it is a body. A pivotal consequence of this situation is that the soul forgets its own privileged nature and divinity, and in many cases concludes that it is nothing distinct from matter. Thus, there is a disconnect in Ficino’s philosophy between the metaphysical nature of the soul, and its subjective experience when joined with matter. This is the cause, according to Ficino, of the wretchedness of the human condition, which is characterized by a certain confusion regarding what is real and worthy of its pursuit.

d. The Immortality of the Soul

The primary aim of the Platonic Theology is of course to demonstrate the immortality of the soul. Ficino provides a plurality of arguments across the eighteen books of this work. He argues that the soul’s immortality is a consequence of its position on the metaphysical hierarchy. He also provides arguments that rest upon the metaphysical and epistemological foundations of the Platonic Theology. Still other arguments are polemical and aim at refuting relevant and uneliminated alternatives, such as the positions of Epicurus and Averroes. Epicurus and Averroes—with the former denying immortality, and the latter claiming that it was one and the same for all—were growing in popularity in some academic circles in fifteenth-century Italy.

First and foremost, Ficino argues that the natural appetite for immortality entails post-mortem existence for the soul. He starts with the assumption that our primary goal is to ascend to a spiritual union with God, and he holds that this is a basic and natural desire shared and acted on by most human beings. If these efforts were to go unfulfilled, Ficino concludes that they would be otiose, vain, and even perverse. Perhaps more importantly, this would stand in direct violation of the perfection of nature and the wisdom of God. Thus, Ficino concludes that the natural desire for immortality must be vindicated in an actual afterlife.

In addition, in the Platonic Theology Ficino puts forward two prominent argument types that draw upon the nature and powers of the human mind, and on his theory of matter and body. He aims to show that the rational powers of the soul all support immortality and that these essential functions are in no way dependent upon matter and body. He argues that there is a correspondence or likeness between incorporeal entities and the soul. The intellect knows best when it does not depend upon the body or the senses whatsoever, and instead experiences an immediate union with forms. Ficino says that “when the soul despises corporeals and when the senses have been allayed and the clouds of phantasmata dissipated … then the intellect discerns truly and is at its brightest” (IX.II.2). Ficino takes this as evidence that the soul did not originate with the body. Instead, he argues that the soul is ineluctably drawn to things divine, and its union with incorporeals comes most naturally to it. He says that the soul was born for the contemplation of things divine, and through them it is enriched and perfected. Both the soul’s correspondence to incorporeals and the pull that they have on it are indicative of its underlying nature—like things incorporeal, it is immortal.

Ficino also aims to show that there are dissimilarities between the soul and matter. He argues that the essential functions of the mind are distinct from the body, and further that body cannot in any way give rise to them. These arguments aim to refute materialists who think that matter can give rise to the soul’s essential functions. Ficino argues that the soul’s most important operations are inconsistent with the basic conditions of corporeality. In fact, the body, the senses, and the passions all conspire to impede and frustrate the soul in its search for knowledge and goodness. Much like Plato in the Phaedo, Ficino argues that the soul’s overall condition improves the farther it is removed from the material world, and the soul knows best when it does not draw upon the senses. These dissimilarities establish, Ficino thinks, the soul’s essential otherness from matter and body. Ficino’s metaphysics of matter is also tailored to provide support for immortality. He provides what he calls a “Platonic” definition of body, according to which it is composed of matter and extension. Both matter and extension are passive and inert, and cannot give rise in any way to the essential functions of the soul. Therefore, Ficino concludes that it is only on account of the presence of something incorporeal, namely forms and souls, that material things are at all substantial.

5. Ethics and Love

Ficino did not compose a systematic treatise on ethics. Nonetheless, his familiarity with classical Greek philosophy means that ethical considerations are central to many of his philosophical works, and he often comes around to discussing human virtues and well-being. Ficino does not generally place an emphasis on the rightness of actions, or on duties or obligations for that matter. Instead, he focuses on the health and development of the whole person, which is consistent with what is today called virtue ethics. Ficino marks the traditional distinction between intellectual and moral virtues. The speculative virtues concern, for instance, the understanding of things divine, the knowledge of nature, and the craftsman’s ability to produce artifacts. This species of virtue is acquired through learning and speculation, and it is characterized by an intellectual state of clarity. The moral virtues come about through custom and habit, and their domain is human desires and appetites. Ficino holds that the end of moral virtues is to purify the soul and to ultimately release it from the sometimes overwhelming demands made by the body. Thus, moral virtue produces a state of soul that governs desires and appetites so that they do not take control of the soul, thereby leading to an incontinent or intemperate character. In the end, both the speculative and moral virtues are consistent with Ficino’s broader aspirations as a Christian Platonist. For him the virtues are prerequisites that prepare the soul for its inner ascent up the hierarchy of being, ultimately uniting it with God.

Ficino’s theory of love plays a central role in his ethics. He defines love as the desire for beauty. Love originates with God, and it is the link or bond that all things share in common. Here Ficino follows the patterns left by Plato and Plotinus. Beautiful things ignite or inspire the soul with love. When an individual thing is loved properly, the soul ascends progressively from love of the particular to the universal. The lover, therefore, turns inwardly to the soul from the corporeal world, and thus ultimately finds its end in God. However, it is possible for the soul to love improperly and become fixated on beautiful objects. This results in a life of confusion and wretchedness. Thus, for Ficino, the proper application of love lies at the heart of human happiness.

6. Legacy

Ficino left an enduring impression on the history of Western philosophy. His philosophical writings, and his translations of Platonic and Hermetic texts, exercised both a direct and indirect influence on the form and content of philosophy in subsequent centuries. The Platonic Theology was instrumental in elevating the defense of the immortality of the soul to philosophical prominence in the early modern period. It contributed to the Lateran Council of 1512 requiring philosophers to defend the immortality of the soul and the existence of God. In the letter of dedication to his Meditations on First Philosophy, Descartes refers to the Lateran Council to explain, in part, the proofs of God’s existence and immortality found therein. Ficino’s influence can also be seen in many of the most noteworthy philosophers of the sixteenth century, most notably Giordano Bruno, and Francesco Patrizi da Cherso, who held a chair of Platonic philosophy at the University of Ferrara. He indirectly influenced generations of philosophers who encountered Platonism and Hermeticism through his translations and commentaries.

The fortune of Ficino’s philosophical legacy has waxed and waned over the centuries. His influence on intellectual life in the sixteenth century was especially strong, but his brand of Christian Platonism was certainly not without its critics in subsequent centuries. The sixteenth-century theologian and historian Johannes Serranus criticized Ficino’s mode of translating and commenting on Plato’s dialogues, which he thought lacked clarity, brevity, and precision. The self-proclaimed Platonist G. W. Leibniz complains that Ficino’s definitions lack the rigor of Plato’s, and he says that his Neoplatonism incorporates too many pagan elements and is therefore prone to heresy. In his Lectures on the History of Philosophy, G. W. F. Hegel gives Ficino a minor and subordinate role to play in the development of modern philosophy. Hegel argues that Ficino’s revival of Platonic philosophy was ultimately a misguided and childish fascination with a dead philosophy. Perhaps more importantly, however, is the fact that Ficino’s philosophy stands in stark contrast to the methods and explanations employed by the new science in the seventeenth century. Hobbes and Descartes, for example, wanted to explain nature in purely materialistic and mechanical terms. The new philosophy and science, therefore, repudiates the vital core of Ficino’s metaphysics, especially his belief in a World Soul and his vitalistic natural philosophy. Hobbes outright rejects an incorporeal soul, and Descartes completely expels it from nature. Both philosophers, therefore, aspired to explain nature in such a way that it did not include many of the core features of the Ficino’s thought.

For a longtime Ficino remained a marginal figure and a footnote in histories of philosophy. It was not until nearly the middle of the twentieth century, when Paul Oskar Kristeller published his seminal book, The Philosophy of Marsilio Ficino, that historians of philosophy started to re-examine and reconsider Ficino’s importance to the history of Renaissance and early modern philosophies. Kristeller’s book examined the formal structure of Ficino’s philosophy, and he painted a picture of a sophisticated and systematic metaphysician. More recently a number of articles and books have been published on other aspects of Ficino’s thought. Since Kristeller, later scholars—such as D. P. Walker, Frances Yates, and Michael J. B. Allen—have focused less on the systematic and formal philosophy, and more on the magical and creative elements of Ficino’s thought. The critical examination of Ficino, and an assessment of his influence, continues today.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • Ficino, Marsilio. Opera Omnia. 2 vols. Basel, 1576.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. The Letters of Marsilio Ficino. Trans. The Language Department of the London School of Economics. 8 vols. London: Shepheard-Walwyn Ltd., 1975-2010.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. The Philebus Commentary. Ed. and trans. Michael J. B. Allen. Berkeley and Los Angeles:  University of California Press, 1975.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. Commentaries on Plato’s Symposium on Love. Trans. Sears Jayne. Dallas: Spring Publications, 1985.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. Three Books on Life. Ed. and trans. Carol Kaske and John Clark. Tempe, Arizona: MRTS, 1998.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. Platonic Theology. Trans. Michael J. B. Allen, and ed. James Hankins. 6 vols. Cambridge: The I Tatti Renaissance Library, Harvard University Press, 2001-2006.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. Commentaries on Plato: Phaedrus and Ion. Cambridge: The I Tatti Renaissance Library, Harvard University Press, 2008.
  • Ficino, Marsilio. All Things Natural: Ficino on Plato’s Timaeus. Trans. Arthur Farndell. London: Shepheard-Walwyn Ltd., 2010.
  • Kristeller, Paul Oskar. Supplementum Ficinianum. 2 vols. Florence: Olschki, 1938.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Allen, Michael J. B. Icastes: Marsilio Ficino’s Interpretation of Plato’s Sophist. Berkeley and Los Angeles:  University of California Press, 1989.
    • A translation of Ficino’s Sophist commentary and discussion of his ontology.
  • Allen, Michael J. B. Synoptic Art: Marsilio Ficino and the History of Platonic Interpretation. Florence: Olschki, 1998.
    • Ficino’s philosophy and the history of later Platonism.
  • Celenza, Christopher. “Pythagoras in the Renaissance: The Case of Marsilio Ficino.” Renaissance Quarterly 52 (1999): 667-711.
    • A study of Ficino’s appropriation of classical Greek philosophy.
  • Collins, Ardis. B. The Secular is Sacred: Platonism and Thomism in Ficino’s Platonic Theology. The Hague: Nijhoff, 1974.
    • An examination of Ficino’s debt to Aquinas, especially the Summa Contra Gentiles.
  • Copenhaver, Brian P. and Charles Schmitt. Renaissance Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1992.
    • A detailed and exhaustive study of Renaissance philosophy with a significant discussion of Ficino’s thought.
  • Field, Arthur. The Origins of the Platonic Academy of Florence. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1988.
    • A study of the social and intellectual role that the Platonic Academy of Florence.
  • Kristeller, Paul Oskar. The Philosophy of Marsilio Ficino. New York: Columbia University Press, 1943.
    • The authoritative guide to Ficino’s formal philosophy.
  • Hankins, James. Plato in the Italian Renaissance. 2 vols. Leiden: Brill, 1989.
    • The definitive examination of the Renaissance revival of Plato. A complete examination of the Renaissance revival of Plato not limited to Ficino.
  • Snyder, James G. “The theory of materia prima in Ficino’s Platonic Theology.” Vivarium 46 (2008): 192-221.
    • A study of the metaphysics and epistemology of Ficino’s theories of prime and corporeal matter.
  • Snyder, James G. “Marsilio Ficino’s Critique of the Lucretian Alternative.”  Journal of the History of Ideas 72 (2011): 165-181.
    • An examination of Ficino’s critique of Epicurean materialism.
  • Walker, D. P. Spiritual and Demonic Magic: From Ficino to Campanella. London: The Warburg Institute, 1958.
    • An examination of Ficino’s theory of natural magic.
  • Yates, Frances A. Giordano Bruno and the Hermetic Tradition. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1964.
    • Examination of Ficino’s natural magic and the influence it had on Bruno.

Author Information

James G. Snyder
Email: james.snyder@marist.edu
Marist College
U. S. A.

Knowledge

Philosophy’s history of reflection upon knowledge is a history of theses and theories; but no less of questions, concepts, distinctions, syntheses, and taxonomies. All of these will appear in this article. They generate, colour, and refine these philosophical theses and theories about knowledge. The results are epistemological — philosophical attempts to understand whatever is most fundamentally understandable about the nature and availability of knowledge. We will gain a sense of what philosophers have thought knowledge is and might be, along with why some philosophers have thought knowledge both does not and could not exist.

Thus, we will examine some of the general kinds or forms of knowledge that epistemologists have thought it important to highlight (section 1), followed by the idea of knowledge as a kind or phenomenon at all (section 2). Knowledge seems to be something we gain as we live; how do we gain it, though? That will be our next question (section 3), before we ask whether our apparently gaining knowledge is an illusion: might no one ever really gain knowledge (section 4)? Answers to these questions could reflect finer details of knowledge’s constituents (section 5), including the standards involved in knowing (section 6). The article ends by asking about the fundamental point of having knowledge (section 7).

Table of Contents

  1. Kinds of Knowledge
    1. Knowing by Acquaintance
    2. Knowledge-That
    3. Knowledge-Wh
    4. Knowing-How
  2. Knowledge as a Kind
  3. Ways of Knowing
    1. Innate Knowledge
    2. Observational Knowledge
    3. Knowing Purely by Thinking
    4. Knowing by Thinking-Plus-Observing
  4. Sceptical Doubts about Knowing
  5. Understanding Knowledge?
    1. The Justified-True-Belief Conception of Knowledge
    2. Not the Justified-True-Belief Conception of Knowledge?
    3. Questioning the Gettier Problem
  6. Standards for Knowing
    1. Certainty or Infallibility
    2. Fallibility
    3. Grades of Fallibility
    4. Safety and Lucky Knowing
    5. Mere True Belief
    6. Non-Factive Conceptions
  7. Knowing’s Point
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Kinds of Knowledge

We talk of knowledge: all of us do; philosophers do. But what is knowledge? We can best answer that potentially complex question in several stages. Let us begin by considering whether there are different kinds of knowledge. Epistemologists have contemplated at least the following general possibilities.

a. Knowing by Acquaintance

Your knowing a person, it seems, involves direct interaction with him or her. Otherwise, at most, you should claim only that it is almost as if you know him or her: ‘I’ve seen and heard so much about her that I feel like I know her. I wonder whether I’ll ever meet her — whether I will ever actually know her.’ Without that meeting, you could well know facts about the person (this being a kind of knowledge to be discussed in section 1.b). Nonetheless, could you know facts about a person without ever meeting him or her? If so, there could well be a kind of knowledge which is different to knowing a fact; maybe knowing a thing or entity (such as a person) is distinct from knowing a fact about that thing or entity.

Bertrand Russell (1959 [1912]: ch. 5) famously distinguished between knowledge by description and a quite particular kind of knowledge by acquaintance. He allowed there to be a form of acquaintance that was immediate and unquestionable, linking one with such things as abstract properties and momentary sensory items passing before one’s mind: you can be acquainted with the abstract property of redness, as well as with a specific patch of redness briefly in your visual field. Knowledge by description was the means by which, in Russell’s view, a person could proceed to know about what he or she had not experienced directly. We formulate definite descriptions (‘the third man listed in the current Sydney residential phonebook’) and indefinite ones (‘a man listed in the current Sydney residential phonebook’). With these, we can designate individuals with whom we have not interacted. Then we can formulate claims using such descriptions. Some of these claims could be knowledge. Thus, we may open up for ourselves a world of knowledge beyond what is revealed by our immediate experiences.

b. Knowledge-That

Most philosophical discussion of knowledge is directed at knowledge-that — such as knowledge that kangaroos hop, knowledge that koalas sleep most of the time, knowledge that kookaburras cackle, and the like. This is generally called propositional knowledge (a proposition that such-and-such is so is the object of the knowledge), declarative knowledge (the knowledge’s object is represented by a declarative sentence: ‘Such-and-such is so’), or knowledge-that (the knowledge is represented in the form ‘that such-and-such is so’). Knowledge by description (mentioned in section 1.a) would be one form that could be taken by knowledge-that: some known propositions include descriptions; but not all do. In principle, knowledge-that is the kind of knowledge present whenever there is knowledge of a fact or truth — no matter what type of fact or truth is involved: knowledge that 2 + 2 = 4; knowledge that rape is cruel; knowledge that there is gravity; and so on. When philosophers use the term ‘know’ unqualifiedly, knowledge-that is standardly what they mean to be designating. (It will therefore be the intended sense throughout most of this article.)

c. Knowledge-Wh

But should knowledge-that receive such sustained and uninterrupted focus by philosophers? After all, there is a far wider range of ways in which we talk and think, using the term ‘know’. Here are some of them (collectively referred to as knowledge-wh):

knowing whether it is 2 p.m.; knowing who is due to visit; knowing why a visit is needed; knowing what the visit is meant to accomplish; knowing how that outcome is best accomplished; and so forth.

How should these be understood? The usual view among epistemologists is that these are specific sorts of knowledge-that. For example, knowing whether it is 2 p.m. is knowing that it is 2 p.m., if it is; and knowing that it is not 2 p.m., if it is not. Knowing who is due to visit is knowing, for some specified person, that it is he or she who is due to visit. Knowing what the visit is meant to accomplish is knowing, for some specified outcome, that it is what the visit is meant to accomplish. Knowing how that outcome is best accomplished is knowing, for some specified description of how that outcome could be accomplished, that this describes the best way of accomplishing that outcome. And so on.

Still, not everyone will assess these examples in quite that way. Note a variation on this theme that is currently being developed. Called contrastivism, its basic idea is that (perhaps always; at least sometimes) to know is to know this rather than that. (For different versions, see Schaffer 2005; 2007; Morton 2011.) One’s knowing, understood contrastively, is explicitly one’s knowing one from among some understood or presumed bunch of possible alternatives. The word ‘explicitly’ is used here because one would know while acknowledging those alternatives. Consider the example of knowing-who. On contrastivism, you could know that it is Fred rather than Arjuna and Diego who is due to visit; and this might be the only way in which you know that Fred is due. ‘Who is due?’ ‘Fred, as against Arjuna or Diego.’ Your knowing-who would not be simply your knowing, of Fred, that it is he who is due to visit. Your knowing-who would be your knowing that it is Fred as against Arjuna or Diego who is due to visit. This remains propositional knowledge, nonetheless.

d. Knowing-How

Gilbert Ryle (1971 [1946]; 1949) made apparent to other philosophers the potential importance of distinguishing knowledge-that from knowledge-how. The latter is not (thought Ryle) one’s knowing how it is that something is so; this, we noted in section 1.c, is quite likely a form of knowledge-that. What Ryle meant by ‘knowing how’ was one’s knowing how to do something: knowing how to read the time on a clock, knowing how to call a friend, knowing how to cook a particular meal, and so forth. These seem to be skills or at least abilities. Are they not simply another form of knowledge-that? Ryle argued for their distinctness from knowledge-that; and often knowledge-how is termed ‘practical knowledge’. Is one’s knowing how to cook a particular meal really only one’s knowing a lot of truths — having much knowledge-that — bearing upon ingredients, combinations, timing, and the like? If Ryle was right, knowing-how is somehow distinct: even if it involves having relevant knowledge-that, it is also something more — so that what makes it knowledge-how need not be knowledge-that. [For more on this issue, see, for example, Bengson and Moffett 2012). Might knowledge-that even be a kind of knowledge-how itself, so that all instances of knowledge-that themselves are skills or abilities (for example, Hetherington 2011a: ch. 2)?]

2. Knowledge as a Kind

Section 1 shows how there might be different kinds of knowledge. We will now focus on one of them — knowledge-that. What kind of thing is such knowledge? In particular, is it a natural kind — a naturally occurring element in the scientifically describable world? Alternatively, is knowledge at least partly a conventional or artifactual kind — a part of our practices of judging and evaluating, possessing a socially describable nature?

The former idea portrays knowledge as an identifiable and explanatory aspect of what it is for beings relevantly like us to function as a natural component of a natural world. We have beliefs, some of which help us to achieve our aims by telling us how not to ‘bump into’ the world around us. We can ‘fit into’ — by ‘finding our way within’ — the world by using beliefs. Is that because these beliefs are knowledge? Is that part of why humans as a natural kind (if this is what we are) have prospered so markedly? In introducing epistemologists to the idea of what he called a naturalized epistemology, W. V. Quine (1969) recommended that philosophy conceive of us in psychological terms, so that when it seeks to understand us as reasoning, as believing, and as rational, it does not do this in terms distinct from those scientific ways of describing our psychological and physical features. Hilary Kornblith (2002) continues that theme: in effect, we know as other animals do — limitedly but reliably, thanks to our roles as sensing and believing beings operating within the world’s natural order. There would be natural laws, say, or at least natural regularities — scientifically formulable ones, we may hope — about how we know.

In contrast, we may feel that knowing is a distinctively conventional accomplishment. It might consist of socially constituted and approved patterns — not thereby natural laws or regularities admitting of scientific description — in aspects of how we interact with other people. Perhaps we can collectively choose what to count as knowledge. Perhaps that is all there is to knowing. Such a view could even say that this is how knowledge differs from belief: beliefs happen to or within us; knowledge we shape from beliefs. And we might do this deliberatively, subjecting ourselves and others to social norms of inquiry, responding to other people and their concepts, aims, and values. As civilizations expand and mutate, could knowing change not only its content (that is, what is known), but its basic nature (for example, how the knowing occurs and even what in general is required for it to occur)? Different social arrangements would bring into being different ways of thinking and acting, new aims and values. In that sense, possibly knowledge is an artefact, created by us in social groupings, used by us in those same groupings — often wittingly and deliberately so. In short, maybe knowing is a matter of functioning in socially apt ways. Barry Allen (2004) is one who argues for an artifactual interpretation of knowing’s nature.

The rest of this article will remain neutral between these two broad ideas. Some of the suggestions to be considered will be more appropriate (and clearly so) for one than the other of the two. But in general the article’s aim will be to display, not to favour.

3. Ways of Knowing

To say the least, not everyone knows everything, not even everything that in principle is knowable. Individual instances of knowledge come to individual people at individual times, remaining in place for varying — individual — lengths of time. So it is right to ask how it is that individual cases of knowledge reach, or are acquired by, people; along with how it is that these cases of knowledge are then retained by people. In what broadly characterisable ways do people gain and maintain their knowledge? In practice, philosophers do not treat that as a question about the ineliminable specificities of each person, each moment, and each particular piece of knowledge. It is treated as a question about general ways and means of coming to know a specific fact or truth.

Over the centuries, these have been some of the more philosophically pondered forms of answer to that question:

  • Some or all knowledge is innate. (And then it is remembered later, during life.)
  • Some or all knowledge is observational.
  • Some or all knowledge is non-observational, attained by thought alone.
  • Some or all knowledge is partly observational and partly not — attained at once by observing and thinking.

The rest of this section will consider these in turn.

a. Innate Knowledge

If some instances of knowledge accompany a person into life, how will they reveal themselves within his or her life? How would the person, or indeed anyone else, know that he or she has this innate knowledge? It could depend on what is being known innately — the subject matter of this knowledge with which the person has been born.

For example, if people begin life already knowing some grammatical rules (an idea famously due to Noam Chomsky: see Stich 1975, ch. 4), this innate knowledge would be shown in subsequent speedy, widespread, and reliable language-learning by those involved. These instances of people learning so readily and predictably would be actions expressing some knowledge-how. But (as section 1.d acknowledged) such manifestations of knowledge-how might actually reflect the presence within of knowledge-that.

Or consider another possible example: knowledge of some mathematics and some logical principles. Seemingly, Plato (in the Meno, one of his dialogues) accorded people this sort of innate knowledge; as did Leibniz, in his New Essays. (For excerpts from Plato and from Leibniz, see Stich 1975, ch. 2.) Plato presented us with a story of a slaveboy, lacking education, whom Socrates brought, via minimal questioning, to a state of remembering some geometrical knowledge.

Naturally, it could be difficult to ascertain that any particular knowledge is genuinely innate. Knowledge which is not innate, but which is acquired especially easily, seemingly effortlessly, might nonetheless feel innate. And (as section 1.d also acknowledged) even when an action, such as of language-learning, is manifesting knowledge-how, there remains a philosophical question as to whether that action is reflecting knowledge-that already existing within, dormant until activated. The answer to that question might be that there is only knowledge-how present — without owing its existence to some related prior knowledge-that. (As ever throughout this article these possibilities are suggested for continued consideration, not as manifestly decisive refutations.)

b. Observational Knowledge

One of epistemology’s perennially central topics has been that of observational knowledge. Let us consider a few of the vast number of philosophical questions that have arisen about such knowledge.

Can there be purely or directly observational knowledge? When you observe a cat sleeping in front of you, do you know observationally — and only observationally — that the cat is sleeping there? Observation is occurring; and you do not consciously ‘construct’ the knowledge. Still, is there a perceptual experience present, along with some conceptual or even theoretical knowledge (for example, that cats are thus-and-so, that to sleep is to do this-and-not-that, and so forth)? Otherwise, how could your experience constitute your knowing this-content-rather-than-another? Is conceptual knowledge what gives knowledgeable content to your observational experience? Is this so, even for experiences that are as simple as you can imagine having?

Can there be foundational observational knowledge? Wilfrid Sellars (1963) engaged famously with this question, confronting what he called the myth of the given. Part of the traditional epistemological appeal of the idea of there being purely or directly observational knowledge was the idea that such knowledge could be foundational knowledge. It would be knowledge given to us in experiences which would be cases of knowledge, yet which would be conceptually simple. Sellars argued, however, that they would not be conceptually so simple.

For example, imagine knowing observationally that here is something white. This would possibly be as simple, in conceptual terms, as observational knowledge could be for you. Nevertheless, even here the question remains of whether you are applying concepts (such as of being here, of being something, and of being white); and if you are doing so, of whether you must be able to know that you are using them correctly. Would you need to find even simpler observational experiences, via which you could know what these concepts involve? If so, the other experience — knowing observationally that here is something white — would not have been foundational. That is, it would not have amounted to a basic piece of knowledge, upon which other pieces of knowledge can be based and which need not itself be based upon other pieces of knowledge.

How much observation is needed for observational knowledge? When you look at what appears to be a cat, for how long must you maintain your gaze if you are to know that you are seeing a cat? Do you need also to walk around it, still looking at it, scrutinising it from different angles, if you are to know that you are seeing a cat? And what of your other senses? Could the animal’s sounding or smelling like a cat, for example, be needed if the knowledge in question is to be yours? There is a more general question behind those ones: What standard must observational knowledge meet? You are using, it seems, observational evidence; what standard must it meet, if it is to be giving you observational knowledge? (And that sort of question will arise about all evidence and all knowledge. That will become apparent as this article proceeds.)

[For a range of readings on observational knowledge, see Dancy 1988.]

c. Knowing Purely by Thinking

When philosophers ask about the possibility of some knowledge’s being gained purely by thinking — by reflection rather than observation —  they are wondering whether a priori knowledge is possible. Historically, those who believe that some such knowledge is possible are called rationalists about knowledge. (Empiricists, in contrast, believe that all knowledge is observational in its underlying nature, even when it might not seem so. This is the belief that all knowledge is a posteriori — present only after some suitably supportive observations are made.) As was done for observational knowledge in section 3.b, this section mentions a few of the multitude of questions that have arisen about a priori knowledge — knowledge which would be present, if it ever is, purely by thinking, maybe through an accompanying rational insight.

How would there be a priori knowledge? It is difficult, to say the least, for us ever to know that a piece of putative knowledge would not be at all observational, so that it would be gained purely by thought or reflection. We talk of pure mathematics, for example, and our knowledge of it. Consider the content of the sentence, ‘2 + 2 = 4.’ It could be applied to physical objects; nonetheless, we might deny that it is at all about such objects. But then we must explain how we know that we are using thought alone in knowing that 2 + 2 = 4, rather than knowing this mathematical truth in a way which is simply much less directly observational. Would we know it, for instance, partly by knowing how to interpret various physical representations which we would observe — numerals (‘2’ and ‘4’) and function signs (‘+’ and ‘=’)? If this is even part of how we know that 2 + 2 = 4, is the knowledge at least not purely a result of thought rather than observation?

[On related issues, see Quine’s ‘Two Dogmas of Empiricism’, in Moser 1987, a collection with many readings relevant to this section.]

Could a priori knowledge be substantive? It might be thought that pure reflection — and hence a priori knowledge — is possible when the truths being known are especially simple, even trivial. ‘All bachelors are unmarried’ is true, yet trivial: it is uninformative for anyone who understands at all the concept of a bachelor. ‘There is more than one infinity’ is true yet not trivial: it is informative for some who understand at all the concept of an infinitude. If ‘There is more than one infinity’ is knowable by thought alone, that would be substantive a priori knowledge. But if only truths like ‘All bachelors are unmarried’ are knowable purely by thinking, maybe there cannot be substantive a priori knowledge. So, which is it to be? (If we reply that it depends upon what a particular a priori known truth is about, we return to the previous paragraph’s question about knowledge gained purely by thinking. Alternatively, if we reply that it depends upon which standard is being met — such as when understanding a specific concept like that of bachelorhood or of infinitude, so as to gain knowledge from it — this takes us to the next paragraph’s question.)

[Classically, the issue of whether there can be substantive a priori knowledge was posed by Immanuel Kant, in his eighteenth-century Critique of Pure Reason (2007 [1781/1787] — as the question of whether there can be synthetic a priori knowledge.]

What standard would a priori knowledge have to satisfy? If there could be a priori knowledge, is it clear what standard it would need to have satisfied? There have long been philosophers for whom part of the appeal in the idea of a priori knowledge is the presumption that it would be infallible. That is, it would satisfy a conclusive — in effect, a perfect — evidential standard. It would do this because a capacity for pure thought, undistracted by observed contingencies within this world, would be what has provided the a priori knowledge. However, some recent epistemologists (for example, BonJour 1998) regard that picture as overly optimistic. The one person is both observing and thinking; and if we expect fallibility to be part of how she observes, maybe we should expect fallibility likewise when she is thinking. Is it simply obvious that when we are not observing, only thinking, we are more — let alone perfectly — reliable or trustworthy in our views? Or do we also think only imperfectly? Perhaps we need observations as ‘checks’ on what could otherwise become thoughts ‘floating free’ in our minds. Yet maybe, even so, these ‘checks’ remain imperfect. To think without observing might not be to improve dramatically, if at all, the use of one’s mind.

d. Knowing by Thinking-Plus-Observing

And so again we meet the question of the extent to which, in one way or another, we are vulnerable when trying to gain whatever knowledge we can. Of course, we might claim that we are only vulnerable when focussing just on observation or on reflection — ignoring the other. Surely (it will be suggested), much or even all of our knowledge is a mixture — both observational and reasoned. Is that how we will stride forward as knowers?

Optimism replies, ‘Yes. Possibly there are philosophical limits upon the effectiveness of observation by itself and of reason by itself. Still, to combine them is to overcome those limits, or at least enough of them.’ In response to which, less-than-optimism counsels, ‘Maybe not. If each of observation and reflection has limitations of its own, a combination of them might compound those weaknesses. The result could be a blurring of the two, so that we would never know whether, on a particular occasion, weakness in one — in the observing or in the reflecting — is weakening the whole.’ Which of those alternatives is right? Optimism? Less-than-optimism?

That depends. We should now consider an epistemologically classic doubt about people’s abilities ever to gain knowledge.

4. Sceptical Doubts about Knowing

From the outset of philosophical thinking about knowledge, doubts have never been far away: do we really know what we think we know? And that question was not meant merely to ask whether sometimes we are mistaken in claiming a particular piece of knowledge. The philosophical concern was more pressing: do we ever know what we think we know? Even when lacking all views on whether we know, could we always fail to know? Is knowledge an attainment forever beyond us — all of us, everyone, all of the time?

That question confronts us with a radical sceptical possibility. Possibilities that are less radical but still possibly disturbing, and less widely sceptical but still sceptical, have also been discussed. Is there no knowledge of a physical world? Is there no scientific knowledge? Is there no knowledge of moral truths? Is there no knowledge of the future? And so it goes. Let us now examine one of these. It is one of philosophy’s most famous non-radical sceptical arguments — a scepticism about external world knowledge. (It is sceptical, partly because it denies something otherwise accepted by almost everyone: sceptical denials are surprising in that sense.) Here is how it unfolds.

If there is observational knowledge (section 3.b), it is knowledge of what philosophers generally call the external world. By this, they mean to designate the physical world, regarded as something with an existence and nature distinct from (and perhaps, or perhaps not, represented accurately in) any individual’s beliefs as to its existence and nature. Those beliefs could be true because there is a physical world with a nature matching what the beliefs attribute to it. Equally, however, the beliefs could be false because there is no physical world quite, or even at all, as the beliefs claim it to be. And if the beliefs are false, the usual philosophical moral to be drawn would be that they are not knowledge. (Knowledge is only of truths or facts: see section 6.f.)

Still, do we ever have reason to regard all of our beliefs about the physical world as actually false? Perhaps not consciously so, while ever in fact we have the beliefs; for part of having a belief is some sort of acceptance of its content as true, not false. Nevertheless, maybe one can have a belief while accepting that one cannot know quite how one has gained that belief. And this is significant because there are ways of having a belief which — even without guaranteeing the belief’s being false — would be incompatible with the belief’s being knowledge. For instance, even if one feels as though a particular belief has been formed via careful reasoning, perhaps ultimately that belief is present largely because one wants it to be. And one might concede this, even if reluctantly, as a possibility about oneself. More generally, therefore, maybe one could have a belief while also accepting one’s not quite being able to know that one has not gained it in a way which is wholly unsuitable for its being knowledge.

In theory, there are many possible knowledge-precluding ways of gaining a particular belief. Here are a few generically described ways:

  • Sometimes, your individual sensing or thinking might be only yours, in the worrying sense that it could be misleading on the particular topic of your belief, more so than other people’s sensing or thinking would be on that same topic.
  • Sometimes, anyone’s sensing is only human, in the sense that it could be misleading about aspects of the world which other animals sense more accurately.
  • Human reasoning is also only ever human in the sense that (as Christopher Cherniak has explained: 1986) even some seemingly simple assessments could be computationally beyond our capacities. There is only so much that any person’s brain can do with so much data. Even checking for something as familiar as consistency between many of one’s beliefs is an extremely complex task. This is not necessarily because consistency in itself is always complex. It is because there is too much checking to do, given the need to evaluate every possible combination from among one’s beliefs.

Sceptical arguments could be generated from those and from comparable possibilities.

One historically prominent suggestion — philosophers usually attribute its most influential form to Descartes (1911 [1641]), in his ‘Meditation I’ — directs us to the phenomenon of dreaming. Suppose that you feel as though you are sensing, in a normal way, a cat’s sitting in front of you. But suppose that this experience is actually present as part of your dreaming, not as part of using your senses in a normal way. There seems to you to be a cat; the circumstance feels normal to you; even so, in fact you are asleep, dreaming. Presumably, therefore, your feeling or experience at this time is not providing you with knowledge right now of the cat’s presence.

Now, could that be how it is on every occasion of your feeling there to be a cat in front of you? Indeed, we can generalise that question, to this philosophical challenge: Whenever you seem to be having a sensory experience about the world around you, can you know that you are not dreaming at that time? And this question is a challenge, not only a question, because it might not be clear how you could have that knowledge of not dreaming at that time. Any evidence you mention in support of the contention that you are not dreaming will be the same sort of evidence as that which has just been questioned. Imagine thinking to yourself, ‘I remember waking up this morning. I feel awake still. I feel so awake.’ You thereby feel as though you are mentioning some good evidence, reflecting decisive non-dreaming experiences. But your having that feeling could itself be present as part of your dreaming; and if it is, then it is not knowledge. So, any such experience on your part of reaching for apparently good evidence, of bringing to mind how awake you feel, will merely be more of the same. That is, it will be just another instance of the same sort of experience as was being questioned in the first place; and it will be no less vulnerable to the possibility of merely being part of a more or less extended moment of dreaming by you. Your citing these further experiences thus provides no new form of evidence which is somehow above suspicion in this context of questioning the apparently observational evidence (the suspicion, remember, of possibly being an experience produced as part of a dreaming experience).

Then the sceptical conclusion follows swiftly. If you never know that your apparent experiences of the physical world around you are not present as part of your dreaming while asleep, you never know that what feels to you like a normally produced belief about the world is not present as part of an experience which precludes that you are thereby having a belief at this time which is knowledge. Accordingly, for all that you do know about yourself at that time, you fail to have knowledge of your surroundings. In that sense, you might not have knowledge of the physical world around you. Do your apparent beliefs about the world fail in that way to be knowledge? Indeed so, concludes the sceptical reasoning: if (for all that you do otherwise know about them) they might not be knowledge, then they are not sufficiently well supported by you to actually be knowledge.

[On external world scepticism in particular, see Stroud (1984: ch. 1). On scepticism and dreaming, see Sosa (2007: ch. 1). On sceptical reasoning in general, see DeRose and Warfield 1999.]

5. Understanding Knowledge?

There are various possible ways of seeking philosophical understanding of a phenomenon. One such approach involves attempting to understand the phenomenon in terms of other phenomena. If one can do this exhaustively and with full precision, one might even attain a definition of the phenomenon. Sometimes that method is called the search for an analytic reduction of the phenomenon in question. (It is also often described as analysing the concept of that phenomenon. But the associated aim should thereby be to understand the phenomenon itself: hopefully, we would understand X by having a full and precise understanding of what it takes for something to satisfy the concept of X.) That approach has dominated epistemology’s efforts over the past fifty or so years to understand knowledge’s nature.

a. The Justified-True-Belief Conception of Knowledge

In 1963, a short paper was published which highlighted — while questioning strikingly — a way of trying to define knowledge. Section 5.b will present the question raised by that paper. Right now, we should have before us a sense of what it questioned — which was a kind of view that has generally been called the justified-true-belief conception of knowledge.

That conception was usually presented as a definition. The thinking behind it took this form:

Consider someone’s knowing that such-and-such is the case. This instance of knowing amounts, by definition, to the person’s having a true and well justified belief that such-and-such is the case.

So, three distinct phenomena are identified (even if only in a generic way), before being combined. And that combination is being said to be what any — and only any — case of knowledge exemplifies. Knowledge is a belief; but not just any belief. Knowledge is always a true belief; but not just any true belief. (A confident although hopelessly uninformed belief as to which horse will win — or even has won — a particular race is not knowledge, even if the belief is true.) Knowledge is always a well justified true belief — any well justified true belief. (And thus we have the justified-true-belief conception of knowledge.)

What does ‘justified’ mean? That is a substantial topic in its own right, but it is not the topic of this article. Still (for illustration only), here are two possible forms that justification can take within knowledge:

Evidence. Often, you have evidence — supportive experiences and views, consciously held — which, overall, favours your belief that such-and-such is the case. This evidence is thereby justification for or towards your belief’s being true. (On justification as evidence, see Conee and Feldman 2004.)

Reliability. Often, you have formed your belief that such-and-such is the case in a way which was likely to have led you to form a true belief. This reliability is thereby justification for or towards your belief’s being true. (On reliability as justification, see Goldman 1979.)

Must such justification — be it favourable evidence or be it reliability in belief-formation — be perfect support for or towards the belief’s being true? Section 6.a will discuss that idea; the usual answer is ‘No, perfection is not needed.’ At the very least, that answer was part of the underpinning to the famous 1963 questioning of the justified-true-belief conception of knowledge.

[Epistemology textbooks standardly present some version of a justified-true-belief conception of knowledge: for example, Chisholm 1989; Hetherington 1996; Feldman 2003; Morton 2003; Zagzebski 2009.]

b. Not the Justified-True-Belief Conception of Knowledge?

Edmund Gettier’s 1963 article had a dramatic epistemological impact — as immediately so as is possible within philosophy. Almost all epistemologists, at the time and since, have agreed that Gettier disproved the justified-true-belief conception of knowledge. How so?

He proposed two supposed counterexamples to the claim that a belief’s being true and well justified is sufficient for its being knowledge. In each of his imagined cases, a person forms a belief which is true and well justified, yet which — this is the usual view, at any rate — is not knowledge. (These situations came to be known as Gettier cases, as did the many subsequent kindred cases.) For instance, in Gettier’s first case a person Smith forms a belief that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket. Smith’s evidence is that the company president told him that Jones would get the job, and that Smith has counted the coins in Jones’s pocket. Is Smith’s belief true? Yes, it is; but only because he himself will get the job and because he himself has ten coins in his pocket — two facts of which he is actually unaware.

Why is a belief like Smith’s not knowledge? Many theories have been proposed, as to why such beliefs (Gettiered beliefs, as they have come to be called) are not knowledge. Collectively, this post-Gettier theorising has generated another independently large epistemological topic — the Gettier problem. But none of those theories are favored here because epistemology as a whole has not favored one. There has been widespread agreement only on Gettier cases being situations from which knowledge is absent — not on why or how the knowledge is absent.

[For an extensive exposition of the first twenty years of epistemology’s engagement with the Gettier problem, including a range of theories that were proposed as to why Gettiered beliefs are not knowledge, see Shope 1983. For recent accounts, see Lycan 2006 and Hetherington 2011b.]

c. Questioning the Gettier Problem

A few forms of doubt have been advanced about the potency of Gettier’s challenge. Such doubts, if correct, could allow philosophers to return to a view — a pre-Gettier view — of knowledge as being some sort of justified true belief. Let’s consider two of those forms of doubt.

A more varied range of intuitions is needed. In reacting to Gettier’s own two cases and to the many similar ones that have since appeared, epistemologists have continually relied on its being intuitively clear that the cases’ featured beliefs are not instances of knowledge. In response to case after case, epistemologists say that ‘intuitively’ the belief in question — the Gettiered belief — is not knowledge.

Yet that sort of reaction has begun to be questioned by some work that initiated what has since become known as experimental philosophy. Rather than continuing to rely only on what epistemologists and their students would say about such thought-experiments, Jonathan Weinberg, Shaun Nichols, and Stephen Stich (2001) asked a wider range of people for their intuitive reactions, including to some Gettier cases. This wider range included people not affiliated with universities or colleges, along with more people of a non-European ancestry. And the results were at odds with what epistemological orthodoxy would have expected. For example, interestingly more respondents of a Subcontinental ancestry (Indian, Pakistani, Bangladeshi) than ones of a Western European ancestry replied that the Gettiered beliefs about which they were being asked are instances of knowledge.

This does not prove that Gettiered beliefs are knowledge, of course. But it complicates the epistemological story: to whom — to whose intuitions, if to any — should we be listening here? Some philosophers are beginning to wonder whether such a result should even undermine their confidence in knowledge’s being something more than a justified true belief — in particular, its being a non-Gettiered justified true belief.

[For discussions of the nature and role of intuitions within philosophy, see DePaul and Ramsey 1998. On intuitions and epistemology, see Weinberg 2006.]

The need to be fallibilist in assessing the knowledge’s absence. Gettier introduced his challenge (section 5.b) as concerning precisely what knowledge is if its justification component is not required to be producing infallibly good support for or towards the belief’s being true. Section 6 will focus upon a range of possible standards that knowledge could be thought to need to meet. Fallibilism is one of them; for now, we need note only that it functions explicitly within Gettier’s challenge as a constraint upon knowledge.

For example, in Gettier’s first case Smith’s evidence (the company president’s testimony, and Smith’s counting the coins in Jones’s pocket) justifies only fallibly his final belief (that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket). By this, Gettier meant that the evidence does not logically mandate or entail the belief’s being true: the belief could have been false, even given that evidence’s being true. In fact, the belief is true. But how is it made true? It is made true, we saw, not by aspects of Jones, but by aspects of Smith himself — none of which are noticed by his evidence. Accordingly, the fallibility within the case amounts to a ‘gap’ of logic or information between the evidence-content’s being true and the final belief’s truth. This gap allows the case’s final belief to be true because of something other than what is reported in the evidence. And so that final belief is not knowledge.

Yet here is a counter-challenge (described more fully in Hetherington 2011c). When thinking that the case’s final belief is not knowledge, could epistemologists unwittingly have been applying a higher standard to the case than a fallibilist one? Is it possible that to deny Smith this knowledge is to assume, even if not deliberately, an infallibilist standard instead? It will not feel to an epistemologist as if this is happening. Yet could it be, even so? How would an epistemologist know that an infallibilist standard is not what is being applied, even if only implicitly and even if she is claiming explicitly to be applying a fallibilist standard? Ultimately, epistemologists have relied on appeals to intuition as a way of monitoring their more theoretical interpretations of Gettier cases. And (as we found a moment ago) there is a question about how decisive that is as a way of knowing exactly what epistemological moral to take from the cases.

Here is an alternative possible fallibilist interpretation of Gettier’s case about the job and the coins. Although there is a ‘gap’ of logic or information between what Smith’s evidence and reasoning claims to tell him about directly (that is, aspects of Jones) and how his final belief is made true (that is, by aspects of Smith himself), some such ‘gap’ is sometimes to be expected whenever a merely fallibilist standard for knowing is at stake. So (continues this interpretation), if the presence of a fallibilist standard was the only shortcoming in the case, we should not dismiss the belief as failing to be knowledge; for that would be simply an infallibilist dismissal of the belief.

We must acknowledge, however, that something more than mere fallibility is present within the case: only through some actual oddity does Smith’s true belief (the final belief) eventuate within the case. Hence, the question is one of whether that combination — the fallibility and the oddity — should be allowed by fallibilism as being knowledge nonetheless. Of course knowledge would rarely, even at most, be fallibly present in such an odd way; could it ever be, though? Normally it would not be; abnormally, however, could it be? So, could there be knowledge like this? Might a Gettiered belief be knowledge? Even if it is rare, is it possible?

Some epistemologists have argued that what such cases show is the need for the justification within a belief’s being knowledge somehow to guarantee the truth of the belief (for example, Zagzebski 1994). But we should ask whether this is evading rather than solving Gettier’s challenge. (Howard-Snyder, Howard-Snyder, and Feit argue that it is also not needed for solving Gettier’s challenge: 2003.) That question arises because Gettier is challenging only justified-true-belief conceptions of knowledge which include a fallibilist form of justification. Our correlative aim, if we accept the usual reading of Gettier cases, should be to formulate a satisfactory conception of that form of knowledge.

[On the nature of fallibilism, see Hetherington (2005) and Dougherty (2011).]

6. Standards for Knowing

Many philosophical questions about knowledge (its nature and availability) may be treated as questions about standards. We expect knowledge to amount to something, to be an improvement in some respect upon various forms of non-knowledge. (Why is that so? Section 7 will discuss what knowledge is for, hence why it should meet any particular standard.) Section 5 ended by asking about knowledge and infallibilism; we may now consider a wider range of possible standards, beginning with infallibility, which have at times been placed by epistemologists and others upon knowing.

a. Certainty or Infallibility

There is a recurring temptation, often felt by philosophers and non-philosophers alike, to impose some kind of infallibilist standard upon knowing. This can even feel intuitive to the person applying the standard. One version of that temptation talks of certainty — not necessarily a subjectively experienced sense of certainty, but what is usually termed an epistemic kind of certainty. The latter amounts to the certainty’s being a rationally inviolable and unimprovable form of justificatory support, regardless of whether it feels so perfect. (It could also be experienced as certainty. That would not be the important aspect of its being part of the knowing, though.)

Why would one adopt such a demanding view of knowledge? Perhaps because the alternative could feel too undemanding. Consider the apparent oddity of claims like this:

I do know that I’m looking at a dingo, even though I could be mistaken.

(One could talk in that way because one might implicitly be thinking, ‘My evidence isn’t perfect.’) Is that concessive knowledge-attribution, as it is often called, a contradiction? If it is, perhaps knowing is incompatible with possibly being mistaken; in which case, knowledge does have to involve an epistemic certainty. What epistemologists in general regard as the most famous advocacy of knowing’s including such certainty was by Descartes, again in his ‘Meditation I’ (1911 [1641]).

Of course, there remains the possibility that knowing is merely incompatible with saying or thinking that one is possibly mistaken — not with the fact of one’s possibly being mistaken. This is why the oddity of concessive knowledge-attributions might not entail knowledge’s including certainty or infallibility. The matter is currently being debated (for example, Dougherty and Rysiew 2009).

b. Fallibility

The spectre of a sceptical conclusion is the most obvious philosophical concern about requiring knowledge to satisfy an infallibilist standard. If knowledge is like that, then how often will anyone succeed in actually having some knowledge? Rarely, if ever (is the usual reply). For people’s imperfections in their attempts to know (see the examples highlighted early in section 4) will be incompatible with the success of those attempts — if perfection is required for such success. Anyone who accepts infallibilism about some or all knowledge must confront the question of whether he or she wants thereby to deny that any such knowledge is ever actually attained. (Descartes wished not to be a sceptic, for example, even as he allowed that some knowledge, if it was to be present, would have to be certain.)

So there is a key choice, between infallibility and fallibility, in what standard we are to require of knowing. To demand infallibility is to court the danger of scepticism. Again, though (as section 6.a acknowledged), settling for fallibility may seem overly accommodating of the possibility of mistake. This is a substantial choice to make in thinking philosophically about knowledge. Most epistemologists profess not to be infallibilists. They aim to understand knowing as needing only to satisfy a fallibilist standard. Think of everyday situations in which people attribute knowledge: ‘I know that you are a good person. And I know that you are sitting down.’ The knowledge being attributed is not being thought to involve infallibility. Nonetheless, we do claim or attribute knowledge casually yet literally, all day, every day. In practice, we are fallibilists in that respect. (Still, in practice we also often could have infallibilist moments: ‘You’re not sure? Then you don’t know.’ The situation is complex. Maybe we are not always consistent about this.)

c. Grades of Fallibility

What any fallibilist could helpfully do, therefore, is to ascertain which standard of fallibility is the minimum one that must be met by any instance of knowing. So far, the discussion has been about fallibility, not different standards of fallibility. But in theory the latter way of talking is available. After all, fallibility is merely an absence of infallibility; and there might be many possible standards available to be met, each of which would fall short to some or another extent of the absolute achievement constituted by infallibility. Consider three ideas that have been proposed.

Animal knowledge; reflective knowledge. Maybe we can distinguish between a kind of knowledge which involves some sort of reliability (see section 5.a above), and one which adds to that reliability an appropriately aware reflectiveness about that reliability. Sosa (2009) describes this as a distinction between animal knowledge and reflective knowledge; and he regards the latter as a better way of knowing a truth. In principle, each kind of knowledge can be fallible (although an infallibilist, such as Sosa himself, can also accept the distinction). What matters for the present discussion is that you could know a particular truth, such as that you are tired, in either an animal way or a reflective way. But your reflective knowledge of being tired will be a better grade than your animal knowledge of being tired. The reflectiveness would improve your epistemic relationship to the fact of your being tired. Nevertheless, that relationship would remain one of knowing. So the knowing would improve as knowledge of the particular fact of your being tired. You would know that fact less fallibly, by knowing it more reflectively.

Knowledge-gradualism. That talk of improving the knowing should be suggestive for a fallibilist. Maybe we can allow there to be many grades or degrees of fallibility — reflecting, for instance, the multiply varied extents to which evidence can support a belief well. Think of a body of observational data: your belief could receive improved support if the data proceeded to be supplemented by further corroborative observations. Similarly, think of hearing expert testimony — and then more of it, by even better experts — in support of a thesis. The idea of improving one’s evidence, or one’s reliability in attaining true beliefs, is perfectly compatible with already having good support for a particular belief. A belief could be more, or it could be less, fallibly supported — yet well supported all the while.

Then we might also say that the knowledge itself is improved. The belief would already be knowledge, with there being good enough justificatory support for it. But its quality as knowledge of the particular truth in question would correspond to the degree or grade of its fallibility, such as of the fallibility in its justification component. And this degree or grade could improve, as the fallibility is lessened by the improvement in the justificatory support. For example, you know better that it is raining, if you see that it is and you feel its doing so. You still know — but less well — that it is raining, if you only see that it is. In each case, your knowledge is fallible; it remains knowledge, though. [For more on this idea, see Hetherington (2001; 2011a). See Hetherington (2011a: sec. 2.7) on others who have accepted it.

Contextualism. In recent years, contextualism has attracted much philosophical attention, especially within epistemology (for example, Cohen 1986; 1991; DeRose 1999; 2009; Lewis 1996). It is a way of claiming to understand the truth-conditions of utterances or thoughts, particularly of knowledge-attributions or knowledge-denials. And it is often thought to accommodate the existence of different standards for knowledge-attributions. It has mainly focussed on this sort of comparison:

  • In an ‘everyday’ conversational context, when she is asked whether you know that dingoes exist, your friend may well say of you that you do.
  • In a conversational context where sceptical possibilities are being taken seriously, when she is asked that same question, your friend may well deny that you know that dingoes exist.

This disparity, according to contextualism, reflects different standards (or something similar) being applied within the respective contexts. A lower and more accommodating standard for applying the term ‘knows’ to you is presumed within the everyday context; not so in the sceptically-aware context.

Note that contextualism, as a kind of theory of knowledge-attributions or knowledge-denials, is not directly a kind of theory of knowing. It is a theory directly about language use and meaning (specifically, occasions of talking or thinking while using the word ‘knows’ and its cognates); in that sense, it is not directly about knowing as such. Contextualism is mentioned here because some epistemologists (for example, Stanley 2005) have thought that if we were to countenance there being different grades of (fallible) knowing, this is how we would have to do so. Such a thought is mistaken, though, even if we regard contextualism as indirectly a theory of knowing. For we have already met two approaches that are directly about knowing (animal/reflective knowledge, and knowledge-gradualism) while also accepting the possibility of there being different grades of fallible knowing.

d. Safety and Lucky Knowing

Even if we accept that knowledge can be fallible (section 6.b) and even if we accept that there can be different grades of (fallible) knowledge (section 6.c), we might still be concerned about the possibility of being too generous in according people knowledge. (The concern would be about the possibility of generosity’s triumphing over accuracy.) In particular, some epistemologists (for example, Prichard 2005) will insist that a moral to be learnt from the Gettier problem (section 5.b above) is that (fallible) knowledge is never present when some kinds of luck are involved in the presence of that true belief, given that justification. In this respect, can there be lucky knowledge — accurate and justified, but only luckily accurate (even given that justification)? Epistemologists usually deny that knowledge could be like that. Recently, their denial has tended to take the form of specifying that knowledge has to be safe — a condition failed, we are then told, by those beliefs found within Gettier cases:

Safety. A true belief is safely formed just in case, given how it has been formed, it would have been formed only if true.

But is that sort of condition really failed in Gettier cases? This depends on how we describe the way, within a given Gettier case, in which the final true belief has been formed. For example, it would be natural to say that in Gettier’s own first case (section 5.b above), Smith forms his belief — that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket — by listening to the company president and by counting coins in Jones’s pocket. Yet to form that belief on that basis is to proceed in a way that was likely to yield not only Smith’s same belief, but its being true. Hence, Safety does not obviously tell us why Smith’s belief — by being unsafely formed — is not knowledge.

Instead of Safety, therefore, what the epistemologically usual interpretation needs to require is something a little more complicated, along these lines:

Safety+. A true belief is safely formed just in case, given how it has been formed and given the surrounding circumstances in which it has been formed, it would have been formed only if true.

Does that show us why the usual interpretation of Gettier cases is correct? We should consider two possible answers to this question.

Yes, it does.’ The usual interpretation might say that Smith’s surrounding circumstances include the facts that he himself will get the job and that he himself has ten coins in his pocket — facts of which Smith is ignorant. He has formed his belief (that the person who will get the job has ten coins in his pocket) on the basis only of evidence about Jones — none of which describes how Smith’s belief is in fact made true (by facts about Smith). And in general a belief is formed unsafely if it is formed by overlooking facts that make the belief true. Thus, given how Smith’s belief is formed, it was likely not to be formed as true. This explains why the belief is not knowledge.

No, it does not.’ We might say instead that, although Smith’s circumstances (which include the facts, overlooked by him, that he himself will get the job and that he himself has ten coins in his pocket) are odd, in fact they render even more likely his forming the same final belief along with the belief’s being true. After all, those circumstances now include the details constituting that final belief’s being true — the details of how it is true, details about Smith himself. So (on this alternative interpretation), Smith’s final belief is not formed unsafely. The belief’s failing to be knowledge (if it does fail to be) is therefore not explained by its being formed unsafely.

As the preceding two paragraphs show, competing interpretive possibilities exist here. It might be advisable, then, for us to be cautious about embracing the idea that an anti-luck condition like Safety or even Safety+ impels us towards the usual interpretation of Gettier cases. Those conditions might not reveal the impossibility of lucky knowledge, at least not on the basis of Gettier cases. [For debate on this, see Pritchard 2012 and Hetherington 2012.]

e. Mere True Belief

Section 5.a assumed that knowledge is at least a justified true belief. Gettier’s challenge, in section 5.b, was to knowledge’s never needing to be anything more than a justified true belief. But must knowledge be even as much as a justified true belief? In this section and the next, we will encounter a few epistemologically heterodox ways in which people have sometimes regarded knowledge, in principle at any rate, as able to be less than a justified true belief.

Here is one of those ways of drastically lowering the standard required for knowing:

Knowledge need not be anything beyond a true belief.

On that suggestion (for example, Sartwell 1991; 1992), justification — be it good evidence; be it good reliability; be it both or neither — is not needed as part of knowing. Accordingly, even when justification is in fact present and supporting a particular true belief, it was never needed for the mere presence of knowledge. This is because the belief, by being true, would be knowledge anyway, irrespectively of whether there was also justification supporting the truth of the belief. (What does the justification do in such a case? Even if it was not needed for the knowledge’s mere presence, could its presence improve the knowing? That is, could it strengthen the knowing’s grade? This would exemplify section 6.c’s idea of knowledge-gradualism.)

Might that be how knowledge is? Few epistemologists will accept so, although developed arguments against that picture are also few. The standard form of argument is an appeal to normality of linguistic usage, even intuitions: ‘Intuitively, knowledge is something more than only a true belief. Otherwise, every confident and lucky guess is knowledge!’ Is that sort of point decisive? Section 5.c raised the question of how much we should credit ourselves with having a faculty of intuitive insight into knowledge’s nature. Moreover, Alvin Goldman (1999) shows how, if we allow a weak sense of knowledge (whereby such knowledge is required only to be at least a true belief), we can still accommodate how people in many fields of inquiry and policy beyond philosophy purport to talk — apparently constructively, within those fields — of knowledge.

f. Non-Factive Conceptions

When people talk casually of knowledge, sometimes they reflect a non-factive conception of it. (Philosophers almost never talk in this way of knowledge, but at times others do.) Any non-factive conception of knowledge allows this idea:

Knowledge need not be even a true belief. (Even if it is always a belief or something related, truth is not essential for knowing.)

Here are two ways of expanding upon that idea.

Mere socially justified belief. Maybe being socially justified is enough to make a belief knowledge. That is, what most people within a particular social grouping would accept is thereby knowledge for that grouping; and knowledge would only ever be knowledge for some or another grouping, and in such a way.

Mere professionally justified belief. Some such social groupings are also professional groupings (for example, of physicists, of physicians, of high school teachers, of carpenters, and so forth). Within that kind of social grouping, being widely accepted is enough to make a belief knowledge.

Those proposals share the idea that nothing beyond acceptance within a designated group need be expected of a view if it is to be knowledge. Insisting on truth as an additional condition of the view’s being knowledge would be needless (according to these non-factive conceptions of knowledge), perhaps because any attempt within a group to ascertain whether the accepted view is true would itself need to be accepted within the group. Such acceptance would remain paramount in practice. (We might even want to say that truth is thereby being ascertained, precisely because truth is whatever is accepted widely by one’s fellow speakers and peers. For an influential instance of that pragmatist approach to conceiving of knowledge and truth, see Rorty 1979. But it is far from clear that many classical pragmatists would share that approach: see Bernstein 2010.)

Of course, we may also wonder whether those ways of talking of justification are too lenient in what they allow to be knowledge. The key question is that of whether a group could be not only mistaken in a shared belief, but even unreliable in how they form and try to support it. If so, could that belief actually be unjustified, no matter that the group’s members take it to be justified? This would be so, if justification is a kind of actual reliability (section 5.a) in being correct — reliability which even an entire group might therefore lack when sharing a particular belief.

Yet some people (even if probably no epistemologists) might wish to understand knowledge in an even more deflationary way. Here are two such approaches:

Mere sincere belief. Is it enough — for knowledge — that a person sincerely believes something to be so? Yes.

Mere sincere feeling. Is it enough — for knowledge — for a person to feel something to be so? Yes.

Suppose someone claims to have a specific piece of knowledge. Yet when asked for supporting evidence, she provides none. No matter; she claims anyway to have the knowledge: ‘I really do believe it. I sincerely feel it to be so. That’s enough for knowledge, isn’t it?’

Well, is it? Often the dictates merely of manners or friendliness dictate our not engaging critically with such claims of knowledge. So as to be polite, for example, you refrain from telling someone that his or her claim, made carefully to you, is insufficiently justified and hence is not knowledge. But epistemology professes to focus more upon accuracy and knowledge than cheeriness and decorum. Could you unwittingly be condescending or patronising, indeed, when forbearing to assess critically whether the other person really knows? To allow his or her mere claim or belief — simply because he or she feels it sincerely — to be knowledge is possibly to trivialise the notion of knowledge. Even if this is done with the intention of respecting the person (by not questioning him or her critically), the result could be to trivialise or somehow to lessen the status of the person in that setting. This is because the person would not be being treated as someone whom there is even a point in subjecting to a higher standard (such as of being genuinely justified or definitely correct). Think of how proper it could be to adopt this undemanding approach if the person was a child, or was otherwise mentally incapable of appreciating and striving to meet the higher standard. Equally, therefore, think of how improper it would be to do this if the person is not incapable of such an aim and effort — such as if he or she is a cognitively capable adult.

7. Knowing’s Point

With those reflections, we reach the question of what knowing is for. If we are to understand what knowledge is (what kind of thing it is; what its components or features are), along with whether and how it is available to us, we should reflect upon what role knowing would play within the lives of knowers. One way of doing so is to confront the question of what value there is in knowing — its inherent value, if there is any. Jonathan Kvanvig (2003) calls this the value problem within epistemology.

That issue first appeared in Plato’s Meno, as the question of how knowledge is more valuable than merely true belief. How is it more valuable, if it is, for you to know that you are hungry than merely to believe accurately that you are hungry? That question is not intended to be only or even about subjective value, such as about how grateful or pleased you may be, in a given case, to have knowledge rather than something lesser. The question concerns whatever value knowing has for a person, even if he or she does not realise that the value is present. Briefly consider a few possible ways of trying to answer that question.

Virtue epistemology. We might regard knowing as a person’s having manifested various virtues of an intellectual nature. These could be more, or they could be less, narrowly characterised. For example, an intellectual virtue may involve a cognitive faculty that is intellectually reliable (this phenomenon was mentioned in section 5.a); or, less narrowly, an intellectual virtue can reflect more of one’s being generally solicitous and respectful towards truth. And one’s manifesting such virtues would be a personal achievement. It would reflect well in general, to some non-trivial extent, upon one as an inquirer. In this sense, knowing could be an inherent part of personal development. In knowing, is one better as a person (all else being equal)? [For instances of this way of thinking, see Zagzebski 1996; Sosa 2007; Greco 2010.]

Reliable informants. Anyone with knowledge is potentially helpful to others, by being — inherently so — a reliable source of information. In a similar but restricted way, so too is a thermometer (Armstrong 1973: ch. 12); and, realising this, we create thermometers expressly for that purpose. Do we regard knowers analogously, primarily as reliable repositories of information for others? And do we create knowers likewise, when interpreting people as knowers? See section 2 above for the idea of knowledge as an artefact, created socially to serve conventionally significant purposes. In this sense, is knowing an inherent part of how people function socially? And is that valuable in itself? [On the idea of knowers as reliable informants, see Craig 1990. On knowing via testimony, see Coady 1992 and Lackey 2008.]

Usefulness. Knowledge can be used in various ways, some of which could well contribute significantly to the functioning of our lives. And this might be an intrinsic feature of knowing. That is, part — not just a consequence, but a part — of your knowing a specific truth could be that truth’s mattering to your life. You would not know it to be true simply by caring about its being true, for instance: wishful thinking is not knowing. But the importance to your life of that truth might affect what justificatory standard would need to be met, if you are to know it to be true. In this sense, perhaps satisfying some of one’s practical aims or needs is an inherent part of each case of one’s knowing. Equally, perhaps part of any knowing’s value is thereby its inherently satisfying some personal aims or needs. [For a later version of this idea, sometimes called pragmatic encroachment within knowing, see Fantl and McGrath 2009.]

A normative standard for assertions and other actions. Might knowledge (irrespective of whatever else exactly it is or does) function as a normative standard for much that we do? For example, maybe assertion is apt only when expressing or reflecting knowledge. Perhaps even a much wider range of actions is apt only when they are expressing or reflecting knowledge. In this sense, possibly knowing is an inherent contributor to our living as we should — so that we are performing various actions, such as assertion, only when our doing so is apt. [For these ideas about knowledge’s functioning as a normative standard, see Williamson 2000. On Williamson’s epistemology, see Greenough and Pritchard 2009.]

And thus we have a few possible proposals as to knowing’s possible point, bearing upon what knowledge’s inherent value could be. We might blend some or all of them with ideas from earlier in the article, ideas bearing upon knowing’s nature. Some of those combinations will be more natural than others; unless, of course, none of them will be even a little natural. We should not forget the possibility of knowing’s failing to have a point or value in itself. Maybe it will lack, at any rate, all value beyond whatever value is inherent in the presence of a true belief — in one’s being correct at all in a belief about something at all.

Let’s close with another idea, touching upon those others:

Existing with value. Perhaps there are few, if any, particular facts which one needs to know in order to exist. But imagine existing while knowing nothing. (Maybe this would reflect a combination of circumstances. First, possibly some of your beliefs would be false. Second, if knowledge is more than true belief — something questioned in section 6.e — then perhaps you would have true beliefs which fail in a further way to be knowledge. Third, presumably some truths escape your attention altogether.) Quite possibly, we would regard such an existence — wholly empty of knowing — as somehow devalued, somehow failing. Bear in mind that there could still be actions and opinions aplenty within your life; but (given the imagined scenario) never would there be knowledge either in them or guiding them. And if such an existence would be a failure to that extent, then perhaps the inherent point or value in knowing a particular truth is the point or value in knowing at all — with this being, in turn, some more or less substantial part of the point or value in living at all.

That proposal is highly programmatic. It would make knowing’s value personal, in an existential way. It would be one’s existing’s having a value which it would otherwise lack (if it was not to include knowing). Hopefully, there are other potential sources of value within a life. But maybe knowing is one aspect of living with value. Without knowing, possibly one’s living lacks part of its possible point — regardless of how, more specifically and fully, we describe that point.

This suggestion, although vague, is substantive enough to imply that if one was to know nothing then to a correlative extent (however far that extent reaches) one would not be alive in a valuable way. To that same extent, one’s living at all would be devalued inherently. (One might not feel or notice its being so. But it would in fact be so.) Hence, the suggestion has the following explanatory implication, for a start. It could help to illuminate why sceptical doubts (such as in section 4) have been a part of philosophy for so long. That could also be why such doubts should remain present within philosophy, at least as hovering dangers to be defused if possible — and also, if ever defused, to remind us of dangers thereby past. In effect, sceptical doubts question whether our lives, no matter what else we do or accomplish within these, are imbued with as much value as we would otherwise assume to be ours. This threat does not make the sceptical doubts correct, but it might cloak them with a living potency, an existential urgency. It does remind us of why the alternative should be sought: Knowing would be our protection against that potential emptiness within our lives.

8. References and Further Reading

  • Allen, Barry. 2004. Knowledge and Civilization. Boulder: Westview Press.
  • Armstrong, D. M. 1973. Belief, Truth and Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Bengson, John and Moffett, Marc A. (Eds.). 2012. Knowing How: Essays on Knowledge, Mind, and Action. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Bernstein, Richard B. 2010. The Pragmatic Turn. Cambridge: Polity.
  • BonJour, Laurence. 1998. In Defense of Pure Reason: A Rationalist Account of A Priori Justification. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Cherniak, Christopher. 1986. Minimal Rationality. Cambridge: The MIT Press.
  • Chisholm, Roderick M. 1989. Theory of Knowledge. 3rd ed. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall.
  • Coady, C. A. J. 1992. Testimony: A Philosophical Study. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Cohen, Stewart. 1986. “Knowledge and Context.” The Journal of Philosophy 83, 574-585.
  • Cohen, Stewart. 1991. “Skepticism, Relevance, and Relativity.” In B. P. McLaughlin, ed., Dretske and His Critics. Cambridge: Blackwell, 17-37.
  • Conee, Earl and Feldman, Richard. 2004. Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Craig, Edward. 1990. Knowledge and the State of Nature: An Essay in Conceptual Synthesis. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Dancy, Jonathan. (Ed.). 1988. Perceptual Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • DePaul, Michael R. and Ramsey, William. (Eds.). 1998. Rethinking Intuition: The Psychology of Intuition and its Role in Philosophical Inquiry. Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield.
  • DeRose, Keith. 1999. “Contextualism: An Explanation and Defense.” In J. Greco and E. Sosa, eds., The Blackwell Guide to Epistemology. Malden, Massachusetts: Blackwell, 187-205.
  • DeRose, Keith. 2009. The Case for Contextualism: Knowledge, Skepticism, and Context, Volume 1. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • DeRose, Keith and Warfield, Ted A. (Eds.). 1999. Skepticism: A Contemporary Reader. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Descartes, René. 1911 [1641]. “Meditation I.” In E. S. Haldane and G. R. T. Ross, eds. and trans., The Philosophical Works of Descartes, Volume I. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Dougherty, Trent. 2011. “Fallibilism.” In S. Bernecker and D. Pritchard, eds., The Routledge Companion to Epistemology. New York: Routledge, 131-143.
  • Dougherty, Trent and Rysiew, Patrick. 2009. “Fallibilism, Epistemic Possibility, and Concessive Knowledge Attributions.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 78, 123-132.
  • Fantl, Jeremy and McGrath, Matthew. 2009. Knowledge in an Uncertain World. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Feldman, Richard. 2003. Epistemology. Upper Saddle River, New Jersey: Prentice Hall.
  • Gettier, Edmund L. 1963. “Is Justified True Belief Knowledge?” Analysis 23, 121-123.
  • Goldman, Alvin I. 1979. “What is Justified Belief?” In G. S. Pappas, ed., Justification and Knowledge: New Studies in Epistemology. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1-23.
  • Goldman, Alvin I. 1999. Knowledge In a Social World. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Greco, John. 2010. Achieving Knowledge: A Virtue-Theoretic Account of Epistemic Normativity. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Greenough, Patrick and Pritchard, Duncan. (Eds.). 2009. Williamson on Knowledge. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 1996. Knowledge Puzzles: An Introduction to Epistemology. Boulder: Westview Press.
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 2001. Good Knowledge, Bad Knowledge: On Two Dogmas of Epistemology. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 2005. “Fallibilism.” In J. Fieser and B. Dowden, eds., The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, ISSN 2161-0002, https://iep.utm.edu/fallibil/ .
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 2011a. How To Know: A Practicalist Conception of Knowledge. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 2011b. “The Gettier Problem.” In S. Bernecker and D. Pritchard, eds., The Routledge Companion to Epistemology. London: Routledge, 119-130.
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 2011c. “The Significance of Fallibilism Within Gettier’s Challenge: A Case Study.” Philosophia. DOI: 10.1007/s11406-011-9340-7.
  • Hetherington, Stephen. 2012. “There Can Be Lucky Knowledge.” In M. Steup and J. Turri, eds., Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, 2nd ed. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Howard-Snyder, Daniel, Howard-Snyder, Frances, and Feit, Neil. 2003. “Infallibilism and Gettier’s Legacy.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 66, 304-327.
  • Kant, Immanuel. 2007 [1781/1787]. Critique of Pure Reason, 2nd ed., trans., N. K. Smith. Basingstoke: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • Kornblith, Hilary. 2002. Knowledge and its Place In Nature. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Kvanvig, Jonathan L. 2003. The Value of Knowledge and the Pursuit of Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Lackey, Jennifer. 2008. Learning From Words: Testimony as a Source of Knowledge. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Lewis, David. 1996. “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74, 549-567.
  • Lycan, William G. 2006. “On the Gettier Problem Problem.” In S. Hetherington, ed., Epistemology Futures. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 148-168.
  • Morton, Adam. 2003. A Guide Through the Theory of Knowledge, 3rd ed. Malden: Blackwell.
  • Morton, Adam. 2011. “Contrastivism.” In S. Bernecker and D. Pritchard, eds., The Routledge Companion to Epistemology. London: Routledge, 513-522.
  • Moser, Paul K. (Ed.). 1987. A Priori Knowledge. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Pritchard, Duncan. 2005. Epistemic Luck. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Pritchard, Duncan. 2012. “There Cannot Be Lucky Knowledge.” In M. Steup and J. Turri, eds., Contemporary Debates in Epistemology, 2nd ed. Malden: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Quine, Willard V. 1969. “Epistemology Naturalized.” In W. V. Quine, Ontological Relativity and Other Essays. New York: Columbia University Press, 69-90.
  • Rorty, Richard. 1979. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Russell, Bertrand. 1959 [1912]. The Problems of Philosophy. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1949. The Concept of Mind. London: Hutchinson.
  • Ryle, Gilbert. 1971 [1946]. “Knowing How and Knowing That.” In G. Ryle, Collected Papers, Volume II. London: Hutchinson, 212-225.
  • Sartwell, Crispin. 1991. “Knowledge Is Merely True Belief.” American Philosophical Quarterly 28, 157-165.
  • Sartwell, Crispin. 1992. “Why Knowledge Is Merely True Belief.” The Journal of Philosophy 89, 167-180.
  • Schaffer, Jonathan. 2005. “Contrastive Knowledge.” In J. Hawthorne and T. Gendler, eds., Oxford Studies in Epistemology, Volume I. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 235-271.
  • Schaffer, Jonathan. 2007. “Knowing the Answer.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 75, 383-403.
  • Sellars, Wilfrid F. 1963. “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind.” In W. F. Sellars, Science, Perception and Reality. London: Routledge & Kegan Paul, 127-196.
  • Shope, Robert K. 1983. The Analysis of Knowing: A Decade of Research. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Sosa, Ernest. 2007. A Virtue Epistemology: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume I. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Sosa, Ernest. 2009. Reflective Knowledge: Apt Belief and Reflective Knowledge, Volume II. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Stanley, Jason. 2005. Knowledge and Practical Interests. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Stich, Stephen P. (Ed.). 1975. Innate Ideas. Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • Stroud, Barry. 1984. The Significance of Philosophical Scepticism. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Weinberg, Jonathan M. 2006. “What’s Epistemology For? The Case for Neopragmatism in Normative Metaepistemology.” In S. Hetherington, ed., Epistemology Futures. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 26-47.
  • Weinberg, Jonathan, Nichols, Shaun, and Stich, Stephen. 2001. “Normativity and Epistemic Intuitions.” Philosophical Topics 29, 429-460.
  • Williamson, Timothy. 2000. Knowledge and Its Limits. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Zagzebski, Linda T. 1994. “The Inescapability of Gettier Problems.” The Philosophical Quarterly 44, 65-73.
  • Zagzebski, Linda T. 1996. Virtues of the Mind: An Inquiry Into the Nature of Virtue and the Ethical Foundations of Knowledge. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Zagzebski, Linda T. 2009. On Epistemology. Belmont: Wadsworth.

 

Author Information

Stephen Hetherington
Email: s.hetherington@unsw.edu.au
University of New South Wales
Australia

Philosophy of History

History is the study of the past in all its forms. Philosophy of history examines the theoretical foundations of the practice, application, and social consequences of history and historiography. It is similar to other area studies – such as philosophy of science or philosophy of religion – in two respects. First, philosophy of history utilizes the best theories in the core areas of philosophy like metaphysics, epistemology, and ethics to address questions about the nature of the past and how we come to know it: whether the past proceeds in a random way or is guided by some principle of order, how best to explain or describe the events and objects of the past, how historical events can be considered causally efficacious on one another, and how to adjudicate testimony and evidence. Second, as is the case with the other area-studies, philosophy of history investigates problems that are unique to its subject matter. History examines not what things are so much as how they came to be. History focuses on the unique rather than the general. Its movers are most often people who act for a variety of inner motives rather than purely physical forces. Its objects are no longer observable directly, but must be mediated by evidence. These problems and many more that are specific to the past have been studied and debated for as long as philosophy itself has existed.

This article presents the history of philosophy of history from Ancient Greece to the present, with particular emphases on the variety of 19th century philosophy of history and on the divide between continental and Anglophone or analytic philosophy of history in the 20th century.

Table of Contents

  1. Ancient through Medieval
  2. Humanism through Renaissance
  3. Enlightenment through Romanticism
  4. 19th Century Teleological Systems
  5. 19th Century Scientific Historiography
  6. 19th Century Post-Kantian Historiography
  7. 20th Century Continental
  8. 20th Century Anglophone
  9. Contemporary
  10. References and Further Reading
    1. Classical Works in English Translation
    2. Prominent Scholarship and Collections

1. Ancient through Medieval

 

The attempt to derive meaning from the past is as old as culture itself. The very notion of a culture depends upon a belief in a common history that members of that culture recognize themselves as meaningfully sharing. Whether it be an interpretation of events as products of divine intervention or whether it be the secular uniting of families or of nations, history has always been a sort of glue for a culture’s fabric.

Arguably the first scientific philosophy of history—which is characterized by an attempt to be non-biased, testimony-based, comprehensive, and unencumbered by grand predictive structures— was produced by the father of history, Herodotus (c. 484-425 BCE). The word ‘history’ derives from his usage of historía to define his ‘inquiries’ or ‘researches’: “Herodotus of Halicarnassus, his inquiries are here set down to preserve the memory of the past by putting on record the marvelous achievements both of the Greek and non-Greek peoples; and more particularly, to show how the two races came into conflict” (Herodotus, Histories I.1,1). To attain his comprehensive characterization of the Greek and non-Greek worlds, Herodotus’ research depended on the often fabulous oral traditions of his predecessors. But what he sacrifices in confirmable fact he makes up for in the descriptive vividness of everyday life. All stories, however preposterous, are recorded without moral judgment since they each reflect the beliefs of a time and of a people, all of which are worth knowing.

While Greece and Rome produced a number of important historians and chroniclers, none were more comprehensive or more influential than Thucydides (c.460-c.395 BCE). Like Herodotus, Thucydides viewed history as a source of lessons about how people tended to act. And like him, too, Thucydides was concerned with how methodological considerations shaped our view of the past. However, Thucydides was critical of Herodotus for having failed to carry out a sufficiently objective account. “To hear this history told, insofar as it lacks all that is fabulous, shall perhaps not be entirely pleasing. But whoever desires to investigate the truth of things done, and which according to the character of mankind may be done again, or at least approximately, will discover enough to make it worthwhile” (Thucydides, The Peloponnesian War I, 22). To remedy Herodotus’ uncritical record, first, Thucydides restricted his inquiry to the main actors of the Peloponnesian War: the generals and governors who decided what was to be done rather than the everyday people who could only speculate about it. The lesson to be learned was not the sheer diversity of cultural behaviors but the typological character of agents and their actions, which was to serve as a sort of guide to future conduct since they were likely to repeat themselves. Second, Thucydides treated his evidence with overt skepticism. He claims to not accept hearsay or conjecture, and to admit only that which he had personally seen or else had been confirmed by multiple reliable sources. Thucydides was the first to utilize source criticism in documentary evidence. The lengthy and eloquent speeches he ascribes to various parties are preserved only under the promise that they follow as closely as possible the intention of their alleged speaker.

With the waning of classical antiquity came the decline of the scientific paradigm of history. The religious practice of sacred-history in the Judeo-Christian and Islamic worlds, though often interpreting the same key events in very different ways, share common meta-historical principles. The past is not studied for the sake of disinterested truth, but in the hope of attaining a glimpse of the bond between the divine plan and a given people’s course in the world. In that sense, many non-fundamentalist historians of each faith regard their sacred texts as meaningful documents meant for consideration in the light of the present and what its authors believe to be our common future. Under the surface chronicle of events like floods, plagues, good harvests, or benevolent rulers is seen a moral and spiritual lesson provided by god to his people, which it is the historian’s task to relate. As the Qur’an makes clear, “In their history, there is a lesson [‘ibra] for those who possess intelligence” (Qu’ran 12:111).

The most reflective of the early medieval historiographers is doubtless Augustine (354-430). In opposition to Thucydides’ aim to show the repeatability of typical elements from the past, Augustine’s emphasized the linearity of history as a part of the Christian eschatology, the necessary unfolding of God’s eternal plan within a temporally-ordered course of history. His City of God (413-26) characterizes lives and nations as a long redemption from original sin that culminates in the appearance of Christ. Since then, history has been a record of the engaged struggle between the chosen elect of the City of God and the rebellious self-lovers who dwell in the City of Men. Because time is linear, its key events are unique and inviolable: the Fall of Adam, the Birth and Death of Jesus, and the Resurrection all move history along to the Final Judgment with infallible regularity.

Sacred-history thus tends to provide an overarching narrative about the meaning of human existence, either as a tragedy or a statement of hope in a redeemed future. Besides its canonical status throughout much of the Medieval world, its influence manifestly stretches over the hermeneutical tradition as well as the teleological philosophers of history of the Nineteenth Century.

2. Humanism through Renaissance

Petrarch’s (1304-1374) De secreto conflict curarum mearum (c.1347-c.1353) argued that secular intellectual pursuits, among them history, need not be spiritually hazardous. His circle of followers recovered and restored a mass of ancient texts the likes of which the previous millennium had not imagined, among them the histories of Cicero, Livy, Tacitus, and Varro. At the beginning of the 15th century, humanist universities expanded from their scholastic core to include rhetoric, poetry, and above all, history. And with their greater concern for the things and people of the natural world came an increasing focus on political history rather than grand religious narratives. Accordingly, the common focal point was not the Resurrection of Christ, but the fall of Rome. And here the lesson of history was not a consistent moral decline, but a hope that understanding Ancient models of social and political life would make room for a sort of secular golden age.

With the new focus on human affairs, there came an increased attention to written records and natural evidence. Armed with newly unlocked troves of secular literary artifacts, the works of Leonardo Bruni (c.1370-1444) and Flavio Biondo (1392-1463) contain the first forays into modern source criticism and demands for documentary evidence. And for Bruni’s History of the Florentine People (1415-39), the story to be told was neither a spiritual nor a moral one, but a natural history of the progress of political freedom in Florence.

Though less nationalistic than these, Desiderius Erasmus, too, demanded that historians trace their sources back to the originals, not just in government documents but in cultural artifacts as well. And that meant investigating the religious spirit of sacred history with the tools of Renaissance humanism. His Latin and Greek translations of the New Testament are monuments of scholarly historiography, and became instrumental for the Reformation. History, for Erasmus, became a tool for critiquing modern misinterpretations and abuses of the once noble past and a means for uncovering the truth about long-misunderstood people, ideas, and events.

But although previous writers of history were reflective about their enterprise, the first to merit the name Philosopher of History is Giambattista Vico (1668-1744). He is the first to argue for a common historical process that guides the course of peoples and nations. In the Scienza Nuova, he writes:

Our Science therefore comes to describe at the same time an ideal eternal history traversed in time by the history of every nation in its rise, progress, maturity, decline, and fall. Indeed we go so far as to assert that whoever mediates this Science tells himself this ideal eternal history only so far as he makes it by that proof, ‘it had, has, and will have to be’. For the first indubitable principle above posited is that this world of nations has certainly been made by men, and its guise must therefore be found within the modifications of our own human mind. And history cannot be more certain than when he who creates the things also describes them. (Vico 1948, 104)

Vico’s philosophy of history follows from his epistemological postulate that to know something fully required understanding how it came to be. The true is precisely that which has been made, expressed in his Latin as Verum esse ipsum factum. Since natural objects were not made by the scientists who study them, their nature must remain to some degree mysterious. But human history, since its objects and its investigators are one and the same, has in principle a methodological advantage. That division between the natural sciences and human sciences was in conscious contradistinction to Descartes’ methodological universalism; and it would become crucial for 19th century Post-Kantian philosophers of history and, later, for the British Idealists.

Vico also suggests that the cultured minds of his day were of a different order than those of their primitive ancestors. Whereas his 18th century thinkers form abstract concepts and universal propositions, to the primitive individual images and sounds directly indicate the real things to which they refer. While for Post-Kantian philosophers lightning is a symbol or metaphor for Zeus, to Vico’s poetic imaginers the lightning really is Zeus. To perfectly reconstruct both their mentality and their history by the principles of rationalist science or enlightenment historiography  is impossible. A new science of the imagination is required, one that can symbolically recapture past people’s forms of thoughts and re-embody their emotions.

Because of these epistemological views, Vico is the first to posit distinct epochs of history in which all nations evolve due to an overarching scheme of logic. Each stage of a nation’s development produces a newly-believed system of natural law, use of language, and institution of government. It is ‘providence’ that causes the transition in every nation from an Age of Gods, wherein people believe themselves directly governed by divine signs and spoke only in a direct object language, to an Age of Heroes wherein aristocrats hold commoners in thrall by their natural superiority and speak in metaphoric images, and then to an Age of Men, wherein people communicate with abstract generalities and assume both a general equality in their social associations and an abstract notion of justice by which they are governed. It is our fate as human beings in every nation to live out this ‘corso’ of history, this progression of mental capacities from fantasia to riflessione.

Ultimately the ideal epoch of reason and civilization is never reached. At our most civilized, history circles back upon itself in a ‘ricorso’ to a ‘second barbarism’. Here in this barbarism of reflection, aided by civil bureaucracy, deceitful language, and cunning reason, our passions are unrestrained by the manners and customs prominent in the Ages of Gods or Heroes to the point that civil society collapses upon itself before returning to a second cycle of history.

3. Enlightenment through Romanticism

In contrast to Vico’s pessimism, the philosophy of history in the 18th century is continuous with the Enlightenment ideals of moral progress and the power of reason. Voltaire’s (1694-1778) Essay on the Customs and the Spirit of the Nations (1756), wherein the phrase ‘philosophy of history’ is supposed to have been coined, was the first attempt since Herodotus to write a comprehensive history of world culture in a non-Christian and non-teleological framework. Social and cultural history replaced military and political history with a trans-religious and trans-European tenor intended to showcase the spiritual and moral progress of humanity. To further rid Europe of what he considered Christian biases, on display especially in the modern eschatology of Jacques Bénigne Bossuet (1627-1704), Voltaire was the first major modern thinker to stress Arab contributions to world culture. In keeping with the Enlightenment, he believed that the best remedy for intolerance and prejudice was simply the truth, something which is best discovered by the objective historian working with original documents, never by the ideologue repeating the dicta of authorities. But for his apologies for non-biased historiography, Voltaire betrays rather clearly the ideals of his age. Differences between the Christian eschatological worldview and his own age’s rationalist science are regarded summarily as improvements, whereas the medieval destruction of the ancient clearly represents decline. The age of reason is, for Voltaire, the standard by which other eras and peoples are to be judged, though few could be said to have reached.

Antoine-Nicolas de Condorcet (1743-1794) openly embraced Enlightenment progressivism. Like Voltaire, his Sketch for a Historical Picture of the Progress of the Human Mind (published posthumously in 1795) viewed the past as a progress of reason, but was more optimistic about the inevitable progress of liberal ideals such as free speech, democratic government, and the equity of suffrage, education, and wealth. The point of history was not only a description of this progress. Because the progress is lawful and universal, history is also predictive and, what is more, articulates a duty for political institutions to work toward the sort of equalities that the march of history would bring about anyway. The historian is no mere critic of his time, but also a herald of what is to come. Widely influential on the French Revolution, Condorcet also made a significant impression on the systematizing philosophies of history of Saint-Simon, Hegel, and Marx, as well as laid the first blueprints for systematic study of social history made popular by Comte, Weber, and Durkheim.

Less revolutionary was Immanuel Kant’s (1724-1804) Idea of a Universal History from a Cosmopolitan Point of View (1784). Kant begins from the Enlightenment view of history as a progressive march of reason and freedom. But given his epistemology he could not presume, as did Voltaire and Condorcet, that the teleological progression of history was empirically discernible within the past. It is not a demonstrable fact, but a necessary condition for the meaningfulness of the past to posit teleological progress as a regulative idea that allows us to justify the many apparent evils that have sprung up within history despite the overall benevolent character of creation. The wars, famines, and natural disasters that pervade history should be seen as nature’s instruments, guiding people into the kinds of civil relationships that eventually maximize freedom and justice. History reveals human culture as the means by which nature accomplishes its state of perpetual peace in all the spiritual pursuits of mankind.

Johann Gottfried Herder (1744-1803) was key in the general turn from Enlightenment historiography to the romantic. His Ideas toward a Philosophy of History of Humanity (1784-91) echoes Vico’s contention that there is no single faculty of human reason for all peoples at all times, but different forms of rationality for various cultures as determined by their particular time and place in the world. Accepting Vico’s notion of necessary development, he nevertheless rejects the Enlightenment emphasis on rationality and freedom as its measures. Herder also discards the Enlightenment tendency to judge the past by the light of the present, irrespective of how rational we consider ourselves today. This results from his fundamental conviction that each national culture is of equal historical value. The same inner vitalism of nature guides all living things on the regular path from birth to death. Just as childhood and old age are essential to the development of the person, are valuable in their own right, and thus should not be judged as somehow inferior from the standpoint of adulthood, so too a nation’s character is of inviolable worth and essential to the development of the whole.

Herder not only rejected Kant’s Enlightenment universalism, but also the epistemological means by which an understanding of ancient people can be reached. It was clear that there could be no empirical proof or rationalist demonstration of the organic pattern of the development Herder finds. Nor, however, should we posit teleological progress as a merely regulative principle of reason. The sense for past people and cultures is not itself communicated whole and entire through their documents in such a way that would be open to historical analysis or source criticism. The historian only apprehends the real spirit of a people through a sympathetic understanding – what Herder calls Einfühlen— of their inner life by analogy with her own. The historian ‘feels her way into’ a people and an age, in order to try to sympathetically apprehend why they made the choices they did.

Romantic historiographers were strongly guided by Herder’s idea that the definition of a people lay more in its inner spirit than its legal borders. The fairy tales of the Grimm brothers (1812), as much as the nationalistic histories of Macaulay (1800-1859), the Wilhelm Tell (1804) saga of Friedrich Schiller (1759-1805), J.W.v. Goethe’s (1749-1832) Goetz von Berlichingen (1773), the transcription of the Beowulf epic (1818), and the surge of histories asserting the sanctity of minority Russio-slavic cultures like the Estonian Kalevipoeg (1853) or the Armenian Sasuntzi Davit (1873) each sought to revitalize and unify present culture under the banner of a shared past. The Romantics followed Herder, too, in their belief that this national character was not discernible solely by meticulous analysis of documents and archival records. The historian must have an overarching sense of the course of history of a people, just as the dramaturge reveals the unity of a character through each individual episode. Hardly a bare chronicle of disconnected facts, the narratives historians tell about the past should communicate a sense of spirit rather than objective information. And only those who ‘breathe the air of a people or an age’ have the proper sort of sympathetic understanding to interpret it correctly. The potential abuses of historiography, to which this nationalistic romanticism lends itself, had a decisive impact on the three main streams of philosophy of history in the 19th century.

4. 19th Century Teleological Systems

The name of G.W.F. Hegel (1770-1831) is nearly synonymous with philosophy of history in two senses, both captured by his phrase, “The only thought which philosophy brings with it, in regard to history, is the simple thought of Reason—the thought that Reason rules the world, and that world history has therefore been rational in its course” (Hegel 1988, 12f). History unfolds itself according to a rational plan; and we know this precisely because the mind which examines it unfolds itself from the first inklings of sense-certainty to absolute knowing in a regular teleological pattern. The same process that governs the movement of history also governs the character of the philosophical speculation inherent in that moment of history. And at the present epoch of philosophical speculation we are capable of understanding the entire movement of history as a rational process unfolding an ever greater awareness of rational freedom. A true account of the whole of reality, which is itself the sole endeavor of philosophy, must consider everything real as real insofar as it can be comprehended by reason as it unfolds within its necessary historical course. Reason is, for Hegel, the real. Both are understood as historical.

Hegel’s lecture series on the Introduction to the Philosophy of History (published posthumously in 1837) is a sort of secular eschatology, wherein the course of reality is considered a single epochal evolution toward a providential end. This is cognized by an increasingly unfolding awareness according to that same plan. As he demotes religion to a subservient place to absolute knowing in his Phenomenology of Spirit (1807), so too does Hegel replace the sacred-history conception of grace with the phenomenological unfolding of reason.

Hegel’s view of the common structural unveiling of reason and history leads to specific consequences for his teleological historiography. Reason consists in both the awareness of contradiction and its sublimation by means of the speculative act of synthesis which results in an increased self-recognition. Analogously, the development of history consists in a progressive structure of oppositions and their necessary synthetic sublimations which leads to an ever increasing self-awareness of freedom. That necessary movement is illustrated in his account of three distinct epochs of world history. In the ancient orient, only the despot is free; his freedom consists only in the arbitrary savagery of his will. The people are held in bondage by the identity of state and religion. The opposition of the despot and his subjects is to some degree overcome by the classical Greek and Roman recognition of citizenship, under which the free individual understands himself to be bound by honor over and above the laws of the state. Still, the great many in the classical world are still un-free. It is only in the intertwining of the Christian recognition of the sanctity of life and the modern liberal definition of morality as inherently intersubjective and rational that guarantees freedom for all. “It was first the Germanic Peoples, through Christianity, who came to the awareness that every human is free by virtue of being human, and that the freedom of spirit comprises our most human nature” (Hegel 1988, 21).

The critics of Hegel have been as passionate as his disciples. Of the former we may count Thomas Carlyle (1795-1881) and the historical school at Basel: J.J. Bachofen (1815-1887), Jacob Burckhardt (1818-1897), and a younger Friedrich Nietzsche (1844-1900). What unites them is a shared belief that historiography should highlight rather than obscure the achievements of individuals under the banner of necessary rational progress, a general ridicule of any historical process which brings about providential ends in the face of overwhelming global suffering, an anti-statist political stance, and a disavowal of progress as coextensive with the expansion of social welfare, intellectualism, and utility. Past epochs were not merely some preparatory ground on the way to the comfortably modern Hegelian or Marxist state, but stand on their own as inherently superior cultures and healthier models of culture life. For Bachofen and Nietzsche, this meant the ancient Greeks, for Burckhardt the aristocrats of the Italian Renaissance. So too ought the remarkable individuals of these eras be seen as fully-willed heroes rather than as Hegelian ‘world-historical individuals’ who appear only when the world process requires a nudge in the direction that providence had already chosen apart from them.

Of the latter group, we may count his disciples both on the left and the right, and prominent theorists of history like Ludwig Feuerbach (1804-1872), David Friedrich Strauss (1808-1874), Eduard von Hartmann (1842-1906), Max Stirner (1806-1856), Georg Lukács (1885-1971), Arnold Toynbee (1889-1975), Herbert Marcuse (1898-1979), Alexandre Kojève (1902-1968), and Theodor Adorno (1903-1969). Most recently the general outline of Hegel’s philosophy of history has been adopted in Francis Fukuyama’s (1952—) controversial The End of History (1992).

But without question the most important philosophical engagement with Hegel’s historiography is that of Karl Marx (1818-1883), whose own account of the past is often considered a sort of ‘upside-down’ version of Hegel’s Weltprozess. Even while Marx maintains Hegel’s belief in dialectical progress and historical inevitability, he supplants his speculative method with a historical materialism that views the transitions of epochs in terms of the relationship between production and ownership. Marx’s account of the past has obviously had pervasive political and economic influences; but his philosophy of history has also won many modern and contemporary adherents among a wide number of practicing historians, who regard material conditions as opposed to motivational conditions, as sufficient for historical explanation.

5. 19th Century Scientific Historiography

 

 

Perhaps the most common complaint against the Hegelians was that their speculative systems overlooked the empirical facts of history. This explains to some degree the partition, new to the 19th century, between philosophers of history and practicing historians, who were themselves often quite reflective on the philosophical issues of their discipline. Friedrich August Wolf (1759-1824), the first to enter the ranks of the German academy as a classical philologist, was exemplary in this respect. Though more focused on religious and romantic historians, Wolf rejected teleological systems generally by his demand that interpretation be grounded in the combination of a comprehensive sense for the contextual whole of a particular epoch and rigorous attention to the details of textual evidence. Wolf’s 1795 Prolegomena zu Homer is a landmark in source criticism and the first modern attempt to treat history as a genuine science.

While the Romantic historians tried to coopt the intuitive and holistic aspects of Wolf, the influence of his methodological rigor was shared by two rival schools of thought about the possibility of knowledge in antiquity: the Sprachphilologen and the Sachphilologen. J.G.J. Hermann (1772-1848), led the Sprachphilologen in Leipzig along with his followers Karl Lachmann (1793-1851) and Moritz Haupt (1808-1874). For them, knowledge of antiquity concerns principally its verifiability conditions. Since any claim about what Plato, Euripides, or Caesar ‘meant’ requires an evidenced demonstration of their actual words, the philologist’s task should be concerned principally with affixing an as-perfect-as-possible edition of their text. In the 21st century, the legacy of Sprachphilologie can be seen in the tradition of a ‘critical edition’ of an author’s work. The Sachphilologen accepted the demand for critical rigor, but rejected that our knowledge of antiquity should be restricted to written texts. August Boeckh (1785-1867), F.G. Welcker (1784-1868), and Karl Otfried Müller (1797-1840) took seriously the critical methods of Wolf, but cast a wider net in order to incorporate the artifacts, art, and culture. If rigorous proof was sacrificed thereby, then it was repaid by a more comprehensive sense of the genuine life of antiquity. Although sometimes underappreciated by historians of historiography, this debate gave rise to two sets of pervasively influential fields: Sprachphilologie’s demand for rigorous evidence was a forerunner of ‘scientific’ historiography in the mid-19th and 20th centuries; Sachphilologie’s holism laid the groundwork for serious work in archeology, anthropology, numismatics, epigraphy, and a number of other historical disciplines.

What Wolf did for philology, Leopold von Ranke (1795-18860) did for historiography generally. Although arguably exaggerated, his famous claim that historians should not interpret the past subjectively but re-present it wie es eingentlich gewesen ist, or ‘as it really was’, became the rallying cry for practicing historians to reject both the Hegelian system building and the Romantic narratives. And where Wolf sought the scientific character of history in the demonstrability of its evidence, Ranke and propagators such as Heinrich von Sybel (1817-1895) sought it in the disinterested character of its researchers. The historian should be like a clear mirror of the past, absent the biases, political aims, and religious zealotry that distort the image of the real and genuine past. In opposition to the Hegelian and Marxist ranking of ages according to some a priori criterion, Ranke sided with Herder in believing ‘every age is next to God’. To prevent prejudice and hasty generalizations, the historian must not settle for hearsay, but work intensively with official documents and archival records.

In the 20th century, however, and by figures as diverse as E.H. Carr (1892-1982) and Walter Benjamin (1892-1940), Ranke’s hope for empirical objectivity had been characterized as naïvely realist or else as an ironic example of how Western, Christian, economically privileged, and male perspectives masquerade as objectivity. The French Annales School, led by Fernand Braudel (1902-1985), sought to meet these challenges while restoring the Rankean vision of objective historiography.

The mid-1800’s saw another group of historical theorists emerge who were concerned principally to show that the scientific character of historiography concerned its use of the same logic of explanation utilized by the natural scientists. Auguste Comte (1798-1857), founder of positivism, considered history to be a sort of ‘social physics’, which limited explanation to relations among observable phenomena. Any claims to apprehend the ‘real essences’ behind the empirical data was prohibited as a foray into speculative metaphysics. Through empirical inquiry alone we can discover the natural laws that govern historical change. Henry Thomas Buckle’s (1821-1862) History of Civilization in England (1857) made clear that these laws could neither be divined philosophically nor with theological suppositions about divine providence, but could be described statistically in keeping with the empirical methods of the natural sciences.

The most comprehensive advance in the logic of historical inquiry came at this time from John Stuart Mill (1806-1873). Even while he rejected Jeremy Bentham’s (1748-1832) overly reductive hypothesis that all humans are guided simply by pleasure and pain, he maintained the possibility of discovering behavioral laws that would allow us to deduce the meaning of particular actions and predict the future with at least some degree of certainty:

[T]he uniformities of co-existence obtaining among phenomena which are effects of causes, must (as we have so often observed) be corollaries from the laws of causation by which these phenomena are really determined. […] The fundamental problem, therefore, of the social science, is to find the laws according to which any state of society produces the states which succeeds it and takes its place. (Mill 1843, 631)

Despite constraining their explanations to the empirical, many positivists held the belief that history was progressing as a necessary lawful order in terms of both its moral and intellectual development. Comte’s “law of three stages,” for example, held that the human mind and by extension the cultural institutions that result from it follow a strict progression from a ‘theological’ view of things, to the ‘metaphysical’, and finally to the ‘scientific’. Critics have charged that Comte is in this way little better than Hegel in positing an overarching structure to events and a certain zealotry about human progress. Nevertheless, Comte’s insistence that empirical laws are deducible from and predictive of human behavior has had decisive influence in the development of sociology and social psychology, especially in the writing of Émile Durkheim (1858-1917) and Max Weber (1864-1920), as well as upon 20th century explanatory positivism.

6. 19th Century Post-Kantian Historiography

 

Also in conscious opposition to the Hegelians stood the Post-Kantians Wilhem Dilthey (1833-1911), William Windelband (1848-1915), and Heinrich Rickert (1863-1936). Their shared exhortation – ‘back to Kant!’– involved the recognition, absent in both the practicing historians and in the positivists, that knowledge was necessarily mediated by the pre-given structures of the subject of knowing.

Dilthey’s lifelong and never-finalized project was to provide for the ‘human sciences’ – Geisteswissenschaften – what Kant had for metaphysics: a programmatic schemata of the possible logical forms of inquiry such that the necessarily true could be separated from both the arbitrary and the speculative. This involved his supposition that all expressed historical agency is a manifestation of one of three classes of mental states: judgments, actions, and expressions of experience. To understand the working of history is to understand how this trio – described as an inner Lebenszusammenhang – is exercised in all the empirically observable features of the human world. An advantage over the natural scientist’s explanation of physical objects, this descriptive understanding is aided by the analogies we might draw with the understanding of our own inner experiences. We have an inherent sort of sympathetic awareness of historical events since the agents involved in them are psychologically motivated in ways not wholly dissimilar to ourselves.

Windelband took up Dilthey’s suggestions about the differences between history and other sciences on the question of values to forge his own methodological distinction between erklären and verstehen, explanation and understanding. The biggest difference was not just that history involved values, but that the very means by which we come to our knowledge about the past differs from that by which we explain objects external to us. Science deals in invariable laws, in generalities, and considers its individual objects only insofar as they are instances of their classes. For the historian, however, it is the particular that requires examination: Caesar not as an instance of some general rule about how emperors behave, but as a unique, unrepeatable phenomenon distinct from Alexander, Charlemagne, and Ying Zheng. And from particulars alone general laws cannot be formed. In this way, history is ideographic and  descriptive rather than nomothetic or law-positing, and as such, more concerned to describe and understand than to explain.

Heinrich Rickert accepted Windelband’s methodological distinction as well as Dilthey’s attempt to provide the outlines of a distinctively historical logic. But Rickert stressed, more than they, the psychological dimension of historiography. What an historian held as interesting, or what they choose to present of the practical infinity of possible historical inquiries, was not a matter of reason but a psychology of value. And because historiography was value-driven, any attempt to excise its subjective foundation was not only unwarranted but impossible. These practical interests do not force history to resolve into a merely relativistic narrativity, Rickert thought, since human nature was sufficiently uniform to allow for inter-subjectively compelling accounts even if there is never proof in the positivist sense.

The direct influence of post-Kantian philosophy of history is not as pronounced as the teleological or scientific. But the notion that history is a unique sort of inquiry with its own methodology, logic of explanation, and standards of adjudication has been echoed in various ways by figures from Benedetto Croce (1866-1952) and Georg Simmel (1858-1918), to R. G. Collingwood (1889-1943) and Michael Oakeshott (1901-1990); so too has Dilthey’s search for the cognitive and psychological conditions for historical inquiry been taken up by Ernst Cassirer (1874-1945) and by the Frankfurt School of Critical Theory. The hermeneutics of Hans-Georg Gadamer (1900-2002) are in some respects a critical engagement with the Post-Kantian attempt to recover the past as it was apart from the ‘historically conditioned consciousness’ (wirkungsgeschichtliches Bewußtsein) that predetermines our approach to particular texts and, ultimately, the past as a whole.

7. 20th Century Continental

As diverse as continental philosophy has been, it would not be an unwarranted generalization to say that all thinkers and schools have in one way or another been focused on history. And they have mostly been so in terms of two distinct conceptual foci: historicity and narrativity.

It was Nietzsche’s On the Uses and Disadvantages of History for Life (1874) that first called into question not just how we could obtain knowledge of the past, but whether and to what extent our attempt to know the past is itself a life-enhancing or life-enervating activity. As human beings, we are unique in the animal world insofar as we are constantly burdened with our pasts as well as our futures, unable to forget those incidents which it would be otherwise preferable to bury on the one hand, and unable to ignore what must become of us on the other. History is not just something we study objectively, but an experience through which we must live and by which we seemingly without conscious control burden ourselves for a variety of psychological reasons.

Martin Heidegger’s (1889-1976) Being and Time (1927) attempts to give a comprehensive analysis to this experience. His overarching project is to answer the question ‘what is Being?’ But in doing so, he recognizes that the truth about Being, that is, our openness to the question of Being, has been gradually covered over in the history of philosophy. From the Presocratics, when the question of the meaning of being was at its most open, to the nihilistic academic age of the 20th century, philosophical history becomes a history of the meaning of Being. The end of philosophy, wherein the specialized sciences have entirely preoccupied themselves with particular beings while summarily ignoring Being itself, beckons a new and intrinsically historical engagement. Accordingly, Heidegger’s own historiography of philosophy is a working-back from this modern dead-end in the hopes of reopening the question of Being itself.

Heidegger’s historiography is, however, more than just an academic recitation of what various other philosophers have said. Human beings, what Heidegger famously terms Dasein, are characterized above all by their ‘being there’ in the world, their ‘thrown-ness’ in existence, which entails as it did for Nietzsche their relation to Being itself in terms of both their pasts and their existential march toward the common future horizon: death. The self as Dasein is constantly engaged in the project of coming out of its past and moving into its future as the space of possibilities in which alone it can act. As such an inextricable part of the human person is its historical facticity.

The existential dimension of Heidegger’s conception of historicity had a profound influence on figures like Martin Buber (1878-1965), Karl Jaspers (1883-1969), Hannah Arendt (1906-1975), Emmanuel Levinas (1906-1995), Jan Patočka (1907-1977), and Paul Ricouer (1913-2005). Jean Paul Sartre (1905-1980), in particular, focused on the existential aspects of the past, which he conceives in terms of a blend of the Marxist material conditions for human action and a quasi psycho-analytic unfolding of the phenomenological self. Man is an historical praxis, for Sartre, a continual project that is both being produced by its past and producing its future in a way that will determine that future person’s possibilities and limits. Sartre’s well-known conception of authenticity is intrinsically historical insofar as it involves the recognition of our personal freedom in the context of the material conditions history imposes upon us. Albeit in less existential terms, the Frankfurt School also founded their view of the subject and of the world in a combination of Marxist materialist historiography and psycho-analysis.

 

In the latter decades of the 20th century, continental philosophy of history turned its attention to epistemological questions about historical narrative. Again Nietzsche’s reflections on history are a crucial influence, especially his contention that truth is no straightforward or objective correspondence between the world and the proposition but a historically contingent outcome of the continuous struggle between the interests of interpreters. As such, philosophy must concern itself with an historical investigation of how these truth practices function within and against the backdrop of their historical facticities.

Michel Foucault (1926-1984) characterized his own project as the historical investigation of the means of truth production. His earlier work is characterized by what he calls ‘archeology’. His History of Madness (1961) begins a series of works that denies a single fixed meaning for phenomena, but undertakes to show how meaning transmogrifies over time through a series of cultural practices. In The Order of Things (1966), archeology is characterized as a description of the transitions between cultural discourses in a way that highlights their structural and contextual meaning while undermining any substantive notion of the author of those discourses. Foucault’s later work, though he never repudiates his archeological method, is characterized as a ‘genealogy’. The effort, again roughly Nietzschean, is to understand the past in terms of the present, to show that the institutions we find today are neither the result of teleological providence nor an instantiation of rational decision making, but emerge from a power play of discourses carried over from the past. This does not mean that history should study the ‘origins’ of those practices; on the contrary it denies the notion of origin as an illegitimate abstraction from what is a continuous interaction of discourses. History should instead concern itself with those moments when the contingencies of the past emerge or descend out of the conflict of its discourses, with how the past reveals a series of disparities rather than progressive steps.

The conception of history as a play of power-seeking discursive practices was reflected back upon the practices of the historian. A row of postmodern philosophers such as Roland Barthes (1915-1980), Paul de Man (1919-1983), Jean-François Lyotard (1924-1988), Gilles Deleuze (1925-1995), Philippe Lacoue-Labarthe (1940-2007), and Jacques Derrida (1930-2004) came to view not just the events of history but also the writing of history to be necessarily colored by power-based subjectivity. This power play crystallizes in the meta-narrative structures grafted upon the world by the philosophers of history. Indeed, Lyotard’s The Postmodern Condition (1979) characterizes the entire postmodern project as “incredulity toward meta-narratives” (Lyotard 1984, xxiv). With respect to philosophy of history, this entails rejecting both the grand Hegelian ‘master discourse’ about progress and also the Enlightenment categories of generalization from which moral lessons are supposed to be derivable. Rather than a dialectical logic that would seek unity among past events, the postmodern condition drives us to see the disjointedness, dissimilarity, and diversity of events and people.

Lyotard’s rejection of traditional unities leads a contemporary postmodernist like Jean-Luc Nancy (1940-) to refocus history on smaller-scale and self-enclosed ‘immanent’ communities like brotherhoods or families rather than on society writ-large. Required for that is a new way of writing history that embraces a multiplicity of perspectives and standards of judgment, and, by extension, a willingness to embrace the plurality of moral and political lessons that can be drawn absent conviction in a single correct narrative. Postmodern theory was influential, for but one example, in the post-colonialism of Edward Said’s (1935-2003) Orientalism (1978), which became prominent for its attempt to open a discursive space for competing non-dominant narratives by the so-called ‘sub-altern’ other. Standpoint narratives, exercises in ‘cultural memory’, and oral history have lately won increasing popularity.

8. 20th Century Anglophone

Like analytic philosophy generally, analytic philosophy of history is partly characterized by its Anglophone heritage and partly by a propensity to treat individual problems rather than offering comprehensive interpretations of reality. The major difference between analytic and continental philosophy of history concerns the former’s almost exclusive focus on epistemological issues of historiography and a general indifference toward questions of historicity.

Anglophone philosophy of history is also marked by its conscious self-distancing from the teleological systems of the Hegelians. There were essentially two reasons for this, one political and one epistemological, brought to eloquent expression in Karl Popper’s (1902-1994) The Open Society and Its Enemies (1945) and The Poverty of Historicism (1957). Concerning the former, Popper charged that the ideological impetus for the totalitarian regimes of the previous hundred years was their shared belief in a national or religious destiny that was both guaranteed and justified by a grand historical process. Whether Bismarck, Communism, Fascism, or Nazism, all were confident that history was inexorably marching toward a global regime that would guarantee their way of life and justify the actions taken in their name. The Anglophone tradition was inspired to deny the grand teleological narrative partly as a political aversion to this way of thinking. Epistemologically, Popper’s ‘falsifiability’ criterion of positive knowledge also targeted the teleological systems of the 19th century. Largely accepting Bertrand Russell’s (1872-1970) natural ontology, he argued that the teleologists began from non-falsifiable assumptions about metaphysical processes, which ignored the empirical facts of the past for the sake of positing what they thought the past must have been. The focus of philosophy of history in the Anglophone world after Popper turned away from attempts to provide grand narratives in order to deal with specific meta-historical problems.

One problem, carried over from the 19th century scientific philosophers of history, was the logic of historical explanation. Similar to their positivist counterparts, the earlier analytics held explanations to be justified insofar as they were able to render historical events predictable by means of deducing their particulars under a general law. The most well-known expression comes from C.G. Hempel (1905-1997). “Historical explanation, too, aims at showing that the event in question was not a ‘matter of chance’, but was to be expected in view of certain antecedent or simultaneous conditions. The expectation referred to is not prophecy or divination, but rational scientific anticipation which rests on the assumption of general laws” (Hempel 1959, 348f). The logic itself is straightforward: “The explanation of the occurrence of an event of some specific kind E at a certain place and time consists, as it is usually expressed, in indicating the causes or determining factors of E” (Ibid, 345). In this respect, the logic of historical explanation is no different from the logic of scientific explanation. And while they may be more difficult to locate, once the laws of historical change have been discovered by psychology, anthropology, economics, or sociology, the predictive force of historiography should theoretically rival that of the natural sciences.

Hempel’s confidence came under attack from those like Popper who thought that history could not offer absolute regularities and maintained that predictions were never inviolable but at best probable ‘trends’. Attack also came from R.G. Collingwood, who denied the existence of covering laws in history and accordingly the applicability of scientific explanatory mechanisms. For him, as well as for Michael Oakeshott, history is a study of the uniqueness of the past and not its generalities, and always for the sake of understanding rather than proving or predicting. In agreement with Aristotle, Oakeshott believes, “the moment historical facts are regarded as instances of general laws, history is dismissed” (Oakeshott 1933, 154). It is the particular, especially the particular person, that history studies, and as such the attempt to predict their behavior nomothetically is not only impossible but misunderstands the very reason for historical inquiry in the first place.

Contrary to Aristotle, the unscientific character of history for Collingwood and Oakeshott renders it no less-worthy a course of study. Indeed, following the Post-Kantian 19th century philosophers of history and ultimately Vico, they thought the past proves itself more intelligible precisely because the objects under investigation can be understood from the ‘inside’ rather than explained from a standpoint outside the object. The proper task of history, Collingwood thought, was not to address mere general naturalistic events but the rationality of specific actions. A mass migration can be studied by the sociologist, the geographer, or the volcanologist from the ‘outside’ as a natural event. What marks the historian, by contrast, is her interest in the actions of the migrating individuals in terms of their intentions and decisions. While this may not be recorded in any palpable evidence, Collingwood was consistent with Herder in thinking that the historian must attempt to ‘get inside the head’ of the agents being investigated under the presumption that they typically make similarly reasonable choices as she would in the same situation. Collingwood’s advocation of a sort of empathic projection into the mind of past agents has been criticized as armchair psychologism. It would be difficult to deny, however, that many working historians adopt Collingwood’s intuitivism rather than the Hempelian nomothetic deduction.

In the latter half of the 20th century, a number of explanatory theories were proposed which walk a middle line between the nomothetic and idealist proposals. W.H. Walsh (1913-1986) returned to William Whewell’s (1794-1866) conception of ‘colligation’ type explanations as a way of making the past intelligible. Here the effort is neither to demonstrate nor to predict, but to bring together various relevant events around a central unifying concept in order to make clear their interconnections:

What we want from historians is […] an account which brings out their connections and bearing on one another. And when historians are in a position to give such an account it may be said that they have succeeded in ‘making sense of’ or ‘understanding’ their material. (Walsh 1957, 299)

In this way, Walsh’s meta-theory sides neither with the ‘scientific’ philosophers of history of either the Comteian or Hempelian variety nor with the British idealists, but maintains that the explanatory force of historiography rests in its narrativity. Just as the pedagogical value of a narrative is not reducible to what it can demonstrate, so the value of history rests in its ability to make sense of various features of the lives and times of others.

William Dray (1921-2009), too, argued that historical explanation does not require the sufficient conditions for why something happened, but only the necessary conditions for describing how what did happen could possibly have happened. For example, if an historian accounts for the assassination of a king in terms of his unpopular policies and dishonest court, then this explains ‘how’ his assassination could possibly have occurred without relying on a Hempelian deduction from some suppositional law that claims all kings with unpopular policies and dishonest courts will necessarily be assassinated.

A second problem addressed by 20th century Anglophone philosophers of history concerned the nature and possibility of objectivity. While all would agree with Ranke that historiography should endeavor to expunge overt biases and prejudices, the question remains to what extent this could or even should be done. Carl Becker (1873-1945) was perhaps the first Anglophone thinker to take up Croce’s claim that all history is ‘contemporary’ in the sense of being written necessarily from the perspective of present-day interests. Along these lines Charles Beard (1874-1948) had a series of arguments against the Rankean ideal of objectivity. Historiography cannot observe its subject matter since by definition what is in the past is no longer in the present; evidence is always fragmentary and never controllable the way a scientific experiment can control its variables; historians impose structures that the events themselves do not have; and their accounts are selective in ways that betray the historians’ own interests. Nevertheless, Beard would not come to endorse the sort of relativistic narrativism of his post-modern continental counterparts.

It certainly seems true to say that historians select – insofar as a map is itself not the road – and that their selection is a matter of what they personally esteem worth discussing, whether on the level of their general topic or in terms of which causes they consider relevant within an explanation. But selectivity of itself does not imply prejudice; and a careful reader is more often than not able to distinguish overtly prejudiced accounts from one whose selections are balanced and fair. Moreover, the fact that they are selective would not serve as a prima facie principle of discernment between historians and scientists, since the latter are every bit as selective in the topics under their purview. Even if science and historiography choose their inquiries as a matter of personal interest, both operate under norms to be impartial, to use only reputable evidence, and to present ‘the whole truth’, even should it call into question their hypotheses.

Isaiah Berlin (1909-1997) considered the problem of historiographical objectivity from the perspective of the objects written about rather than exclusively the writer. While the scientist has little emotional commitment to the chemicals or atoms under examination, historians often have strong feelings about the moral consequences of their subjects. The choice between historical designations like ‘terrorist’ and ‘freedom fighter’, ‘sedition’ and ‘revolution’, or ‘ruler’ and ‘tyrant’ are normatively connotative in a way that scientific descriptions can easily avoid. Yet to write about the holocaust or slavery in a purposefully detached way misses the intensely personal character of these events and thus fails to communicate their genuine meaning, even if doing so detracts from their status as objective records in a way scientific history would disallow. Historians justifiably maintain “that minimal degree of moral or psychological evaluation which is necessarily involved in viewing human beings as creatures with purposes and motives (and not merely as causal factors in the procession of events)” (Berlin 1954, 52f). What precisely that minimal degree is, however, and how a working historian can navigate moral gray areas without falling back into inherited biases, remains difficult to account for.

Beard’s contentions about the possibility of objectivity led some philosophers of history to wonder whether the past was something that existed only in the mind of the historian, if, in other words, the past was constructed rather than discovered. For a constructivist like Leon Goldstein (1927-2002), this does not imply an ontological anti-realism wherein none but perceptible objects are considered real. For Goldstein, it would be senseless for historians to doubt that the world they study ever existed; constructivists are equally constrained by evidence as their objectivist counterparts. And for both the evidence with which the historian works concerns a genuinely past state of affairs outside their own minds. The meaningfulness of that evidence –what the evidence is evidence ‘of’— is, for the constructivist, only imbued by the mind of the historian who considers it. A Roman coin is a piece of evidence dating from a certain era and can provide evidence ‘of’ that era’s monetary policy and trade. But that coin is also evidence ‘of’ the natural environment of every single moment it was buried in the ground thereafter, providing evidence, if one were so interested, in the corrosive effects of the acidity levels near the banks of the Tiber. What that evidence is evidence ‘of’ depends upon the mind of the historian who utilizes it to construct a meaningful account in accord with her interests. Were the viewer of the coin wholly oblivious to either Rome or the natural environment, the coin would not cease to exist, of course; but it would cease to evidence either of these topics. In that sense at least, even non-postmodern Anglophone philosophers of history admit the necessarily interpretive and constructive aspects of historiography. Peter Novick (1934-) and Richard Evans (1947-) have recently taken up the limits of constructivism on behalf of professional historians.

How causes function within historical accounts was the third major question for 20th century Anglophone philosophers of history. Historians, like most people, tend to treat causal terms like ‘influenced’, ‘generated’, ‘brought about’, ‘led to’, ‘resulted in’, among others, as unproblematic diagnostics to explain how events come about. For philosophers generally and for philosophers of history specifically, causation presents a multifaceted set of problems. According to the positivist theory of explanation, an adequate causal account explicates the sum total of necessary and sufficient conditions for an event to take place. This ideal bar is acknowledged as having been set too high for practicing historians, since there is perhaps a near infinity of necessary causes for any historical event. That the assassination of Archduke Ferdinand was a cause of the First World War is clear; but necessary, too, was an indescribably myriad set of other economic, social, political, geographical, and even personal factors that led to such a wide-reaching and complex phenomenon to take place precisely as it did: had Gavrilo Princip not associated with the Young Bosnian movement, had gravity failed that day causing bullets to float harmlessly upward, had the Austro-Hungarian alliance not held the southern Slavic provinces, had Franz Ferdinand decided to stay at home on June 28th, 1914 – were any of these conditions actual, the course of history would have been altered. Thus, their contraries were necessary for having produced the exact outcome that obtained. Because it would be quite impossible, if not ridiculous, for an historian to attempt to record all of these, he must admit that his explanation fails to satisfy the positivist criterion and therefore remains only a partial one –an ‘explanation sketch’ in Hempel’s phrasing.

R.G. Collingwood was again influential in overturning the positivist view by distinguishing causes and motives. Physical causes such as properly working guns or the presence of gravity are necessary for assassination in a strictly physical sense. But no historian would bother mentioning them. Only motives, the reasons agents have for conducting their actions, are typically referenced: what motives Princip had for firing and what motives the leaders of Germany, France, and Russia had to mobilize their armies. A proper explanation, for Collingwood, involves making clear the reasons why the key actors participated in an event as they did.

While Collingwood’s theory is intuitively suggestive and matches rather well the character of most historical accounts, some philosophers have noted shortcomings. One is that Collingwood presumes a freedom of choice that relies upon an outmoded notion of cognitive agency. The same reasons that are purported to have been causally efficacious are often enough retrospective justifications supplied by agents who in reality acted without conscious deliberation. Second, even if freedom of choice is presumed, transparency about an agent’s motives cannot be. Collingwood often appeals to a particular motive as what a reasonable being would elect to do in a certain situation. Yet those standards of reasonability more often betray the historian’s own projection than anything psychologically demonstrable. The third is that, as historians themselves often note, many actions do not result from the motives of their agents but from the confluence of several motives whose outcome is unpredictable. The motive for Princip’s assassination was not to start a world-wide conflict anymore than Robert E. Lee’s capture of John Brown at Harper’s Ferry was intended to begin the American Civil War. Both actions were nevertheless crucial causes of consequences whose main actors could not have foreseen them, much less have willed.

Following the conception of causation in legal theory promulgated by H.L.A. Hart (1907-1992) and Tony Honoré (1921-), some philosophers consider a proper causal ascription in history to amount to a description of both intention and abnormality. Just as in legal cases, where conditions in history are normalized the abnormal or untypical decision or event is assigned responsibility for what results. In our example of the causes of WWI, the long history of constant political bickering between the great powers was of course part of the story, but the assassination of the Archduke is assigned responsibility since it stands so untypically out of its context.

The shift in thinking about historical causes as metaphysical entities which bring about change themselves to a set of epistemological grounds that explain why change occurred has led some recent philosophers to adopt David Lewis’s (1941-2001) notion of counterfactuals. “We think of a cause as something that makes a difference, and the difference it makes must be a difference from what would have happened without it. Had it been absent, its effects ─ some of them, at least, and usually all ─ would have been absent as well” (Lewis 1986, 161). Counterfactuals had long been employed by historians in the commonsense way that ascribes sufficient cause to that object or event whose consequence could not have happened without it, in the form ‘were it not for A, B never would have occurred’ or ‘No B without A’. To adapt our previous example, one might justifiably think the assassination of Archduke Ferdinand was the sufficient cause of WWI if and only if one thinks WWI would not have happened in its absence. Yet whereas counterfactuals are easily enough tested in science by running multiple experiments that control for the variable in question, the unrepeatability of historical events renders traditional counterfactual statements little more than interesting speculations. To ask how Rome would have developed had Caesar never crossed the Rubicon may be a fascinating thought experiment, but nothing remotely verifiable since a contrary-to-fact conditional is by definition unable to be tested given only one course of facts. Lewis would revise this traditional notion of counterfactuals to include the semantics of maximally similar possible worlds, wherein two worlds are supposed entirely identical save for one alteration which brings about the event in question. Under the previous description of the necessary conditions for WWI, Franz Ferdinand’s assassination was considered a necessary condition. Lewis’s revised version instead presents two maximally similar worlds, world ‘A’ where the assassination takes place and world ‘B’ which is identical in all respects except that the assassination does not take place. Under this model, it is at best debatable whether war would not have broken out anyway in world ‘B’ given the highly charged political atmosphere in Europe at that time. And as such we are invited to question whether assigning the assassination a causal role is justified.

9. Contemporary

Characterized by its criticism of the 20th century Anglophone attempts to epistemologically ground historical explanation, objectivity, and causation as universal functions of logic, the Postmodern legacy in philosophy of history has been taken up by three contemporary theorists in particular: Hayden White (1928-), Frank Ankersmit (1945-), and Keith Jenkins (1943-). Each maintains that the analysis of these epistemological issues wrongly circumvents questions about interpretation and meaning, and each considers the search for once-and-for-all demonstrations an attempt to avoid the relativistic character of historical truth. Hayden White inaugurated this ‘linguistic turn’ in historiography with his Meta-History: The Historical Imagination in Nineteenth-Century Europe (1979). By focusing on the structures and strategies of historical accounts, White came to see historiography and literature as fundamentally the same endeavor. Historians, like fiction writers, wrote according to a four-fold logic of emplotment, according to whether they saw their subject matter as a romance, tragedy comedy, or satire. This aim stems from their political ideology – anarchist, radical, conservative, or liberal respectively – and is worked out by means of a dominant rhetorical trope – metaphor, metonymy, synecdoche, or irony respectively. Representative philosophers – Nietzsche, Marx, Hegel, and Croce – and representative historians – Michelet, Tocqueville, Ranke, and Burckhardt – are themselves tied to these modes of emplotment. While White’s architectonic has come under criticism as being both overly reductive in its structure and a warrant for relativism, other theorists have taken up his banner.

Among these, Frank Ankersmit endorses the general outline of White’s narrativism, while stressing the constructivist aspect of our experience of the past. There is no ‘ideal narratio’ for Ankersmit, because ultimately there is no ontological structure onto which the single ‘correct’ narration can be correspondentially grafted. Alongside Gianni Vattimo (1936-), Sande Cohen (1946-), and Alan Munslow (1947-), Keith Jenkins takes White’s anti-realism in a decidedly deconstructionist fashion. Jenkins exhorts an end to historiography as customarily practiced. Since historians can never be wholly objective, and since historical judgment cannot pretend to a correspondential standard of truth, all that remains of history are the congealed power structures of a privileged class. In a statement that summarizes much of contemporary historical theory, Jenkins concludes the following:

[Historiography] now appears as a self-referential, problematic expression of ‘interests’, an ideologically-interpretive discourse without any ‘real’ access to the past as such; unable to engage in any dialogue with ‘reality’. In fact, ‘history’ now appears to be just one more ‘expression’ in a world of postmodern expressions: which of course is what it is. (Jenkins 1995, 9)

Although 21st century philosophy of history has widened the gap between practicing historians and theorists of history, and although it has lost some of the popularity it enjoyed from the early-19th to mid-20th century, it will remain a vigorous field of inquiry so long as the past itself continues to serve as a source of philosophical curiosity.

10. References and Further Reading

a. Classical Works in English Translation

  • Herodotus, Histories (c.450BCE-c.420BCE), translated by J. Marincola (London, 1996).
  • Thucydides, History of the Peloponnesian War (431BCE), translated by R. Warner (London, 1972).
  • Augustine of Hippo, The City of God (c. 422), translated by R.W. Dyson (Cambridge, 1998).
  • J. B. Bossuet, A Universal History (1681) (London, 1778).
  • G. Vico, The New Science (1725), translated by Bergin & Fisch (Ithaca, NY, 1948).
  • C. Montesquieu, The Spirit of the Laws (1748), translated by T. Nugent (London, 1902).
  • F.M.A. Voltaire, “Historiography” and “History” in his Philosophical Dictionary (1764), volume IV, translated by J. Morley (London, 1824).
  • J.G. Herder, Outlines of a Philosophy of the History of Man (1781), translated by T. Churchill (London, 1803).
  • I. Kant, “The Idea of a Universal Cosmo-Political History” (1784), translated by W. Hastie, in Eternal Peace and Other International Essays (Boston, 1914).
  • E. Burke, Reflections on the Revolution in France (1790) (London: 1940).
  • A.N. Condorcet, Sketch for a Historical Picture of the Progress of the Human Mind (1795), translated by J. Barraclough (London, 1955).
  • G.W.F. Hegel, Introduction to the Philosophy of History (1837), translated by L. Rauch (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 1988).
  • T. Carlyle, On Heroes, Hero-Worship, and the Heroic in History (1841), in The Works of Thomas Carlyle, edited by H. Traill (New York, 1896-1901).
  • J.S. Mill, A System of Logic (1843), in Collected Works, edited by J. Robson (Toronto, 1963-91).
  • A. Comte, The Positive Philosophy of Auguste Comte (1853), 2 vols., translated by H. Martineau (London, 1893).
  • H.T. Buckle, History of Civilization in England (1864), 3 vols. (London, 1899).
  • J. Burckhardt, Judgments on History and Historians (compiled from 1860’s-1880’s), translated by H. Zohn (Boston, 1958).
  • F. Nietzsche, On the Uses and Disadvantages of History for Life (1874), translated by P. Preuss (Indianapolis, 1980).
  • W. Dilthey, Introduction to the Human Sciences (1883), translated by Makkreel & Rodi (Princeton, 1991).
  • F. Nietzsche,  On the Genealogy of Morals (1887), translated by Clark & Swensen (Indianapolis, 1998).
  • W. Windelband, An Introduction to Philosophy (1895), translated by J. McCabe (London, 1921).
  • H. Rickert, Science and History: A Critique of Positivist Epistemology (1899), translated by G. Reisman (New York, 1962).
  • B. Croce, Theory and History of Historiography (1916), translated by D. Ainslie (London, 1921).
  • O. Spengler, The Decline of the West (1923), 2 vols., translated by C.F. Atkinson (New York, 1947).
  • M. Oakeshott, Experience and Its Modes (Cambridge, 1933).
  • A. Toynbee, A Study of History, 10 vols. (Oxford, 1934-54).
  • B. Croce, History as the Story of Liberty (1938), translated by S. Sprigge (London, 1941).
  • M. Mandelbaum, The Problem of Historical Knowledge (New York, 1938).
  • C. Hempel, “The Function of General Laws in History (1942),” in Theories of History, edited by P. Gardiner (New York/London, 1959), 344-356.
  • K. Popper, The Open Society and Its Enemies, 2 vols. (1945).
  • R. Collingwood, The Idea of History (Oxford, 1946).
  • K. Popper, The Poverty of Historicism (London, 1957).
  • B. Russell, Understanding History (New York, 1957).
  • K. Popper, The Logic of Scientific Discovery (New York, 1959).
  • H.G. Gadamer, Truth and Method (1960), translated by Weinsheimer & Marshall (New York, 1989).
  • E.H. Carr, What is History? (New York, 1961).
  • A. Danto, Analytical Philosophy of History (Cambridge, 1965).
  • C. Hempel, Aspects of Scientific Explanation (New York, 1965).
  • W. Dray, Philosophical Analysis and History (New York, 1966).
  • G. Elton, The Practice of History (London, 1969).
  • M. Foucault, The Archeology of Knowledge (New York, 1972).
  • H. White, Meta-history: The Historical Imagination in Nineteenth-century Europe (Baltimore, 1973).
  • E. Said, Orientalism (New York, 1978).
  • J.F. Lyotard, The Postmodern Condition: A Report on Knowledge (1979), translated by Bennington & Massumi (Minneapolis, 1984).
  • P. Ricoeur, Time and Narrative (1983-5), 3 vols., translated by McLaughlin & Pellauer (Chicago, 1984-8)
  • P. Novick, That Noble Dream: The ‘Objectivity Question’ and the American Historical Profession (Cambridge, 1988).
  • K. Jenkins, Re-Thinking History (London, 1991).
  • R. Evans, In Defense of History (London, 1999).
  • F. Ankersmit, Historiographical Representation (Stanford, 2001).

b. Prominent Scholarship and Collections

  • R. Aron, Introduction to the Philosophy of History, translated by G. Irwin (Westport, CT, 1976).
  • C. Bambach, Heidegger, Dilthey, and the Crisis of Historicism (Ithaca, NY, 1995).
  • C. Becker, Everyman his own Historian (New York, 1935).
  • I. Berlin, Historical Inevitability (New York, 1954).
  • I. Berlin, Vico and Herder: Two Studies in the History of Ideas (New York, 1976).
  • M. Bloch, The Historian’s Craft, translated by P. Putnam (New York, 1953).
  • E. Breisach, Historiography: Ancient, Medieval, and Modern (Chicago, 1983).
  • E. Breisach, On the Future of History: The Postmodernist Challenge and its Aftermath (Chicago, 2003).
  • J. Bury, The Idea of Progress (London, 1920).
  • D. Carr, Time, Narrative, and History (Bloomington, IN, 1986).
  • D. Chakrabarty, Provincializing Europe: Postcolonial Thought and Historical Difference (Princeton, NJ, 2000).
  • R. D’Amico, Historicism and Knowledge (New York, 1989).
  • W. Dray, Laws and Explanation in History (London, 1957).
  • W. Dray, Philosophy of History (Englewood Cliffs, NJ, 1964).
  • M. Dummett, Truth and the Past (New York, 2006).
  • E. Fryde, Humanism and Renaissance Historiography (London, 1983).
  • M. Fulbrook, Historical Theory (London, 2002).
  • P. Gardiner, The Nature of Historical Explanation (Oxford, 1952). (ed.) The Philosophy of History (Oxford, 1974).
  • C. Geertz, The Interpretation of Culture (New York, 1973).
  • L. Goldstein, Historical Knowing (Austin, TX, 1976).
  • L. Gossman,Basel in the Age of Burckhardt (Chicago, 2000).
  • L. Gossman, Between History and Literature (Cambridge, MA, 1990).
  • A. Grafton, The Footnote: A Curious History (London, 1997).
  • I. Hacking, Historical Ontology (Cambridge, MA, 1990).
  • E. Hobsbawm, On History (London, 1998).
  • G. Iggers, The German Conception of History (Hanover, NH, 1968).
  • G. Iggers, Historiography in the Twentieth Century (Middleton, CT, 1997).
  • K. Jenkins, On ‘What is History?’ (London, 1995). (ed.), The Postmodern History Reader (London, 1997).
  • H. Kellner, Language and Historical Representation (Madison, WI, 1989).
  • P. Kosso, Knowing the Past (Amherst, NY, 2001).
  • D. La Capra, History and Criticism (Ithaca, NY, 1985).
  • D. La Capra, Rethinking Intellectual History (Ithaca, NY, 1983).
  • K. H. Lembeck (ed.), Geschichtsphilosophie (Freiburg, 2000).
  • D. Lewis, Philosophical Papers: Volume II (Oxford, 1986).
  • K. Löwith, Meaning in History (Chicago, 1948).
  • G. Lukács, History and Class Consciousness: Studies in Marxist Dialectics, translated by R. Livingstone (Cambridge, MA, 1971).
  • K. Mannheim, Ideology and Utopia (London, 1936).
  • K. Marx & F. Engels, Karl Marx: Selected Writings in Sociology and Social Philosophy, edited by Bottomore & Rubel (London, 1956).
  • A. Marwick, The New Nature of History: Knowledge, Evidence, Language (London, 2001).
  • F. Meinecke, Historicism: The Rise of a New Historical Outlook, translated by J. Anderson (London, 1972).
  • L. Mink, Historical Understanding (Ithaca, NY, 1987).
  • A. Momigliano, The Classical Foundations of Modern Historiography (Berkeley, CA, 1990).
  • A. Munslow, The Routledge Companion to Historical Studies (London, 2000).
  • J. Patočka, Heretical Essays in the Philosophy of History, translated by E. Kohák (Chicago, 1996).
  • L. Pompa, Human Nature and Historical Knowledge (Cambridge, 1990).
  • H. Putnam, Reason, Truth, and History (Cambridge, 1981).
  • L.v. Ranke, The Theory and Practice of History, edited by Iggers & Moltke (Indianapolis, 1973).
  • G. Roberts, The History and Narrative Reader (London, 2001).
  • F. Rosenthal, History of Muslim Historiography (Leiden, 2nd Edition, 1968).
  • J. Rüsen, Grundzüge einer Historik (Göttingen, 1986).
  • B. Southgate, Postmodernism in History: Fear or Freedom? (London, 2003).
  • F. Stern (ed.), The Varieties of History: from Voltaire to the Present (London, 1970).
  • A. Tucker, Our Knowledge of the Past: A Philosophy of Historiography (Cambridge, 2004).
  • W. Walsh, An Introduction to Philosophy of History (New York, 1976).
  • W. Walsh, “‘Meaning’ in History,” in Theories of History, edited by P. Gardiner (New York/London, 1957), 296-307.
  • M. White, Foundations of Historical Knowledge (New York, 1965).
  • R. Young, White Mythologies: Writing History and the West (London, 1990).
  • J. Zammito, A Nice Derangement of Epistemes: Post-positivism in the Study of Science from Quine to Latour (Chicago, 2004).

 

Author Information

Anthony K. Jensen
Email: Anthony.jensen@lehman.cuny.edu
City University of New York / Lehman College
U. S. A.

Phenomenology and Natural Science

Phenomenology provides an excellent framework for a comprehensive understanding of the natural sciences. It treats inquiry first and foremost as a process of looking and discovering rather than assuming and deducing. In looking and discovering, an object always appears to a someone, either an individual or community; and the ways an object appears and the state of the individual or community to which it appears are correlated.

To use the simplest of examples involving ordinary perception, when I see a cup, I see it only through a single profile. Yet to perceive it as real rather than a hallucination or prop is to apprehend it as having other profiles that will show themselves as I walk around it, pick it up, and so forth. No act of perception – not even a God’s – can grasp all of a thing’s profiles at once. The real is always more than what we can perceive.

Phenomenology of science treats discovery as an instrumentally mediated form of perception. When researchers detect the existence of a new particle or asteroid, it assumes these will appear in other ways in other circumstances – and this can be confirmed or disconfirmed only by looking, in some suitably broad sense. It is obvious to scientists that electrons appear differently when addressed by different instrumentation (for example, wave-particle duality), and therefore that any conceptual grasp of the phenomenon involves instrumental mediation and anticipation. Not only is there no “view from nowhere” on such phenomena, but there is also no position from which we can zoom in on every available profile. There is no one privileged perception and the instrumentally mediated “positions” from which we perceive constantly change.

Phenomenology looks at science from various “focal lengths.” Close up, it looks at laboratory life; at attitudes, practices, and objects in the laboratory. It also pulls back the focus and looks at forms of mediation – how things like instruments, theories, laboratories, and various other practices mediate scientific perception. It can pull the focus back still further and look at how scientific research itself is contextualized, in an environment full of ethical and political motivations and power relations. Phenomenology has also made specific contributions to understanding relativity, quantum mechanics, and evolution.

Table of Contents

  1. Introduction
  2. Historical Overview
  3. Science and Perception
  4. General Implications
    1. The Priority of Meaning over Technique
    2. The Priority of the Practical over the Theoretical
    3. The priority of situation over abstract formalization
  5. Layers of Experience
    1. First Phase: Laboratory Life
    2. Second Phase: Forms of Mediation
    3. Third Phase: Contextualization of Research
  6. Phenomenology and Specific Sciences
    1. Relativity
    2. Quantum Mechanics
    3. Evolution
  7. Conclusion
  8. References and Further Reading

1. Introduction

Phenomenology provides an excellent starting point, perhaps the only adequate starting point, for a comprehensive understanding of the natural sciences: their existence, practices, methods, products, and cultural niches. The reason is that, for a phenomenologist, inquiry is first and foremost a question of looking and discovering rather than assuming and deducing. In looking and discovering, an object is always given to a someone – be it an individual or community – and the object and its manners of givenness are correlated. In the special terminology of phenomenology, this is the doctrine of intentionality (for example, see Cairns 1999). This doctrine has nothing to do with the distinction between “inner” and “outer” experiences, but is a simple fact of perception. To use the time-honored phenomenological example, even when I see an ordinary object such as a cup, I apprehend it only through a single appearance or profile. Yet for me to perceive it as a real object – rather than a hallucination or prop – I apprehend it as having other profiles that will show themselves as I walk around it, pick it up, and so forth, each profile flowing into the next in an orderly, systematic way. I do more than expect or deduce these profiles; the act of perceiving a cup contains anticipations of other acts in which the same object will be experienced in other ways. That’s what gives my experience of the world its depth and density. Perhaps I will discover that my original perception was misled, and my anticipations were mere assumptions; still, I discover this only through looking and discovering – through sampling other profiles. In science, too, when researchers propose the existence of a new particle or asteroid, such a proposal involves anticipations of that entity appearing in other ways in other circumstances, anticipations that can be confirmed or disconfirmed only by looking, in some suitably broad sense (Crease 1993). In ordinary perception, each appearance and profile (noema) is correlated with a particular position of the one who apprehends it (noesis); a change in either one (the cup turning, the person moving) affects the profile apprehended. This is called the noetic-noematic correlation. In science, the positioning of the observer is technologically mediated; what a particle or cell looks like depends in part on the state of instrumentation that mediates the observation.

Another core doctrine of phenomenology is the lifeworld (Crease 2011). Human beings, that is, engage the world in different ways. For instance, they seek wealth, fame, pleasure, companionship, happiness, or “the good”. They do this as children, adolescents, parents, merchants, athletes, teachers, and administrators. All these ways of being are modifications of a matrix of practical attachments that human beings have to the world that precedes any cognitive understanding. The lifeworld is the technical term phenomenologists have for this matrix. The lifeworld is the soil out of which grow various ways of being, including science. Understanding photosynthesis or quantum field theory, for instance, is only one – and very rare – way that human beings interact with plants or matter, and not the default setting. Humans have to be trained to see the world that way; they have to pay a special kind of attention and pursue a special kind of inquiry. Thus the subject-inquirer (again, whether individual or community) is always bound up with what is being inquired into by practical engagements that precede the inquiry, engagements that can be altered by and in the wake of the inquiry. It is terribly tempting for metaphysicians to “kick away the ladder of lived experience” from scientific ontology as a means to gain some sort of privileged access to the world that bypasses lifeworld experience, but this condemns science to being “empty fictions” (Vallor 2009).

The aim of phenomenology is to unearth invariants in noetic-noematic correlations, to make forms or structures of experience appear that are hidden in ordinary, unreflective life, or the natural attitude. Again, the parallel with scientific methodology is uncanny; scientific inquiry aims to find hidden forms or structures of the world by varying, repeating, or otherwise changing interventions into nature to see what remains the same throughout. Phenomenologists seek invariant structures at several different phases or levels – including that of the investigator, the laboratory, and the lifeworld – and can examine not only each phase or level, but the relation of each to the others. Over the last hundred years, this has generated a vast and diverse body of literature (Ginev 2006; Kockelmans & Kisiel 1970; Chasan 1992; Hardy and Embree 1992; McGuire and Tuchanska 2001; Gutting 2005).

2. Historical Overview

Phenomenology started out, in Husserl’s hands, well-positioned to develop an account of science. After all, Husserl was at the University of Göttingen during the years when David Hilbert, Felix Klein, and Emmy Noether were developing and extending the notion of invariance and group theory. Husserl not only had a deep appreciation for mathematics and natural science, but his approach was allied in many key respects with theirs, for he extended the notion of invariance to perception by viewing the experience of an object as of something that remains the same in the flux of changing sensory conditions produced by changing physical conditions. This may seem far-removed from the domain of mathematics but it is not. Klein’s Erlanger program viewed mathematical objects as not representable geometrically all at once but rather in definite and particular ways, depending on the planes on which they were projected; the mathematical object remained the same throughout different projections. In an analogous way, Husserl’s phenomenological program viewed a sensuously apprehended object as not given to an experiencing subject all at once but rather via a series of adumbrations or profiles, one at a time, that depend on the respective positioning of subject and object. The “same” object – even light of a certain wavelength – can look very different to human observers in different conditions. What is different about Husserl’s program, and may make it seem removed from the mathematical context, is that these profiles are not mathematical projections but lifeworld experiences. What remained to be added to the phenomenological approach to create a fuller framework for a natural philosophy of science was a notion of perceptual fulfillment under laboratory conditions, and of the theoretical planning and instrumental mediation leading to the observing of a scientific object. The “same” structure – for example, a cell – will look very different using microscopes of different magnification and quality, and phenomenology easily provides an account for this (Crease 2009).

Despite this promising beginning, many phenomenologists after Husserl turned away from the sciences, sometimes even displaying a certain paternalistic and superior attitude towards them as impoverished forms of revealing. This is unwarranted. Husserl’s objection to rationalistic science in the Crisis of the European Sciences was after all not to science but to the Galilean assumption that the ontology of nature could be provided by mathematics alone, bypassing the lifeworld (Gurwitsch 1966, Heelan 1987). And Heidegger’s objection, in Being and Time, most charitably considered, was not to theoretical knowledge, but to the forgetting of the fact that it is a founded mode in the lifeworld, to be interpreted not merely as an aid to disclosure but as a special and specialized mode of access to the real itself. Others to follow, including Gadamer and  Merleau-Ponty, for various reasons did not pursue the significance of phenomenology for natural science.

Science also lagged behind other areas of phenomenological inquiry for historical reasons. The dramatic success of Einstein’s theory of general relativity, in 1919, brought “a watershed for subsequent philosophy of science” that proved to be detrimental to the prospects of phenomenology for science (Ryckman 2005). Kant’s puzzling and ambiguous doctrine of the schematism – according to which intuitions, which are a product of sensibility, and categories, which are a product of understanding, are synthesized by rules or schemata to produce experience – had nurtured two very different approaches to the philosophy of science. One, taken by logical empiricists, rejected the schematism and treated sensibility and the understanding as independent, and the line between the intuitive and the conceptual as that between experienced physical objects and abstract mathematical frameworks. The empiricists saw these two as linked by rules of coordination that applied the latter to the former. Such coordination – the subjective contribution of mind to knowledge – produced objective knowledge. The other, more phenomenological route was to pursue the insight that experience is possible only thanks to the simultaneous co-working of intuitions and concepts. While some forms and categories are subject to replacement, producing a “relativized a priori” (my conception of things like electrons, cells, and simultaneity may change) such forms and categories make experience possible. Objective knowledge arises not by an arbitrary application of concepts to intuitions – it is not just a decision of consciousness – but is a function of the fulfillment of physical conditions of possible conscious experience; scientists look at photographic plates or information collected by detectors in laboriously prepared conditions that assure them that such information is meaningful and not noise. Husserl’s phenomenological approach to transcendental structures, though, must be contrasted with Kant’s, for while Kant’s transcendental concepts are deduced, Husserl’s are reflectively observed and described. However, following the stunning announcement of the success of general relativity in 1919, which seemed to destroy transcendental assumptions about at least the Euclidean form of space and about absolute time, logical empiricists were quick to claim it vindicated their approach and refuted not only Kant but all transcendental philosophy. “Through Einstein … the Kantian position is untenable,” Schlick declared, “and empiricist philosophy has gained one of its most brilliant triumphs.”  But the alleged vanquishing of transcendental philosophy and triumph of logical empiricism’s claims to understand science was due to “rhetoric and successful propaganda” rather than argument (Ryckman 2005). For as other transcendental philosophers such as Ernst Cassirer, and philosophically sophisticated scientists such as Hermann Weyl, realized, in making claims about the forms of possible phenomena general relativity called for what amounted to a revision, rather than a refutation, of Kant’s doctrine; how we may experience spatiality in ordinary life remains unaffected by Einstein’s theory. But the careers of both Cassirer and Weyl took them away from such questions, and nobody else took their place.

3. Science and Perception

One way of exhibiting the deep link between phenomenology and science is to note that phenomenology is concerned with the difference between local effects and global structures in perception. To use the time-honored example of perceiving a cup through a profile again: Grasping it under that particular adumbration or profile is a local effect, though what I intend is a global structure – the phenomenon – with multiple horizons of profiles. Phenomenology aims to exhibit how the phenomenon is constituted in describing these horizons of profiles. But this of course is closely related to the aim of science, which seeks to describe how phenomena (for example, electrons) appear differently in different contexts – and even, in the case of general relativity, incorporates a notion of invariance into the very notion of objectivity itself (Ryckman 2005). An objective state of affairs, that is, is one that has the same description regardless of whether the frame of reference from which it is observed is accelerating or not.

In science, however, perceiving (observing) is mediated by theory and instruments. Thanks to theories, the lawlike behavior of scientific phenomena (for example, how electrons behave in different conditions) is represented or “programmed” and then correlated with instrumental techniques and practices so that a phenomenon appears. The theory (for example, electromagnetism) thus structures both the performance process thanks to which the phenomenon appears, and the phenomenon itself. Read noetically, with respect to production, the theory is something to be performed; read noematically, with respect to the product, it describes the object appearing in performance. A theory does not correspond to a scientific phenomenon; rather, the phenomenon fulfills or does not fulfill the expectations of its observation raised by the theory. Is this an electron beam or not?  To decide that, its behavior has to be evaluated. Theory provides a language that the experimenter can use for describing or recognizing or identifying the profiles. For the theorist, the semantics of the language is mathematical; for the experimenter, the semantics are descriptive and the objects described are not mathematical objects but phenomena – bodily presences in the world. Thus the dual semantics of science (Heelan 1988); a scientific word (such as ‘electron’) can refer to both an abstract term in a theory and to a physical phenomenon in a laboratory. The difference is akin to that between a ‘C’ in a musical score and a ‘C’ heard in a concert hall. Conflating these two usages has confused many a philosopher of science. But our perception of the physical phenomenon in the laboratory has been mediated by the instruments used to produce and measure it (Ihde 1990).

By adding theoretical and experimental mediation to Husserl’s account of what is “constitutive” of perceptual horizons (Husserl 2001, from where the following quotations are taken except where noted), one generates a framework for a phenomenological account of science. To grasp a scientific object, like a perceptual object, as a presence in the world, as “objective,” means, strangely enough, to grasp it as never totally given, but as having an unbounded number of profiles that are not simultaneously grasped. Such an object is embedded in a system of “referential implications” available to us to explore over time. And it is rarely grasped with Cartesian clarity the first time around, but “calls out to us” and “pushes us” towards appearances not simultaneously given. A new property, for example parity violation, is detected in one area of particle physics – but if it shows up here it should also show up there even more intensely and dramatically. Entities, that is, show themselves as having further sides to be explored, and as amenable to better and better instrumentation. Phenomena even as it were call attention to their special features – strangeness in elementary particles, DNA in cells, gamma ray bursters amongst astronomical bodies – and recommends these features to us for further exploration. “There is a constant process of anticipation, of preunderstanding.”  With sufficient apprehension of sampled profiles, “The unfamiliar object is … transformed …into a familiar object.”  This involves development both of an inner horizon of profiles already apprehended, already sampled, and an external of not-yet apprehended profiles. But the object is never fully grasped in its complete presence, horizons remain, and the most one can hope for is for a thing to be given optimally in terms of the interests for which it is approached. And because theory and instruments are always changing, the same object will always be grasped with new profiles. Thus, Husserl’s phenomenological account readily handles the often vexing question in traditional philosophy of science of how “the same” experiment can be “repeated.”  It equally readily handles the even more troublesome puzzle in traditional approaches of how successive theories or practices can refer to the same object. For just as the same object can be apprehended “horizontally” in different instrumental contexts at the same time, it can also be apprehended “vertically” by successively more developed instrumentation. Husserl, for instance, refers to the “open horizon of conceivable improvement to be further pursued” (Husserl Crisis #9a). Newer, more advanced instruments will pick out the same entity (for example, an electron), yield new values for measurements of the same quantities, and open up new domains in which new phenomena will appear amid the ones that now appear on the threshold. Today’s discovery is tomorrow’s background.

The basic account of perception given above has been further elaborated in the context of group theory by Ernst Cassirer in a remarkable article (Cassirer 1944). Cassirer extends the attempts of Helmholtz, Poincaré and others to apply the mathematical concept of group to perception in a way that makes it suitable to the philosophy of science. Group theory may seem far from the perceptual world, Cassirer says. But the perceptual world, like the mathematical world, is structured; it possesses perceptual constancy in a way that cannot be reduced to “a mere mosaic, an aggregate of scattered sensations” but involve a certain kind of invariance. Perception is integrated into a total experience in which keeping track of “dissimilarity rather than similarity” is a hallmark of the same object. The cup is going to look different as the light changes and as I move about it. “As the particular changes its position in the context, it changes its “aspect.”  Thus, Cassirer writes, “the ‘possibility of the object’ depends upon the formation of certain invariants in the flux of sense-impressions, no matter whether these be invariants of perception or of geometrical thought, or of physical theory. The positing of something endowed with objective existence and nature depends on the formation of constants of the kinds mentioned …. The truth is that the search for constancy, the tendency toward certain invariants, constitutes a characteristic feature and immanent function of perception. This function is as much a condition of perception of objective existence as it is a condition of objective knowledge.”  The constitutive factor of objective knowledge, Cassirer concludes, “manifests itself in the possibility of forming invariants.”  Again, one needs to flesh out such an approach with account of fulfillment as mediated both theoretically and practically.

4. General Implications

The above, it will be seen, has three general implications for philosophy of science:

a. The Priority of Meaning over Technique.

In contrast to positivist-inspired and much mainstream philosophy of science, a phenomenological approach does not view science as pieced together at the outset from praxes, techniques, and methods. Praxes, techniques, and methods – as well as data and results – come into being by interpretation. The generation of meaning does not move from part to whole, but via a back-and-forth (hermeneutical) process in which phenomena are projected upon an already-existing framework of meaning, the assumptions of which are at least partially brought into question, and by this action further reviewed and refined within the ongoing process of interpretation. This process is amply illustrated by episode after episode in the history of science. Relativity theory evolved as a response to problems and developments experienced by scientists working within Newtonian theory.

b. The Priority of the Practical over the Theoretical

The framework of meaning mentioned above in terms of which phenomena are interpreted is not comprised merely of tools, texts, and ideas, but involves a culturally and historically determined engagement with the world which is prior to the subject and object separation. On the one hand, this means that the meanings generated by science are not ahistorical forms or natural kinds that have a transcendent origin. On the other hand, it means that these meanings are also not arbitrary or mere artifacts of discourse; science has a “historical space” in which meanings are realized or not realized. Results are right or wrong; theories are adjudicated as true or false. Later, as the historical space changes, the “same” theory (or more fully developed versions thereof) may be confirmed by different results inconsistent with previous confirmations of the earlier version. What a “cell” is may look very different depending on the techniques and instruments used to apprehend it, but what is happening is not a wholesale replacement of one picture or theory by another, but expanding and evolving knowledge (Crease 2009).

c. The Priority of the Practical over the Theoretical

Truth always involves a disclosure of something to someone in a particular cultural and historical context. Even scientific knowledge can never completely transcend these culturally and historically determined involvements, leaving them behind as if scientific knowledge consisted in abstractions viewed from nowhere in particular. The particularity of the phenomena disclosed by science is often disguised by the fact that they can show themselves in many different cultural and historical contexts if the laboratory conditions are right, giving rise to the illusion of disembodied knowledge.

5. Layers of Experience

These three implications suggest a way of ordering the kinds of contributions that a phenomenology can make to the philosophy of science. For there are several different phases – focal lengths, one might say – at which to set one’s phenomenology, and it is important to distinguish between them. The focal length can be trained within the laboratory on laboratory life, and investigate the attitudes, practices, and objects encountered in the laboratory. These, however, are nested in the laboratory environment and in the structure of scientific knowledge, which is their exterior expression. Another phase concerns the forms of mediation, both theoretical and instrumental, and how these contextualize the phase just mentioned of attitudes, practices, and objects, and how these are related to their exterior. This phase is nested in turn in another kind of environment, the lifeworld itself, with its ethical and political motivations and power relations. The contributions of phenomenology to the philosophy of science is first of all to describe these phases and how they are nested in each other, and then to describe and characterize each. A philosophical account of science cannot begin, nor is it complete, without a description of these phases.

a. First Phase: Laboratory Life

One phase has to do with specific attitudes, practices, or objects encountered by a researcher doing research in the laboratory environment – with the phenomenology of laboratory perception. Inquiry is one issue here. Conventional textbooks often treat the history of science as a sequence of beliefs about the state of the world, as if it were like a series of snapshots. This creates problems having to do with accounting for how these beliefs change, how they connect up, and what such change implies about continuity of science. It also rings artificial from the standpoint of laboratory practice. A phenomenological approach, by contrast, considers the path of science as rather like an evolving perception, as a continual process that cannot be neatly dissected into what’s in question and what not, what you believe and what you do not. Affects of research is another issue. The moment of experience involves more than knowledge, global or local, more than iterations and reiterations. Affects like wonder, astonishment, surprise, incredulity, fascination, and puzzlement are important to inquiry, in mobilizing the transformation of the discourse and our basic way of being related to a field of inquiry. They indicate to us the presence of something more than what’s formulated, yet also not arbitrary. When something unexpected happens, it is not a matter of drawing a conceptual blank. When something unexpected and puzzling happens in the lab, it involves a discomfort from running into something that you think you should understand and you do not. Taking that discomfort with you is essential to what transformations ensue. Other key issues of the phenomenology of laboratory experience include trust, communication, data, measurement, and experiment (Crease 1993). Experiment is an especially important topic. For there is nothing automatic about experimentation; experiments are first and foremost material events in the world. Events to not produce numbers – they do not measure themselves – but do so only when an action is planned, prepared, and witnessed. An experiment, therefore, has the character of a performance, and like all performances is a historically and culturally situated hermeneutical process. Scientific objects that appear in laboratory performances may have to be brought into focus, somewhat like the ship that Merleau-Ponty describes that has run aground on the shore, whose pieces are at first mixed confusingly with the background, filling us with a vague tension and unease, until our sight is abruptly recast and we see a ship, accompanied by release of the tension and unease (Crease 1998). In the laboratory, however, what is at first latent in the background and then recognized as an entity belongs to an actively structured process. We are staging what we are trying to recognize, and the way we are staging it may interfere with our recognition and the experiment may have to be restaged to bring the object into better focus.

b. Second Phase: Forms of Mediation

Second order features have to do with understanding the contextualization of the laboratory itself. For the laboratory is a special kind of environment. The laboratory is like a garden, walled off to a large extent from the wider and wilder surrounding environment outside. Special things are grown in it that may not appear in the outside world, but yet are related to them, and which help us understand the outside world. To some extent, the laboratory can be examined as the product or embodiment of forms discursive formations imposing power and unconditioned knowledge claims (Rouse 1987). But only to a limited extent. For the laboratory is not like an institution in which all practices are supposed to work in the same way without changing. It thus cannot be understood by studying discursive formations of power and knowledge exclusively; it is unlike a prison or military camp. A laboratory is a place designed to make it possible to stage performances that show themselves at times as disruptive of discourse, to explore such performances and make sure there really is a disruption, and then to foster creation of a new discourse.

c. Third Phase: Contextualization of Research

A third phase has to do with the contextualization of research itself, with approaches to the whole of the world, and with understanding why human beings have come to privilege certain kinds of inquiry over others. The lifeworld – a kind of horizon or atmosphere in which we think, pre-loaded with powerful metaphors and images and deeply embedded habits of thought – has its own character and changes over time. This character affects everyone in it, scientists and philosophers who think about science. The conditions of the lifeworld can, for instance, seduce us into thinking that only the measurable is the real. This is the kind of layer addressed by Husserl’s Crisis (Husserl 1970), Heidegger’s “The Question Concerning Technology,” (Heidegger 1977) and so forth. The distinction between the second and third phases thus parallels the distinction in sociology of science between micro-sociology and macro-sociology.

6. Phenomenology and Specific Sciences

Phenomenology has also been shown to contribute to understanding certain features or developments in contemporary theories which seem of particular significance for science itself, including relativity, quantum mechanics, and evolution.

a. Relativity

Ryckman (2005) highlights the role of phenomenology in understanding the structure and implications of general relativity and of certain other developments in contemporary physics. The key has to do with the role of general covariance, or the requirement that objects must be specified without any reference to a dynamical background space-time setting. Fields, that is, are not properties of space-time points or regions, they are those points and regions. The result of the requirement of general covariance is thus to remove the physical objectivity of space and time as independent of the mass and energy distribution that shapes the geometry of physical space and time. This, Ryckman writes, is arguably its “most philosophically significant aspect,” for it specifies “what is a possible object of fundamental physical theory.”  The point was digested by transcendental philosophers who could understand relativity. One was Cassirer, who saw that covariance could not be treated as a principle of coordination between intuitions and formalisms, and thus was not part of the “subjective” contribution to science, as Schlick and his follower Hans Reichenbach were doing. Rather, it amounted to a restriction on what was allowed as a possible object of field theory to begin with. The requirement of general covariance meant that relativity was about a universe in which objects did not flit about on a space-time stage, but were that stage. Ryckman’s book also demonstrates the role of phenomenology in Weyl’s classic treatment of relativity, and in his formulation of the gauge principle governing the identity of units of measurement. Phenomenology thus played an important role in the articulation of general relativity, and certain concepts central to modern physics.

b. Quantum Mechanics

Phenomenology may also contribute to explaining the famous disparity between the clarity and correctness of the theory and the obscurity and inaccuracy of the language used to speak about its meaning. In Quantum Mechanics and Objectivity (Heelan 1965) and other writings (Heelan 1975), Heelan applies phenomenological tools to this issue. His approach is partly Heideggerian and partly Husserlian. What is Heideggerian is the insistence on the moment prior to object-constitution, the self-aware context or horizon or world or open space in which something appears. The actual appear­ing (or phenomenon) to the self is a second moment. This Heelan analyses in a Husserlian way by studying the intentionality structure of object constitution and insisting on the duality therein of its (embodied subjective) noetic and (embodied objective) noematic poles. “The noetic aspect is an open field of connected scientific questions addressed by a self-aware situated researcher to empirical experience; the noematic aspect is the response obtained from the situated scientific experiment by the experiencing researcher. The totality of actual and possible answers constitutes a horizon of actual and possible objects of human knowledge and this we call a World.”  (Heelan 1965, x; also 3-4). The world then becomes the source of meaning of the word “real,” which is defined as what can appear as an object in the world. The ever-changing and always historical laboratory environment with all its ever-to-be-updated instrumentation and technologies belongs to the noetic pole; it is what makes the objects of science real by bringing them into the world in the act of measurement. Measure­ment involves “an interaction with a measuring instrument capable of yielding macroscopic sensible data, and a theory capable of explaining what it is that is measured and why the sensible data are observable symbols of it” (Heelan 1965, 30-1). The difference between quantum and classical physics does not lie in the intervention of the observer’s subjectivity but in the nature of the quantum object: “[W]hile in classical physics this is an idealised normative (and hence abstract) object, in quantum physics the object is an individual instance of its idealised norm” (Heelan 1965, xii). For while in classical physics deviations of variables from their ideal norms are treated independently in a statistically based theory of errors, the variations (statistical distribution) of quantum measurements are systematically linked in one formalism. The apparent puzzle raised by the “reduction of the wave packet” is thus explained via an account of measurement. In the “orthodox” interpretation, the wave function is taken to be the “true” reality, and the act of measurement is seen as changing the incoming wave packet into one of its component eigen functions by an anonymous random choice. The sensible outcome of this change is the eigenvalue of the outgoing wave function which is read from the measuring instrument. (An eigen function, very simply, is a function which has the property that, when an operation is performed on it, the result is that function multiplied by a constant, which is called the eigenvalue.) The agent of this transformation is the human spirit or mind as a doer of mathematics. Heelan also sees this process as depending on the conscious choice and participation of the scientist-subject, but through a much different process. The formulae relate, not to the ideal object in an absolute sense, apart from all human history, culture, and language, but to the physical situation in which the real object is placed, yielding a particular instance of an ensemble or system that admits of numerous potential experimental realizations. The reduction of the wave packet then “is nothing more than the expression of the scientist’s choice and implementation of a measuring process; the post-measurement outcome is different from the means used to prepare the pure state” prior to the implementation of the measurement (Heelan 1965, 184). The wave function describes a situation which is imperfectly described as a fact of the real world; it describes a field of possibilities. That does not mean there is more-to-be-discovered (“hidden variables”) which will make it a part of the real world, nor that only human participation is able to bring it into the real world, but that what becomes a fact of the real world does so by being fleshed out by an instrumental environment to one or another complementary presentations. Heelan’s work therefore shows the value of Continental approaches to the philosophy of science, and exposes the shortcomings of approaches to the philosophy of science which relegate such themes to “somewhere between mysticism and crossword puzzles” (Heelan 1965, x).

c. Evolution

One of the ­most significant discover­ies of 20th century phe­nomenology was of what is variously called em­bodiment, lived body, flesh, or animate form, the experiences of which are that of a unified, self-aware being, and which cannot be understood apart from reflection on con­crete human experience. The body is not a bridge that connects subject and world, but rather a primordial and unsurpassab­le unity productive of there being persons and worlds at all. Husserl was aware even of the significance of evolution and move­ment. His use of the expression “animate organism” betrays a recognition that he was discussing “something not exclusive to humans, that is, something broader and more funda­mental than human animate organism” (Sheets-Johnstone 1999, 132); thus, a need to discuss matters across the evolutionary spec­trum. Failing to examine our evolutionary heritage, in fact, means misconceiving the wellsprin­gs of our humanity (Sheets-Johnstone 1999). Biologists who developed phenomenological treatments of animal behavior include von Uxhull, to whom Heidegger refers in the section on animals in Fundamental Concepts of Metaphysics, and Adolph Portmann, both of whom discussed the animal’s umwelt. And Sheets-Johnstone has emphasized that phenome­nology needs to ­examine not only the ontogenet­ic dimension B infant behavior B but also the phylogenetic one. ­­­­­­If we treat human animate form as unique we shirk our phenomenologic­al duties and end up with incomplete and distorted accounts containing implicit and unexamined notions. “[G]enuine understandings of consciousness demand close and serious study of evolution as a history of animate form” (Sheets-Johnstone 1999, 42).

7. Conclusion

Developing a phenomenological account of science is important for the philosophy of science insofar as it has the potential to move us beyond a dead-end in which that discipline has entrapped itself. The dead-end involves having to choose between: on the one hand, assuming that a fixed, stable order pre-exists human beings that is uncovered or approximated in scientific activity; and on the other hand, assuming that the order is imposed by the outside. Each approach is threatened, though in different ways, by the prospect of having to incorporate a role for history and culture. Phenomenology is not as threatened, for its core doctrine of intentionality implies that parts are only understood against the background of wholes and objects against the background of their horizons, and that while we discover objects as invariants within horizons, we also discover ourselves as those worldly embodied presences to whom the objects appear. It thus provides an adequate philosophical foundation for reintroducing history and culture into the philosophy of the natural sciences.

8. References and Further Reading

  • Babich, Babette, 2010. “Early Continental Philosophy of Science,” in A. Schrift, ed., The History of Continental Philosophy, V. 3, Durham: Acumen, 263-286.
  • Cairns, Dorion, 1999. “The Theory of Intentionality in Husserl,” ed. by L. Embree, F. Kersten, and R. Zaner, Journal of the British Society for Phenomenology 32: 116-124.
  • Cassirer, E. 1944. “The Concept of Group and the Theory of Perception,” tr. A. Gurwitsch, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, pp. 1-35.
  • Chasan, S. 1992. “Bibliography of Phenomenological Philosophy of Natural Science,” in Hardy & Embree, 1992, pp. 265-290.
  • Crease, R. 1993. The Play of Nature. Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Crease, R. ed. 1997. Hermeneutics and the Natural Sciences. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
  • Crease, R. 1998. “What is an Artifact?”  Philosophy Today, SPEP Supplement, 160-168.
  • Crease, R. 2009. “Covariant Realism.”  Human Affairs 19, 223-232.
  • Crease, R. 2011. “Philosophy Rules.”  Physics World, August 2011.
  • Ginev, D. 2006. The Context of Constitution: Beyond the Edge of Epistemological Justification. Boston: Boston Studies in the Philosophy of Science.
  • Gurwitsch, A. 1966. “The Last Work of Husserl,” Studies in Phenomenology and Psychology, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1966, pp. 397-447.
  • Gutting, G. (ed.). 2005  Continental Philosophy of Science. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Hardy, L., and Embree, L., 1992. Phenomenology of Natural Science. Dordrecht: Kluwer.
  • Heelan, P. 1965. Quantum Mechanics and Objectivity. The Hague: Nijhoff.
  • Heelan, P. 1967. Horizon, Objectivity and Reality in the Physical Sciences. International Philosophical Quarterly 7, 375-412.
  • Heelan, P. 1969. The Role of Subjectivity in Natural Science, Proc. Amer. Cath. Philos. Assoc. Washington, D.C.
  • Heelan, P. 1970a. Quantum Logic and Classical Logic: Their Respective Roles, Synthese 21: 2 – 33.
  • Heelan, P. 1970b. Complementarity, Context-Dependence and Quantum Logic. Foundations of Physics 1, 95-110.
  • Heelan, P. 1972. Toward a new analysis of the pictorial space of Vincent van Gogh. Art Bull. 54, 478-492.
  • Heelan, P. 1975. Heisenberg and Radical Theoretical Change. Zeitschrift für allgemeine Wissenchaftstheorie 6, 113-136, and following page 136.
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Author Information

Robert P. Crease
Email: rcrease@notes.cc.sunysb.edu
Stony Brook University
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Technology

Like many domain-specific subfields of philosophy, such as philosophy of physics or philosophy of biology, philosophy of technology is a comparatively young field of investigation. It is generally thought to have emerged as a recognizable philosophical specialization in the second half of the 19th century, its origins often being located with the publication of Ernst Kapp’s book, Grundlinien einer Philosophie der Technik (Kapp, 1877). Philosophy of technology continues to be a field in the making and as such is characterized by the coexistence of a number of different approaches to (or, perhaps, styles of) doing philosophy. This highlights a problem for anyone aiming to give a brief but concise overview of the field because “philosophy of technology” does not name a clearly delimited academic domain of investigation that is characterized by a general agreement among investigators on what are the central topics, questions and aims, and who are the principal authors and positions. Instead, “philosophy of technology” denotes a considerable variety of philosophical endeavors that all in some way reflect on technology.

There is, then, an ongoing discussion among philosophers, scholars in science and technology studies, as well as engineers about what philosophy of technology is, what it is not, and what it could and should be. These questions will form the background against which the present article presents the field. Section 1 begins by sketching a brief history of philosophical reflection on technology from Greek Antiquity to the rise of contemporary philosophy of technology in the mid-19th to mid-20th century. This is followed by a discussion of the present state of affairs in the field (Section 2). In Section 3, the main approaches to philosophy of technology and the principal kinds of questions which philosophers of technology address are mapped out. Section 4 concludes by presenting two examples of current central discussions in the field.

Table of Contents

  1. A Brief History of Thinking about Technology
    1. Greek Antiquity: Plato and Aristotle
    2. From the Middle Ages to the Nineteenth Century: Francis Bacon
    3. The Twentieth Century: Martin Heidegger
  2. Philosophy of Technology: The State of the Field in the Early Twenty-First Century
  3. How Philosophy of Technology Can Be Done: The Principal Kinds of Questions That Philosophers of Technology Ask
  4. Two Exemplary Discussions
    1. What Is (the Nature of) Technology?
    2. Questions Regarding Biotechnology
  5. References and Further Reading

1. A Brief History of Thinking about Technology

The origin of philosophy of technology can be placed in the second half of the 19th century. But this does not mean that philosophers before the mid-19th century did not address questions that would today be thought of as belonging in the domain of philosophy of technology. This section will give the history of thinking about technology – focusing on a few key figures, namely Plato, Aristotle, Francis Bacon and Martin Heidegger.

a. Greek Antiquity: Plato and Aristotle

Philosophers in Greek antiquity already addressed questions related to the making of things. The terms “technique” and “technology” have their roots in the ancient Greek notion of “techne” (art, or craft-knowledge), that is, the body of knowledge associated with a particular practice of making (cf. Parry, 2008). Originally the term referred to a carpenter’s craft-knowledge about how to make objects from wood (Fischer, 2004: 11; Zoglauer, 2002: 11), but later it was extended to include all sorts of craftsmanship, such as the ship’s captain’s techne of piloting a ship, the musician’s techne of playing a particular kind of instrument, the farmer’s techne of working the land, the statesman’s techne of governing a state or polis, or the physician’s techne of healing patients (Nye, 2006: 7; Parry, 2008).

In classical Greek philosophy, reflection on the art of making involved both reflection on human action and metaphysical speculation about what the world was like. In the Timaeus, for example, Plato unfolded a cosmology in which the natural world was understood as having been made by a divine Demiurge, a creator who made the various things in the world by giving form to formless matter in accordance with the eternal Ideas. In this picture, the Demiurge’s work is similar to that of a craftsman who makes artifacts in accordance with design plans. (Indeed, the Greek word “Demiourgos” originally meant “public worker” in the sense of a skilled craftsman.) Conversely, according to Plato (Laws, Book X) what craftsmen do when making artifacts is to imitate nature’s craftsmanship – a view that was widely endorsed in ancient Greek philosophy and continued to play an important role in later stages of thinking about technology. On Plato’s view, then, natural objects and man-made objects come into being in similar ways, both being made by an agent according to pre-determined plans.

In Aristotle’s works this connection between human action and the state of affairs in the world is also found. For Aristotle, however, this connection did not consist in a metaphysical similarity in the ways in which natural and man-made objects come into being. Instead of drawing a metaphysical similarity between the two domains of objects, Aristotle pointed to a fundamental metaphysical difference between them while at the same time making epistemological connections between on the one hand different modes of knowing and on the other hand different domains of the world about which knowledge can be achieved. In the Physics (Book II, Chapter 1), Aristotle made a fundamental distinction between the domains of physis (the domain of natural things) and poiesis (the domain of non-natural things). The fundamental distinction between the two domains consisted in the kinds of principles of existence that were underlying the entities that existed in the two domains. The natural realm for Aristotle consisted of things that have the principles by which they come into being, remain in existence and “move” (in the senses of movement in space, of performing actions and of change) within themselves. A plant, for instance, comes into being and remains in existence by means of growth, metabolism and photosynthesis, processes that operate by themselves without the interference of an external agent. The realm of poiesis, in contrast, encompasses things of which the principles of existence and movement are external to them and can be attributed to an external agent – a wooden bed, for example, exists as a consequence of a carpenter’s action of making it and an owner’s action of maintaining it.

Here it needs to be kept in mind that on Aristotle’s worldview every entity by its nature was inclined to strive toward its proper place in the world. For example, unsupported material objects move downward, because that is the natural location for material objects. The movement of a falling stone could thus be interpreted as a consequence of the stone’s internal principles of existence, rather than as a result of the operation of a gravitational force external to the stone. On Aristotle’s worldview, contrary to our present-day worldview, it thus made perfect sense to think of all natural objects as being subject to their own internal principles of existence and in this respect being fundamentally distinct from artifacts that are subject to externally operating principles of existence (to be found in the agents that make an maintain them).

In the Nicomachean Ethics (Book VI, Chapters 3-7), Aristotle distinguished between five modes of knowing, or of achieving truth, that human beings are capable of. He began with two distinctions that apply to the human soul. First, the human soul possesses a rational part and a part that does not operate rationally. The non-rational part is shared with other animals (it encompasses the appetites, instincts, etc.), whereas the rational part is what makes us human – it is what makes man the animal rationale. The rational part of the soul in turn can be subdivided further into a scientific part and a deductive or ratiocinative part. The scientific part can achieve knowledge of those entities of which the principles of existence could not have been different from what they are; these are the entities in the natural domain of which the principles of existence are internal to them and thus could not have been different. The deductive or ratiocinative part can achieve knowledge of those entities of which the principles of existence could have been different; the external principles of existence of artifacts and other things in the non-natural domain could have been different in that, for example, the silver smith who made a particular silver bowl could have had a different purpose in mind than the purpose for which the bowl was actually made. The five modes of knowledge that humans are capable of – often denoted as virtues of thought – are faculties of the rational part of the soul and in part map onto the scientific part / deductive part dichotomy. They are what we today would call science or scientific knowledge (episteme), art or craft knowledge (techne), prudence or practical knowledge (phronesis), intellect or intuitive apprehension (nous) and wisdom (sophia). While episteme applies to the natural domain, techne and phronesis apply to the non-natural domain, phronesis applying to actions in general life and techne to the crafts. Nous and sophia, however, do not map onto these two domains: while nous yields knowledge of unproven (and not provable) first principles and hence forms the foundation of all knowledge, sophia is a state of perfection that can be reached with respect to knowledge in general, including techne.

Both Plato and Aristotle thus distinguished between techne and episteme as pertaining to different domains of the world, but also drew connections between the two. The reconstruction of the actual views of Plato and Aristotle, however, remains a matter of interpretation (see Parry, 2008). For example, while many authors interpret Aristotle as endorsing the widespread view of technology as consisting in the imitation of nature (for example, Zoglauer, 2002: 12), Schummer (2001) recently argued that for Aristotle this was not a characterization of technology or an explication of the nature of technology, but merely a description of how technological activities often (but not necessarily) take place. And indeed, it seems that in Aristotle’s account of the making of things the idea of man imitating nature is much less central than it is for Plato, when he draws a metaphysical similarity between the Demiurge’s work and the work of craftsmen.

b. From the Middle Ages to the Nineteenth Century: Francis Bacon

In the Middle Ages, the ancient dichotomy between the natural and artificial realms and the conception of craftsmanship as the imitation of nature continued to play a central role in understanding the world. On the one hand, the conception of craftsmanship as the imitation of nature became thought of as applying not only to what we would now call “technology” (that is, the mechanical arts), but also to art. Both were thought of as the same sort of endeavor. On the other hand, however, some authors began to consider craftsmanship as being more than merely the imitation of nature’s works, holding that in their craftsmanship humans were also capable of improving upon nature’s designs. This conception of technology led to an elevated appreciation of technical craftsmanship which, as the mere imitation of nature, used to be thought of as inferior to the higher arts in the Scholastic canon that was taught at medieval colleges. The philosopher and theologian Hugh of St. Victor (1096-1141), for example, in his Didascalicon compared the seven mechanical arts (weaving, instrument and armament making, nautical art and commerce, hunting, agriculture, healing, dramatic art) with the seven liberal arts (the trivium of grammar, rhetoric, and dialectic logic, and the quadrivium of astronomy, geometry, arithmetic, and music) and incorporated the mechanical arts together with the liberal arts into the corpus of knowledge that was to be taught (Whitney, 1990: 82ff.; Zoglauer, 2002: 13-16).

While the Middle Ages thus can be characterized by an elevated appreciation of the mechanical arts, with the transition into the Renaissance thinking about technology gained new momentum due to the many technical advances that were being made. A key figure at the end of the Renaissance is Francis Bacon (1561-1626), who was both an influential natural philosopher and an important English statesman (among other things, Bacon held the offices of Lord Keeper of the Great Seal and later Lord Chancellor). In his Novum Organum (1620), Bacon proposed a new, experiment-based method for the investigation of nature and emphasized the intrinsic connectedness of the investigation of nature and the construction of technical “works”. In his New Atlantis (written in 1623 and published posthumously in 1627), he presented a vision of a society in which natural philosophy and technology occupied a central position. In this context it should be noted that before the advent of science in its modern form the investigation of nature was conceived of as a philosophical project, that is, natural philosophy. Accordingly, Bacon did not distinguish between science and technology, as we do today, but saw technology as an integral part of natural philosophy and treated the carrying out of experiments and the construction of technological “works” on an equal footing. On his view, technical “works” were of the utmost practical importance for the improvement of the living conditions of people, but even more so as indications of the truth or falsity of our theories about the fundamental principles and causes in nature (see Novum Organum, Book I, aphorism 124).

New Atlantis is the fictional report of a traveler who arrives at an as yet unknown island state called Bensalem and informs the reader about the structure of its society. Rather than constituting a utopian vision of an ideal society, Bensalem’s society was modeled on the English society of Bacons” own times that had become increasingly industrialized and in which the need for technical innovations, new instruments and devices to help with the production of goods and the improvement of human life was clearly felt (compare Kogan-Bernstein, 1959). The utopian vision in New Atlantis only pertained to the organization of the practice of natural philosophy. Accordingly, Bacon spent much of New Atlantis describing the most important institution in the society of Bensalem, Salomon’s House, an institution devoted entirely to inquiry and technological innovation.

Bacon provided a long list of the various areas of knowledge, techniques, instruments and devices that Salomon’s House possesses, as well as descriptions of the way in which the House is organized and the different functions that its members fulfill. In his account of Salomon’s house Bacon’s unbridled optimism about technology can be seen: Salomon’s House appears to be in the possession of every possible (and impossible) technology that one could think of, including several that were only realized much later (such as flying machines and submarines) and some that are impossible to realize. (Salomon’s House even possesses several working perpetuum mobile machines, that is, machines that once they have been started up will remain in motion forever and are able to do work without consuming energy. Contemporary thermodynamics shows that such machines are impossible.) Repeatedly it is stated that Salomon’s House works for the benefit of Bensalem’s people and society: the members of the House, for example, regularly travel through the county to inform the people about new inventions, to warn them about upcoming catastrophic events, such as earthquakes and droughts the occurrence of which Salomon’s House is been able to forecast, and to advise them about how they could prepare themselves for these events.

While Bacon is often associated with the slogan “knowledge is power”, contrary to how the slogan is often understood today (where “power” is often taken to mean political power or power within society) what is meant is that knowledge of natural causes gives us power over nature that can be used for the benefit of mankind. This can be seen, for instance, from the way Bacon described the reasons of the Bensalemians for founding Salomon’s House: “The end of our foundation is the knowledge of causes, and secret motions of things; and the enlarging of the bounds of human empire to the effecting of all things possible.” Here, inquiry into “the knowledge of causes, and secret motions of things” and technological innovation by producing what is possible (“enlarging of the bounds of human empire to the effecting of all things possible”) are explicitly mentioned as the two principal goals of the most important institution in society. (It should also be noted that Bacon himself never formulated the slogan “knowledge is power”. Rather, in the section “Plan of the Work” in the Instauratio Magna he speaks of the twin aims of knowledge – Bacon’s term is ‘scientia” – and power – “Potentia” – as coinciding in the devising of new works because one can only have power over nature when one knows and follows nature’s causes. The connection between knowledge and power here is the same as in the description of the purpose of Salomon’s House.)

The improvement of life by means of natural philosophy and technology is a theme which pervades much of Bacons’ works, including the New Atlantis and his unfinished opus magnum, the Instauratio Magna. Bacon saw the Instauratio Magna, the “Great Renewal of the Sciences”, as the culmination of his life work on natural philosophy. It was to encompass six parts, presenting an overview and critical assessment of the knowledge about nature available at the time, a presentation of Bacon’s new method for investigating nature, a mapping of the blank spots in the corpus of available knowledge and numerous examples of how natural philosophy would progress when using Bacon’s new method. It was clear to Bacon that his work could only be the beginning of a new natural philosophy, to be pursued by later generations of natural philosophers, and that he would himself not be able to finish the project he started in the Instauratio. In fact, even the writing of the Instauratio proved a much too ambitious project for one man: Bacon only finished the second part, the Novum Organum, in which he presented his new method for the investigation of nature.

With respect to this new method, Bacon argued against the medieval tradition of building on the Aristotelian/Scholastic canon and other written sources as the sources of knowledge, proposing a view of knowledge gained from systematic empirical discovery instead. For Bacon, craftsmanship and technology played a threefold role in this context. First, knowledge was to be gained by means of observation and experimentation, so inquiry in natural philosophy heavily relied on the construction of instruments, devices and other works of craftsmanship to make empirical investigations possible. Second, as discussed above, natural philosophy should not be limited to the study of nature for knowledge’s sake but should also always inquire how newly gained knowledge could be used in practice to extend man’s power over nature to the benefit of society and its inhabitants (Kogan-Bernstein, 1959; Fischer, 1996: 284-287). And third, technological “works” served as the empirical foundations of knowledge about nature in that a successful “work” could count as an indication of the truth of the involved theories about the fundamental principles and causes in nature (see above).

While in many locations in his writings Bacon suggests that the “pure” investigation of nature and the construction of new “works” are of equal importance, he did prioritize technology. From the description that Bacon gives of how Salomon’s House is organized, for example, it is clear that the members of Salomon’s House also practice “pure” investigation of nature without much regard for its practical use. The “pure” investigation of nature seems to have its own place within the House and to be able to operate autonomously. Still, as a whole, the institution of Salomon’s House is decidedly practice-oriented, such that the relative freedom of inquiry in the end manifests itself within the confines of an environment in which practical applicability is what counts. Bacon draws the same picture in the Instauratio Magna, where he explicitly acknowledges the value of “pure” investigation while at the same time emphasizing that the true aims of natural philosophy (‘scientiae veros fines” – see towards the end of the Preface of the Instauratio Magna) concern its benefits and usefulness for human life.

c. The Twentieth Century: Martin Heidegger

Notwithstanding the fact that philosophers have been reflecting on technology-related matters ever since the beginning of Western philosophy, those pre-19th century philosophers who looked at aspects of technology did not do so with the aim of understanding technology as such. Rather, they examined technology in the context of more general philosophical projects aimed at clarifying traditional philosophical issues other than technology (Fischer, 1996: 309). It is probably safe to say that before the mid to late 19th century no philosopher considered himself as being a specialized philosopher of technology, or even as a general philosopher with an explicit concern for understanding the phenomenon of technology as such, and that no full-fledged philosophies of technology had yet been elaborated.

No doubt one reason for this is that before the mid to late 19th century technology had not yet become the tremendously powerful and ubiquitously manifest phenomenon that it would later become. The same holds with respect to science, for that matter: it is only after the investigation of nature stopped being thought of as a branch of philosophy – natural philosophy – and the contemporary notion of science emerged that philosophy of science as a field of investigation could emerge. (Note that the term “scientist”, as the name for a particular profession, was coined in the first half of the 19th century by the polymath and philosopher William Whewell – see Snyder, 2009.) Thus, by the end of the 19th century natural science in its present form had emerged from natural philosophy and technology had manifested itself as a phenomenon distinct from science. Accordingly, “until the twentieth century the phenomenon of technology remained a background phenomenon” (Ihde, 1991: 26) and the philosophy of technology “is primarily a twentieth-century development” (Ihde, 2009: 55).

While one reason for the emergence of the philosophy of technology in the 20th century is the rapid development of technology at the time, according to the German philosopher Martin Heidegger an important additional reason should be pointed out. According to Heidegger, not only did technology in the 20th century develop more rapidly than in previous times and by consequence became a more visible factor in everyday life, but also did the nature of technology itself at the same time undergo a profound change. The argument is found in a famous lecture that Heidegger gave in 1955, titled The Question of Technology (Heidegger, 1962), in which he inquired into the nature of technology. Note that although Heidegger actually talked about “Technik” (and his inquiry was into “das Wesen der Technik”; Heidegger, 1962: 5), the question he addressed is about technology. In German, “Technologie” (technology) is often used to denote modern “high-tech” technologies (such as biotechnology, nanotechnology, etc.), while “Technik” is both used to denote the older mechanical crafts and the modern established fields of engineering. (“Elektrotechnik”, for example, is electrical engineering.) As will be discussed in Section 2, philosophy of technology as an academic field arose in Germany in the form of philosophical reflection on “Technik”, not “Technologie”. While the difference between the two terms remains important in contemporary German philosophy of technology (see Section 4.a below), both “Technologie” and “Technik” are commonly translated as “technology” and what in German is called “Technikphilosophie” in English goes by the name of “philosophy of technology”.

On Heidegger’s view, one aspect of the nature of both older and contemporary technology is that technology is instrumental: technological objects (tools, windmills, machines, etc.) are means by which we can achieve particular ends. However, Heidegger argued, it is often overlooked that technology is more than just the devising of instruments for particular practical purposes. Technology, he argued, is also a way of knowing, a way of uncovering the hidden natures of things. In his often idiosyncratic terminology, he wrote that “Technology is a way of uncovering” (“Technik ist eine Weise des Entbergens”; Heidegger, 1962: 13), where “Entbergen” means “to uncover” in the sense of uncovering a hidden truth. (For example, Heidegger (1962: 11-12) connects his term “Entbergen” with the Greek term “aletheia”, the Latin “veritas” and the German “Wahrheit”.) Heidegger thus adopted a view of the nature of technology close to Aristotle’s position, who conceived of techne as one of five modes of knowing, as well as to Francis Bacon’s view, who considered technical works as indications of the truth or falsity of our theories about the fundamental principles and causes in nature.

The difference between older and contemporary technology, Heidegger went on to argue, consists in how this uncovering of truth takes place. According to Heidegger, older technology consisted in “Hervorbringen” (Heidegger, 1962: 11). Heidegger here plays with the dual meaning of the term: the German “Hervorbringen” means both “to make” (the making or production of things, material objects, sound effects, etc.) and “to bring to the fore”. Thus the German term can be used to characterize both the “making” aspect of technology and its aspect of being a way of knowing. While contemporary technology retains the “making” aspect of older technology, Heidegger argued that as a way of knowing it no longer can be understood as Hervorbringen (Heidegger, 1962: 14). In contrast to older technology, contemporary technology as a way of knowing consists in the challenging (“Herausfordern” in German) of both nature (by man) and man (by technology). The difference is that while older technologies had to submit to the standards set by nature (e.g., the work that an old windmill can do depends on how strongly the wind blows), contemporary technologies can themselves set the standards (for example, in modern river dams a steady supply of energy can be guaranteed by actively regulating the water flow). Contemporary technology can thus be used to challenge nature: “Heidegger understands technology as a particular manner of approaching reality, a dominating and controlling one in which reality can only appear as raw material to be manipulated” (Verbeek, 2005: 10). In addition, on Heidegger’s view contemporary technology challenges man to challenge nature in the sense that we are constantly being challenged to realize some of the hitherto unrealized potential offered by nature – that is, to devise new technologies that force nature in novel ways and in so doing uncover new truths about nature.

Thus, in the 20th century, according to Heidegger, technology as a way of knowing assumed a new nature. Older technology can be thought of as imitating nature, where the process of imitation is inseparably connected to the uncovering of the hidden nature of the natural entities that are being imitated. Contemporary technology, in contrast, places nature in the position of a supplier of resources and in this way places man in an epistemic position with respect to nature that differs from the epistemic relation of imitating nature. When we imitate nature, we examine entities and phenomena that already exist. But products of contemporary technology, such as the Hoover dam or a nuclear power plant, are not like already existing natural objects. On Heidegger’s view, they force nature to deliver energy (or another kind of resource) whenever we ask for it and therefore cannot be understood as objects made by man in a mode of imitating nature – nature, after all, cannot produce things that force herself to deliver resources in ways that man-made things can force her to do this. This means that there is a fundamental divide between older and contemporary technology, making the rise of philosophy of technology in the late 19th century and in the 20th century an event that occurred in parallel to a profound change in the nature of technology itself.

2. Philosophy of Technology: The State of the Field in the Early Twenty-First Century

In accordance with the preceding historical sketch, the history of philosophy of technology – as the history of philosophical thinking about issues concerned with the making of things, the use of techne, the challenging of nature and so forth – can be (very) roughly divided into three major periods.

The first period runs from Greek antiquity through the Middle Ages. In this period techne was conceived of as one among several kinds of human knowledge, namely the craft-knowledge that features in the domain of man-made objects and phenomena. Accordingly, philosophical attention for technology was part of the philosophical examination of human knowledge more generally. The second period runs roughly from the Renaissance through the Industrial Revolution and is characterized by an elevated appreciation for technology as an increasingly manifest but not yet all-pervasive phenomenon. Here we see a general interest in technology not only as a domain of knowledge but also as a domain of construction, that is, of the making of artifacts with a view on the improvement of human life (for instance, in Francis Bacon’s vision of natural philosophy). However, there is no particular philosophical interest yet in technology per se other than the issues that earlier philosophers had also considered. The third period is the contemporary period (from the mid 19th century to the present) in which technology had become such a ubiquitous and important factor in human lives and societies that it began to manifest itself as a subject sui generis of philosophical reflection. Of course, this is only a very rough periodization and different ways of periodizing the history of philosophy of technology can be found in the literature – e.g., Wartofsky (1979), Feenberg (2003: 2-3) or Franssen and others (2009: Sec. 1). Moreover, this periodization applies only to Western philosophy. To be sure, there is much to be said about technology and thinking about technology in technologically advanced ancient civilizations in China, Persia, Egypt, etc., but this cannot be done within the confines of the present article. Still, the periodization proposed above is a useful first-order subdivision of the history of thinking about technology as it highlights important changes in how technology was and is understood.

The first monograph on philosophy of technology appeared in Germany in the second half of the 19th century in the form of Ernst Kapp’s book, Grundlinien einer Philosophie der Technik (“Foundations of a Philosophy of Engineering”) (Kapp, 1877). This book is commonly seen as the origin of the field (Rapp, 1981: 4; Ferré, 1988: 10; Fischer, 1996: 309; Zoglauer, 2002: 9; De Vries, 2005: 68; Ropohl, 2009: 13), because the term “philosophy of technology” (or rather, “philosophy of technics”) was first introduced there. Kapp used it to denote the philosophical inquiry into the effects of the use of technology on human society. (Mitcham (1994: 20), however, mentions the Scottish chemical engineer Andrew Ure as a precursor to Kapp in this context. Apparently in 1835 Ure coined the phrase “philosophy of manufactures” in a treatise on philosophical issues concerning technology.) For several decades after the publication of Kapp’s work not much philosophical work focusing on technology appeared in print and the field didn”t really get going until well into the 20th century. Again, the main publications appeared in Germany (for example, Dessauer, 1927; Jaspers, 1931; Diesel, 1939).

It should be noted that if philosophy of technology as an academic field indeed started here, the field’s origins lie outside professionalized philosophy. Jaspers was a philosopher, but neither Kapp nor most of the other early authors on the topic were professional philosophers. Kapp, for example, had earned a doctorate in classical philology and spent much of his life as a schoolteacher of geography and history and as an independent writer and untenured university lecturer (a German “Privatdozent”). Dessauer was an engineer (and an advocate of an unconditionally optimistic view of technology), Ure a chemical engineer and Diesel (son of the inventor of the Diesel engine, Rudolf Diesel) an independent writer.

In his book, Kapp argued that technological artifacts should be thought of as man-made imitations and improvements of human organs (see Brey, 2000; De Vries, 2005). The underlying idea is that human beings have limited capacities: we have limited visual powers, limited muscular strength, limited resources for storing information, etc. These limitations have led human beings to attempt to improve their natural capacities by means of artifacts such as cranes, lenses, etc. On Kapp’s view, such improvements should not so much be thought of as extensions or supplements of natural human organs, but rather as their replacements (Brey, 2000: 62). Because technological artifacts are supposed to serve as replacements of natural organs, they must on Kapp’s view be devised as imitations of these organs – after all, they are intended to perform the same function – or at least as being modeled on natural organs: ‘since the organ whose utility and power is to be increased is the standard, the appropriate form of a tool can only be derived from that organ” (Kapp, quoted and translated by Brey, 2000: 62). This way of understanding technology, which echoes the view of technology as the imitation of nature by men that was already found with Plato and Aristotle, was dominant throughout the Middle Ages and continued to be endorsed later.

The period after World War II saw a sharp increase in the amount of published reflections on technology that, for obvious reasons given the role of technology in both World Wars, often expressed a deeply critical and pessimistic view of the influence of technology on human societies, human values and the human life-world in general. Because of this increase in the amount of reflection on technology after World War II, some authors locate the emergence of the field in that period rather than in the late 19th century (for example Ihde, 1993: 14-15, 32-33; Dusek, 2006: 1-2; Kroes and others, 2008: 1). Ihde (1993: 32) points to an additional reason to locate the beginning of the field in the period following World War II: historians of technology rate World War II as the technologically most innovative period in human history until then, as during that war many new technologies were introduced that continued to drive technological innovation as well as the associated reflection on such innovation for several decades to follow. Thus, from this perspective it was World War II and the following period in which technology reached the level of prominence in the early 21st century and, accordingly, became a focal topic for philosophy. It became “a force too important to overlook”, as Ihde (1993: 32) writes.

A still different picture is obtained if one takes the existence of specialized professional societies, dedicated academic journals, topic-specific textbooks as well as a specific name identifying the field as typical signs that a particular field of investigation has become established as a branch of academia. (Note that in his influential The Structure of Scientific Revolutions, historian and philosopher of science Thomas Kuhns mentions these as signs of the establishment of a new paradigm, albeit not a new field or discipline – see Kuhn, 1970: 19.) By these indications, the process of establishing philosophy of technology as an academic field has only begun in the late 1970s and early 1980s – as Ihde (1993: 45) writes, “from the 1970s on, philosophy of technology began to take its place alongside the other “philosophies of …”” – and continued into the early 21st century.

As Mitcham (1994: 33) remarks, the term “philosophy of technology” was not widely used outside Germany until the 1980s (where the German term is “Technikphilosophie” or “Philosophie der Technik” rather than “philosophy of technology”). In 1976, the Society for the Philosophy of Technology was founded as the first professional society in the field. In the 1980s introductory textbooks on philosophy of technology began to appear. One of the very first (Ferré, 1988) appeared in the famous Prentice Hall Foundations of Philosophy series that included several hallmark introductory texts in philosophy (such as Carl Hempel’s Philosophy of Natural Science, David Hull’s Philosophy of Biological Science, William Frankena’s Ethics and Wesley Salmon’s Logic). In recent years numerous introductory texts have become available, including Ihde (1993), Mitcham (1994), Pitt (2000), Bucciarelli (2003), Fischer (2004), De Vries (2005), Dusek (2006), Irrgang (2008) and Nordmann (2008). Anthologies of classic texts in the field and encyclopedias of philosophy of technology have only very recently begun to appear (e.g., Scharff & Dusek, 2003; Kaplan, 2004; Meijers, 2009; Olsen, Pedersen & Hendricks, 2009; Olsen, Selinger, & Riis, 2009). However, there were few academic journals in the early 21st century dedicated specifically to philosophy of technology and covering the entire range of themes in the field.

”Philosophy of technology” denotes a considerable variety of philosophical endeavors. There is an ongoing discussion among philosophers of technology and scholars in related fields (e.g., science and technology studies, and engineering) on how philosophy of technology should be conceived of. One would expect to find a clear answer to this question in the available introductory texts, along with a general of agreement on the central themes and questions of the field, as well as on who are its most important authors and which the fundamental positions, theories, theses and approaches. In the case of philosophy of technology, however, comparing recent textbooks reveals a striking lack of consensus about what kind of endeavor philosophy of technology is. According to some authors, the sole commonality of the various endeavors called “philosophy of technology” is that they all in some way or other reflect on technology (cf. Rapp, 1981: 19-22; 1989: ix; Ihde, 1993: 97-98; Nordmann, 2008: 10).

For example, Nordmann characterized philosophy of technology as follows: “Not only is it a field of work without a tradition, it is foremost a field without its own guiding questions. In the end, philosophy of technology is the whole of philosophy done over again from the start – only this time with consideration for technology” (2008: 10; Reydon’s translation). Nordmann (2008: 14) added that the job of philosophy of technology is not to deal philosophically with a particular subject domain called “technology” (or “Technik” in German). Rather, its job is to deal with all the traditional questions of philosophy, relating them to technology. Such a characterization of the field, however, seems impracticably broad because it causes the name “philosophy of technology” to lose much of its meaning. On Nordmann’s broad characterization it seems meaningless to talk of “philosophy of technology”, as there is no clearly recognizable subfield of philosophy for the name to refer to. All of philosophy would be philosophy of technology, as long as some attention is paid to technology.

A similar, albeit apparently somewhat stricter, characterization of the field was given by Ferré (1988: ix, 9), who suggested that philosophy of technology is ‘simply philosophy dealing with a special area of interest”, namely technology. According to Ferré, the various “philosophies of” (of science, of biology, of physics, of language, of technology, etc.) should be conceived of as philosophy in the broad sense, with all its traditional questions and methods, but now “turned with a special interest toward discovering how those fundamental questions and methods relate to a particular segment of human concern” (Ferré, 1988: 9). The question arises what this “particular segment of human concern” called “technology” is. But first, the kinds of questions philosophers of technology ask with respect to technology must be explicated.

3. How Philosophy of Technology Can Be Done: The Principal Kinds of Questions That Philosophers of Technology Ask

Philosopher of technology Don Ihde defines philosophy of technology as philosophy that examines the phenomenon of technology per se, rather than merely considering technology in the context of reflections aimed at philosophical issues other than technology. (Note the opposition to Nordmann’s view, mentioned above.) That is, philosophy of technology “must make technology a foreground phenomenon and be able to reflectively analyze it in such a way as to illuminate features of the phenomenon of technology itself” (Ihde, 1993: 38; original emphasis).

However, there are a number of different ways in which one can approach the project of illuminating characteristic features of the phenomenon of technology. While different authors have presented different views of what philosophy of technology is about, there is no generally agreed upon taxonomy of the various approaches to (or traditions in, or styles of doing) philosophy of technology. In this section, a number of approaches that have been distinguished in the recent literature are discussed with the aim of providing an overview of the various kinds of questions that philosophers ask with respect to technology.

In an early review of the state of the field, philosopher of science Marx W. Wartofsky distinguished four main approaches to philosophy of technology (Wartofsky, 1979: 177-178). First, there is the holistic approach that sees technology as one of the phenomena generally found in human societies (on a par with phenomena such as art, war, politics, etc.) and attempts to characterize the nature of this phenomenon. The philosophical question in focus here is: What is technology? Second, Wartofsky distinguished the particularistic approach that addresses specific philosophical questions that arise with respect to particular episodes in the history of technology. Relevant questions are: Why did a particular technology gain or lose prominence in a particular period? Why did the general attitude towards technology change at a particular time? And so forth. Third is the developmental approach that aims at explaining the general process of technological change and as such has a historical focus too. And fourth, there is the social-critical approach that conceives of technology as a social/cultural phenomenon, that is a product of social conventions, ideologies, etc. In this approach, technology is seen as a product of human actions that should be critically assessed (rather than characterized, as in the holistic approach). Besides critical reflection on technology, a central question here is how technology has come to be what it is today and which social factors have been important in shaping it. The four approaches as distinguished by Wartofsky clearly are not mutually exclusive: while different approaches address similar and related questions, the difference between them is a matter of emphasis.

A similar taxonomy of approaches is found with Friedrich Rapp, an early proponent of analytic philosophy of technology (see also below). For Rapp, the principal dichotomy is between holistic and particularistic approaches, that is, approaches that conceive of technology as a single phenomenon the nature of which philosophers should clarify vs. approaches that see “technology” as an umbrella term for a number of distinct historical and social phenomena that are related to one another in complex ways and accordingly should each be examined in relation to the other relevant phenomena (Rapp, 1989: xi-xii). Rapp’s own philosophy of technology stands in the latter line of work. Within this dichotomy, Rapp (1981: 4-19) distinguished four main approaches, each reflecting on a different aspect of technology: on the practice of invention and engineering, on technology as a cultural phenomenon, on the social impact of technology, and on the impact of technology on the physical/biological system of planet Earth. While it is not entirely clear how Rapp conceives of the relation between these four approaches and his holistic/particularistic dichotomy, it seems that holism and particularism can generally be understood as modes of doing philosophy that can be realized within each of the four approaches.

Gernot Böhme (2008: 23-32) also distinguished between four main paradigms of contemporary philosophy of technology: the ontological paradigm, the anthropological paradigm, the historical-philosophical paradigm and the epistemological paradigm. The ontological paradigm, according to Böhme, inquires into the nature of artifacts and other technical entities. It basically consists in a philosophy of technology that parallels philosophy of nature, but focuses on the Aristotelian domain of poiesis instead of the domain of physis (see Section 1.a. above). The anthropological paradigm asks one of the traditional questions of philosophy – What is man? – and approaches this question by way of an examination of technology as a product of human action. The historical-philosophical paradigm examines the various manifestations of technology throughout human history and aims to clarify what characterizes the nature of technology in different periods. In this respect, it is closely related to the anthropological paradigm and individual philosophers can work in both paradigms simultaneously. Böhme (2008: 26), for example, lists Ernst Kapp as a representative of both the anthropological and historical-philosophical paradigms. Finally, the epistemological paradigm inquires into technology as a form of knowledge in the sense in which Aristotle did (See Sec. 1.a. above). Böhme (2008: 23) observed that despite the factual existence of philosophy of technology as an academic field, as yet there is no paradigm that dominates the field.

Carl Mitcham (1994) made a fundamental distinction between two principal subdomains of philosophy of technology, which he called “engineering philosophy of technology” and “humanities philosophy of technology”. Engineering philosophy of technology is the philosophical project aimed at understanding the phenomenon of technology as instantiated in the practices of engineers and others working in technological professions. It analyzes “technology from within, and [is] oriented toward an understanding of the technological way of being-in-the-world” (Mitcham, 1994: 39). As representatives of engineering philosophy of technology Mitcham lists, among others, Ernst Kapp and Friedrich Dessauer. Humanities philosophy of technology, on the other hand, consists of more general philosophical projects in which technology per se is not principal subject of concern. Rather, technology is taken as a case study that might lead to new insights into a variety of philosophical questions by examining how technology affects human life.

The above discussion shows how different philosophers have quite different views of how the field of philosophy of technology is structured and what kinds of questions are in focus in the field. Still, on the basis of the preceding discussion a taxonomy can be constructed of three principal ways of conceiving of philosophy of technology:

(1) philosophy of technology as the systematic clarification of the nature of technology as an element and product of human culture (Wartofsky’s holistic and developmental approaches; Rapp’s cultural approach; Böhme’s ontological, anthropological and historical paradigms; and Mitcham’s engineering approach);

(2) philosophy of technology as the systematic reflection on the consequences of technology for human life (Wartofsky’s particularistic and social/critical approaches; Rapp’s social impact and physical impact approaches; and Mitcham’s humanities approach);

(3) philosophy of technology as the systematic investigation of the practices of engineering, invention, designing and making of things (Wartofsky’s particularistic approach; Rapp’s invention approach; Böhme’s epistemological paradigm; and Mitcham’s engineering approach).

All three approaches are represented in present-day thinking about technology and are illustrated below.

(1) The systematic clarification of the nature of technology. Perhaps most philosophy of technology has been done – and continues to be done – in the form of reflection on the nature of technology as a cultural phenomenon. As clarifying the nature of things is a traditional philosophical endeavor, many prominent representatives of this approach are philosophers who do not consider themselves philosophers of technology in the first place. Rather, they are general philosophers who look at technology as one among the many products of human culture, such as the German philosophers Karl Jaspers (e.g., his book Die geistige Situation der Zeit; Jaspers, 1931), Oswald Spengler (Der Mensch und die Technik; Spengler, 1931), Ernst Cassirer (e.g., his Symbol, Technik, Sprache; Cassirer, 1985), Martin Heidegger (Heidegger, 1962; discussed above), Jürgen Habermas (for example with his Technik und Wissenschaft als “Ideologie”; Habermas, 1968) and Bernhard Irrgang (2008). The Spanish philosopher José Ortega y Gasset is also often counted among the prominent representatives of this line of work.

(2) Systematic reflection on the consequences of technology for human life. Related to the conception of technology as a human cultural product is the approach to philosophy of technology that reflects on and criticizes the social and environmental impact of technology. As an examination of how technology affects society, this approach lies at the intersection of philosophy and sociology, rather than lying squarely within philosophy itself. Prominent representatives thus include the German philosopher/sociologists of the Frankfurt School (Herbert Marcuse, Theodor W. Adorno and Max Horkheimer), Jürgen Habermas, the French sociologist Jacques Ellul (1954), or the American political theorist Langdon Winner (1977).

A central question in contemporary versions of this approach is whether technology controls us or we are able to control technology (Feenberg, 2003: 6; Dusek, 2006: 84-111; Nye, 2006: Chapter 2). Langdon Winner, for example, thought of technology as an autonomously developing phenomenon fundamentally out of human control. As Dusek (2006: 84) points out, this issue is in fact a constellation of two separate questions: Are the societies that we live in, and we ourselves in our everyday lives, determined by technology? And are we able to control or guide the development of technology and the application of technological inventions, or does technology have a life of its own? As it might be that while our lives are not determined by technology we still are not able to control the development and application of technology, these are separate, albeit intimately related issues. The challenge for philosophy of technology, then, is to assess the effects of technology on our societies and our lives, to explore possibilities for us to exert influence on the current applications and future development of technology, and to devise concepts and institutions that might enable democratic control over the role of technology in our lives and societies.

(3) The systematic investigation of the practices of engineering, invention, designing and making of things. The third principal approach to philosophy of technology examines concrete technological practices, such as invention, design and engineering. Early representatives of this approach include Ernst Kapp (1877), Friedrich Dessauer (1927; 1956) and Eugen Diesel (1939). The practical orientation of this approach, as well as its comparative distance from traditional issues in philosophy, is reflected in the fact that none of these three early philosophers of technology were professional philosophers (see Section 2).

A guiding idea in this approach to philosophy of technology is that the design process constitutes the core of technology (Franssen and others, 2009: Sec. 2.3), such that studying the design process is crucial to any project that attempts to understand technology. Thus, philosophers working in this approach often examine design practices, both in the strict context of engineering and in wider contexts such as architecture and industrial design (for example, Vermaas and others, 2008). In focus are epistemological and methodological questions, such as: What kinds of knowledge do engineers have? (for example, Vincenti, 1990; Pitt, 2000; Bucciarelli, 2003; Auyang, 2009; Houkes, 2009). Is there a kind of knowledge that is specific to engineering? What is the nature of the engineering process and the design process? (for example, Vermaas and others, 2008). What is design? (for example, Houkes, 2008). Is there a specific design/engineering methodology? How do reasoning and decision processes in engineering function? How do engineers deal with uncertainty, failure and error margins? (for example, Bucciarelli, 2003: Chapter 3). Is there any such thing as a technological explanation? If so, what is the structure of technological explanations? (for example, Pitt, 2000: Chapter 4; Pitt, 2009). What is the relation between science and technology and in what way are design processes similar to and different from investigative processes in natural science? (for example, Bunge, 1966).

This approach to philosophy of technology is closely related to philosophy of science, where also much attention is given to methodology and epistemology. This can be seen from the fact that central questions from philosophy of science parallel some of the aforementioned questions: What is scientific knowledge? Is there a specific scientific method, or perhaps a clearly delimited set of such methods? How does scientific reasoning work? What is the structure of scientific explanations? Etc. However, there still seems to be comparatively little attention for such questions among philosophers of technology. Philosopher of technology Joseph Pitt, for example, observed that notwithstanding the parallel with respect to questions that can be asked about technology “there is a startling lack of symmetry with respect to the kinds of questions that have been asked about science and the kinds of questions that have been asked about technology” (2000: 26; emphasis added). According to Pitt, philosophers of technology have largely ignored epistemological and methodological questions about technology and have instead focused overly on issues related to technology and society. But, Pitt pointed out, social criticism “can come only after we have a deeper understanding of the epistemological dimension of technology (Pitt, 2000: 27) and “policy decisions require prior assessment of the knowledge claims, which require good theories of what knowledge is and how to assess it” (ibid.). Thus, philosophers of technology should orient themselves anew with respect to the questions they ask.

But there are more parallels between the philosophies of technology and science. An important endeavor in philosophy of science that is also seen as central in philosophy of technology is conceptual analysis. In the case of philosophy of technology, this involves both concepts related to technology and engineering in general (concepts such as “technology”, “technics”, “technique”, “machine”, “mechanism”, “artifact”, “artifact kind”, “information”, ‘system”, “efficiency”, “risk”, etc.; see also Wartofsky, 1979: 179) and concepts that are specific for the various engineering disciplines. In addition, in both philosophy of science and philosophy of technology a renewed interest in metaphysical issues can currently be seen. For example, while philosophers of science inquire into the nature of the natural kinds that the sciences study, philosophers of technology are developing a parallel interest into the metaphysics of artifacts and kinds of artifacts (e.g., Houkes & Vermaas, 2004; Margolis & Laurence, 2007; Franssen, 2008). And lastly, philosophers of technology and philosophers of particular special sciences are increasingly beginning to cooperate on questions that are of crucial interest to both fields; a recent example is Krohs & Kroes (2009) on the notion of function in biology and technology.

A difference between the states of affairs in philosophy of science and in philosophy of technology, however, lies in the relative dominance of continental and analytic approaches. While there is some continental philosophy of science (e.g., Gutting, 2005), it constitutes a small minority in the field in comparison to analytic philosophy of science. In contrast, continental-style philosophy of technology is a domain of considerable size, while analytic-style philosophy of technology is small in comparison. Analytic philosophy of technology has existed since the 1960s and only began the process of becoming the dominant form of philosophy of technology in the early 21st century (Franssen and others, 2009: Sec. 1.3.). Kroes and others (2008: 2) even speak of a “recent analytic turn in the philosophy of technology”. Overviews of analytic philosophy of technology can be found in Mitcham (1994: Part 2), Franssen (2009) and Franssen and others (2009: Sec. 2).

4. Two Exemplary Discussions

After having mapped out three principal ways in which one can conceive of philosophy of technology, two discussions from contemporary philosophy of technology will be presented to illustrate what philosophers of technology do. The first example will demonstrate philosophy of technology as the systematic clarification of the nature of technology. The second example shows philosophy of technology as systematic reflection on the consequences of technology for human life, and is concerned with biotechnology. (Illustrations of philosophy of technology as the systematic investigation of the practices of engineering, invention, designing and making of things will not be presented. Examples of this approach to philosophy of technology can be found in Vermaas and others (2008) or Franssen and others (2009).)

a. What Is (the Nature of) Technology?

The question, What is technology? or What is the nature of technology?, is both a central question that philosophers of technology aim to answer and a question the answer to which determines the subject matter of philosophy of technology. One can think of philosophy of technology as the philosophical examination of technology, in the same way as the philosophy of science is the philosophical examination of science and the philosophy of biology the philosophical study of a particular subdomain of science. However, in this respect the philosophy of technology is in a similar situation as the philosophy of science finds itself in.

Central questions in the philosophy of science have long been what science is, what characterizes science and what distinguishes science from non-science (the demarcation problem). These questions have recently somewhat moved out of focus, however, due to the lack of acceptable answers. Philosophers of science have not been able to satisfactorily explicate the nature of science (for a recent suggestion, see Hoyningen-Huene, 2008) or to specify any clear-cut criterion by which science could be demarcated from non-science or pseudo-science. As philosopher of science Paul Hoyningen-Huene (2008: 168) wrote: “fact is that at the beginning of the 21st century there is no consensus among philosophers or historians or scientists about the nature of science.”

The nature of technology, however, is even less clear than the nature of science. As philosopher of science Marx Wartofsky put it, ““Technology” is unfortunately too vague a term to define a domain; or else, so broad in its scope that what it does define includes too much. For example, one may talk about technology as including all artifacts, that is, all things made by human beings. Since we “make” language, literature, art, social organizations, beliefs, laws and theories as well as tools and machines, and their products, such an approach covers too much” (Wartofsky, 1979: 176). More clarity on this issue can be achieved by looking at the history of the term (for example, Nye, 2006: Chapter 1; Misa, 2009; Mitcham & Schatzberg, 2009) as well as at recent suggestions to define it.

Jacob Bigelow, an early author on technology, conceived of it as a specific domain of knowledge: technology was “an account […] of the principles, processes, and nomenclatures of the more conspicuous arts” (Bigelow, 1829, quoted in Misa, 2009: 9; Mitcham & Schatzberg, 2009: 37). In a similar manner, Günter Ropohl (1990: 112; 2009: 31) defined “technology” as the ‘science of technics” (“Wissenschaft von der Technik”, where “Technik” denotes the domain of crafts and other areas of manufacturing, making, etc.). The important aspect of Bigelow’s and Ropohl’s definitions is that “technology” does not denote a domain of human activity (such as making or designing) or a domain of objects (technological innovations, such as solar panels), but a domain of knowledge. In this respect, their usage of the term is continuous with the meaning of the Greek “techne” (Section 1.a).

A review of a number of definitions of “technology” (Li-Hua, 2009) shows that there is not much overlap between the various definitions that can be found in the literature. Many definitions conceive of technology in Bigelow’s and Ropohl’s sense as a particular body of knowledge (thus making the philosophy of technology a branch of epistemology), but do not agree on what kind of knowledge it is supposed to be. On some definitions it is seen as firm-specific knowledge about design and production processes, while others conceive of it as knowledge about natural phenomena and laws of nature that can be used to satisfy human needs and solve human problems (a view which closely resembles Francis Bacon’s).

Philosopher of science Mario Bunge presented a view of the nature of technology along the latter lines (Bunge, 1966). According to Bunge, technology should be understood as constituting a particular subdomain of the sciences, namely “applied science”, as he called it. Note that Bunge’s thesis is not that technology is applied science in the sense of the application of scientific theories, models, etc. for practical purposes. Although a view of technology as being “just the totality of means for applying science” (Scharff, 2009: 160) remains present among the general public, most engineers and philosophers of technology agree that technology cannot be conceived of as the application of science in this sense. Bunge’s view is that technology is the subdomain of science characterized by a particular aim, namely application. According to Bunge, natural science and applied science stand side by side as two distinct modes of doing science: while natural science is scientific investigation aimed at the production of reliable knowledge about the world, technology is scientific investigation aimed at application. Both are full-blown domains of science, in which investigations are carried out and knowledge is produced (knowledge about the world and how it can be applied to concrete problems, respectively). The difference between the two domains lies in the nature of the knowledge that is produced and the aims that are in focus. Bunge’s statement that “technology is applied science” should thus be read as “technology is science for the purpose of application” and not as “technology is the application of science.”

Other definitions reflect still different conceptions of technology. In the definition accepted by the United Nations Conference on Trade and Development (UNCTAD), technology not only includes specific knowledge, but also machinery, production systems and skilled human labor force. Li-Hua (2009) follows the UNCTAD definition by proposing a four-element definition of “technology” as encompassing technique (that is, a specific technique for making a particular product), specific knowledge (required for making that product; he calls this technology in the strict sense), the organization of production and the end product itself. Friedrich Rapp, in contrast, defined “technology” even more broadly as a domain of human activity: “in simplest terms, technology is the reshaping of the physical world for human purposes” (Rapp, 1989: xxiii).

Thus, attempts to define “technology” in such a way that this definition would express the nature of technology, or only some of the principal characteristics of technology, have not led to any generally accepted view of what technology is. In this context, historian of science and technology Thomas J. Misa observed that historians of technology have so far resisted defining “technology” in the same way as “no scholarly historian of art would feel the least temptation to define “art”, as if that complex expression of human creativity could be pinned down by a few well-chosen words” (Misa, 2009: 8). The suggestion clearly is that technology is far too complex and too diverse a domain to define or to be able to talk about the nature of technology. Nordmann (2008: 14) went even further by arguing that not only can the term “technology” not be defined, but also it should not be defined. According to Nordmann, we should accept that technology is too diverse a domain to be caught in a compact definition. Accordingly, instead of conceiving of “technology” as the name of a particular fixed collection of phenomena that can be investigated, Nordmann held that “technology” is best understood as what Grunwald & Julliard (2005) called a “reflective concept”. According to the latter authors, “technology” (or rather, “Technik” – see Section 1.c) should simply be taken to mean whatever we mean when we use the term. While this clearly cannot be an adequate definition of the term, it still can serve as a basis for reflections on technology in that it gives us at least some sense of what it is that we are reflection on. Using “technology” in this extremely loose manner allows us to connect reflections on very different issues and phenomena as being about – in the broadest sense – the same thing. In this way, “technology” can serve as the core concept of the field of philosophy of technology.

Philosophy of technology faces the challenge of clarifying the nature of a particular domain of phenomena without being able to determine the boundaries of that domain. Perhaps the best way out of this situation is to approach the question on a case-by-case basis, where the various cases are connected by the fact that they all involve technology in the broadest possible sense of the term. Rather than asking what technology is, and how the nature of technology is to be characterized, it might be better to examine the natures of particular instances of technology and in so doing achieve more clarity about a number of local phenomena. In the end, the results from various case studies might to some extent converge – or they might not.

b. Questions Regarding Biotechnology

The question how to define “technology” is not merely an academic issue. Consider the case of biotechnology, the technological domain that features most prominently in systematic reflections on the consequences of technology for human life. When thinking about what the application of biotechnologies might mean for our lives, it is important to define what we mean by “biotechnology” such that the subject matter under consideration is delimited in a way that is useful for the discussion.

On one definition, given in 1984 by the United States Office of Technology Assessment, biotechnology comprises “[a]ny technique using organisms and their components to make products, modify plants and animals to carry desired traits, or develop micro-organisms for specific uses” (Office of Technology Assessment, 1984; Van den Beld, 2009: 1302). On such a conception of biotechnology, however, traditional farming, breeding and production of foodstuffs, as well as modern large-scale agriculture and industrialized food production would all count as biotechnology. The domain of biotechnology would thus encompass an extremely heterogeneous collection of practices and techniques of which many would not be particularly interesting subjects for philosophical or ethical reflection (although all of them affect human life: consider, for example, the enormous effect that the development of traditional farming had with respect to the rise of human societies). Accordingly, many definitions are much narrower and focus on “new” or “modern” biotechnologies, that is, technologies that involve the manipulation of genetic material. These are, after all, the technologies that are widely perceived by the general public as ethically problematic and thus as constituting the proper subject matter of philosophical reflection on biotechnology. Thus, the authors of a 2007 reported on the possible consequences, opportunities and challenges of biotechnology for Europe make a distinction between traditional and modern biotechnology, writing about modern biotechnology that it “can be defined as the use of cellular, molecular and genetic processes in production of goods and services. Its beginnings date back to the early 1970s when recombinant DNA technology was first developed” (quoted in Van den Beld, 2009: 1302).

Such narrow definitions, however, tend to cover too little. As Van den Beld (2009: 1306) pointed out in this context, “There are no definitions that are simply correct or incorrect, only definitions that are more or less pragmatically adequate in view of the aims one pursues.” When it comes to systematic reflection on how the use of technologies affects human life, the question thus is whether there is any particular area of technology that can be meaningfully singled out as constituting “biotechnology”. However, the spectrum of technological applications in the biological domain is simply too diverse.

In overviews of the technologies that are commonly discussed under the name of “biotechnology” a common distinction is between “white biotechnology” (biotechnology in industrial contexts), “green biotechnology” (biotechnology involving plants) and “red biotechnology” (biotechnology involving humans and non-human animals, in particular in medical and biomedical contexts). White biotechnology involves, among other things, the use of enzymes in detergents or the production of cheeses; the use of micro-organisms for the production of medicinal substances; the production of biofuels and bioplastics and so forth. Green biotechnology typically involves genetic technology and is also often called “green genetic technology”. It mainly encompasses the genetic modification of cultivated crops. Philosophical/ethical issues discussed under this label include the risk of outcrossing between genetically modified types of plants and the wild types; the use of genetically modified crops in the production of foodstuffs, either directly or indirectly as food for animals intended for human consumption (for example, soy beans, corn, potatoes and tomatoes); the labeling of foodstuffs produced on the basis of genetically modified organisms; issues related to the patenting of genetically modified crops and so forth.

Not surprisingly, red biotechnology is the most hotly discussed area of biotechnology as red biotechnologies directly involve human beings and non-human animals, both of which are categories that feature prominently throughout ethical discussions. Red biotechnology involves such things as the transplantation of human organs and tissues, and xenotransplantation (the transplantation of non-human animal organs and tissues to humans); the use of cloning techniques for reproductive and therapeutic purposes; the use of embryos for stem cell research; artificial reproduction, in vitro fertilization, the genetic testing of embryos and pre-implantation diagnostics and so forth. In addition, an increasingly discussed area of red biotechnology is constituted by human enhancement technologies. These encompass such diverse technologies as the use of psycho-pharmaceutical substances for the improvement of one’s mental capacities, the genetic modification of human embryos to prevent possible genetic diseases and so forth.

Other areas of biotechnology can include synthetic biology, which involves the creation of synthetic genetic systems, synthetic metabolic systems and attempts at creating living synthetic life forms from scratch. Synthetic biology does not fit into the distinction between white, green and red biotechnology and receives attention from philosophers not only because projects in synthetic biology may raise ethical questions (for example, Douglas & Savulescu, 2012) but also because of questions from epistemology and philosophy of science (for example, O”Malley, 2009; Van den Beld, 2009: 1314-1316).

Corresponding to this diversity of technologies covered by the label of “biotechnology”, philosophical reflection on biotechnology as such and on its possible consequences for human life will not be a very fruitful enterprise as there will not be much to say about biotechnology in general. Instead, philosophical reflection on biotechnology will need to be conducted locally rather than globally, taking the form of close examination of particular technologies in particular contexts. Philosophers concerned with biotechnology reflect on such specific issues as the genetic modification of plants for agricultural purposes, or the use of psycho-pharmaceutical substances for the improvement of the mental capacities of healthy subjects – not biotechnology as such. In the same way as “technology” can be thought of as a “reflective concept” (Grunwald & Julliard, 2005) that brings together a variety of phenomena under a common denominator for the purposes of enabling philosophical work, so “biotechnology” too can be understood as a “reflective concept” that is useful to locate particular considerations within the wide domain of philosophical reflection.

This is, however, not to say that on more general levels nothing can be said about biotechnology. Bioethicist Bernard Rollin, for example, considered genetic engineering in general and addressed the question whether genetic engineering could be considered intrinsically wrong – that is, wrong in any and all contexts and hence independently of the particular context of application that is under consideration (Rollin, 2006: 129-154). According to Rollin, the alleged intrinsic wrongness of genetic engineering constituted one out of three aspects of wrongness that members of the general public often associate with genetic engineering. These three aspects, which Rollin illustrated as three aspects of the Frankenstein myth (see Rollin, 2006: 135), are: the intrinsic wrongness of a particular practice, its possible dangerous consequences and the possibilities of causing harm to sentient beings. While the latter two aspects of wrongness might be avoided by means of appropriate measures, the intrinsic wrongness of a particular practice (in cases where it obtains) is unavoidable. Thus, if it could be argued that genetic engineering is intrinsically wrong – that is, something that we just ought not to do, irrespective of whatever positive or negative consequences are to be expected –, this would constitute a strong argument against large domains of white, green and red biotechnology. On the basis of an assessment of the motivations that people have to judge genetic engineering as being intrinsically wrong, Rollin, however, concluded that such an argument could not be made because in the various cases in which people concluded that genetic engineering was intrinsically wrong the premises of the argument were not well-founded.

But in this case, too, the need for local rather than global analyses can be seen. Assessing the tenability of the value judgment that genetic engineering is intrinsically wrong requires examining concrete arguments and motivations on a local level. This, I want to suggest by way of conclusion, is a general characteristic of the philosophy of technology: the relevant philosophical analyses will have to take place on the more local levels, examining particular technologies in particular contexts, rather than on more global levels, at which large domains of technology such as biotechnology or even the technological domain as a whole are in focus. Philosophy of technology, then, is a matter of piecemeal engineering, in much the same way as William Wimsatt has suggested that philosophy of science should be done (Wimsatt, 2007).

5. References and Further Reading

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  • Irrgang, B. (2008): Philosophie der Technik, Darmstadt: Wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft.
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Author Information

Thomas A.C. Reydon
Email: reydon@ww.uni-hannover.de
Leibniz University of Hannover
Germany

John McTaggart Ellis McTaggart (1866—1925)

McTaggartJ. M. E. McTaggart is a British idealist, best known for his argument for the unreality of time and for his system of metaphysics advocating personal idealism. By the early twentieth century, the philosophical movement known as British Idealism was waning, while the ‘new realism’ (later dubbed ‘analytic philosophy’) was gaining momentum. Although McTaggart’s commitment to idealism never faltered, he enjoyed an usually close relationship with several of the new realists. McTaggart spent almost his entire career at Trinity College, Cambridge, and there he taught Bertrand Russell, G. E. Moore and C. D. Broad. McTaggart influenced all of these figures to some degree, and all of them speak particularly highly of his careful and clear philosophical method.

McTaggart studied Hegel from the very beginning of his philosophical career and produced a large body of Hegel scholarship, including the mammoth Studies in Hegelian Cosmology (1901). Towards the end of his career he produced his two volume magnum opus The Nature of Existence (1921 & posthumously 1927), a highly original metaphysical system developing─what McTaggart took to be─Hegel’s ontology. This personal idealism holds that the universe is composed solely of minds and their perceptions, bound into a tight unity by love. However, McTaggart is best known for his influential paper “The Unreality of Time” in which he argues that change and time are contradictory and unreal. This argument, and the metaphysical groundwork it lays down, especially its contrast between his A-series and B-series of time, is still widely discussed.

Table of Contents

  1. Biography
  2. Philosophical Influences
    1. The British Idealists
    2. The British New Realists
  3. Philosophical Writings
    1. Hegel
    2. Some Dogmas of Religion
    3. The Unreality of Time
    4. The Nature of Existence
  4. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Selected Secondary Sources

1. Biography

McTaggart was born in London on 3 September 1866, the son of Francis Ellis, a county court judge, and his wife Caroline Ellis. McTaggart was born ‘John McTaggart Ellis’ and acquired the name ‘McTaggart’ as a surname when his father adopted it on condition of inheriting an uncle’s wealth. As a boy McTaggart attended a preparatory school in Weybridge, from which he was expelled for his frequent avowal of atheism. He subsequently attended school in Caterham and Clifton College, Bristol. He began studying philosophy at Trinity College, Cambridge in 1885. Once McTaggart began at Trinity, he hardly left: he graduated in 1888 with a first class degree, became a Prize Fellow in 1891, became a lecturer in Moral Sciences in 1897 and stayed until his retirement in 1923. In a letter to a friend, he writes of Cambridge: ‘Unless I am physically or spiritually at Cambridge or Oxford, I have no religion, no keenness (I do not identify them) except by snatches. I must have been made for a don… I learn a good many things there, the chief one being that I am a damned sight happier than I deserve to be’. In addition to being an academic, McTaggart was a mystic. He reports having visions ─ not imaginary, but literal perceptions of the senses ─ conveying the spiritual nature of the world; this may have played a part in his unswerving devotion to idealism. McTaggart investigates the nature of mysticism in “Mysticism” ─ reprinted in his Philosophical Studies (1934) ─ and he takes it to involve an awareness of the unity of the universe.

Beginning in 1891, McTaggart took a number of trips to New Zealand to visit his mother, and it was there that he met his future wife. He married Margaret Elizabeth Bird in New Zealand on 5 August 1899, and subsequently removed her to Cambridge. They had no children. During the first World War, McTaggart worked as a special constable and helped in a munitions factory. McTaggart’s friend Dickinson writes of him, ‘it is essential to remember that, if he was a philosopher by nature and choice he was also a lover and a husband… and a whole-hearted British patriot’ (Dickinson, 1931, 47).

Towards the end of his life McTaggart produced the first volume of his magnum opus The Nature of Existence (1921). He retired shortly afterwards in 1923, and died unexpectedly two years later on 18 January 1925. In his introduction to the second edition of Some Dogmas of Religion, McTaggart’s friend and former student Broad describes McTaggart’s funeral and mentions how one of McTaggart’s favourite Spinozistic passages were read out. It is worth mentioning here that, although McTaggart never contributed to Spinoza scholarship, he admired him greatly ─ perhaps even more than Hegel. McTaggart describes Spinoza as a great religious teacher, ‘in whom philosophical insight and religious devotion were blended as in no other man before or since’ (McTaggart, 1906, 299). The passage from Spinoza was consequently engraved on McTaggart’s memorial bass in Trinity College. McTaggart did not live to see the second volume of The Nature of Existence in print but fortunately the manuscript was largely complete and it was finally published in 1927, under Broad’s careful editorial care. Broad describes McTaggart as follows:

‘Take an eighteenth-century English Whig. Let him be a mystic. Endow him with the logical subtlety of the great schoolmen and their belief in the powers of human reason, with the business capacity of a successful lawyer, and with the lucidity of the best type of French mathematician. Inspire him (Heaven knows how) in early youth with a passion for Hegel. Then subject him to the teaching of Sidgwick and the continual influence of Moore and Russell. Set him to expound Hegel. What will be the result? Hegel himself could not have answered this question a priori, but the course of world history has solved it ambulando by producing McTaggart.’

For further biographical information (and anecdotes) see Dickinson’s (1931) biographical sketch of McTaggart, and Broad’s (1927) notice on McTaggart.

2. Philosophical Influences

McTaggart was active in British philosophy at a time when it was caught between two opposing philosophical currents ─ British Idealism and the New Realism ─ and McTaggart was involved with figures within both of these movements.

a. The British Idealists

McTaggart began his career in British philosophy when it was firmly under the sway of British Idealism, a movement which argues that the world is inherently unified, intelligible and idealist. Due to the influence of Hegel on these philosophers, the movement is also sometimes known as British Hegelianism. The movement began in the latter half of the nineteenth century; J. H. Stirling is generally credited with introducing Hegel’s work to Britain via his book The Secret of Hegel (1865). Aside from McTaggart himself, important figures in British Idealism include T. H. Green, F. H. Bradley, Harold Joachim, Bernard Bosanquet and Edward Caird. Early on, a schism appeared in the movement as to how idealism should be understood. Absolute idealists ─ such as Bradley ─ argued that reality is underpinned by a single partless spiritual unity known as the Absolute. In contrast, personal idealists ─ such as G. F. Stout and Andrew Seth ─ argued that reality consists of many individual spirits or persons. McTaggart firmly endorses personal idealism, the doctrine that he took to be Hegel’s own. In addition to his idealism, McTaggart shared other neo-Hegelian principles. Among these are his convictions that the universe is as tightly unified as it is possible for a plurality of existents to be, that the universe is fundamentally rational and open to a priori investigation, and his disregard for naturalism. On this last point, McTaggart goes so far as to say that, while science may investigate the nature of the universe, only philosophy investigates its ‘ultimate nature’ (McTaggart, 1906, 273).

Nearly all of McTaggart’s early work concerns Hegel, or Hegelian doctrines, and this work forms the basis of the metaphysical system he would later develop in so much detail. A good example of this is his earliest publication, a pamphlet printed for private circulation entitled “The Further Determination of the Absolute” (1893); it is reprinted in McTaggart’s Philosophical Studies. In this defence of idealism, McTaggart’s Hegelian credentials are well established: he repeatedly references Hegel, Green, and Bradley ─ whom he later describes as ‘the greatest of all living philosophers’. McTaggart apparently cared  greatly about this paper. In its introduction, McTaggart apologises for its ‘extreme crudeness… and of its absolute inadequacy to its subject’. In private correspondence (see Dickinson) McTaggart describes the experience of writing it. ‘It has been shown to one or two people who are rather authorities (Caird of Glasgow and Bradley of Oxford) and they have been very kind and encouraging about it… [writing] it was almost like turning one’s heart out’.

b. The British New Realists

Despite his close philosophical ties to British Idealism, McTaggart bucked the trends of the movement in a number of ways. (In fact, Broad (1927) goes so far as to say that English Hegelianism filled McTaggart with an ‘amused annoyance’). To begin with, McTaggart spent his entire career at Cambridge. Not only was Oxford, rather than Cambridge, the spiritual home of British Idealism but Cambridge became the home of new realism. While at Trinity College, McTaggart taught a number of the new realists ─ including Moore, Russell and Broad ─ and held great influence over them. Moore read and gave notes on a number of McTaggart’s works prior to publication, including Some Dogmas of Religion (1906) and the first volume of The Nature of Existence. In his obituary note on McTaggart, Moore describes him as a philosopher ‘of the very first rank’ (Moore, 1925, 271). For more on McTaggart’s influence on Moore, see Baldwin (1990). McTaggart was also involved with some of the realist debates of the time; for example, see his discussion note on Wittgenstein “Propositions Applicable to Themselves”, reprinted in his Philosophical Studies (1906).

As a young philosopher, Russell was so impressed by McTaggart’s paper “The Further Determination of the Absolute” and its doctrine of philosophical love that he used it to woo his future wife. In his autobiography, Russell writes that he remembers wondering as a student ‘as an almost unattainable ideal, whether I should ever do work as good as McTaggart’s’ (Russell, 1998, 129). Later, their relationship soured; McTaggart took a leading role in the expulsion of Russell from his fellowship following Russell’s controversial pacifist wartime writings. For more on this, and on McTaggart’s more general influence on Russell, see Dickinson (1931) and Griffin (1984). McTaggart, Russell and Moore were described at one point as ‘The Mad Tea Party of Trinity’, with McTaggart painted as the Dormouse.

As for Broad, McTaggart describes him as his ‘most brilliant’ pupil. Broad edited the two volumes of McTaggart’s The Nature of Existence, and produced extensive studies of both. Both Moore and Broad heap praise upon McTaggart for his exceptional clarity and philosophic rigour; the lack of these qualities in other idealists played a part in driving both of these new realists away from British Idealism. For example, Broad writes: ‘The writings of too many eminent Absolutists seem to start from no discoverable premises; to proceed by means of puns, metaphors, and ambiguities; and to resemble in their literary style glue thickened with sawdust’ (Broad, 1933, ii). In contrast, Broad says of McTaggart that he ‘was an extremely careful and conscientious writer… [to] be ranked with Hobbes, Berkeley and Hume among the masters of English philosophical prose… [his] style is pellucidly clear’ (Broad, 1927, 308).

Not only did McTaggart enjoy close relationships with the new realists, they shared some basic philosophic tenets. For example, McTaggart and the new realists reject the Bradleyian claim that reality and truth come in degrees. McTaggart argues that there is a ‘confusion’ which leads philosophers to move from one to the other (McTaggart, 1921, 4). McTaggart also rejects the coherence theory of truth espoused by British idealists such as Joachim (and, arguably, Bradley) in favour of the correspondence theory of truth (McTaggart, 1921, 10).

3. Philosophical Writings

a. Hegel

While many of the British idealists studied Hegel, few entered into the murky waters of Hegel scholarship. McTaggart is an exception: Hegel scholarship occupied McTaggart for most of his career. Hegel is a German idealist and his work is notoriously difficult. While some of the British  idealists understood Hegel to be arguing that reality consists of a single partless spiritual being known as the Absolute, McTaggart took Hegel to be arguing for personal idealism.

Hegel is discussed in McTaggart’s very first publication, “The Further Determination of the Absolute” (1893). McTaggart argues that the progress of any idealistic philosophy may be divided into three stages: the proof that reality is not exclusively matter, the proof that reality is exclusively spirit and determining the fundamental nature of that spirit. McTaggart describes Hegel’s understanding of the fundamental nature of spirit as follows. ‘Spirit is ultimately made up of various finite individuals, each of which finds his character and individuality by relating himself to the rest, and by perceiving that they are of the same nature as himself’. The individuals that make up spirit are interdependent, united by a pattern or design akin to an organic unity. McTaggart adds that justifying this ‘would be a task beyond the limits of this paper… it could only be done by going over the whole course of Hegel’s Logic’. One way of understanding the rest of McTaggart’s career is to see that he is making good on his threat to justify Hegel’s understanding of spirit.

Just some of McTaggart’s works on Hegel include Studies in the Hegelian Dialectic (1896), Studies in Hegelian Cosmology (1901) and A Commentary on Hegel’s Logic (1910). A central theme in these books is the question of how the universe, as unified spirit, is differentiated into finite spirits ─ how can a unity also be a plurality? McTaggart takes Hegel to have solved this problem by postulating a unity which is not only in the individuals, but also for the individuals, in that reality is a system of conscious individuals wherein each individual reflects the whole: ‘If we take all reality, for the sake of convenience, as limited to three individuals, A, B, and C, and suppose them to be conscious, then the whole will be reproduced in each of them… [A will] be aware of himself, of B, and of C, and of the unity which joins them in a system’ (McTaggart, 1901, 14). Later, this is exactly the position that McTaggart himself advances. McTaggart also discusses Hegel’s dialectic method at length; this is the process whereby opposition between a thesis and an anti-thesis is resolved into a synthesis. For example, ‘being’ and ‘not being’ are resolved into ‘becoming’. Despite his admiration for this method, McTaggart does not use it in his Nature of Existence; instead of proceeding by dialectic, his argument proceeds via the more familiar method of principles and premises.

There is disagreement within contemporary Hegel scholarship as to how correct McTaggart’s reading of Hegel is. Stern argues that McTaggart’s reading of Hegel bears close similarities to contemporary readings, and that it should be seen as an important precursor (Stern, 2009, 121). In contrast, in his introduction to Some Dogmas of Religion, Broad argues that ‘if McTaggart’s account of Hegelianism be taken as a whole and compared with Hegel’s writings as a whole, the impression produced is one of profound unlikeness’. Similarly, Geach compares McTaggart’s acquaintance with Hegel’s writings to the chapter-and-verse knowledge of the Bible that out-of-the-way Protestant sectarians often have; he adds that the ‘unanimous judgement’ of Hegel scholars appears to be that McTaggart’s interpretations of Hegel were as perverse as these sectarians’ interpretations of the Bible (Geach, 1979, 17).

b. Some Dogmas of Religion

Some Dogmas of Religion (1906) is an exception to McTaggart’s main body of work, in that it assumes no knowledge of philosophy and is intended for general audience. The book covers a large number of topics, from the compatibility of God’s attributes to human freewill. This section picks out three of the book’s central themes: the role of metaphysics, McTaggart’s brand of atheism and the immortality of the soul.

McTaggart defines metaphysics as ‘the systematic study of the ultimate nature of reality’. A dogma is ‘any proposition which has a metaphysical significance’, such as belief in God (McTaggart, 1906, 1). McTaggart argues that dogmas can only be produced by reason ─ by engaging in metaphysics. Science does not produce dogmas, for scientific claims do not aim to express the fundamental nature of reality. For example, science tells us about the laws governing the part of the universe know as ‘matter’ are mechanical. Science does not go on to tell us whether these laws are manifestations of deeper laws, or the will of God (McTaggart, 1906, 13-4). In fact, McTaggart argues that the consistency of science would be unaffected if its object of study ─ matter ─ turned out to be immaterial. To learn about the ultimate nature of the world, we must look to metaphysics, not science.

McTaggart embodies two apparently contradictory characteristics: he is religious and an atheist. The apparent contradiction is resolved by McTaggart’s definition of religion. ‘Religion is clearly a state of mind… an emotion resting on a conviction of a harmony between ourselves and the universe at large’ (McTaggart, 1906, 3). McTaggart aims to define religion as broadly as possible, so as to include the traditional systems ─ such as those of the Greeks, Roman Christians, Judaism and Buddhism ─ and the idiosyncratic ones espoused by philosophers like Spinoza and Hegel. Given this very broad definition of religion, McTaggart’s own system of personal idealism qualifies as religious. However, McTaggart is an atheist, for he denies the existence of God. In Some Dogmas of Religion McTaggart does not argue for atheism, he merely rejects some of the traditional arguments for theism. He defines God as ‘a being that is personal, supreme and good’ (McTaggart, 1906, 186) and argues that theistic arguments do not prove the existence of such a being. For example, the cosmological ‘first cause’ argument claims that if every event must have a cause, including the universe’s very first event, then the first cause must being a which is uncaused: God. McTaggart argues that even if this argument is valid, it does not prove the existence of God, for it does not prove that the first existing being is either personal or good (McTaggart, 1906, 190-1). In The Nature of Existence, McTaggart goes even further than this and argues directly for atheism (McTaggart, 1927, 176-89).

Given that McTaggart denies the reality of time and the existence of God, it may seem strange that he also affirms the immortality of the human soul. However, McTaggart held all three of these claims throughout his life. In Some Dogmas of Religion, McTaggart takes the immortality of the soul as a postulate, and considers objections to it, such as the claim that the soul or self is an activity of the finite human body, or that it cannot exist without it. McTaggart argues that none of these objections are successful. For example, concerning the claim that the self is of such a nature that it cannot exist outside of its present body, McTaggart argues that while we have no evidence of disembodied selves, this shows at most that the self needs some body, not that it needs the body it currently has (McTaggart, 1906, 104-5). McTaggart concludes that the immortality of the soul is at least a real possibility, for souls can move from body to body. He argues that souls are immortal, not in the sense of existing at every time ─ for time does not exist ─ but in the sense that we enjoy a succession of lives, before and after this one. McTaggart calls this the doctrine of the ‘plurality of lives’ (McTaggart, 1906, 116). He goes on to argue that our journey throughout these lives is not guided by chance or mechanical necessity, but rather by the interests of spirit: love, which ‘would have its way’. For example, our proximity to our loved ones is not the product of chance or mechanical arrangement, but is rather caused by the fact that our spirits are more closely connected to these selves than to others. This accounts for phenomena such as ‘love at first sight’: we have loved these people before, in previous lives (McTaggart, 1906, 134-5). In The Nature of Existence, McTaggart puts forward a positive argument for the immortality of the soul and continues to emphasise that love is of the utmost importance. By affirming the immortality of the soul, McTaggart seems to take himself to be following Spinoza in making death ‘the least of all things’ (McTaggart, 1906, 299).

c. The Unreality of Time

McTaggart’s paper “The Unreality of Time” (1908) presents the argument he is best known for. (The argument of this paper is also included in the second volume of The Nature of Existence.) McTaggart argues that the belief in the unreality of time has proved ‘singularly attractive’ throughout the ages, and attributes such belief to Spinoza, Kant, Hegel and Bradley. (In the case of Spinoza, this attribution is arguable; Spinoza describes time as a general character of existents, albeit one conceived using the imagination.) McTaggart offers us a wholly new argument in favour of this belief, and here is its outline.

McTaggart distinguishes two ways of ordering events or ‘positions’ in time: the A series takes some position as present, and orders other positions as running from the past to the present and from the present to the future; meanwhile the B series orders events in virtue of whether they are earlier or later than other events. The argument itself has two steps. In the first step, McTaggart aims to show that there is no time without the A series because only the A series can account for change. On the B series nothing changes, any event N has ─ and will always have ─ the same position in the time series: ‘If N is ever earlier than O and later than M, it will always be, and has always been… since the relations of earlier and later are permanent’. In contrast, change does occur on the A series. For example an event, such as the death of Queen Anne, began by being a future event, became present and then became past. Real change only occurs on the A series when events move from being in the future, to being in the present, to being in the past.

In the second step, McTaggart argues that the A series cannot exist, and hence time cannot exist. He does so by attempting to show that the existence of the A series would generate contradiction because past, present and future are incompatible attributes; if an event M has the attribute of being present it cannot also be in the past and the future. However, McTaggart maintains that ‘every event has them all’ ─ for example, if M is past, then it has been present and future ─ which is inconsistent with change. As the application of the A series to reality involves a contradiction, the A series cannot be true of reality. This does not entail that our perceptions are false; on the contrary, McTaggart maintains that it is possible that the realities which we perceive as events in a time series do really form a non-temporal C series. Although this C series would not admit of time or change, it does admit of order. For example, if we perceive two events M and N as occurring at the same time, it may be that ─ while time does not exist ─ M and N have the same position in the ordering of the C series. McTaggart attributes this view of time to Hegel, claiming that Hegel regards the time series as a distorted reflexion of something in the real nature of the timeless reality. In “The Unreality of Time”, McTaggart does not consider at length what the C series is; he merely suggests that the positions within it may be ultimate facts or that they are determined by varying quantities within objects. In “The Relation of Mind to Eternity” (1909) ─ reprinted in his Philosophical Studies ─ McTaggart goes further than this. He compares our perception of time to viewing reality through a tinted glass, and suggests that the C series is an ordering of representations of reality according to how accurate they are. Our ersatz temporal perception that we are moving through time reflects our movement towards the end point of this series, which is the correct perception of reality. This end point will involve the fact that reality is really timeless, so time is understood as the process by which we reach the timeless. Later still, in the second volume of The Nature of Existence, McTaggart reconsiders this position and argues that while the objects of the C series are representations of reality, they are not ordered by veracity. Instead, McTaggart argues that the ‘fundamental sense’ of the C series is that it is ordered according to the ‘amount of content of the whole that is included in it’: it runs from the less inclusive to the more inclusive (McTaggart, 1927, 362). However, McTaggart does not give up his claim that the C series will reach a timeless end point. For more on this, see The Nature of Existence (1927), chapters 59-61.

Reception to “The Unreality of Time” among McTaggart’s contemporaries was mixed. Ewing describes its implausible conclusion as ‘heroic’, while Broad describes it ‘as an absolute howler’. This argument is probably the most influential piece of philosophy that McTaggart ever produced. Although the paper’s conclusions are rarely endorsed in full, it is credited with providing the framework for a debate ─ between the A and B series of time ─ which is still alive today.  For discussion, see Dummett “A Defence of McTaggart’s Proof of the Unreality of Time” (1960),  Lowe “The Indexical Fallacy in McTaggart’s Proof of the Unreality of Time” (1987) and Le Poidevin & Mellor “Time, Change, and the ‘ Indexical Fallacy’” (1987). For an extended, more recent discussion, see Dainton (2001).

d. The Nature of Existence

McTaggart’s magnum opus aims to provide a comprehensive, systematic a priori description of the world; the conclusion of this system is personal idealism. Broad claims that The Nature of Existence may quite fairly be ranked with the Enneads of Plotinus, the Ethics of Spinoza, and the Encyclopaedia of Hegel (Broad, 1927). The central argument of The Nature of Existence is based on the nature of substance and it is extremely complex. The bare bones of the argument contains three steps but along the way, McTaggart makes use of a number of subsidiary arguments.

In the first step, McTaggart argues that the universe contains multiple substances. McTaggart defines a substance as whatever exists and has qualities, or stands in relations, but is not itself a quality or relation, entailing that the following are all substances: sneezes, parties and red-haired archdeacons (McTaggart, 1921, 73). Given this broad definition, McTaggart argues that at least one substance exists; this is true given the evidence of our senses, and that there is anything around to consider the statement at all. All substances have qualities (today, we would say ‘properties’) such as redness and squareness. If there are multiple substances, then relations hold between them. Although to contemporary philosophers the claim that relations are real is familiar, in the context of British Idealism this is a significant departure from Bradley’s claim that relations are unreal. The qualities and relations possessed by a substance are jointly called its characteristics. McTaggart puts forward two kinds of arguments for the claim that there are multiple substances. Firstly, there are empirical proofs, such as the claim that if I and the things I perceive exist, then there are at least two substances (McTaggart, 1921, 75). Secondly, as we will see below, McTaggart argues that all substances can be differentiated into further substances. If this is true then it follows that if at least one substance exists, many exist.

In the second step, McTaggart places two necessary ontological conditions on the nature of substances ─ they must admit of sufficient descriptions, and they must be differentiated into further substances ─ which results in his theory of determining correspondence.

The first ontological condition McTaggart places on substance is that they must admit of sufficient descriptions. This grows out of McTaggart’s extended discussion of the ‘Dissimilarity of the Diverse’ ─ see Chapter 10 of the first volume of the Nature of Existence ─ which argues that diverse (that is, non-identical) things are dissimilar, that two things cannot have the same nature. This ‘similarity’ involves the properties and relations a substance has. For example, McTaggart argues that if space is absolute then two things will occupy different spatial positions and stand in dissimilar spatial relations. McTaggart discusses the relationship between his principle the ‘Dissimilarity of the Diverse’, and Leibniz’s principle the ‘Identity of Indiscernibles’, which states that two things are identical if they are indiscernible. McTaggart prefers the name of his principle, for it does not suggest that there are indiscernibles which are identical but rather that there is nothing which is indiscernible from anything else. McTaggart goes on to argue that all substances admit of an ‘exclusive description’ which applies only to them via a description of their qualities. For example, the description ‘The continent lying over the South Pole’ applies to just one substance. All substances admit of exclusive descriptions because, given the Dissimilarity of the Diverse, no substance can have exactly the same nature as any other (McTaggart, 1921, 106). There are two kinds of exclusive descriptions: firstly, the kind that introduce another substance into the description, such as ‘The father of Henry VIII’; secondly, the kind known as ‘sufficient descriptions’, which describe a substance purely in terms of its qualities, without introducing another substance into the description, such as ‘The father of a monarch’. McTaggart argues that all substances must admit of sufficient descriptions: all substances are dissimilar to all other substances and as a result they admit of exclusive descriptions. If a substance could not be described without making reference to other substances then we would arrive at an infinite regress (because, as we will see, all substances are differentiated to infinity) and the description would correspondingly be infinite (McTaggart, 1921, 108). Such a regress would be vicious because it would never be completed. As substances do exist, they must admit of sufficient descriptions.

The second ontological condition placed on substances is that they are infinitely differentiated into proper parts which are also substances. By ‘differentiated,’ McTaggart implies that they are divisible and that they are divisible into parts unlike their wholes. To illustrate, a homogeneous ─ that is, uniform ─ liquid akin to milk might be infinitely divisible, but all of its parts would be like their wholes, they would merely be smaller portions of milk. In contrast, a heterogeneous ─ that is, non-uniform ─ liquid akin to a fruit smoothie would be infinitely divisible into parts that are unlike their whole: the whole might contain cherry and orange, while its parts contain pieces of cherry and orange respectively. McTaggart argues that all substances are infinitely differentiated by denying a priori that ‘simple’ partless substances are possible; he does so in two ways. The first way is based on divisibility. Simples would have to be indivisible in every dimension ─ in length, breadth and time ─ and this is impossible because even a substance like ‘pleasure’ has two dimensions, if it lasts for at least two moments of time (McTaggart, 1921, 175). The second way is based on notion of content. A simple substance would be a substance without ‘content’ in that it would lack properties and would not stand in relations. McTaggart argues that it is part of our notion of a substance that they must have a ‘filling’ of some sort ─  an ‘internal structure’ ─ and this could only be understood to mean that they must have parts (McTaggart, 1921, 181). Both of these arguments are somewhat hazy; see Broad (1933) for an extensive discussion and critique.

McTaggart’s full account of parts and wholes ─ which discusses divisibility, simples and composition ─ can be found in the first volume of The Nature of Existence, chapters 15-22. McTaggart endorses the doctrine of unrestricted composition, whereby any two substances compose a further compound substance. It follows from this that the universe or ‘all that exists’ is a single substance composed of all other substances (McTaggart, 1921, 78). While we might doubt the existence of simples (that is, partless atoms) we cannot doubt the existence of the universe because it includes all content (McTaggart, 1921, 172). Given McTaggart’s claim that all substances are differentiated and that unrestricted composition occurs, it follows that all parts and all collections of substances are themselves substances. These dual claims have made their way into an argument within contemporary metaphysics by Jonathan Schaffer. In contemporary parlance, anything that is infinitely divisible into proper parts which also have proper parts is ‘gunky’. One way of understanding McTaggart is to see that he claiming that, while all substances lack a ‘lower’ level ─ because they are gunky, infinitely divisible into further parts ─ all substances have a ‘highest’ level in the form of the universe, a substance which includes all content. Schaffer makes use of this asymmetry of existence ─ the fact that one can seriously doubt the existence of simples but not the existence of the universe as a whole ─ to argue for priority monism (Schaffer, 2010, 61).

With these two ontological conditions in place ─ that substances must admit of sufficient descriptions and be differentiated ─ McTaggart sets out to combine them into his theory of determining correspondence. This theory is extremely difficult and rather obscure; see Wisdom (1928) and Broad (1933). Essentially, McTaggart argues that the two ontological conditions result in contradiction unless substances fulfil a certain requirement. The worry is that a substance A cannot be given a sufficient description in virtue of sufficient descriptions of its parts M, for they can only be described in virtue of a sufficient descriptions of their parts… and so on to infinity. This is a vicious series because the sufficient descriptions of the members of M can only be made sufficient by means of the last stage of an unending series; in other words, they cannot be made sufficient at all (McTaggart, 1921, 199). Of course, as there are substances, they must admit of sufficient descriptions. McTaggart’s way out of this apparent contradiction seems to be to reverse the direction of epistemological priority: we have been considering deducing a sufficient description of a substance in virtue of its parts; instead, we should be deducing sufficient descriptions of the parts in virtue of the substance of which they are a whole. ‘[If] the contradiction is to be avoided, there must be some description of every substance which does imply sufficient descriptions of every part through all its infinite series of sets of parts’ (McTaggart, 1921, 204). The only way to provide such a description is via the law of determining correspondence, which asserts that each part of A is in a one-to-one correspondence with each term of its infinite series, the nature of the correspondence being such that, in the fact that a part of A corresponded in this way to a reality with a given nature, there would be implied a sufficient description of that part of A. The theory of determining correspondence involves a classification of the contents of the universe. The universe is a primary whole and it divides into primary parts, whose sufficient descriptions determine ─ by virtue of the relation of determining correspondence ─ the sufficient description of all further, secondary parts.

In the third step of his argument, McTaggart shows that the only way the nature of substance could comply with the theory of determining correspondence is if substance is spirit. He does this by eliminating the other candidates for the nature of substance, matter and sense data. His objections to both of these rival candidates are similar; we will focus on his rejection of matter. McTaggart argues that while there ‘might’ be no difficulty in the claim that matter is infinitely divisible, there is certainly is difficulty in the claim that matter can allow for determining correspondence (McTaggart, 1927, 33). This is impossible because, in a material object, the sufficient description of the parts determines the sufficient description of the whole, not the other way around. ‘If we know the shape and size of each one of a set of parts of A, and their position relatively to each other, we know the size and shape of A… we shall thus have an infinite series of terms, in which the subsequent terms imply the precedent’ (McTaggart, 1927, 36). As we have already seen above, such a series will involve a contradiction, for the description will never ‘bottom out’. One way out of this contradiction might be to postulate that, at each level of composition, the parts bear a ‘new’ property ─ such as a new colour or taste ─ which would be sufficient to describe them. McTaggart swiftly dispenses with this reply by arguing that it would require matter to possess an infinite number of sorts of qualities ─ ‘one sort for each of the infinite series of grades of secondary parts’ ─ and there is no reason to suppose that matter possesses more than the very limited number of qualities that are currently known to us (McTaggart, 1927, 35). McTaggart briefly considers dividing matter to infinity in time but dismisses the idea because of course, for McTaggart, time is unreal. McTaggart concludes that matter cannot exist. Interestingly, he does not take this conclusion to imply anti-realism about science or common sense, for when those disciplines use terms which assume the existence of matter, what is meant by those terms ‘remains just as true’ if we take the view that matter does not exist (McTaggart, 1927, 53).

Having dispensed with its rivals, McTaggart turns to idealism. Spiritual substances include selves, their parts, and compounds of multiple selves. Idealism is compatible with the theory of determining correspondence when the primary parts of the universe are understood to be selves, and the secondary parts their perceptions which are differentiated to infinity (McTaggart, 1927, 89).   While this does not amount to a positive proof of idealism, it gives us good reason to believe that nothing but spirit exists, for there is no other option on the table (McTaggart, 1927, 115). McTaggart also describes how the universe is a ‘self-reflecting unity’, in that the parts of the universe reflect every other part (McTaggart, 1921, 299). As we saw above, this is the view that McTaggart attributed to Hegel. McTaggart’s system also bears some similarity to the monadism advanced in Leibniz’s Monadology, wherein each monad is a spirit that reflects every other monad. Furthermore, in Leibniz’s system the highest ranks of monads are capable of entering into a community with God of pure love. Similarly, in McTaggart’s system (although there is no divine monarch) the souls are bound together by the purest form of love which results in the purest form of happiness (McTaggart, 1927, 156). These arguments are but developments of principles that McTaggart had espoused his entire life.

This section merely describes the main thread of argument in The Nature of Existence; the work itself covers many more topics. These include the notion of organic unity, the nature of cogitation, volition, emotion, good and evil, and error. Further topics are also covered in McTaggart’s Philosophical Studies, such the nature of causality and the role of philosophy as opposed to science.

4. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources

  • (1893) “The Further Determination of the Absolute”. Pamphlet designed for private distribution only. Reprinted in McTaggart’s Philosophical Studies.
  • (1896) “Time and the Hegelian Dialectic”. Mind Vol. 2, 490–504.
  • (1896) Studies in the Hegelian Dialectic. CUP: GB.
  • (1897) “Hegel’s Treatment of the Categories of the Subjective Notion”. Mind Vol. 6, 342–358.
  • (1899) “Hegel’s Treatment of the Categories of the Objective Notion”. Mind Vol. 8, 35–62.
  • (1900) “Hegel’s Treatment of the Categories of the Idea”. Mind Vol. 9, 145–183.
  • (1901) Studies in Hegelian Cosmology. CUP: Glasgow.
  • (1906) Some Dogmas of Religion. Edward Arnold press: GB.
  • (1908) “The Unreality of Time”. Mind Vol. 17, 457–474.
  • (1909) “The Relation of Time to Eternity” Mind Vol. 18, 343-362.
  • (1910) A Commentary on Hegel’s Logic. CUP: GB.
  • (1916) Human Immortality and Pre-Existence. Edward Arnold Press: GB.
  • (1921) The Nature of Existence I. CUP: London.
  • (1927)The Nature of Existence II. Edited by C. D. Broad. CUP: London.
  • (1934) Philosophical Studies. Edited by S.V. Keeling. Theomes Press: England.
    • [A large collection of McTaggart’s papers]

b. Selected Secondary Sources

  • Baldwin, Thomas (1990). G. E. Moore. Routledge: UK.
    • [Describes the relationship between Moore and McTaggart]
  • Bradley, F. (1920). Appearance and Reality. George Allen & Unwin Ltd: GB
    • [Bradley is the arch British idealist]
  • Broad, C. D. (1927). “John McTaggart Ellis McTaggart 1866-1925”, Proceedings of the British Academy Vol. XIII, 307-334.
  • Broad, C.D. (1933) An Examination of McTaggart’s Philosophy. CUP: GB
  • Dainton, Barry (2001). Time and Space. Acumen Publishing Ltd: GB.
    • [Provides an excellent discussion of McTaggart’s argument on the unreality of time]
  • Dickinson, G. Lowes (1931). J. M. E. McTaggart. CUP: GB.
  • Geach, Peter (1979). Truth, Love and Immortality: an Introduction to McTaggart’s Philosophy. University of California Press: GB.
  • Moore, G.E. (1925). “Death of Dr. McTaggart”, Mind Vol. 34, 269–271.
  • Moore, G.E. (1942). “An Autobiography”, in The Philosophy of G.E. Moore. Tudor Publishing Company: GB.
  • Russell, Bertrand (1998). The Autobiography of Bertrand Russell. Routledge: GB.
  • Schaffer, Jonathan (2010). “Monism: The Priority of the Whole”, Philosophical Review, Vol. 119, pp. 31-76.
    • [Utilises McTaggart’s asymmetry of existence – between the non-existence of simples and the existence of the universe as a whole – in a new way]
  • Stern, Robert (2009). Hegelian Metaphysics. OUP: GB.
    • [Gives an excellent history of the movement, and discusses how close McTaggart’s interpretation of Hegel is to Hegel himself]
  • Wisdom, John. 1928. “McTaggart’s Determining Correspondence of Substance: a Refutation”, Mind Vol. 37, 414–438.

 

Author Information

Emily Thomas
Email: aeet2@cam.ac.uk
University of Cambridge
United Kingdom

The Lucas-Penrose Argument about Gödel’s Theorem

In 1961, J.R. Lucas published “Minds, Machines and Gödel,” in which he formulated a controversial anti-mechanism argument.  The argument claims that Gödel’s first incompleteness theorem shows that the human mind is not a Turing machine, that is, a computer.  The argument has generated a great deal of discussion since then.  The influential Computational Theory of Mind, which claims that the human mind is a computer, is false if Lucas’s argument succeeds.  Furthermore, if Lucas’s argument is correct, then “strong artificial intelligence,” the view that it is possible at least in principle to construct a machine that has the same cognitive abilities as humans, is false.  However, numerous objections to Lucas’s argument have been presented.  Some of these objections involve the consistency or inconsistency of the human mind; if we cannot establish that human minds are consistent, or if we can establish that they are in fact inconsistent, then Lucas’s argument fails (for reasons made clear below).  Others object to various idealizations that Lucas’s argument makes.  Still others find some other fault with the argument.  Lucas’s argument was rejuvenated when the physicist R. Penrose formulated and defended a version of it in two books, 1989’s The Emperor’s New Mind and 1994’s Shadows of the Mind. Although there are similarities between Lucas’s and Penrose’s arguments, there are also some important differences.  Penrose argues that the Gödelian argument implies a number of claims concerning consciousness and quantum physics; for example, consciousness must arise from quantum processes and it might take a revolution in physics for us to obtain a scientific explanation of consciousness.  There have also been objections raised to Penrose’s argument and the various claims he infers from it: some question the anti-mechanism argument itself, some question whether it entails the claims about consciousness and physics that he thinks it does, while others question his claims about consciousness and physics, apart from his anti-mechanism argument.

Section one discusses Lucas’s version of the argument.  Numerous objections to the argument – along with Lucas’s responses to these objections – are discussed in section two. Penrose’s version of the argument, his claims about consciousness and quantum physics, and various objections that are specific to Penrose’s claims are discussed in section three. Section four briefly addresses the question, “What did Gödel himself think that his theorem implied about the human mind?”  Finally, section five mentions two other anti-mechanism arguments.

Table of Contents

  1. Lucas’s Original Version of the Argument
  2. Some Possible Objections to Lucas
    1. Consistency
    2. Benacerraf’s Criticism
    3. The Whiteley Sentence
    4. Issues Involving “Idealizations”
    5. Lewis’s Objection
  3. Penrose’s New Version of the Argument
    1. Penrose’s Gödelian Argument
    2. Consciousness and Physics
  4. Gödel’s Own View
  5. Other Anti-Mechanism Arguments
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Lucas’s Original Version of the Argument

Gödel’s (1931) first incompleteness theorem proves that any consistent formal system in which a “moderate amount of number theory” can be proven will be incomplete, that is, there will be at least one true mathematical claim that cannot be proven within the system (Wang 1981: 19).  The claim in question is often referred to as the “Gödel sentence.”  The Gödel sentence asserts of itself: “I am not provable in S,” where “S” is the relevant formal system.  Suppose that the Gödel sentence can be proven in S.  If so, then by soundness the sentence is true in S.  But the sentence claims that it is not provable, so it must be that we cannot prove it in S.  The assumption that the Gödel sentence is provable in S leads to contradiction, so if S is consistent, it must be that the Gödel sentence is unprovable in S, and therefore true, because the sentence claims that it is not provable.  In other words, if consistent, S is incomplete, as there is a true mathematical claim that cannot be proven in S. For an introduction to Gödel’s theorem, see Nagel and Newman (1958).

Gödel’s proof is at the core of Lucas’s (1961) argument, which is roughly the following.  Consider a machine constructed to produce theorems of arithmetic.  Lucas argues that the operations of this machine are analogous to a formal system.  To explain, “if there are only a definite number of types of operation and initial assumptions built into the [machine], we can represent them all by suitable symbols written down on paper” (Lucas 1961: 115).  That is, we can associate specific symbols with specific states of the machine, and we can associate “rules of inference” with the operations of the machine that cause it to go from one state to another.  In effect, “given enough time, paper, and patience, [we could] write down an analogue of the machine’s operations,” and “this analogue would in fact be a formal proof” (ibid).  So essentially, the arithmetical claims that the machine will produce as output, that is, the claims the machine proves to be true, will “correspond to the theorems that can be proved in the corresponding formal system” (ibid).  Now suppose that we construct the Gödel sentence for this formal system.  Since the Gödel sentence cannot be proven in the system, the machine will be unable to produce this sentence as a truth of arithmetic.  However, a human can look and see that the Gödel sentence is true.  In other words, there is at least one thing that a human mind can do that no machine can.  Therefore, “a machine cannot be a complete and adequate model of the mind” (Lucas 1961: 113).  In short, the human mind is not a machine.

Here is how Lucas (1990: paragraph 3) describes the argument:

I do not offer a simple knock-down proof that minds are inherently better than machines, but a schema for constructing a disproof of any plausible mechanist thesis that might be proposed.  The disproof depends on the particular mechanist thesis being maintained, and does not claim to show that the mind is uniformly better than the purported mechanist representation of it, but only that it is one respect better and therefore different.  That is enough to refute that particular mechanist thesis.

Further, Lucas (ibid) believes that a variant of his argument can be formulated to refute any future mechanist thesis.  To explain, Lucas seems to envision the following scenario:  a mechanist formulates a particular mechanistic thesis by claiming, for example, that the human mind is a Turing machine with a given formal specification S.  Lucas then refutes this thesis by producing S’s Gödel sentence, which we can see is true, but the Turing machine cannot.  Then, a mechanist puts forth a different thesis by claiming, for example, that the human mind is a Turing machine with formal specification S’.  But then Lucas produces the Gödel sentence for S’, and so on, until, presumably, the mechanist simply gives up.

One who has not studied Gödel’s theorem in detail might be wondering: why can’t we simply add the Gödel sentence to the list of theorems a given machine “knows” thereby giving the machine the ability Lucas claims it does not have?  In Lucas’s argument, we consider some particular Turing machine specification S, and then we note that “S-machines” (that is, those machines that have formal specification S) cannot see the truth of the Gödel sentence while we can, so human minds cannot be S-machines, at least.  But why can’t we simply add the Gödel sentence to the list of theorems that S-machines can produce?  Doing so will presumably give the machines in question the ability that allegedly separates them from human minds, and Lucas’s argument falters.  The problem with this response is that even if we add the Gödel sentence to S-machines, thereby producing Turing machines that can produce the initial Gödel sentence as a truth of arithmetic, Lucas can simply produce a new Gödel sentence for these updated machines, one which allegedly we can see is true but the new machines cannot, and so on ad infinitum.  In sum, as Lucas (1990: paragraph 9) states,  “It is very natural…to respond by including the Gödelian sentence in the machine, but of course that makes the machine a different machine with a different Gödelian sentence all of its own.”  This issue is discussed further below.

One reason Lucas’s argument has received so much attention is that if the argument succeeds, the widely influential Computational Theory of Mind is false.  Likewise, if the argument succeeds, then “strong artificial intelligence” is false; it is impossible to construct a machine that can perfectly mimic our cognitive abilities.  But there are further implications; for example, a view in philosophy of mind known as Turing machine functionalism claims that the human mind is a Turing machine, and of course, if Lucas is right, this form of functionalism is false. (For more on Turing machine functionalism, see Putnam (1960)).  So clearly there is much at stake.

2. Some Possible Objections to Lucas

Lucas’s argument has been, and still is, very controversial.  Some objections to the argument involve consistency; if we cannot establish our own consistency, or if we are in fact inconsistent, then Lucas’s argument fails (for reasons made clear below).  Furthermore, some have objected that the algorithm the human mind follows is so complex we might be forever unable to formulate our own Gödel sentence; if so, then maybe we cannot see the truth of our own Gödel sentence and therefore we might not be different from machines after all.  Others object to various idealizations that Lucas’s argument makes.  Still others find some other fault with the argument.  In this section, some of the more notable objections to Lucas’s argument are discussed.

a. Consistency

Lucas’s argument faces a number of objections involving the issue of consistency; there are two related though distinct lines of argument on this issue.  First, some claim that we cannot establish our own consistency, whether we are consistent or not.  Second, some claim that we are in fact inconsistent.  The success of either of these objections would be sufficient to defeat Lucas’s argument.  But first, to see why these objections (if successful) would defeat Lucas’s argument, recall that Gödel’s first incompleteness theorem states that if a formal system (in which we can prove a suitable amount of number theory) is consistent, the Gödel sentence is true but unprovable in the system.  That is, the Gödel sentence will be true and unprovable only in consistent systems.  In an inconsistent system, one can prove any claim whatsoever because in classical logic, any and all claims follow from a contradiction; that is, an inconsistent system will not be incomplete.  Now, suppose that a mechanist claims that we are Turing machines with formal specification S, and this formal specification is inconsistent (so the mechanist is essentially claiming that we are inconsistent).  Lucas’s argument simply does not apply in such a situation; his argument cannot defeat this mechanist.  Lucas claims that any machine will be such that there is a claim that is true but unprovable for the machine, and since we can see the truth of the claim but the machine cannot, we are not machines.  But if the machine in question is inconsistent, the machine will be able to prove the Gödel sentence, and so will not suffer from the deficiency that Lucas uses to separate machines from us.  In short, for Lucas’s argument to succeed, human minds must be consistent.

Consequently, if one claims that we cannot establish our own consistency, this is tantamount to claiming that we cannot establish the truth of Lucas’s conclusion.  Furthermore, there are some good reasons for thinking that even if we are consistent, we cannot establish this.  For example, Gödel’s second incompleteness theorem, which quickly follows from his first theorem, claims that one cannot prove the consistency of a formal system S from within the system itself, so, if we are formal systems, we cannot establish our own consistency.  In other words, a mechanist can avoid Lucas’s argument by simply claiming that we are formal systems and therefore, in accordance with Gödel’s second theorem, cannot establish our own consistency.  Many have made this objection to Lucas’s argument over the years; in fact, Lucas discusses this objection in his original (1961) and attributes it to Rogers (1957) and Putnam.  Putnam made the objection in a conversation with Lucas even before Lucas’s (1961) (see also Putnam (1960)).  Likewise, Hutton (1976) argues from various considerations drawn from Probability Theory to the conclusion that we cannot assert our own consistency.  For example, Hutton claims that the probability that we are inconsistent is above zero, and that if we claim that we are consistent, this “is a claim to infallibility which is insensitive to counter-arguments to the point of irrationality” (Lucas 1976: 145).  In sum, for Lucas’s argument to succeed, we must be assured that humans are consistent, but various considerations, including Gödel’s second theorem, imply that we can never establish our own consistency, even if we are consistent.

Another possible response to Lucas is simply to claim that humans are in fact inconsistent Turing machines.  Whereas the objection above claimed that we can never establish our own consistency (and so cannot apply Gödel’s first theorem to our own minds with complete confidence), this new response simply outright denies that we are consistent.  If humans are inconsistent, then we might be equivalent to inconsistent Turing machines, that is, we might be Turing machines.  In short, Lucas concludes that since we can see the truth of the Gödel sentence, we cannot be Turing machines, but perhaps the most we can conclude from Lucas’s argument is that either we are not Turing machines or we are inconsistent Turing machines.  This objection has also been made many times over the years; Lucas (1961) considers this objection too in his original article and claims that Putnam also made this objection to him in conversation.

So, we see two possible responses to Lucas: (1) we cannot establish our own consistency, whether we are consistent or not, and (2) we are in fact inconsistent.  However, Lucas has offered numerous responses to these objections.  For example, Lucas thinks it is unlikely that an inconsistent machine could be an adequate representation of a mind.  He (1961: 121) grants that humans are sometimes inconsistent, but claims that “it does not follow that we are tantamount to inconsistent systems,” as “our inconsistencies are mistakes rather than set policies.”  When we notice an inconsistency within ourselves, we generally “eschew” it, whereas “if we really were inconsistent machines, we should remain content with our inconsistencies, and would happily affirm both halves of a contradiction” (ibid).  In effect, we are not inconsistent machines even though we are sometimes inconsistent; we are fallible but not systematically inconsistent.   Furthermore, if we were inconsistent machines, we would potentially endorse any proposition whatsoever (ibid).  As mentioned above, one can prove any claim whatsoever from a contradiction, so if we are inconsistent Turing machines, we would potentially believe anything.  But we do not generally believe any claim whatsoever (for example, we do not believe that we live on Mars), so it appears we are not inconsistent Turing machines.  One possible counter to Lucas is to claim that we are inconsistent Turing machines that reason in accordance with some form of paraconsistent logic (in paraconsistent logic, the inference from a contradiction to any claim whatsoever is blocked); if so, this explains why we do not endorse any claim whatsoever given our inconsistency (see Priest (2003) for more on paraconsistent logic).  One could also argue that perhaps the inconsistency in question is hidden, buried deep within our belief system; if we are not aware of the inconsistency, then perhaps we cannot use the inconsistency to infer anything at all (Lucas himself mentions this possibility in his (1990)).

Lucas also argues that even if we cannot prove the consistency of a system from within the system itself, as Gödel’s second theorem demonstrates, there might be other ways to determine if a given system is consistent or not.  Lucas (1990) points out that there are finitary consistency proofs for both the propositional calculus and the first-order predicate calculus, and there is also Gentzen’s proof of the consistency of Elementary Number Theory.  Discussing Gentzen’s proof in more detail, Lucas (1996) argues that while Gödel’s second theorem demonstrated that we cannot prove the consistency of a system from within the system itself, it might be that we can prove that a system is consistent with considerations drawn from outside the system.  One very serious problem with Lucas’s response here, as Lucas (ibid) himself notes, is that the wider considerations that such a proof uses must be consistent too, and this can be questioned.  Another possible response is the following: maybe we can “step outside” of, say, Peano arithmetic and argue that Peano arithmetic is consistent by appealing to considerations that are outside of Peano arithmetic; however, it isn’t clear that we can “step outside” of ourselves to show that we are consistent.

Lucas (1976: 147) also makes the following “Kantian” point:

[perhaps] we must assume our own consistency, if thought is to be possible at all.  It is, perhaps like the uniformity of nature, not something to be established at the end of a careful chain of argument, but rather a necessary assumption we must make if we are to start on any thinking at all.

A possible reply is that assuming we are consistent (because this assumption is a necessary precondition for thought) and our actually being consistent are two different things, and even if we must assume that we are consistent to get thought off of the ground, we might be inconsistent nevertheless.  Finally, Wright (1995) has argued that an intuitionist, at least, who advances Lucas’s argument, can overcome the worry over our consistency.

b. Benacerraf’s Criticism

Benacerraf (1967) makes a well-known criticism of Lucas’s argument.  He points out that it is not easy to construct a Gödel sentence and that in order to construct a Gödel sentence for any given formal system one must have a solid understanding of the algorithm at work in the system.  Further, the formal system the human mind might implement is likely to be extremely complex, so complex, in fact, that we might never obtain the insight into its character needed to construct our version of the Gödel sentence.  In other words, we understand some formal systems, such as the one used in Russell and Whitehead’s (1910) Principia, well enough to construct and see the truth of the Gödel sentence for these systems, but this does not entail that we can construct and see the truth of our own Gödel sentence.  If we cannot, then perhaps we are not different from machines after all; we might be very complicated Turing machines, but Turing machines nevertheless.  To rephrase this objection, suppose that a mechanist produces a complex formal system S and claims that human minds are S.  Of course, Lucas will then try to produce the Gödel sentence for S to show that we are not S.  But S is extremely complicated, so complicated that Lucas cannot produce S’s Gödel sentence, and so cannot disprove this particular mechanistic thesis.  In sum, according to Benacerraf, the most we can infer from Lucas’s argument is a disjunction: “either no (formal system) encodes all human arithmetical capacity – the Lucas-Penrose thought – or any system which does has no axiomatic specification which human beings can comprehend” (Wright, 1995, 87).  One response Lucas (1996) makes is that he [Lucas] could be helped in the effort to produce the Gödel sentence for any given formal system/machine.  Other mathematicians could help and so could computers.  In short, at least according to Lucas, it might be difficult, but it seems that we could, at least in principle, determine what the Gödelian formula is for any given system.

c. The Whiteley Sentence

Whiteley (1962) responded to Lucas by arguing that humans have similar limitations to the one that Lucas’s argument attributes to machines; if so, then perhaps we are not different from machines after all.  Consider, for example, the “Whiteley sentence,” that is, “Lucas cannot consistently assert this formula.”  If this sentence is true, then it must be that asserting the sentence makes Lucas inconsistent.  So, either Lucas is inconsistent or he cannot utter the sentence on pain of inconsistency, in which case the sentence is true and so Lucas is incomplete.  Hofstadter (1981) also argues against Lucas along these lines, claiming that we would not even believe the Whiteley sentence, while Martin and Engleman (1990) defend Lucas on this point by arguing against Hofstadter (1981).

d. Issues Involving “Idealizations”

A number of objections to Lucas’s argument involve various “idealizations” that the argument makes (or at least allegedly makes).  Lucas’s argument sets up a hypothetical scenario involving a mind and a machine, “but it is an idealized mind and an idealized machine,” neither of which are subject to limitations arising from, say, human mortality or the inability of some humans to understand Gödel’s theorem, and some believe that once these idealizations are rejected, Lucas’s argument falters (Lucas 1990: paragraph 6).  Several specific instances of this line of argument are considered in successive paragraphs.

Boyer (1983) notes that the output of any human mind is finite.  Since it is finite, it could be programmed into and therefore simulated by a machine.  In other words, once we stop ignoring human finitude, that is, once we reject one of the idealizations in Lucas’s argument, we are not different from machines after all.  Lucas (1990: paragraph 8) thinks this objection misses the point: “What is in issue is whether a computer can copy a living me, when I have not yet done all that I shall do, and can do many different things.  It is a question of potentiality rather than actually that is in issue.”  Lucas’s point seems to be that what is really at issue is what can be done by a human and a machine in principle; if, in principle, the human mind can do something that a machine cannot, then the human mind is not a machine, even if it just so happens that any particular human mind could be modeled by a machine as a result of human finitude.

Lucas (1990: paragraph 9) remarks, “although some degree of idealization seems allowable in considering a mind untrammeled by mortality…, doubts remain about how far into the infinite it is permissible to stray.”    Recall the possible objection discussed above (in section 1) in which the mechanist, when faced with Lucas’s argument, responds by simply producing a new machine that is just like the last except it contains the Gödel sentence as a theorem.  As Lucas points out, this will simply produce a new machine that has a different Gödel sentence, and this can go on forever.  Some might dispute this point though.  For example, some mechanists might try “adding a Gödelizing operator, which gives, in effect a whole denumerable infinity of Gödelian sentences” (Lucas 1990: paragraph 9).  That is, some might try to give a machine a method to construct an infinite number of Gödel sentences; if this can be done, then perhaps any Gödel sentence whatsoever can be produced by the machine.  Lucas (1990) argues that this is not the case, however; a machine with such an operator will have its own Gödel sentence, one that is not on the initial list produced by the operator.  This might appear impossible: how, if the initial list is infinite, can there be an additional Gödel sentence that is not on the list?  It is not impossible though: the move from the initial infinite list of Gödel sentences to the additional Gödel sentence will simply be a move into the “transfinite,” a higher level of infinity than that of the initial list.  It is widely accepted in mathematics, and has been for quite some time, that there are different levels of infinity.

Coder (1969) argues that Lucas has an overly idealized view of the mathematical abilities of many people; to be specific, Coder thinks that Lucas overestimates the degree to which many people can understand Gödel’s theorem and this somehow creates a problem for Lucas’s argument.  Coder holds that since many people cannot understand Gödel’s theorem, all Lucas has shown is that a handful of competent mathematical logicians are not machines (the idea is that Lucas’s argument only shows that those who can produce and see the truth of the Gödel sentence are not machines, but not everyone can do this).  Lucas (1970a) responds by claiming, for example, that the only difference between those who can understand Gödel’s theorem and those who cannot is that, in the case of the former, it is more obvious that they are not machines; it isn’t, say, that some people are machines and others are not.

Dennett (1972) has claimed there is something odd about Lucas’s argument insofar as it seems to treat humans as creatures that simply wander around asserting truths of first-order arithmetic.  Dennett (1972: 530) remarks,

Men do not sit around uttering theorems in a uniform vocabulary, but say things in earnest and jest, makes slips of the tongue, speak several languages…, and – most troublesome for this account – utter all kinds of nonsense and contradictions….

Lucas’s (1990: paragraph 7) response is that these differences between humans and machines that Dennett points to are sufficient for some philosophers to reject mechanism, and that he [Lucas] is simply giving mechanism the benefit of the doubt by assuming that they can explain these differences.  Furthermore, humans can, and some actually do, produce theorems of elementary number theory as output, so any machine that cannot produce all of these theorems cannot be an adequate model of the human mind.

e. Lewis’s Objection

Lewis (1969) has also formulated an objection to Lucas’s argument:

Lewis argues that I [that is, Lucas] have established that there is a certain Lucas arithmetic which is clearly true and cannot be the output of some Turing machine. If I could produce the whole of Lucas arithmetic, then I would certainly not be a Turing machine. But there is no reason to suppose that I am able in general to verify theoremhood in Lucas arithmetic (Lucas 1970: 149).

To clarify, “Peano arithmetic” is the arithmetic that machines can produce and “Lucas arithmetic” is the arithmetic that humans can produce, and Lucas arithmetic will contain Gödel sentences while Peano arithmetic will not, so humans are not machines, at least according to Lucas’s argument.  But Lewis (1969) claims that Lucas has not shown us that he (or anyone else, for that matter) can in fact produce Lucas arithmetic in its entirety, which he must do if his argument is to succeed, so Lucas’s argument is incomplete.   Lucas responds that he does not need to produce Lucas arithmetic in its entirety for his argument to succeed.  All he needs to do to disprove mechanism is produce a single theorem that a human can see is true but a machine cannot; this is sufficient.  Lucas (1970: 149) holds that “what I have to do is to show that a mind can produce not the whole of Lucas arithmetic, but only a small, relevant part.  And this I think I can show, thanks to Gödel’s theorem.”

3. Penrose’s New Version of the Argument

Penrose has formulated and defended versions of the Gödelian argument in two books, 1989’s The Emperor’s New Mind and 1994’s Shadows of the Mind. Since the latter is at least in part an attempt to improve upon the former, this discussion will focus on the latter.  Penrose’s (1994) consists of two main parts: (a) a Gödelian argument to show that humans minds are non-computable and (b) an attempt to infer a number of claims involving consciousness and physics from (a).  (a) and (b) are discussed in successive sections.

a. Penrose’s Gödelian Argument

Penrose has defended different versions of the Gödelian argument.  In his earlier work, he defended a version of the argument that was relatively similar to Lucas’s (although there were some minor differences (for example, in his argument, Penrose used Turing’s theorem, which is closely related to Gödel’s first incompleteness theorem)).  Insofar as this version of the argument overlaps with Lucas’s, this version faces many of the same objections as Lucas’s argument.  In his (1994) though, Penrose formulates a version of the argument that has some more significant differences from Lucas’s version.  Penrose regards this version “as the central (new) core argument against the computational modelling of mathematical understanding” offered in his (1994) and notes that some commentators seem to have completely missed the argument (Penrose 1996: 1.3).

Here is a summary of the new argument (this summary closely follows that given in Chalmers (1995: 3.2), as this is the clearest and most succinct formulation of the argument I know of): (1) suppose that “my reasoning powers are captured by some formal system F,” and, given this assumption, “consider the class of statements I can know to be true.”  (2) Since I know that I am sound, F is sound, and so is F’, which is simply F plus the assumption (made in (1)) that I am F (incidentally, a sound formal system is one in which only valid arguments can be proven).  But then (3) “I know that G(F’) is true, where this is the Gödel sentence of the system F’” (ibid).  However, (4) Gödel’s first incompleteness theorem shows that F’ could not see that the Gödel sentence is true.  Further, we can infer that (5) I am F’ (since F’ is merely F plus the assumption made in (1) that I am F), and we can also infer that I can see the truth of the Gödel sentence (and therefore given that we are F’, F’ can see the truth of the Gödel sentence). That is, (6) we have reached a contradiction (F’ can both see the truth of the Gödel sentence and cannot see the truth of the Gödel sentence).  Therefore, (7) our initial assumption must be false, that is, F, or any formal system whatsoever, cannot capture my reasoning powers.

Chalmers (1995: 3.6) thinks the “greatest vulnerability” with this version of the argument is step (2); specifically, he thinks the claim that we know that we are sound is problematic (he attempts to show that it leads to a contradiction (see Chalmers 1995: section 3)).  Others aside from Chalmers also reject the claim that we know that we are sound, or else they reject the claim that we are sound to begin with (in which case we do not know that we are sound either since one cannot know a falsehood).  For example, McCullough (1995: 3.2) claims that for Penrose’s argument to succeed, two claims must be true: (1) “Human mathematical reasoning is sound.  That is, every statement that a competent human mathematician considers to be “unassailably true” actually is true,” and (2) “The fact that human mathematical reasoning is sound is itself considered to be “unassailably true.””  These claims seem implausible to McCullough (1995: 3.4) though, who remarks, “For people (such as me) who have a more relaxed attitude towards the possibility that their reasoning might be unsound, Penrose’s argument doesn’t carry as much weight.”  In short, McCullough (1995) thinks it is at least possible that mathematicians are unsound so we do not definitively know that mathematicians are sound.  McDermott (1995) also questions this aspect (among others) of Penrose’s argument.  Looking at the way that mathematicians actually work, he (1995: 3.4) claims, “it is difficult to see how thinkers like these could even be remotely approximated by an inference system that chugs to a certifiably sound conclusion, prints it out, then turns itself off.”  For example, McDermott points out that in 1879 Kempe published a proof of the four-color theorem which was not disproved until 1890 by Heawood; that is, it appears there was an 11 year period where many competent mathematicians were unsound.

Penrose attempts to overcome such difficulties by distinguishing between individual, correctable mistakes that mathematicians sometimes make and things they know are “unassailably” true.  He (1994: 157) claims “If [a] robot is…like a genuine mathematician, although it will still make mistakes from time to time, these mistakes will be correctable…according to its own internal criteria of “unassailable truth.””  In other words, while mathematicians are fallible, they are still sound because their mistakes can be distinguished from things they know are unassailably true and can also be corrected (and any machine, if it is to mimic mathematical reasoning, must be the same way).  The basic idea is that mathematicians can make mistakes and still be sound because only the unassailable truths are what matter; these truths are the output of a sound system, and we need not worry about the rest of the output of mathematicians.  McDermott (1995) remains unconvinced; for example, he wonders what “unassailability” means in this context and thinks Penrose is far too vague on the subject.  For more on these issues, including further responses to these objections from Penrose, see Penrose (1996).

b. Consciousness and Physics

One significant difference between Lucas’s and Penrose’s discussions of the Gödelian argument is that, as alluded to above, Penrose infers a number of further claims from the argument concerning consciousness and physics.  Penrose thinks the Gödelian argument implies, for example, that consciousness must somehow arise from the quantum realm (specifically, from the quantum properties of “microtubules”) and that we “will have no chance…[of understanding consciousness]… until we have a much more profound appreciation of the very nature of time, space, and the laws that govern them” (Penrose 1994: 395).  Many critics focus their attention on defeating Penrose’s Gödelian argument, thinking that if it fails, we have little or no reason to endorse Penrose’s claims about consciousness and physics.  McDermott (1995: 2.2) remarks, “all the plausibility of Penrose’s theory of “quantum consciousness” in Part II of the book depends on the Gödel argument being sound,” so, if we can refute the Gödelian argument, we can easily reject the rest.  Likewise, Chalmers (1995: 4.1) claims that the “reader who is not convinced by Penrose’s Gödelian arguments is left with little reason to accept his claims that physics is non-computable and that quantum processes are essential to cognition…”  While there is little doubt that Penrose’s claims about consciousness and physics are largely motivated by the Gödelian argument, Penrose thinks that one might be led to such views in the absence of the Gödelian argument (for example, Penrose (1994) appeals to Libet’s (1992) work in an effort to show that consciousness cannot be explained by classical physics).  Some (such as Maudlin (1995)) doubt that there even is a link between the Gödelian argument and Penrose’s claims about consciousness and physics; therefore, even if the Gödelian argument is sound, this might not imply that Penrose’s views about consciousness and physics are true.  Still others have offered objections that directly and specifically attack Penrose’s claims about consciousness and physics, apart from his Gödelian argument; some of these objections are now briefly discussed.

Some have expressed doubts over whether quantum effects can influence neural processes.  Klein (1995: 3.4) states “it will be difficult to find quantum effects in pre-firing neural activity” because the brain operates at too high of temperature and “is made of floppy material (the neural proteins can undergo an enormously large number of different types of vibration).”  Furthermore, Penrose “discusses how microtubules can alter synaptic strengths…but nowhere is there any discussion of the nature of synaptic modulations that can be achieved quantum-mechanically but not classically” (Klein 1995: 3.6).  Also, “the quantum nature of neural activity across the brain must be severely restricted, since Penrose concedes that neural firing is occurring classically” (Klein 1995: 3.6).  In sum, at least given what we know at present, it is far from clear that events occurring at the quantum level can have any effect, or at least much of an effect, on events occurring at the neural level.  Penrose (1994) hopes that the specific properties of microtubules can help overcome such issues.

As mentioned above, the Gödelian argument, if successful, would show that strong artificial intelligence is false, and of course Penrose thinks strong A.I. is false.   However, Chalmers (1995: 4.2) argues that Penrose’s skepticism about artificial intelligence is driven largely by the fact that “it is so hard to see how the mere enaction of a computation should give rise to an inner subjective life.”  But it isn’t clear how locating the origin of consciousness in quantum processes that occur in microtubules is supposed to help: “Why should quantum processes in microtubules give rise to consciousness, any more than computational processes should?  Neither suggestion seems appreciably better off than the other” (ibid).  According to Chalmers, Penrose has simply replaced one mystery with another.  Chalmers (1995: 4.3) feels that “by the end of the book the “Missing Science of Consciousness” seems as far off as it ever was.”

Baars (1995) has doubts that consciousness is even a problem in or for physics (of course, some philosophers have had similar doubts).  Baars (1995: 1.3) writes,

The…beings we see around us are the products of billions of years of biological evolution. We interact with them – with each other – at a level that is best described as psychological. All of our evidence regarding consciousness …would seem to be exclusively psychobiological.

Furthermore, Baars cites much promising current scientific work on consciousness, points out that some of these current theories have not yet been disproven, that, relatively speaking, our attempt to explain consciousness scientifically is still in its infancy, and concludes that “Penrose’s call for a scientific revolution seems premature at best” (Baars 1995: 2.3).  Baars is also skeptical of the claim that the solution to the problem of consciousness will come from quantum mechanics specifically.  He claims “there is no precedent for physicists deriving from [quantum mechanics] any macro-level phenomenon such as a chair or a flower…much less a nervous system with 100 billion neurons” (section 4.2) and remarks that it seems to be a leap of faith to think that quantum mechanics can unravel the mystery of consciousness.

4. Gödel’s Own View

One interesting question that has not yet been addressed is: what did Gödel think his first incompleteness theorem implied about mechanism and the mind in general?  Gödel, who discussed his views on this issue in his famous “Gibbs lecture” in 1951, stated,

So the following disjunctive conclusion is inevitable: Either mathematics is incompletable in this sense, that its evident axioms can never be comprised in a finite rule, that is to say, the human mind (even within the realm of pure mathematics) infinitely surpasses the powers of any finite machine, or else there exist absolutely unsolvable diophantine problems of the type specified . . . (Gödel 1995: 310).

That is, his result shows that either (i) the human mind is not a Turing machine or (ii) there are certain unsolvable mathematical problems.  However, Lucas (1998: paragraph 1) goes even further and argues “it is clear that Gödel thought the second disjunct false,” that is Gödel “was implicitly denying that any Turing machine could emulate the powers of the human mind.”  So, perhaps the first thinker to endorse a version of the Lucas-Penrose argument was Gödel himself.

5. Other Anti-Mechanism Arguments

Finally, there are some alternative anti-mechanism arguments to Lucas-Penrose.  Two are briefly mentioned.  McCall (1999) has formulated an interesting argument.  A Turing machine can only know what it can prove, and to a Turing machine, provability would be tantamount to truth.  But Gödel’s theorem seems to imply that truth is not always provability.  The human mind can handle cases in which truth and provability diverge.  A Turing machine, however, cannot.  But then we cannot be Turing machines.  A second alternative anti-mechanism argument is formulated in Cogburn and Megill (2010).  They argue that, given certain central tenets of Intuitionism, the human mind cannot be a Turing machine.

6. References and Further Reading

  • Benacerraf, P. (1967). “God, the Devil, and Gödel,” Monist 51:9-32.
    • Makes a number of objections to Lucas’s argument; for example, the complexity of the human mind implies that we might be unable to formulate our own Gödel sentence.
  • Boyer, D. (1983). “J. R. Lucas, Kurt Godel, and Fred Astaire,” Philosophical Quarterly 33:147-59.
    • Argues, among other things, that human output is finite and so can be simulated by a Turing machine.
  • Chalmers, D. J. (1996). “Minds, Machines, and Mathematics,” Psyche 2:11-20.
    • Contra Penrose, we cannot know that we are sound.
  • Coder, D. (1969). “Gödel’s Theorem and Mechanism,” Philosophy 44:234-7.
    • Not everyone can understand Gödel, so Lucas’s argument does not apply to everyone.
  • Cogburn, J. and Megill, J. (2010).  “Are Turing machines Platonists?  Inferentialism and the Philosophy of Mind,” Minds and Machines 20(3): 423-40.
    • Intuitionism and Inferentialism entail the falsity of the Computational Theory of Mind.
  • Dennett, D.C. (1972). “Review of The Freedom of the Will,” The Journal of Philosophy 69: 527-31.
    • Discusses Lucas’s The Freedom of the Will, and specifically his Gödelian argument.
  • Feferman, S. (1996). “Penrose’s Godelian argument,” Psyche 2(7).
    • Points out some technical mistakes in Penrose’s discussion of Gödel’s first theorem.  Penrose responds in his (1996).
  • Gödel, K. (1931). “Über formal unentscheidbare Sätze der Principia Mathematica und verwandter Systeme I,” Monash. Math. Phys. 38: 173-198.
    • Gödel’s first incompleteness theorem.
  • Gödel, K. (1995). Collected Works III (ed. S. Feferman). New York: Oxford University Press.
    • Gödel discusses his first theorem and the human mind.
  • Dennett, D.C. and Hofstadter, D. R. (1981).  The Mind’s I: Fantasies and Reflections on Self and Soul.  New York: Basic Books.
    • Contains Hofstadter’s discussion of the Whiteley sentence.
  • Hutton, A. (1976). “This Gödel is Killing Me,” Philosophia 3:135-44.
    • Probabilistic arguments that show that we can’t know we are consistent.
  • Klein, S.A.  “Is Quantum Mechanics Relevant to Understanding Consciousness,” Psyche 2(3).
    • Questions Penrose’s claims about consciousness arising from the quantum mechanical realm.
  • Lewis, D. (1969). “Lucas against Mechanism,” Philosophy 44:231-3.
    • Lucas cannot produce all of “Lucas Arithmetic.”
  • Libet, B. (1992). “The Neural Time-factor in Perception, volition and free will,” Review de Metaphysique et de Morale 2:255-72.
    • Penrose appeals to Libet to show that classical physics cannot account for consciousness.
  • Lucas, J. R. (1961). “Minds, Machines and Gödel,” Philosophy 36:112-127.
    • Lucas’s first article on the Gödelian argument.
  • Lucas, J. R. (1968). “Satan Stultified: A Rrejoinder to Paul Benacerraf,” Monist 52:145-58.
    • A response to Benacerraf’s (1967).
  • Lucas, J. R. (1970a). “Mechanism: A Rejoinder,” Philosophy 45:149-51.
    • Lucas’s response to Coder (1969) and Lewis (1969).
  • Lucas, J. R. (1970b). The Freedom of the Will. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Discusses and defends the Gödelian argument.
  • Lucas, J. R. (1976). “This Gödel is killing me: A rejoinder,” Philosophia 6:145-8.
    • Lucas’s reply to Hutton (1976).
  • Lucas, J. R. (1990). “Mind, machines and Gödel: A retrospect.”  A paper read to the Turing Conference at Brighton on April 6th.
    • Overview of the debate; Lucas considers numerous objections to his argument.
  • Lucas, J. R. (1996).  “The Godelian Argument: Turn Over the Page.”  A paper read at a BSPS conference in Oxford.
    • Another overview of the debate.
  • Lucas, J. R. (1998).  “The Implications of Gödel’s Theorem.”  A paper read to the Sigma Club.
    • Another overview.
  • Nagel, E. and Newman J.R. (1958).  Gödel’s Proof.  New York: New York University Press.
    • Short and clear introduction to Gödel’s first incompleteness theorem.
  • Martin, J. and Engleman, K. (1990). “The Mind’s I Has Two Eyes,” Philosophy 510-16.
    • More on the Whiteley sentence.
  • Maudlin, T. (1996).  “Between the Motion and the Act…” Psyche 2:40-51.
    • There is no connection between Penrose’s Gödelian argument and his views on consciousness and physics.
  • McCall, S. (1999).  “Can a Turing Machine Know that the Gödel Sentence is True?”  Journal of Philosophy 96(10): 525-32.
    • An anti-mechanism argument.
  • McCullough, D. (1996). “Can Humans Escape Gödel?” Psyche 2:57-65.
    • Among other things, doubts that we know we are sound.
  • McDermott, D. (1996). “*Penrose is wrong,” Psyche 2:66-82.
    • Criticizes Penrose on a number of issues, including the soundness of mathematicians.
  • Penrose, R. (1989). The Emperor’s New Mind. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Penrose’s first book on the Gödelian argument and consciousness.
  • Penrose, R. (1994).  Shadows of the Mind.  Oxford: Oxford University Press.
    • Human reasoning cannot be captured by a formal system; consciousness arises from the quantum realm; we need a revolution in physics to fully understand consciousness.
  • Penrose, R. (1996). “Beyond the Doubting of a Shadow,” Psyche 2(23).
    • Responds to various criticisms of his (1994).
  • Priest, G. (2003). “Inconsistent Arithmetic: Issues Technical and Philosophical,” in Trends in Logic: 50 Years of Studia Logica (eds. V. F. Hendricks and J. Malinowski), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers.
    • Discusses paraconistent logic.
  • Putnam, H. (1960). “Minds and Machines,” Dimensions of Mind. A Symposium (ed. S. Hook). London: Collier-Macmillan.
    • Raises the consistency issue for Lucas.
  • Rogers, H. (1957). Theory of Recursive Functions and Effective Computability (mimeographed).
    • Early mention of the issue of consistency for Gödelian arguments.
  • Whitehead, A. N. and Russell, B. (1910, 1912, 1913). Principia Mathematica, 3 vols, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
    • An attempt to base mathematics on logic.
  • Wang, H. (1981).  Popular Lectures on Mathematical Logic. Mineolam NY: Dover.
    • Textbook on formal logic.
  • Whiteley, C. (1962). “Minds, Machines and Gödel: A Reply to Mr. Lucas,” Philosophy 37:61-62.
    • Humans are limited in ways similar to machines.
  • Wright, C. (1995).  “Intuitionists are Not Turing Machines,” Philosophia Mathematica 3(1):86-102.
    • An intuitionist who advances the Lucas-Penrose argument can overcome the worry over our consistency.

Author Information

Jason Megill
Email: jmegill@carroll.edu
Carroll College
U. S. A.

Philosophy of Medicine

While philosophy and medicine, beginning with the ancient Greeks, enjoyed a long history of mutually beneficial interactions, the professionalization of “philosophy of medicine” is a nineteenth century event.  One of the first academic books on the philosophy of medicine in modern terms was Elisha Bartlett’s Essay on the Philosophy of Medical Science, published in 1844.  In the mid to late twentieth century, philosophers and physicians contentiously debated whether philosophy of medicine was a separate discipline distinct from the disciplines of either philosophy or medicine.  The twenty-first century consensus, however, is that it is a distinct discipline with its own set of problems and questions. Professional journals, books series, individual monographs, as well as professional societies and meetings are all devoted to discussing and answering that set of problems and questions.  This article examines—by utilizing a traditional approach to philosophical investigation—all aspects of the philosophy of medicine and the attempts of philosophers to address its unique set of problems and questions.  To that end, the article begins with metaphysical problems and questions facing modern medicine such as reductionism vs. holism, realism vs. antirealism, causation in terms of disease etiology, and notions of disease and health.  The article then proceeds to epistemological problems and questions, especially rationalism vs. empiricism, sound medical thinking and judgments, robust medical explanations, and valid diagnostic and therapeutic knowledge.  Next, it will address the vast array of ethical problems and questions, particularly with respect to principlism and the patient-physician relationship.  The article concludes with a discussion of what constitutes the nature of medical knowledge and practice, in light of recent trends towards both evidence-based and patient-centered medicine.  Finally, even though a vibrant literature on nonwestern traditions is available, this article is concerned only with the western tradition of philosophy of medicine (Kaptchuk, 2000; Lad, 2002; Pole, 2006; Unschuld, 2010).

Table of Contents

  1. Metaphysics
    1. Reductionism vs. Holism
    2. Realism vs. Antirealism
    3. Causation
    4. Disease and Health
  2. Epistemology
    1. Rationalism vs. Empiricism
    2. Medical Thinking
    3. Explanation
    4. Diagnostic and Therapeutic Knowledge
  3. Ethics
    1. Principlism
    2. Patient-Physician Relationship
  4. What is Medicine?
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Metaphysics

Traditionally, metaphysics pertains to the analysis of objects or events and the forces or factors causing or impinging upon them.  One branch of metaphysics, denoted ontology, investigates problems and questions concerning the nature and existence of objects or events and their associated forces or factors.  For philosophy of medicine in the twenty-first century, the two chief objects are the patient’s disease and health, along with the forces or factors responsible for causing them.  “What is/causes health?” or “What is/causes disease?” are contentious questions for philosophers of medicine.  Another branch of metaphysics involves the examination of presuppositions that inform a given ontology.  For philosophy of medicine, the most controversial debate centers around the presuppositions of reductionism and holism.  Questions like “Can a disease be sufficiently reduced to its elemental components?” or “Is the patient more than simply the sum of physical parts?” drive discussion among philosophers of medicine.  In addition, the debate between realism and antirealism has important traction within the field.  This debate centers on questions like, “Are disease-causing entities real?” or “Are these entities socially constructed?”   This section first explores the reductionism-holism and realism-antirealism debates, along with the notion of causation, before turning attention to the notions of disease and health.

a. Reductionism vs. Holism

The reductionism-holism debate enjoys a lively history, especially from the middle to the latter part of the twentieth century.  Reductionism, broadly construed, is the diminution of complex objects or events to their component parts.  In other words, the properties of the whole are simply the addition or summation of the properties of the individual parts.  Such reductionism is often called metaphysical or ontological reductionism to distinguish it from methodological or epistemological reductionism.  Methodological reductionism refers to the investigation of complex objects and events and their associated forces or factors by using technology that isolates and analyzes individual components only.  Epistemological reductionism involves the explanation of complex objects and events and their associated forces or factors in terms of their individual components only.  For the life sciences vis-à-vis reductionism, an organism is made of component parts like bio-macromolecules and cells, whose properties are sufficient for investigating and explaining the organism, if not life itself.  Life scientists often sort these parts into a descending hierarchy. Beginning with the organism,  they proceed downward through organ systems, individual organs, tissues, cells, and macromolecules until reaching the atomic and subatomic levels.  Albert Szent-Gyorgyi once remarked, as he descended this hierarchy in his quest for understanding living organisms, “life slipped between his fingers.”  Holism, however, is the position that the properties of the whole are not reducible to properties of its individual components.  Jan Smuts (1926) introduced the term in the early part of the twentieth century, especially with respect to biological evolution, to account for living processes—without the need for immaterial components.

The relevance of the reductionism-holism debate pertains to both medical knowledge and practice.  Reductionism influences not only how a biomedical scientist investigates and explains disease, but also how a clinician diagnoses and treats it.  For example, if a biomedical researcher believes that the underlying cause of a mental disease is dysfunction in brain processes or mechanisms, especially at the molecular level, then that disease is often investigated exclusively at that level.  In turn, a clinician classifies mental diseases in terms of brain processes or mechanisms at the molecular level, such as depletion in levels of the neurotransmitter serotonin.  Subsequently, the disease is treated pharmacologically by prescribing drugs to elevate the low levels of the neurotransmitter in the depressed brain to levels considered normal within the non-depressed brain.  Although the assumption of reductionism produces a detailed understanding of diseases in molecular or mechanistic terms, many clinicians and patients are dissatisfied with the assumption.  Both clinicians and patients feel that the assumption excludes important information concerning the nature of the disease, as it influences both the patient’s illness and life experience.  Rather than simply treating the disease, such information is vital for treating patients with chronic cases.  In other words, patients often feel as if physicians reduce them to their disease or diseased body part  rather than on the overall illness experience.  The assumption of holism best suits the approach to medical knowledge and practice that includes the patient’s illness experience.  Rather than striving exclusively for restoration of the patient to a pre-diseased state, the clinician assists the patient in redefining what the illness means for their life.  The outcome is not a physical cure necessarily, as it is healing of wholeness from the fragmentation in the patient’s life caused by the illness.

b. Realism vs. Antirealism

Realism is the philosophical notion that observable objects and events are actual objects and events, independent of the person observing them.  In other words, since it exists outside the minds of those observing it, reality does not depend on conceptual structures or linguistic formulations..  Proponents of realism also espouse that even unobservable objects and events, like subatomic particles, exist.  Historically, realists believe that universals—abstractions of objects and events—are separate from the mind cognizing them.  For example, terms like bacteria and cell denote real objects in the natural world, which exist apart from the human minds trying to examine and understand them.  Furthermore, scientific investigations into natural objects like bacteria and cells yield true accounts of these objects.  Anti-realism, on the other hand, is the philosophical notion that observable objects and events are not actual objects and events as observed by a person but rather they are dependent upon the person observing them.  In other words, these objects and events are mind-dependent—not mind-independent.   Anti-realists deny the existence of objects and events apart from the mind cognizing them.  Human minds construct these objects and events based on social or cultural values.  Historically, anti-realists subscribe to nominalism, in which universals do not exist and predicates of particular objects do.  Finally, they question the truth of scientific accounts of the world since no mind-independent framework can be correct absolutely.  Antirealists hold that such truth is framework dependent, so when one changes the framework, truth itself changes.

The debate among realists and anti-realists has important implications for philosophers of medicine, as well as for the practice of clinical medicine.  For example, a contentious issue is whether disease entities or conditions for the expression of a disease are real or not.  Realists argue that such entities or conditions are real and exist independent of medical researchers investigating them, while anti-realists deny their reality and existence.  Take the example of depression.  According to realists, the neurotransmitter serotonin is a real entity that exists in a real brain—apart from clinical investigations or investigators.  A low level of that transmitter is a real condition for the disease’s expression.  For anti-realists, however, serotonin is a laboratory or clinical construct based on experimental or clinical conditions.  Changes in that construct lead to changes in understanding the disease.  The debate is not simply academic but has traction for the clinic.  Clinical realists believe that restoring serotonin levels cures depression.  Clinical anti-realists are less confident about restoring levels of the neurotransmitter to affect a cure.  Rather, they believe that both diagnosis and treatment of depression do not devolve into simplistic measurements of serotonin levels.  Importantly, the anti-realists do not harbor the hope that additional information is likely to remedy the clinical problems associated with serotonin replacement therapy.  The problems are ontological to their core.  The neurotransmitter is a mental construct entirely dependent on efforts to investigate and translate laboratory investigations into clinical practice.

c. Causation

Causation has a long philosophical history, beginning with the ancient Greek philosophers.  Aristotle in particular provided a robust account of causation in terms of material cause, what something is made of; formal cause, how something is made; efficient cause, forces responsible for making something; and, final cause, the purpose for or end to which something is made.  In the modern period, Francis Bacon pruned the four Aristotelian causes to material and efficient causation.  With the rise of British empiricism, especially with David Hume’s philosophical analysis of causation, causation comes under critical scrutiny.  For Hume, in particular, causation is simply the constant conjunction of object and events, with no ontological significance in terms of hooking up the cause with the effect.  According to Hume, society indoctrinates us to assume something real exists between the cause and its effect.  Although Hume’s skepticism of causal forces prevailed in his personal study, it did not prevail in the laboratory.  During the nineteenth century, with the maturation of the scientific revolution, only one cause survived for accounting for natural entities and phenomena—the material cause, which is not strictly Aristotle’s original notion of material causation.  The modern notion involves mechanisms and processes and thereby eliminates efficient causation.  The material cause became the engine driving mechanistic ontology.  During the twentieth century, after the Einsteinian and quantum revolutions, mechanistic ontology gave way to physical ontology that included forces such as gravity as causal entities.  A century later, efficient causation is the purview of philosophers, who argue endlessly about it, while scientists take physical causation as unproblematic in constructing models of natural phenomena based on cause and effect.

For philosophers of medicine, causation is an important notion for analyzing both disease etiology and therapeutic efficacy (Carter, 2003).  At the molecular level, causation operates physico-chemically to investigate and explain disease mechanisms.  In the example of depression, serotonin is a neurotransmitter that binds specific receptors within certain brain locations, which in turn causes a cascade of molecular events in maintaining mental health.  This underlying causal or physical mechanism is critical not only for understanding the disease, but also for treating it.  Medical causation also operates at other levels.  For infectious diseases, the Henle-Koch postulates are important in determining the causal relationship between an infectious microorganism and an infected host (Evans, 1993).  To secure that relationship the microorganism must be associated with every occurrence of the disease, be isolated from the infected host, be grown under in vitro conditions, and be shown to elicit the disease upon infection of a healthy host.  Finally, medical causation operates at the epidemiological or population level.  Here, Austin Bradford Hill’s nine criteria are critical for establishing a causal relationship between environmental factors and disease incidence (Hill, 1965).  For example, the relationship between cigarette smoking and lung cancer involves the strength of the association between smoking and lung cancer, as well as the consistency of that association for the biological mechanisms.  These examples establish the importance of causal mechanisms involved in disease etiology and treatment, especially for diseases with an organic basis; however, some diseases, particularly mental disorders, do not reduce to such readily apparent causality.  Instead, they represent rich areas of investigations for philosophers of medicine.

d. Disease and Health

“What is disease?” is a contentious question among philosophers of medicine.  These philosophers distinguish among four different notions of disease.  The first is an ontological notion.  According to its proponents, disease is a palpable object or entity whose existence is distinct from that of the diseased patient.  For example, disease may be the condition brought on by the infection of a microorganism, such as a virus.  Critics, who champion a physiological notion of disease, argue that advocates of the ontological notion confuse the disease condition, which is an abstract notion, with a concrete entity like a virus.  In other words, proponents of the first notion often combine the disease’s condition and cause.  Supporters of this second notion argue that disease represents a deviation from normal physiological functioning.  The best-known defender of this notion is Christopher Boorse (1987), who defines disease as a value-free statistical norm with respect to “species design.”  Critics who object to this notion, however, cite the ambiguity of the term “norm” in terms of a reference class.  Instead of a statistical norm, evolutionary biologists propose a notion of disease as a maladaptive mechanism, which factors in the organism’s biological history.  Critics of this third notion claim that disease manifests itself, especially clinically, in terms of the individual patient and not a population.  A population may be important to epidemiologists but not to clinicians who must treat individual patients whose manifestation of a disease and response to therapy for that disease may differ from each other significantly.  The final notion of disease addresses this criticism.  The genetic notion claims that disease is the mutation in or absence of a gene.  Its champions assert that each patient’s genomic constitution is unique. By knowing the genomic constitution, clinicians are able to both diagnose the patient’s disease and tailor a specific therapeutic protocol.  Critics of the genetic notion claim that disease, especially its experience, cannot be reduced to nucleotide sequences.  Instead, it requires a larger notion including social and cultural factors.

“What is health?” is an equally contentious question  among philosophers of medicine.   The most common notion of health is simply absence of disease.  Health, according to proponents of this notion, represents a default state as opposed to pathology.  In other words, if an organism is not sick then it must be healthy.  Unfortunately, this notion does not distinguish between various grades of health or preconditions towards illness.  For example, as cells responsible for serotonin stop producing the neurotransmitter a person is prone to depression.  Such a person is not as healthful as a person who is making sufficient amounts of serotonin.  An adequate understanding of health should account for such preconditions.  Moreover, health as absence of disease often depends upon personal and social values of what is health.  Again, ambiguity enters into defining health given these values.  For one person, health might be very different from that of another.  The second notion of health does permit distinction between grades of health, in terms of quantifying it, and does not depend upon personal or social values.  Proponents of this notion, such as Boorse, define health in terms of normal functioning, where the normal reflects a statistical norm with respect to species design.  For example, a person with low levels of serotonin who is not clinically symptomatic in terms of depression is not as healthful as a person with statistically normal neurotransmitter levels.  Criticisms of the second notion revolve around its lack of incorporating the social dimension of health and jettison the notion altogether opting for the notion of wellbeing.  Wellbeing is a normative notion that combines both a person’s values, especially in terms of his or her life goals, and objective physiological states.  Because normative notions contain a person’s value system, they are often difficult to define and defend since values vary from person to person and culture to culture.  Proponents of this notion include Lennart Nordenfelt (1995), Carol Ryff and Burton Singer (1998), Carolyn Whitbeck (1981).

2. Epistemology

Epistemology is the branch of philosophy concerned with the analysis of knowledge, in terms of both its origins and justification.  The overarching question is, “What is knowing or knowledge?”  Subsidiary questions include, “How do we know that we know?”; “Are we certain or confident in our knowing or knowledge?”; “What is it we know when we claim we know?” Philosophers generally distinguish three kinds or theories of knowledge.  The first pertains to knowledge by acquaintance, in which a knowing or an epistemic agent is familiar with an object or event.  It is descriptive in nature, that is, a knowing-about knowledge.  For example, a surgeon is well acquainted with the body’s anatomy before performing an operation.  The second is competence knowledge, which is the species of knowledge useful for performing a task skillfully.  It is performative or procedural in nature, that is, a knowing-how knowledge.  Again, by way of example, the surgeon must know how to perform a specific surgical procedure before executing it.  The third, which interests philosophers most, is propositional knowledge.  It pertains to certain truths or facts.  As such, philosophers traditionally call this species of knowledge, “justified true belief.”  Rather than descriptive or performative in nature, it is explanatory, or a knowing-that knowledge.  Again, by way of illustration, the surgeon must know certain facts or truths about the body’s anatomy, such as the physiological function of the heart, before performing open-heart surgery.  This section begins with the debate between rationalists and empiricists over the origins of knowledge, before turning to medical thinking and explanation and then concluding with the nature of diagnostic and therapeutic knowledge.

a. Rationalism vs. Empiricism

The rationalism-empiricism debate has a long history, beginning with the ancient Greeks, and focuses on the origins of knowledge and its justification.  “Is that origin rational or empirical in nature?”  “Is knowledge deduced or inferred from first principles or premises?”  “Or, is it the result of careful observation and experience?”  These are just a few of the questions fueling the debate, along with similar questions concerning epistemic justification.  Rationalists, such as Socrates,Plato,  Descartes, and Kant, appeal to reason as being both the origin and the justification of knowledge.  As such, knowledge is intuitive in nature, and in contrast to the senses or perception, it is exclusively the product of the mind.  Given the corruptibility of the senses, argue the rationalists, no one can guarantee or warrant knowledge—except through the mind’s capacity to reason.  In other words, rationalism provides a firm foundation not only for the origin of knowledge but also for warranting its truth.    Empiricists, such as Aristotle, Avicenna, Bacon, Locke, Hume, and Mill, avoid the fears of rationalists and exalt observation and experience with respect to the origin and justification of knowledge.  According to empiricists, the mind is a blank slate (Locke’s tabula rasa) upon which observations and experiences inscribe knowledge.  Here, empiricists champion the role of experimentation in the origin and justification of knowledge.

The rationalism-empiricism debate originates specifically with ancient Greek and Roman medicine.  The Dogmatic school of medicine, founded by Hippocrates’ son and son-in-law in the fourth century BCE, claimed that reason is sufficient for understanding the underlying causes of diseases and thereby for treating them.  Dogmatics relied on theory, especially the humoral theory of health and disease, to practice medicine.  The Empiric school of medicine, on the other hand, asserted that only observation and experience, not theory, is a sufficient foundation for medical knowledge and practice.  Theory is an outcome of medical observation and experience, not their foundation.  Empirics relied on palpable, not underlying, causes to explain health and disease and to practice medicine.  Philinus of Cos and his successor Serapion of Alexandria, both third century BCE Greek physicians, are credited with founding the Empiric school, which included the influential Alexandrian school.  A third school of medicine arose in response to the debate between the Dogmatics and Empirics, the Methodic school of medicine.  In contrast to Dogmatics, and in agreement with Empirics, Methodics argued that underlying causes are superfluous to the practice of medicine.  Rather, the patient’s immediate symptoms, along with common sense, are sufficient and provide the necessary information to treat the patient.  Thus, in contrast to Empirics, Methodics argued that experience is unnecessary to treat disease and that the disease’s symptoms provide all the knowledge needed to practice medicine.

The Dogmatism-Empiricism debate, with Methodism representing a minority position, raged on and was still lively in the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries.  For example, Giorgio Baglivi (1723), an Armenian-born seventeenth century Italian physician, decried the polarization of physicians along dogmatic and empiric boundaries and recommended resolving the debate by combining the two.  Contemporary philosophical commentators on medicine recognize the importance of both epistemic positions, and several commentators propose synthesis of them.  For example, Jan van Gijn (2005) advocates an “empirical cycle” in which experiments drive hypothetical thinking, which in turn results in additional experimentation.  Although no clear resolution of the rationalism-empiricism debate in medicine appears on the immediate horizon, the debate does emphasize the importance of and the need for additional philosophical analysis of epistemic issues surrounding medical knowledge.

b. Medical Thinking

“How doctors think” is the title of two  twenty-first century books on medical thinking.  The first is by a medical humanities scholar, Kathryn Montgomery (2006).  Montgomery addresses vital questions about how physicians go about making clinical decisions when often faced with tangible uncertainty.  She argues for medical thinking based not on science but on Aristotelian phronesis, or practical or intuitive reasoning.  The second book is by a practicing clinician, Jerome Groopman (2007).  Groopman also addresses questions about medical thinking, and he too pleads for clinical reasoning based on practical or intuitive foundations.  Both books call for introducing the art of medical thinking to offset the over dependence on the science of medical thinking.  In general, medical thinking reflects the cognitive faculties of clinicians to make rational decisions about what ails patients and how best to go about treating them both safely and effectively.  That thinking, during the twentieth century, mimicked the technical thinking of natural scientists—and, for good reason.  As Paul Meehl (1954) convincingly demonstrated, statistical reasoning in the clinical setting out performs intuitive clinical thinking.  Although Montgomery’s and Groopman’s attempts to swing the pendulum back to the art of medical thinking, the risk of medical errors often associated with such thinking demands clearer analysis of the science of medical thinking.  That analysis centers traditionally on both logical and algorithmic methods of clinical judgment and decision-making, to which the twenty-first century has turned.

Georg Stahl’s De logico medica, published in 1702, is one of the first modern treatises on medical logic.  However, not until the nineteenth century did logic of medicine become an important area of sustained analysis or have an impact on medical knowledge and practice.  For example, Friedrich Oesterlen’s Medical logic, published in English translation in 1855, promoted medical logic not only as a tool for assessing the formal relationship between propositional statements and thereby avoiding clinical error, but also for analyzing the relationship among medical facts and evidence in the generation of medical knowledge.  Oesterlen’s logic of medicine was indebted to the Paris school of clinical medicine, especially Pierre Louis’ numerical method (Morabia, 1996).  Contemporary logic of medicine continues this tradition, especially in terms of statistical analysis of experimental and clinical data.  For example, Edmond Murphy’s The Logic of Medicine (1997) represents an analysis of logical and statistical methods used to evaluate both experimental and clinical evidence.  Specifically, Murphy identifies several “rules of evidence” critical for interpreting such evidence as medical knowledge.  A particularly vigorous debate concerns the role of frequentist vs. Bayesian statistics in determining the statistical significance of data from clinical trials.  The logic of medicine, then, represents an important and a fruitful discipline in which medical scientists and clinical practitioners can detect and avoid errors in the generation and substantiation of medical knowledge and in its application or translation to the clinic.

Philosophers of medicine actively debate the best courses of action for making clinical decisions.  For, clinical judgment is an informal process in which a clinician assesses a patient’s clinical signs and symptoms to come to an accurate judgment about what is ailing the patient. To make such a judgment requires an insight into the intelligibility of the clinical evidence.  The issue for philosophers of medicine is what role intuition should play in clinical judgment when facing the ideals of objective scientific reasoning and judgment.  Meehl’s work on clinical judgment, as noted earlier casted suspicion on the effectiveness of intuition in clinical judgment; and yet, some philosophers of medicine champion  the understood dimension in such decision-making.  The debate often reduces to whether clinical judgment is an art or a science; however, some, like Alvan Feinstein (1994), argue for a reconciliatory position between them.  Once a physician comes to a judgment then the physician must make a decision as to how to proceed clinically.  Although clinical decision making, with its algorithmic-like decision trees, is a formal procedure compared to clinical judgment, philosophers of medicine actively argue about the structure of these trees and procedures for generating and manipulating them.  The main issue is how best to define the utility grounding the trees.

c. Explanation

Epistemologists are generally interested in the nature of propositions especially the explanatory power of those justified true beliefs.  To know something truly is to understand and explain the hidden causes behind it.  Explanations operate at a variety of levels.  For example, neuroscientific explanations account for human behavior in terms of the neurological activity while astrological explanations account for such behavior with respect to astronomical activity.  Philosophers, especially philosophers of science, distinguish several kinds of explanations, including the covering law explanation, causal explanation, and inference to the best explanation.  In twenty-first century medicine, explanations are important for understanding disease mechanisms and, in understanding those mechanisms, for developing therapeutic modalities to treat the patient’s disease.  This line of reasoning runs deep in medical history, beginning, as we have seen, with the Dogmatics.  Twenty-first century philosophers of medicine utilize the explanatory schemes developed by philosophers of science to account for medical phenomena.  The Following section will briefly examine each of these explanatory schemes and their relevance for medical explanations.

Carl Hempel and Paul Oppenheim introduced covering law explanation in the late 1940s.  According to Hempel and Oppenheim (1948), explanations function as arguments with the conclusion or explanandum—that which is explained—deduced or induced from premises or explanans—that which does the explaining.  At least one of the explanans must be a scientific law, which can be a mechanistic or statistical law.  Although covering law explanations are useful for those medical phenomena that reduce to mechanistic or statistical laws, such as explaining cardiac output in terms of heart rate and stroke volume, not all such phenomena lend themselves to such reductive explanations.  The next explanatory scheme, causal explanation, attempts to rectify that problem.  Causal explanation relies on the temporal or spatial regularity of phenomena and events and utilizes antecedent causes to explain phenomena and events.  The explanations can be simplistic in nature, with only a few antecedent causes arranged linearly, or very complex, with multiple antecedent causes operating in a matrix of interrelated and integrated interactions.  For example, causal explanations of cancer involve at least six distinct sets of genetic factors controlling cellular phenomena such as cell growth and death, immunological response, and angiogenesis.  Finally, Gilbert Harman articulated the contemporary form of inference to the best explanation, or IBE, in the 1960s.  Harman (1965) proposed that based on the totality of evidence one must choose the explanation that best accounts for or infers that evidence and reject its competitors.  The criteria for “bestness” range from the explanation’s simplicity to its generality or consilience to account for analogous phenomena.  Peter Lipton (2004) offers Ignaz Semmelweis’ explanation of increased mortality of women giving birth in one ward compared to another, as an example of IBE.  Donald Gillies (2005) provides an analysis of it in terms of Kuhnian paradigm.

d. Diagnostic and Therapeutic Knowledge

Diagnostic knowledge pertains to the clinical judgments and decisions made about what ails a patient.  Epistemologically, the issues concerned with such knowledge are its accuracy and certainty.  Central to both these concerns are clinical symptoms and signs.  Clinical symptoms are subjective manifestations of the disease that the patient articulates during the medical interview, while clinical signs are objective manifestations that the physician discovers during the physical examine.  What is important for the clinician is how best to quantify those signs and symptoms, and then to classify them in a robust nosology or disease taxonomy.  The clinical strategy is to collect the empirical data through the physical examination and laboratory tests, to deliberate on that data, and then to draw a conclusion as to what the data means in terms of the patient’s disease condition.  The strategy is fraught with questions for philosophers of medicine, from “What constitutes symptoms and signs and how they differ?” to “How best to measure and quantify the signs and to classify the diseases?”  Philosophers of medicine debate the answers to these questions, but the discussion among philosophers of science over the strategy by which natural scientists investigate the natural world guides much of the debate.  Thus, a clinician generates hypotheses about a patient’s disease condition, which he or she then assesses by conducting further medical tests.  The result of this process is a differential diagnosis, which represents a set of hypothetical explanations for the patient’s disease condition.  The clinician then narrows this set to one diagnostic hypothesis that best explains most, and hopefully all, of the relevant clinical evidence.  The epistemic mechanism that accounts for this process and the factors involved in it are unclear.  Philosophers of medicine especially dispute the role of tacit factors in the process.  Finally, the heuristics of the process are an active area of philosophical investigation in terms of identifying rules for interpreting clinical evidence and observations.

Therapeutic knowledge refers to the procedures and modalities used to treat patients.  Epistemologically, the issues concerned with such knowledge are its efficacy and safety.  Efficacy refers to how well the pharmacological drug or surgical procedure treats or cures the disease, while safety refers to possible patient harm caused by side effects.  The questions animating discussion among philosophers of medicine range from “What is a cure?” to “How to establish or justify the efficacy of a drug or procedure?” The latter question occupies a considerable amount of the philosophy of medicine literature, especially the nature and role of clinical trials.  Although basic medical research into the etiology of disease mechanisms is important, the translation of that research and the philosophical problems that arise from it are foremost on the agenda for philosophers of medicine.  The origin of clinical trials dates at least to the eighteenth century but not until the twentieth century is consensus reached over the structure of these trials.  Today, four phases define a clinical trial.  During the first phase, clinical investigators establish the maximum tolerance of healthy volunteers to a drug.  The next phase involves a small patient population to determine the drug’s efficacy and safety.  In the third phase, which is the final phase required to obtain FDA approval, clinical investigators utilize a large and relatively diverse patient population to establish the drug’s efficacy and safety.  A fourth stage is possible in which clinical investigators chart the course of the drug’s use and effectiveness in a diverse patient population over a longer period.  The following are topics of active discussion among philosophers of medicine: The nature of clinical trials with respect to features like randomizing in which test subjects are arbitrarily assigned to either experimental or control groups, blinding of patients and physicians to randomizing to remove assessment bias, concurrent control in which the control group does not receive the experimental treatment that the test group receives, and the role of the placebo effect or the expected benefit patient’s anticipate from receiving treatment represent.  However, the most pressing problem is the type of statistics utilized for analyzing clinical trial evidence.   Some philosophers of medicine champion frequentist statistics, while others Bayesian statistics.

3. Ethics

Ethics is the branch of philosophy concerned with the right or moral conduct or behavior of a community and its members.  Traditionally, philosophers divide ethics into descriptive, normative, and applied ethics.  Descriptive ethics involves detailing ethical conduct without evaluating it in terms of moral codes of conduct, whereas normative ethics pertains to how a community and its members should act under given situations, generally in terms of an ethical code.  This code is often a product of certain values held in common within a community.  For example, ethical codes against murder reflect values community members place upon taking human life without just cause.  Besides values, ethicists base normative ethics on a particular theoretical perspective.  Within western culture, three such perspectives predominate.  The first and historically oldest ethical theory—although it experienced a Renaissance in the late twentieth century—is virtue ethics.  Virtue ethics claims that ethical conduct is the product of a moral agent who possesses certain virtues, such as prudence, courage, temperance, or justice—the traditional cardinal virtues.  The second ethical theory is deontology and bases moral conduct on adherence to ethical precepts and rules reflecting moral duties and obligations.  The third ethical theory is consequentialism, which founds moral conduct on the outcome or consequence of an action.  The chief example of this theory is utilitarianism, or the maximization of an action’s utility, which claims that an action is moral if it realizes the greatest amount of happiness for the greatest number of community members.   Finally, applied ethics is the practical use of ethics within a profession such as business or medicine.  Medical or biomedical ethics reflects applied ethics and is a major feature within the landscape of twenty-first century medicine.  Historically, ethical issues are a conspicuous component of medicine beginning with Hippocrates.  Throughout medical history several important treatises on medical ethics have been published.  Probably the best-known example is Thomas Percival’s Medical Ethics, published in 1803, which influenced the development of the American Medical Association’s ethical code.  Today, medical ethics is founded not on any particular ethical theory but on four ethical principles.

a. Principlism

The origins of the predominant system for contemporary medical or biomedical ethics began in 1932.  In that year, the Public Health Service, in conjunction with the Tuskegee Institute in Macon County, Alabama, undertook a clinical study to document the course of syphilis on untreated test subjects.  The subjects were Afro-American males.  Over the next forty years, healthcare professionals observed the course of the disease, even after the introduction of antibiotics.  Not until 1972, did the study end and only after public outcry from newspaper articles—especially an article in the New York Times—reporting the study’s atrocities.  What made the study so atrocious was that the healthcare professionals misinformed the subjects about treatment or failed to treat the subjects with antibiotics.  To insure that such flagrant abuse of test subjects did not happen again, the National Commission for the Protection of Human Subjects of Biomedical and Behavioral Research met from February 13-16, 1976.  At the Smithsonian Institute’s Belmont Conference Center in Maryland, the commission drafted guidelines for the treatment of research subjects.  The outcome was a report entitled, Ethical Principles and Guidelines for the Protection of Human Subjects of Research, or known simply as the Belmont Report, published in 1979.  The report lists and discusses several ethical principles necessary for protecting human test subjects and patients from unethical treatment at the hands of healthcare researchers and providers.  The first is respect for persons, in that researchers must respect the test subject’s autonomy to make informed decisions based on accurate and truthful information concerning the test study’s procedures and risks.  The next principle is beneficence or maximizing the benefits to risk ratio for the test subject.  The final ethical principle is justice, which ensures that the cost to benefit ratio is equitably distributed among the general population and that no one segment of it bears an unreasonable burden with respect to the ratio.

One of the framers of the Belmont Report was a young philosopher named Tom Beauchamp.  While working on the report, Beauchamp, in collaboration with a colleague, James Childress, was also writing a book on the role of ethical principles in guiding medical practice.  Rather than ground biomedical ethics on any particular ethical theory, such as deontology or utilitarianism, Beauchamp and Childress looked to ethical principles for guiding and evaluating moral decisions and judgments in healthcare.  The fruit of their collaboration was Principles of Biomedical Ethics, first published in the same year as the Belmont Report, 1979.  In the book, Beauchamp and Childress apply the ethical principles approach of the report to regulate the activities of biomedical researchers, to assist physicians in deliberating over the ethical issues associated with the practice of clinical medicine.  However, besides the three guiding principles of the report, they added a fourth—nonmaleficence.  Moreover, the first principle became patient autonomy, rather than respect of persons as denoted in the report.  For the autonomy principle, Beauchamp and Childress stress the patient’s liberty to make critical decisions concerning treatment options, which have a direct impact on the patient’s own values and life plans.  The authors’ second principle, nonmaleficence, instructs the healthcare provider to avoid doing harm to the patient, while the next principle of beneficence emphasizes removing harm and doing good to the patient.  Beauchamp and Childress articulate the final principle, justice, in terms reminiscent of the Belmont report with respect to equitable distribution of risks and benefits, as well as healthcare resources, among both the general and patient populations.  The bioethical community quickly dubbed  the Beauchamp and Childress approach to biomedical ethics as principlism.

Principlism’s impact on the bioethical discipline is unparalleled.  Beauchamp and Childress’ book is now in its fifth edition and is a standard textbook for teaching biomedical ethics at medical schools and graduate programs in medical ethics.  One of the chief advocates of principlism is Raanan Gillon (1986)  Gillon expanded the scope of the principles to aid in their application to difficult bioethical issues, especially where the principles might conflict with one another.  However, principlism is not without its critics.  A fundamental complaint is the lack of theoretical support for the four principles, especially when the principles collide with one another in terms of their application to a bioethical problem. In its use, ethicists and clinicians generally apply the principles in an algorithmic manner to justify practically any ethical position on a biomedical problem.  What critics want is a unified theoretical basis for grounding the principles, in order to avoid or adjudicate conflicts among the principles.  Moreover, Beauchamp and Childress’ emphasis on patient autonomy had serious ramifications on the physician’s role in medical care, with that role at times marginalized to the patient’s role.  Alfred Tauber (2005), for instance, charges that such autonomy itself is “sick” and often results in patients abandoned to their own resources with detrimental outcomes for them.  In response to their critics, Beauchamp and Childress argue that no single ethical theory is available to unite the four principles to avoid or adjudicate conflicts among them.  However, they did introduce in the fourth edition of Principles, a notion of common morality—a set of shared moral standards—to provide theoretical support for the principles.  Unfortunately, their notion of common morality lacks the necessary theoretical robustness to unify the principles effectively.  Although principlism still serves a useful function in biomedical ethics, particularly in the clinic, early twenty-first century trends towards healthcare ethics and global bioethics have made its future unclear.

b. Patient-Physician Relationship

According to many philosophers of medicine, medicine is more than simply a natural or social science; it is a moral enterprise.  What makes medicine moral is the patient-physician or therapeutic relationship.  Although some philosophers of medicine criticize efforts to model the relationship, given the sheer number of contemporary models proposed to account for it, modeling the relationship has important ramifications for understanding and framing the moral demands of medicine and healthcare.  The traditional medical model within the industrialized West, especially in mid twentieth century America, was paternalism or “doctor knows best.”  The paternalistic model is doctor-centered in terms of power distribution, with the patient representing a passive agent who simply follows the doctor’s orders.  The patient is not to question those orders, unless to clarify them.  The source for this power distribution is the doctor’s extensive medical education and training relative to the patient’s lack of medical knowledge.  In this model, the doctor represents a parent, generally a father figure and the patient a child—especially a sick child.  The motivation of this model is to relieve a patient burdened with suffering from a disease, to benefit the patient from the doctor’s medical knowledge, and to affect a cure while returning the patient to health.  In other words, the model’s guiding principle is beneficence.  Besides the paternalistic model, other doctor-centered models include the priestly and mechanic models.  However, the paternalistic model, as well as the other doctor-centered models, ran into severe criticism with abuses associated with the models and with the rise of patient advocacy groups to correct the abuses.

Within the latter part of the twentieth century and the rise of patient autonomy as a guiding principle for medical practice, alternative patient-physician models challenged traditional medical paternalism.  Instead of doctor-centered, one set of models are patient-centered in which patients are the locus of power.  The most predominant patient-centered model is the business model, where the physician is a healthcare provider and the patient a consumer of healthcare goods and services.  The business model is an exchange relationship and relies heavily on a free market system.  Thus, the patient possesses the power to pick and choose among physicians until a suitable healthcare provider is found.  The legal model is another patient-centered model, in which the patient is a client and the guiding forces are patient autonomy and justice.  Patient and physician enter into a contract for healthcare services.  Another set of models in which patients have significant power in the therapeutic relationship are the mutual models.  In these models, neither patients nor physicians have the upper hand in terms of power-they share it.  The most predominant model is the partnership model in which patient and physician are associates in the therapeutic relationship.  The guiding force of this model is informed consent in which the physician apprises the patient of the available therapeutic options and the patient then chooses which is best.  Both the patient and physician share decision making over the best means for affecting a cure.  Finally, other examples of mutual models include the covenant model, which stresses promise instead of contract; the friendship model, which involves a familial-like relationship; and, the neighbor model, which maintains a “safe” distance and yet familiarity between patient and physician.

4. What is Medicine?

The nature of medicine is certainly an important question facing twenty-first century philosophers of medicine.  One reason for its importance is that the question addresses the vital topic of how physicians should practice medicine.  During the turn of the twenty-first century, clinicians and other medical pundits have begun to accept evidence-based medicine, or EBM, as the best way to practice medicine.  Proponents of EBM claim that physicians should engage in medical practices based on the best scientific and clinical evidence available, especially from randomized controlled clinical trials, systematic observations, and meta-analyses of that evidence, rather than on pathophysiology or an individual physician’s clinical experience. Proponents also claim that EBM represents a paradigmatic shift away from traditional medicine.  Traditional practitioners doubt the radical claims of EBM proponents.  One specific objection is that application of evidence from population based clinical trials to the individual patient within the clinic is not as easy to accomplish as EBM proponents realize.  In response, some clinicians propose patient-centered medicine (PCM).   Patient-centered advocates include the patient’s personal information in order to apply the best available scientific and clinical evidence in treatment.  The focus then shifts from the patience’s disease to the patience’s illness experience.  The key for the practice of patient-centered medicine is a physician’s effective communication with the patient.  While some commentators present EBM and PCM as competitors, others propose a combination or integration of the two medicines.  The debate between advocates of EBM and PCM is reminiscent of an earlier debate between the science and art of medicine and belies a deep anxiety over the nature of medicine.  Certainly, philosophers of medicine can play a strategic role in the debate and assist towards its satisfactory resolution.

Besides its nature,  twenty-first century medicine also faces a number of crises, including economic, malpractice, healthcare insurance, healthcare policy, professionalism, public or global health, quality-of-care, primary or general care, and critical care—to name a few (Daschle, 2008; Relman, 2007).  Philosophers of medicine can certainly contribute to the resolution of these crises by carefully and insightfully analyzing the issues associated with them.  For example, considerable attention has been paid in the literature to the crisis over the nature of medical professionalism (Project of the ABIM Foundation, et al., 2002; Tallis, 2006).  The question that fuels this crisis is what type of physician best meets the patient’s healthcare needs and satisfies medicine’s social contract.  The answer to this question involves the physician’s professional demeanor or character.  However, little consensus as to how best to define professionalism is palpable in the literature.  Philosophers of medicine can aid by furnishing guidance towards a consensus on the nature of medical professionalism.

Philosophy of medicine is a vibrant field of exploration into the world of medicine in particular, and of healthcare in general.  Along traditional lines of metaphysics, epistemology, and ethics, a cadre of questions and problems face philosophers of medicine and cry out for attention and resolution.  In addition, many competing forces are vying for the soul of medicine today.  Philosophy of medicine is an important resource for reflecting on those forces in order to forge a medicine that meets both physical and existence needs of patients and society.

5. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

James A. Marcum
Email: James_Marcum@baylor.edu
Baylor University
U. S. A.

Synesthesia

The word “synesthesia” or “synaesthesia,” has its origin in the Greek roots, syn, meaning union, and aesthesis, meaning sensation: a union of the senses.  Many researchers use the term “synesthesia” to refer to a perceptual anomaly in which a sensory stimulus associated with one perceptual modality automatically triggers another insuppressible sensory experience which is usually, but not always, associated with a different perceptual modality as when musical tones elicit the visual experience of colors (“colored-hearing”).  Other researchers consider additional unusual correspondences under the category of synesthesias, including the automatic associations of specific objects with genders, ascriptions of unique personalities to numbers, and the involuntary assignment of spatial locations to months or days of the week.  Many synesthetes experience more than one cross-modal correspondence, and others who have unusual cross-modal sensory experiences also have some non-sensory correspondences such as those mentioned above.

Researchers from fields as varied as neurology, neuroscience, psychology and aesthetics have taken an interest in the phenomenon of synesthesia.  Consideration of synesthesia has also shed light on important subjects in philosophy of mind and cognitive science.  For instance, one of the most widely discussed problems in recent philosophy of mind has been to determine how consciousness fits with respect to physical descriptions of the world.  Consciousness refers to the seemingly irreducible subjective feel of ongoing experience, or the character of what it is like.  Philosophers have attempted to reduce consciousness to properties that will ultimately be more amenable to physical characterizations such as representational or functional properties of the mind.  Some philosophers have argued that reductive theories such as representationalism and functionalism cannot account for synesthetic experience.

Another metaphysical project is to provide an account of the nature of color.  There are two main types of views on the nature of color.  Color objectivists take color to be a real feature of the external world.  Color subjectivists take color to be a mind-dependent feature of the subject (or the subject’s experience).  Synesthesia has been used as a counter-example to color objectivism.  Not everyone agrees, however, that synesthesia can be employed to this end.  Synesthesia has also been discussed in regards to the issue of what properties perceptual experiences can represent objects as having (for example, colors).  The standard view is that color experiences represent objects as having color properties, but a special kind of grapheme-color synesthesia may show that color experience can signify numerical value.  If this is right, it shows that perceptual experiences can represent so-called “high-level” properties.

Synesthesia may also be useful in arbitrating the question of how mental processing can be so efficient given the abundance of mentally stored information and the wide variety of problems that we encounter, which must each require highly specific albeit different, processing solutions.  The modular theory of mind is a theory about mental architecture and processing aimed at solving these problems.  On the modular theory, at least some processing is performed in informationally encapsulated sub-units that evolved to perform unique processing tasks.  Synesthesia has been used as support for mental modularity in several different ways.  While some argue that synesthesia is due to an extra module, others argue that synesthesia is better explained as a breakdown in the barrier that keeps information from being shared between modules.

This article begins with an overview of synesthesia followed by a discussion of synesthesia as it has been relevant to philosophers and cognitive scientists in their discussions of the nature of consciousness, color, mental architecture, and perceptual representation, as well as several other topics.

Table of Contents

  1. Synesthesia
  2. Consciousness
    1. Representationalism
    2. Functionalism
  3. Modularity
  4. Theories of Color
  5. An Extraordinary Feature of Color-Grapheme Synesthesia
  6. Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Psychology
  7. Individuating the Senses
  8. Aesthetics and “Literary Synesthesia”
  9. Synesthesia and Creativity
  10. References and Further Reading

1. Synesthesia

Most take synesthesia to be a relatively rare perceptual phenomenon. Reports of prevalence vary, however, from 1 in 25,000 (Cytowic, 1997) to 1 in 200 (Galton, 1880), to even 1 in 20 (Simner et al., 2006).  It typically involves inter-modal experiences such as when a sound triggers a concurrent color experience (a photism), but it can also occur within modalities.  For example, in grapheme-color synesthesia the visual experience of alpha-numeric graphemes such as of a “4” or a “g,” induces color photisms.  These color photisms may appear to the synesthete as located inside the mind, in the peri-personal space surrounding the synesthete’s body (Grossenbacher & Lovelace, 2001), or as being projected right where the inducing grapheme is situated perhaps as if a transparency were placed on top of the grapheme (Dixon, et al., 2004).  Reported cross-modal synesthesias also include olfactory-tactile (where a scent induces a tactile experience such as of smoothness), tactile-olfactory, taste-color, taste-tactile and visual-olfactory, among others.  It is not clear which of these is most common.  Some researchers report that colored-hearing is the most commonly occurring form of synesthesia (Cytowic, 1989; Harrison & Baron-Cohen, 1997), and others report that approximately 68% of synesthetes have the grapheme-color variety (Day, 2005).  Less common forms include sound-olfactory, taste-tactile and touch-olfactory.  In recent years, synesthesia researchers have increasingly been attending to associations that don’t fit the typical synesthesia profile of cross activations between sensory modalities, such as associations of specific objects with genders, ascriptions of unique personalities to particular numbers, and the involuntary assignment of spatial locations to months or days of the week.  Many synesthetes report having these unusual correspondences in addition to cross-modal associations.

Most studied synesthesias are assumed to have genetic origins (Asher et al., 2009).  It has long been noted that synesthesia tends to run in families (Galton, 1883) and the higher proportion of female synesthetes has led some to speculate that it is carried by the X chromosome (Cytowic, 1997; Ward & Simner, 2005).  However, there are also reports of acquired synesthesias induced by drugs such as LSD or mescaline (Rang & Dale, 1987) or resulting from neurologic conditions such as epilepsy, trauma or other lesion (Cytowic, 1997; Harrison & Baron-Cohen, 1997; Critchley, 1997).  Recent studies suggest it may even be brought on through training (Meier & Rothen, 2009; Proulx, 2010) or post-hypnotic suggestion (Kadosh et al., 2009).  Another hypothesis is that synesthesia may have both genetic and developmental origins.  Additionally, some researches propose that synesthesia may arise in genetically predisposed children in response to demanding learning tasks such as the development of literacy.

Up until very recently, the primary evidence for synesthesia has come from introspectively based verbal reports.  According to Harrison and Baron-Cohen (1997), synesthesia is late in being a subject of scientific interest because the previously prevailing behaviorists rejected the importance of subjective phenomena and introspective report.  Some other researchers continue to downplay the reality of synesthesia, claiming that triggered concurrents are likely ideational in character rather than perceptual (for discussion and criticism of this view see Cytowic, 1989; Harrison, 2001; Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2001a).  One hypothesis is that synesthetic ideas result from learned associations that are so vivid in the minds of synesthetes that subjects mistakenly construe them to be perceptual phenomena.  As psychologists swung from physicalism back to mentalism, however, subjective experience became more accepted as an area of scientific inquiry.  In recent years, scientists have begun to study aspects of subjectivity, such as the photisms of synesthetes, using third person methods of science.

Recent empirical work on synesthesia suggests its perceptual reality.  For example, synesthesia is thought to influence attention (Smilek et al., 2003). Moreover, synesthetes have long reported that photisms can aid with memory (Luria, 1968).  And indeed, standard memory tests show synesthetes to be better with recall where photisms would be involved (Cytowic 1997; Smilek et al., 2002).

Other studies aimed at confirming the legitimacy of synesthesia have demonstrated that genuine synesthesia can be distinguished from other common types of learned associations in that it is remarkably consistent; over time synesthetes’ sensation pairings (for example, the grapheme 4 with the color blue) remain stable across multiple testings whereas most learned associations do not.  Synesthetes tested and retested to confirm consistency of pairings on multiple occasions, at an interval of years and without warning, exhibit consistency as high as 90% (Baron-Cohen, et al., 1987).  Non-synesthete associators are not nearly as consistent.

Grouping experiments are used to distinguish between perceptual and non-perceptual features of experience (Beck, 1966; Treisman, 1982).  In common grouping experiments, subjects view a scene comprised of vertical and tilted lines.  In perception, the tilted and vertical lines appear as grouped independently.  Studies seem to show some grapheme-color synesthetes to be subject to pop-out and grouping effects based on colored photisms (Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2001a, b; Edquist et al., 2006).  If an array of 2’s in the form of a triangle are hidden within a field of distracter graphemes such as 5’s, the 2’s may “pop-out” or appear immediately and saliently in experience as forming a triangle so long as the color ascribed to the 2’s is incongruent with the color of the 5’s (Ramachandran and Hubbard, 2001b).

synesthesia graphic

Some take these studies to show that, for at least some synesthetes, the concurrent colors are genuinely perceptual phenomena arising at a relatively early pre-conscious stage of visual processing, rather than associated ideas, which would arise later in processing.

Another study often cited as substantiating the perceptual reality of synesthetic photisms shows that synesthetes are subject to Stroop effects on account of color photisms.  When synesthetes were shown a hand displaying several fingers colored to match the color photism the synesthetes typically projected onto things signifying that quantity, they were quicker at identifying the actual quantity of fingers displayed than when the fingers were painted a color that was incongruent with the photism typically associated with things significant of that quantity (Ward and Sagiv, 2007).

Finally, Smilek et al. (2001) have conducted a study with a synesthete they refer to as “C,” that suggests the perceptual reality of synesthesia.  In the study, significant graphemes are presented individually against backgrounds that are either congruent or incongruent with the photism associated with the grapheme.  If graphemes really are experienced as colored, then they should be more difficult to discern by synesthetes when they are presented against congruent backgrounds.  C did indeed have difficulty discerning the grapheme on congruent but not incongruent trials.  In a similar study, C was shown a digit “2” or “4” hidden in a field of other digits.  Again, the background was either congruent or incongruent with the photism C associated with the target digit.  C had difficulty locating the target digit when the background was congruent with the target’s photism color, but not when it was incongruent.

Nevertheless, another set of recent studies could be seen as calling into question whether some of the above studies really demonstrate the perceptual reality of synesthesia.  Meier and Rothen (2009) have shown that non-synesthetes trained over several weeks to associate specific numbers and colors behave similarly to synesthetes on synesthetic Stroop studies.  The colors that the non-synesthetes were taught to associate with certain graphemes interfered with their ability to identify target graphemes.  Moreover, Kadosh et al. (2009) have shown that highly suggestible non-synesthetes report abnormal cross-modal experiences similar to congenital synesthetes and behave similarly to Smilek’s synesthete C on target identification after receiving post-hypnotic suggestions aimed to trigger grapheme-color pairings.  Some researchers conclude from these studies that genuine synesthetic experiences can be induced through training or hypnosis.  But it isn’t clear that the evidence warrants this conclusion as the results are consistent with the presence of merely strong non-perceptual associations.  In the cases of post-hypnotic suggestion, participants may simply be behaving as if they experienced genuine synesthesia.  An alternative conclusion to draw from these studies might be that Stroop and the identification studies conducted with C do not demonstrate the perceptual reality of synesthesia.  Nonetheless, it has not been established that training and hypnotism can replicate all the effects, such as the longevity of associations in “natural” synesthetes, and few doubt that synesthetes experience genuine color photisms in the presence of inducing stimuli.

For most grapheme-color synesthetes, color photisms are induced by the formal properties of the grapheme (lower synesthesia).  In some, however, color photisms can be correlated with high-level cognitive representations specifying what the grapheme is taken to represent (higher synesthesia).  Higher synesthesia can be distinguished from lower synesthesia by several testable behaviors.

First, individuals with higher synesthesia frequently have the same synesthetic experiences (for example, see the same colors) in response to multiple inducers that share meaning—for instance, 5, V, and an array of five dots may all induce a green photism (Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2001b; Ward & Sagiv, 2007).  Second, some higher-grapheme-color synesthetes will experience color photisms both when they are veridically perceiving an external numeral, and also when they are merely imagining or thinking about the numerical concept.  Dixon et al. (2000) showed one synesthete the equation “4 + 3” followed by a color patch.  Their participant was slower at naming the color of the patch when it was incongruent with the photism normally associated with the number that is the solution to the equation.  If thinking about the numerical concept alone induces a photism then we should expect that the photism would interfere with identifying the patch color.

Moreover, when an individual with higher synesthesia sees a grapheme that is ambiguous, for example a shape that resembles both a 13 and a B, he or she may mark it with different colors when it is presented in different contexts.  For instance, when the grapheme is presented in the series, “12, 13, 14,” it may induce one photism, but it may induce a different photism when it is presented in the series, A, 13, C.  This suggests that it isn’t merely the shape of the grapheme that induces the photism here, but also the ascribed semantic value (Dixon et al., 2006).  Similarly, if an array of smaller “3”s are arranged in the form of a larger “5,” an individual with higher-grapheme synesthesia may mark the figure with one color photism when attending to it as an array of “3”s, but mark it with a different color photism when attending to it as a single number “5” (Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2000).

2. Consciousness

Some contend that synesthesia presents difficulties for certain theories of mind when it comes to conscious experience, such as representationalism (Wager, 1999, 2001; Rosenberg, 2004) and functionalism (J.A. Gray, 1998, 2003, 2004, J.A. Gray et al.; 1997, 2002, 2006).  These claims are controversial and discussed in some depth in the following two sections.

a. Representationalism

Representationalism is the view that the phenomenal character of experience (or the properties responsible for “what it is like” to undergo an experience) is exhausted by, or at least supervenes on, its representational content (Chalmers, 2004).  This means that there can be no phenomenal difference in the absence of a representational difference, and, if two experiential states are indiscernible with respect to representational content, then they must have the same phenomenal character.  Reductive brands of representationalism say that the qualitative aspects of consciousness are just the properties represented in perceptual experience (that is, the representational contents).  For instance, perhaps the conscious visual sensation of a faraway aircraft travelling across the sky is just the representation of a silver object moving across a blue background (Tye, 1995, p.93).

According to Wager (1999, 2001) and Rosenberg (2004) synesthesia shows that phenomenal character does not always depend on representational content because mental states can be the same representationally, but differ when it comes to experiential character.  Wager dubs this the “extra qualia” problem (1999, p.268) noting that his objection specifically targets externalist versions of representationalism (p.276) contending that phenomenal content depends on what the world is like (such that perfect physical duplicates could differ in experiential character given that their environments differ).  Meanwhile, Rosenberg (2004, p.101) employs examples of synesthetes who see colors when feeling pain, or hearing loud noises.  According to Rosenberg, there is no difference between the representational content of the synesthete and the ordinary person: in the case of pain, they could both be representing damage to the body of, let us suppose, a certain intensity, location and duration.  Again, the examples are claimed to show that mental states with the same representational content can differ experientially.  However, others reject this sort of argument.

Alter (2006, p.4) argues that Rosenberg’s analysis overlooks plausible differences between the representational contents in question.  A synesthete who is consciously representing bodily damage as, say, orange, is representing pain differently than an ordinary person.  The nature of this representational difference might be understood in more than one way: perhaps the manner in which they represent their intentional objects differs, or, perhaps their intentional objects differ (or both).  In short, it is suggested that the synesthete and the ordinary person are not representationally the same, and it is no threat to representationalism that different kinds of experience represent differently.  To take a trivial case, the conscious difference between touching and seeing a snowball is accounted for in that they represent differently (only one represents the snowball as cold).

Turning to Wager, he considers three cases which all concern a synesthete named Cynthia who experiences extra visual qualia in the form of a red rectangle when she hears the note Middle C.  The cases vary according to the version of externalism in question.  Case 1 examines a simple casual co-variation theory of phenomenal content, case 2 a theory that mixes co-variation and teleology (such as Tye’s, 1995), while case 3 concerns a purely teleological account, (such as Dretske’s, 1995).  These cases purportedly show that synesthetic and ordinary experience can share the same contents despite the differences in qualitative character.  R. Gray’s (2001a, 2004, pp.68-9) general reply is that synesthetic experience does indeed differ representationally in that it misrepresents.

For example, instead of attributing the redness and rectangularity to Middle C, why not attribute these to a misrepresentation of a red rectangle triggered by the auditory stimulus?  Whether representationalism can supply a plausible account of misrepresentation is an open question, however, perhaps its problems with synesthesia can be resolved by discharging this explanatory debt.

Regarding case 1, perhaps there is no extra representational content had by Cynthia.  If content is determined by the co-variation of the representation and the content it tracks, then since there is no red triangle in the external world, perhaps her experience only represents Middle C, just as it does in the case of an ordinary person (Wager, 1999, p.269).  If so, then there would be a qualitative difference in the absence of a representational difference, and this version of representationalism would be refuted.  On the other hand, Wager concedes that the objection might fail if Cynthia has visually experienced red bars in the past, for then her synesthetic experience is arguably not representationally the same as that of an ordinary person hearing Middle C.  This is because it would be open to the externalist to reply that Cynthia’s experience represents the disjunction “red bar or Middle C” (p.270) thus differing from an ordinary person’s.   However, Wager then argues that a synesthete who has never seen red bars because she is congenitally blind (Blind Cynthia) would have the same representational contents as an ordinary person (they would both just represent Middle C) and yet since she would also experience extra qualia, the objection goes through after all.

In reply, R. Gray (2001a, p.342) points out that this begs the question against the externalist, since it assumes that synesthetic color experience does not depend on a background of ordinary color experience.  If this is so, there could not be a congenitally blind synesthete, since whatever internal states Blind Cynthia had would not be representing colors.  Wager has in turn acknowledged this point (2001, p.349) though he maintains that it is more natural to suppose that Blind Cynthia’s experience would nevertheless be very different.  Support for Wager’s view might be found in such examples as color blind synesthetes who report “Martian” colors inaccessible to ordinary visual perception (Ramachandran and Hubbard, 2003a).

Wager also acknowledges that case 1 overlooks theories allowing representational contents to depend on evolutionary functions, and so the possibility that the blind synesthete functions differently when processing Middle C needs to be examined.  This leads to the second and third cases.

Case 2 is designed around Tye’s hybrid theory according to which phenomenal character depends on evolutionary functions for beings that evolved, and causal co-variation for beings that did not–such as Swampman (your perfect physical duplicate who just popped into existence as a result of lightening striking in swamp material).  Wager argues that on Tye’s view Middle C triggers an internal state with the teleological function of tracking red in the congenitally blind synesthete.  Hence Tye can account for the idea that Blind Cynthia would be representing differently than an ordinary person.

However, now the problem is that it seems the externalist must, implausibly, distinguish between the phenomenal contents of the hypothetical blind synesthete and a blind Swampsynesthete (Blind Swamp Cynthia) when they each experience Middle C.  Recall that Tye’s theory does not allow teleology to be used to account for representational contents in Swampperson cases.  But if Tye falls back on causal co-variation the problem, discussed in the first case, returns.  Since the blind Swampsynesthete’s causal tracking of Middle C does not differ from that of an ordinary person, externalism seems committed to saying that their contents and experiences do not differ—that is, since Blind Swamp Cynthia’s state reliably co-varies with Middle C, not red, it cannot be a phenomenal experience of red.

This, however, is not the end of the matter.  R. Gray could try to recycle his reply that there could not be a blind synesthete (whether of swampy origins or not) since synesthesia is parasitic on ordinary color experience.  Still another response offered on behalf of Tye (Gray, 2001a, p.343) is that Wager fails to take note of the role played by “optimal” conditions in Tye’s theory.  Where optimal conditions fail to obtain, co-variation is mere misrepresentation.  But what counts as optimal and how do we know it?  Perhaps optimal conditions would fail to obtain if the co-varying relationships are one-many (that is, if an internal state co-varies with many stimuli, or, a stimulus co-varies with many internal states, Gray, 2001a, p.343).  Such may be the case for synesthetes, and if so, then synesthetic experience would misrepresent and so differ in content.  On the other hand, Wager disputes Gray’s conception of optimal conditions (2001, p.349) arguing that Tye himself accepts they can obtain in situations where co-variation is one-many.  In addition, Wager (2001, p.349) contends Blind Swamp Cynthia’s co-varying relationship is not one-many since her synesthetic state co-varies only with Middle C.  As for Gray’s claim that optimal conditions fail for the Blind Swamp Cynthia because Middle-C co-varies with too many internal states, Wager (2001, p.349) responds that optimal conditions should indeed obtain—for it is plausible that a creature with a backup visual system could have multiple independent states co-varying with, and bearing content about, a given stimulus.  To this, however, it can be replied that having primary and backup states with content says nothing about whether the content of the backup state is auditory or visual; in other words, does Blind Swamp Cynthia both hear and synesthetically see Middle C, or, does she just hear it by way of multiple brain states (cf. Gray, 2001a, pp.343-344)?  While this summary does not exhaust the debate between Wager and Gray, the upshot for case 2 seems to turn on contentious questions about optimal conditions: what are they, and how do we know when they obtain or fail to obtain?

Finally, Case 3 considers the view that phenomenal content always depends on the state’s content tracking function as determined by natural selection.  Hence, an externalist such as Dretske could maintain that the blind synesthete undergoes a misfiring of a state that is supposed to indicate the presence of red, not Middle C.  Wager’s criticism here concerns a hypothetical case whereby synesthesia comes to acquire the evolutionary function of representing Middle C while visual perception has faded from the species though audition remains normal.  This time the problem is that it seems plausible that two individuals with diverging evolutionary histories could undergo the same synesthetic experience, but according to the externalist their contents would differ (Wager, 1999, p.273).  Perhaps worse, it follows from externalism that a member of this new synesthetic species listening to Middle C would have the very same content and experience as an ordinary member of our own species.

R. Gray replies that he does not see why the externalist must agree that synesthesia has acquired an evolutionary function just because it is adaptive (2001a, p.344).  Returning to his point about cases 1 & 2, synesthesia might well result from a breakdown in the visual system, and saying that it has no function is compatible with saying that it is fitness-enhancing.  If synesthesia does not have a teleological function, then a case 3 externalist can deny that the mutated synesthete’s contents are indiscernible with respect to those of an ordinary person.

And yet even if R. Gray is right that the case for counting synesthesia as functional is inconclusive, it seems at least possible some being evolves such that it has states with the function of representing Middle C synesthetically.  Whether synesthesia is a bug or a feature depends on, as Gray acknowledges, evolutionary considerations (p.345, see also Gray, 2001b), so Wager need only appeal to the possible world in which those considerations favor his interpretation and he can have his counterexample to externalist representationalism (cf. Wager, 2001, p.348).

On the other hand, and as R. Gray notices, Wager’s strongest cases are not drawn from the real world – and so his objections likewise turn on the very sort of controversial, “thought experiments and intuitions about possibility” he aims to distance his own arguments from (Wager, 1999, p.264).  Consider that for case 3 externalists, since Swamppeople don’t have evolutionary functions, they are unconscious zombies.  Anybody who is willing to accept that outcome will probably not be troubled by Wager’s imagined examples about synesthetes.  After all, someone who thinks having no history makes one a zombie already believes that differing evolutionary histories can have a dramatic impact on the qualitative character of experience.  In short, a lot rides on whether synethesia in fact is the result of malfunction, or, the workings of a separate teleofunctional module.

Finally, the suggestion that representational properties can explain the “extra-qualia” in synesthesia courts controversy given worries about whether this is consilient with synesthetes’ self-reports (that is, would further scrutiny of the self-reports strongly support claims about additional representational content?).  There is also general uncertainty as to what evidential weight these reports ought to be granted.  Despite Ramachandran and Hubbard’s enthusiasm for the method of, “probing the introspective phenomenological reports of these subjects” (2001b, p.7, n.3), they acknowledge skepticism on the part of many psychologists about this approach.

b. Functionalism

Synesthesia might present difficulties for the functionalist theory of mind’s account of conscious experience.  Functionalism defines mental states in terms of their functions or causal roles within cognitive systems, as opposed to their intrinsic character (that is, regardless of how they are physically realized or implemented).  Here, mental states are characterized in terms of their mediation of causal relationships obtaining between sensory input, behavioral output, and each other.  For example, an itch is a state caused by, inter alia, mosquito bites, and which results in, among other things, a tendency to scratch the affected area.  As a theory of consciousness, functionalism claims that the qualitative aspects of experience are constituted by (or at least determined by) functional roles (for example, Lycan, 1987).

In a series of articles, J.A. Gray has argued that synesthesia serves as a counter-example to functionalism, as well as to Hurley and Noë’s (2003a) specific hypothesis that sensorimotor patterns best explain variations in phenomenal experience.

Hurley and Noë’s theory employs a distinction between what they call “deference” and “dominance.”  Sensory deference occurs when experiential character conforms to cortical role rather than sensory input, and dominance the reverse.  Sometimes,

nonstandard sensory inputs “defer” to cortical activity, as when the stimulation of a patient’s cheek is felt as a touch on a missing arm.  Here cortex “dominates,” in the sense that it produces the feel of the missing limb, despite the unusual input.  One explanation is that nerve impulses arriving at the cortical region designated for producing the feel of a touch on the cheek “spill over” triggering a neighboring cortical region assigned to producing sensation of the arm.  But the cortex can also “defer” to nonstandard input, as in the case of tactile qualia experienced by Braille readers corresponding to activity in the visual cortex. J.A. Gray (2003, p.193) observes that cortical deference, not dominance, is expected given functionalism, since the character of a mental state is supposed to depend on its role in mediating inputs and outputs. If that efferent-afferent mediating role changes, then the sensory character of the state should change with it.

Hurley and Noë (2003a) propose that cortical regions implicated in one sensory modality can shift to another (and, thus be dominated by input) if there are novel sensorimotor relationships available for exploitation.  For support they point out that the mere illusion of new sensorimotor relationships can trigger cortical deference.  Such is the case with phantom limb patients who can experience the illusion of seeing and moving a missing limb with the help of an appropriately placed mirror.  In time, the phantom often disappears, leading to the conjecture that the restored sensory-motor feedback loop dominates the cortex, forcing it to give up its old role of producing sensation of the missing limb.

Hurley and Noë (2003a, p.160) next raise a worry for their theory concerning synesthesia.   Perceptual inputs are “routed differently” in synesthetes, as in the case of an auditory input fed to both auditory and visual cortex in colored hearing (p.137). This is a case of intermodal cortical dominance, since the nonstandard auditory input “defers” to the visual cortex’s ordinary production of color experience.  But theirs is a theory assuming intermodal deference, that is, qualia is supposed to be determined by sensory inputs, not cortex (pp.140, 160).  It would appear that the visual cortex should not be stuck in the role of producing extra color qualia if their account is correct.

Hurley & Noë believe synesthesia raises a puzzle for any account of color experience, namely, why color experience defers to the colors of the world in some cases but not others.  For example, subjects wearing specially tinted goggles devised by Kohler at first see one side of the world as yellow, the other, blue.  However, color experience adapts and the subjects eventually report that the world looks normal once more (so a white object would still look white even as it passes through the visual field from yellow to blue).  On the other hand, synesthetic colors differ in that they “persist instead of adapting away.”

J.A. Gray points out that since colored hearing emerges early in life, there should be many opportunities for synesthetes to explore novel sensorimotor contingencies, such as conflicts between heard color names and the elicited “alien” qualia–a phenomenon reminiscent of the Stroop effect in which it takes longer to say “blue” if it’s written in red ink (Gray, et al., 2006; see also Hurley and Noë, 2003a, p.164, n.27).  Once again, why isn’t the visual cortex dominated by these sensory-motor loops and forced to cease producing the alien colors?  Gray (2003, p.193) calls this a “major obstacle” to Hurley and Noë’s theory since the visual cortex stubbornly refuses to yield to sensorimotor dominance.

In reply, Hurley and Noë have suggested that synesthetes are relatively impoverished with respect to their sensorimotor contingencies (2003a, pp.160, 165, n.27).  For example, unlike the case of normal subjects, where unconsciously processed stimuli can influence subsequent judgment, synesthetic colors need to be consciously perceived for there to be priming effects.  In short, the input-output relationships might not be robust enough to trigger cortical deference.  Elsewhere, Noë and Hurley (2003, p.195) propose that deference might fail to occur because the synesthetic function of the visual cortex is inextricably dependent on normal cortex functioning.  Whether sensorimotor accounts of experience can accommodate synesthesia is a matter of ongoing debate and cannot be decided here.

J.A. Gray, as mentioned earlier, also thinks synesthesia (specifically, colored hearing) poses a broader challenge to functionalism, since it shows that function and qualia come apart in two ways (2003, p.194).  His first argument contends that a single quale is compatible with different functions: seeing and hearing are functionally different, and yet either modality can result in exactly the same color experience (see also Gray, et al., 2002, 2006).  A second argument claims that different qualia are compatible with the same function.  Hearing is governed by only one set of input-output relationships, but gives rise to both auditory and visual qualia in the colored-hearing synesthete (Gray, 2003, p.194).

Functionalist replies to J.A. Gray et al.’s first argument (that is, that there can be functional differences in the absence of qualia differences) are canvassed by MacPherson (2007) and R. Gray (2004).  Macpherson points out (p.71) that a single quale associated with multiple functions is no threat to a “weak” functionalism not committed to the claim that functional differences necessarily imply qualia differences—qualia might be “multiply realizable” at the functional, as well as implementational level (note that qualia differences could still imply functional differences).  She continues arguing that even for “strong” functionalisms that do assert the same type of qualitative state cannot be implemented by different functions, the counter-example still fails.  Token mental states of the same type will inevitably differ in terms of some fine-grained causes and effects (for example, two persons can each have the same green visual experience even though the associated functional roles will tend to be somewhat different, for example, as green might lead to thoughts of Islam in one person, Ireland in another, ecology in still another, or envy, and so on).  In light of this, a natural way to interpret claims about functional role indiscernibility is to restrict the experience type individuating function to a “core” or perhaps “typical” or even “normal” role.  Perhaps a core role operates at a particular explanatory level—sort of as a MAC and a PC can be functionally indiscernible at the user-level while running a web browser, despite differing in terms of their underlying operating systems.  An alternative is to argue that the synesthetic “role” is really a malfunction, and so no threat to the claim that qualia differences imply normal role differences (R. Gray 2004, pp.67-8 offers a broadly similar response).

As for the other side of J.A. Gray’s challenge, namely that synesthesia shows functional indiscernibility does not imply qualia indiscernibility, Macpherson questions whether there really is qualia indiscernibility between normal and synesthetic experience (2007, p.77).  Perhaps synesthetes only imagine, rather than perceptually experience colors (Macpherson, 2007, pp.73ff.).  She also expresses doubts about experimental tests utilizing pop-out, and questions the interpretation of brain imaging studies (p.75)—for example, is an active “visual” cortex in colored hearing evidence of visual experience, or, evidence that this part of the brain has a non-visual role in synesthetes (cf. Hardcastle, 1997, p.387)?  In short, she contends there are grounds for questioning whether there is a clear case in which the experience of a synesthetic color is just like some non-synesthetic color.

Finally, although MacPherson does not make the point, J.A. Gray’s second argument is vulnerable to a response fashioned from her reply to his first argument.  Perhaps the qualia differences aren’t functionally indiscernible because core roles are not duplicated, or because the synesthetic “role” is really just a malfunction.  To make this more concrete, consider Gray’s example in which hearing the word “train” results in both hearing sound and seeing color (2003, p.194).  He claims that this shows that one-and-the-same function can have divergent qualia.  But this is a hasty inference, and conflates the local auditory uptake of a signal with divergent processing further downstream. Perhaps there are really two quite different input-output sets involved–the auditory signal is fed to both auditory and visual cortexes, after all, and so perhaps a single signal is fed into functionally distinct subsystems one of which is malfunctioning.  Malfunction or not, the functionalist could thus argue that Gray has not offered an example of a single function resulting in divergent qualia.

3. Modularity

The modular theory of mind, most notably advanced by Jerry Fodor (1983), holds that the mind is comprised of multiple sub-units or modules within which representations are processed in a manner akin to the processing of a classical computer.  Processing begins with input to a module, which is transformed into a representational output by inductive or deductive inferences called “computations.”  Modules are individuated by the functions they perform.  The mental processing underlying visual perception, auditory perception, and the like, take place in individual modules that are specially suited to performing the unique processing tasks relevant to each.  One of the main benefits of modularity is thought to be processing efficiency.  The time-cost involved if computations were to have access to all of the information stored in the mind would be considerable.  Moreover, since an organism encounters a wide variety of problems, it would have been economical for independent systems to have evolved for performing different tasks.  Some argue that synesthesia supports the modular theory.  Before discussing how synesthesia is taken as evidence for modularity, it will help to understand a bit more precisely, the important role that the concept of modularity plays in psychology.

Many, including Fodor, believe that scientific disciplines reveal the nature of natural kinds.  Natural kinds are thought to be mind-independent natural classes of phenomena that, “have many scientifically interesting properties in common over and above whatever properties define the class” (Fodor, 1983, p.46).  Those who believe that there are natural kinds commonly take things such as water, gold, zebras and penicillin to be instances of natural kinds.  If scientific disciplines reveal the nature of natural kinds, then for psychology to be a bona fide science, the mental phenomena that it takes as its objects of study would also have to be natural kinds.  For those like Fodor, who are interested in categorically delineating special sciences like psychology from more basic sciences, it must be that the laws of the special science cannot be reduced to those of the basic science.  This means that the natural kind terms used in a particular science to articulate that science’s laws cannot be replaced with terms for other more fundamental natural phenomena.  From this perspective, it is highly desirable to see whether modules meet the criteria for natural kinds.

According to Fodor, in addition to the properties that define specific types of modules, all modules share most, if not all, of the following nine scientifically interesting characteristics:  1. They are subserved by a dedicated neural architecture, that is, specific brain regions and neural structures uniquely perform each module’s task.  2. Their operations are mandatory, once a module receives a relevant input the subject cannot override or stop its processing.  3. Modules are informationally encapsulated, their processing cannot utilize information from outside of that module.  4. The information from inside the module cannot be accessed by external processing areas.  5. The processing in modules is very quick.  6. Outputs of modules are shallow and conceptually impoverished, requiring only limited expenditure of computational resources.  7. Modules have a fixed pattern of development that, like physical attributes, may most naturally be attributed to a genetic property.  8. The processing in modules is domain specific, it only responds to certain types of inputs.  9. When modules break down, they tend to do so in characteristic ways.

It counts in favor of a theory if it is able to accommodate, predict and explain some natural phenomena, including anomalous phenomena.  In this vein, some argue that the modular theory is particularly useful for explaining the perceptual anomaly of synesthesia.  But there are competing accounts for how modularity is implicated in synesthesia.  Some think that insofar synesthesia has all the hallmarks of modularity, it likely results from the presence of an extra cognitive module (Segal, 1997).  According to the extra-module thesis, synesthetes possess an extra module whose function is the mapping of, for example, sounds or graphemes (input) to color representations (output).  This grapheme-color module would, according to Segal, possess at least most of the nine scientifically interesting characteristics of modules identified by Fodor:

1. There seems to be a dedicated neural architecture, as lexical-color synesthesia appears uniquely associated with multimodal areas of the brain including the posterior inferior temporal cortex and parieto-occipital junctions (Pausenu et al., 1995).  2. Processing is mandatory, once synesthetes are presented with a lexical or grapheme stimulus the induction of a color photism is automatic and insuppressible.  3. Processing in synesthesia seems encapsulated, information that is available to the subject which might negate the effect has no effect on processing in the color-grapheme module.  4. The information and processing in the module is not made available outside of the module, for example, the synesthete does not know how the system affects mapping.  5. Since the processing in synesthesia happens pre-consciously, it meets the rapid speed requirement.  6. The outputs are shallow, they don’t involve any higher-order theoretically inferred features, just color.  7. Since synesthesia runs in families, is dominant in females, and subjects report having had it for as long as they can remember, synesthesia seems to be heritable, and this suggests that it would have a fixed pattern of development.  The features 8 and 9, domain specificity and characteristic pattern of breakdown, are the only two that Segal cannot easily attribute to the grapheme-color module.  Segal doesn’t doubt that a grapheme-color module could be found to have domain specific processing.  But on account of the rarity of synesthesia, he suspects that it may be too hard to find cases where the lexical or grapheme-color module breaks down.  Harrison and Baron-Cohen (1997) and Cytowic (1997) among others, however, note that for some, synesthesia fades with age and has been reported to disappear with stroke or trauma.

Another explanation for synesthesia that draws on the modular framework is that synesthesia is caused by a breakdown in the barriers that ordinarily keep modules and their information and processing separate (Baron-Cohen et al., 1993; Paulesu et al., 1995).  This failure of encapsulation would allow information from one module to be shared with others.  Perhaps in lexical or grapheme-color synesthesia, information is shared between the speech or text processing module and the color-processing module.  There are two hypotheses for how this might occur.  One hypothesis is that the failure of encapsulation originates with a faulty inhibitory mechanism that normally prevents information from leaking out of a module (Grossenbacher & Lovelace, 2001; Harrison & Baron-Cohen, 1997).  Alternatively, some propose that we are born without modules but sensory processes are pre-programmed to become modularized.  So infants are natural synesthetes, but during the process of normal development extra dendritic connections are paired off, resulting in the modular encapsulation typical of adult cognition (Maurer, 1993; Maurer and Mondloch 2004; see Baron-Cohen 1996 for discussion).  In synesthetes, the normal process of pairing off of extra dendritic connections fails to occur.  Kadosh et al. (2009) claim that the fact that synesthesia can be induced in non-synesthetes post-hypnotically, demonstrates that a faulty inhibitory mechanism is responsible for synesthesia rather than excessive dendritic connections; given the time frame of their study, new cortical connections could not have been established.

The modular breakdown theory may also be able to explain why synesthesia has the appearance of the nine scientifically interesting characteristics that Fodor identifies with mental modules (R. Gray, 2001b).  If this is right, then what reason is there to prefer either the breakdown theory or the extra module theory over the other?  Gray (2001b) situates this problem within the larger debate between computational and biological frameworks in psychology; he argues that the concept of function is central to settling the issue over which account of synesthesia we should prefer.  His strategy is to first determine what the most desirable view of function is.  Based on this, we can then use empirical means to arbitrate between the extra-module theory and the modular breakdown theory.

On the classical view of modularity developed by Fodor, function is elaborated in purely computational terms.  Computers are closed symbol-manipulating devices that perform tasks merely on account of the dispositions of their physical components.  We can describe the module’s performance of a task by appealing to just the local causal properties of the underlying physical mechanisms.  R. Gray thinks that it is desirable for a functional description to allow for the possibility of a breakdown.  To describe something as having broken down seems to mean understanding it as having failed to achieve its proper goal.  The purely computational/causal view of function does not seem to easily accommodate the possibility of there being a breakdown in processing.

R. Gray promotes an alternative conception of function that he feels better allows for the possibility of breakdown.  Gray’s alternative understanding is compatible with traditional local causal explanations.  But it also considers the role that a trait such as synesthesia would have in facilitating the organism’s ability to thrive in its particular external environment, its fitness utility.  Crucially, Gray finds the elaboration of modules using this theory of function to be compatible with Fodor’s requirement that a science’s kind predicates “are ones whose terms are the bound variables of proper laws” (1974, p. 506).  Assuming such an account, whether synesthesia is the result of an extra module or a breakdown in modularity will ultimately depend on how it contributes to the fitness of individuals.  According to Baron-Cohen, in order to establish that synesthesia results from a breakdown in modularity, it would have to be shown that it detracts from overall fitness.  The problem is that synesthesia has not been shown to compromise the bearer of the trait.  In contrast, Gray claims that the burden of proof lies with those who propose that synesthesia results from the presence of an extra-module to show that synesthesia is useful in a particular environment.  But at present, according to Gray, we have no reason to think that it is.  For instance, one indicator that something has some positive fitness benefit for organisms possessing it is the proliferation of that trait in a population.  But synesthesia is remarkably rare (Gray, 2001b).  Gray admits, however, that whether or not synesthesia has such a utility is an open empirical question.

4. Theories of Color

Visual perception seems to, at the very least, provide us with information about colored shapes existing in various spatial locations.  An account of the visual perception of objects should therefore include some account of the nature of color.  Some theorists working on issues pertaining to the nature of color and color experience draw on evidence from synesthesia.

Theories about the nature of color fall broadly into two categories.  On the one hand, color objectivism is the view that colors are mind-independent properties residing out in the world, for example, in objects, surfaces or the ambient light.  Typically, objectivists identify color with a physical property.  The view that color is a mind-independent physical property of the perceived world is motivated both by commonsense considerations and the phenomenology of color experience.  It is part of our commonsense or folk understanding of color, as reflected in ordinary language, that color is a property of objects.  Moreover, the experience of color is transparent, which is to say that colors appear to the subject as belonging to external perceptual objects; one doesn’t just see red, one sees a red fire hydrant or a yellow umbrella.  Color objectivism vindicates both the commonsense view of color and the phenomenology of color experience.  But some take it to be an unfortunate implication of the theory that colors are physical properties of objects, since it seems to entail that each color will be identical to a very long disjunctive chain of physical properties.  Multiple external physical conditions can all cause the same color experience both within and across individuals.  This means that popular versions of objectivism cannot identify a single unifying property behind all instances of a single color.

Subjectivist views, on the other hand, take colors to be mind-dependent properties of the subject or of his or her experience, rather than properties of the distal causal stimulus.  Subjectivist theories of color include the sense-data theory, adverbialism and certain varieties of representationalism.  The primary motivation for color subjectivism is to accommodate various types of non-veridical color experience where perceivers have the subjective experience of color in the absence of an external distal stimulus to which the color could properly be attributed.  One commonly cited example is the after-image. Some claim that the photisms of synesthetes provide another example of non-veridical non-referring color experiences (Fish, 2010; Lycan, 2006; Revonsuo, 2001).  But others argue that the door is open to regarding at least some cases of synesthesia as veridical perceptual experiences rather than hallucinations since photisms are often:  i) perceptually and cognitively beneficial, ii) subjectively like non-synesthetic experiences, and iii) fitness-enhancing.

Still, synesthesia may pose additional difficulties for objectivism.  Consider the implications for objectivism if color synesthesias were to become the rule rather than the exception.  How then would objectivism account for color photisms in cases where they are caused by externally produced sounds?  Revonsuo (2001) suggests that the view that colors can be identified with the objective disjunctive collections of physical properties that cause color experiences would have to add the changes of air pressure that produce sounds to that disjunctive collection of color properties.  This means that if synesthesia became the rule, despite the fact that nothing else about the world would have changed, physical properties that weren’t previously colored would suddenly become colored.  Revonsuo (2001) takes this to be an undesirable consequence for a theory of color.

Enactivism is a theory of perception that takes active engagement with perceptual objects along with other contextual relations to be highly relevant to perception.  Typically, enactivists take perception to consist in a direct relation between perceivers and objective properties.  Ward uses synesthesia in an argument for enactivism about color, proposing that the enactivist theory of color actually combines elements of both objectivism and subjectivism, and is therefore the only theory of color that can account for various facts about anomalous color experiences like synesthesia.

For instance, Kohler fitted normal perceivers with goggles, each of whose lenses were vertically bisected with yellow tinting on one side and blue on the other (Kohler, 1964).  When perceivers first donned the goggles, they reported anomalous color experiences consistent with the lens colors; the world appeared to be tinted yellow and blue.  But after a few weeks of wear, subjects reported that the abnormal tint adapted away.  Ward proposes that synesthetic photisms are somewhat similar to the tinted experiences of Kohler’s goggle wearers.  In both cases, the subject is aware of the fact that their anomalous color experiences are not a reliable guide to the actual colors of things around them.  The two cases are not alike, however, in one important respect.  Whereas goggle wearers’ color experiences adapt to fall in line with what they know to be true about their color experiences, synesthetes’ experiences do not.  This asymmetry calls for explanation and Ward demonstrates that the enactive theory of color provides an elegant explanation for this asymmetry.

According to Ward’s enactive view of color, “An object’s color is its property of modifying incident reflected light in a certain way.”  This is an objective property.  But, “we perceive this [objective] property by understanding the way [subjective] color appearances systematically vary with lighting conditions.”  This view explains the asymmetry noted above in the following way.  Kohler’s goggles interfere with regular color perception.  According to the enactive view of color, the tinted goggles introduce, “a complex new set of relationships between apparent colors, viewing conditions and objective color properties.”  So it is necessary for them to adapt away.  As perceivers acclimate to the fact that their color appearances no longer refer to the colors they had previously indicated, their ability to normally perceive color returns.  Ward assumes that synesthetes do not experience their color photisms as attributed to perceived objects, so they do not impact the synesthetes’ ability to veridically perceive color.  Synesthetes’ photisms fail to adapt away because they do not need to.

Another philosophical problem having to do with the nature of color concerns whether or not phenomenal color experiences are intentional.  If they are, we might wonder what sorts of properties they are capable of representing.  A popular view is that color experiences can only represent objects to have specific color or spectral reflectance properties. Matey draws on synesthesia to support the view that perceptual experiences can represent objects to have high-level properties such as having a specific  semantic value (roughly, as representing some property, thing or concept). This argument for high-level representational contents from synesthesia, it is argued, withstands several objections that can be lodged against other popular arguments such as arguments from phenomenal contrast.  The basic idea is that a special category of grapheme-color synesthesia depends on high-level properties.  In higher-grapheme-color synesthesia, perceivers mark with a particular color, graphemes that share conceptual significance such as the property of representing a number.  Matey argues that these high-level properties penetrate color experiences, and infect their contents so that the color-experiences of these synesthetes represent the objects they are projected onto as being representative of certain numbers or letters.  Matey  demonstrates that the conclusions of the argument from synesthesia may generalize to the common perceptual experiences of ordinary perceivers as well.

5. An Extraordinary Feature of Color-Grapheme Synesthesia

What the subject says about his or her own phenomenal experience usually carries great weight.  However, in the case of color-grapheme synesthesia, Macpherson urges caution (2007, p.76).  A striking and odd aspect of color-grapheme synesthesia is that it may seem to involve the simultaneous experience of different colors in exactly the same place at exactly the same time.  Consider synesthetes who claim to see both colors simultaneously: What could it be like for someone to see the grapheme 5 printed in black ink, but see it as red as well?  How are we to characterize their experience?  To Macpherson this “extraordinary feature” suggests that synesthetic colors are either radically unlike ordinary experience, or perhaps more likely, not experiences at all.  A third possibility would be to find an interpretation compatible with ordinary color experience.  For example, perhaps the synesthetic colors are analogous to a colored-transparency laid over ink (as suggested by Kim et al. 2006, p.196;  see also Cytowic 1989, pp.41, 51 and Cytowic & Eagleman 2009, p.72).  However, this analogy is unsatisfying and gives rise to further puzzlement.

One might expect that the colors would interfere with each other, for example, they should see a darker red when the 5 is printed in black ink, and a lighter red when in white.  And yet synesthetes tend to insist that the colors do not blend (Ramachandran & Hubbard 2001b, p.7, n.3) although if the ink is in the “wrong” color this can result in task performance delays analogous to Stroop-test effects and even induce discomfort (Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2003b, p.50).  Another possibility is that the overlap is imperfect, despite the denials, for example, perhaps splotches of black ink can be distinguished from the red (as proposed by Ramachandran & Hubbard 2001b, p.7, n.3).  Or, maybe there can be a “halo” or edge where the synesthetic and ordinary colors do not overlap—this might make sense of the claims of some that the synesthetic color is not “on” the number, but, as it were, “floating” somewhere between the shape and the subject.  But against these suggestions are other reports that the synesthetic and regular colors match up perfectly (Macpherson, 2007, p.76).

A second analogy from everyday experience is simultaneously seeing what is both ahead of and behind oneself by observing a room’s reflection in a window.  This, however, only recycles the problem.  In seeing a white lamp reflected in a window facing a blue expanse of water, the colors mix (for example, the reflected lamp looks to be a pale blue). Moreover, one does not undergo distinct impressions of the lamp and the region occupied by the waves overlapping with the reflected image (though of course one can alter the presentation by either focusing on the lamp or on the waves).

A third explanation draws on the claim mentioned earlier that the extra qualia can depend on top-down processing, appearing only when the shape is recognized as a letter, or as a number (as in seeing an ambiguous shape in FA5T versus 3456).  There is some reason to think that the synesthetic color can “toggle” on and off depending on whether it is recognized and attended to, as opposed to appearing as a meaningless shape in the subject’s peripheral vision (Ramachandran & Hubbard 2001a, 2001b).  Toggling might also explain reports that emphasize seeing the red, as opposed to (merely?) knowing the ink is black (cf. Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2001b, p.7, n.3).  Along these lines, Kim et al. tentatively suggest that the “dual experience” phenomenon might be explained by rapid switching modulated by changes in attention (2006, p.202).

Cytowic and Eagleman (2009, p.73), in contrast to these ruminations, deny there is anything mysterious or conceptually difficult about the dual presentation of imagined and real objects sharing exactly the same location in physical space.  They contend that the dual experience phenomenon is comparable to visualizing an imaginary apple in the same place as a real coffee cup, “you’ll see there is nothing impossible, or even particularly confusing about two objects, one real and one imagined, sharing the same coordinates.”  This dismissal, however, fails to come to terms with the conundrum.  Instead of an apple, try visualizing a perfect duplicate of the actual coffee cup in precisely the same location (for those who believe they can do this, continue visualizing additional coffee cups until the point becomes obvious).  If Cytowic and Eagleman are to be taken literally this ought to be easy.  The visualization of a contrasting color also meets a conceptual obstacle.  What does it even mean to visualize a red surface in exactly the same place as a real black surface in the absence of alternating presentations (as in binocular rivalry) or blending?

Another perplexing feature of synesthetic color experience are reports of strange “alien” colors somehow different from ordinary color experience.  These “Martian” colors may or may not indicate a special kind of color qualia inaccessible to non-synesthetes, though given the apparent causal role differences from ordinary colors when it comes to such things as “lighting, viewing geometry and chromatic context” (Noë & Hurley, 2003, p.195) this is unsurprising and even expected by broadly functionalist theories of phenomenal experience.  Ramachandran and Hubbard (2001b, pp.5, 26, 30) offer some discussion and conjectures about the underlying neural processes.

Whether the more bizarre testimony can be explained away along one (or more) of the above suggestions, or has deep implications about synesthesia, self-report, and the nature of color experience, demands further investigation by philosophers and scientists.

6. Wittgenstein’s Philosophical Psychology

Ter Hark (2009) offers a Wittgensteinian analysis of color-grapheme synesthesia, arguing that it fails to fit the contrast between perception and mental imagery, and so calls for a third category bearing only some of the logical marks of experience.  He contends that it is somewhat like a percept in that it depends on looking, has a definite beginning and end, and is affected by shifts in attention.  On the other hand, it is also somewhat like mental imagery in that it is voluntary and non-informative about the external world.

Although ter Hark cites Rich et al. (2005) for support, only 15% of their informants claimed to have full control over synesthetic experience (that is, induced by thought independent of sensory stimulation) and most (76%) characterized it as involuntary.  It would therefore seem that ter Hark’s analysis applies to only a fraction of synesthetes.  The claim that synesthetic percepts seem non-experiential because they fail to represent the world is also contestable.  Visual experience need not always be informative (for example, hallucinations, “seeing stars,” and so forth) and failing to inform us about the world is compatible with aiming to do so but misrepresenting.

7. Individuating the Senses

Synesthesia might be important when it comes to questions about the nature of the senses, how they interact, and how many of them there are.  For example, Keeley (2002) proposes that synesthesia may challenge the assumption that the various senses are, “significantly separate and independent” (p.25, n.37) and so complicate discussions about what distinguishes one sense from another.  A similar point is made by Ross who notes that synesthesia undermines his “modified property condition” (2001, p.502).  The modified property condition is supposed to be necessary for individuating the senses, and states that each sense modality specializes in detecting certain properties (2001, p.500).  As discussed in the section on representationalism, synesthesia might seem to indicate that properties usually deemed proprietary to one sense can be detected by others after all.  Meanwhile, Ross’ proposal that synesthesia be explained away as a memory association seems unpersuasive in light of the preponderance of considerations suggesting it is a genuine sensory phenomenon (see Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2001a, 2001b, 2003b; for further discussion of Ross see Gatzia, 2008).  At present, little seems to have been written by philosophers on the significance of synesthesia as concerns the individuation and interaction of the senses (though see Macpherson, 2007, O’Callaghan 1998, p.325 and R. Gray 2011, p.253, n.17).

8. Aesthetics and “Literary Synesthesia”

The use of “intersense analogy” or sense-related metaphor as a literary technique is long familiar to authors and critics (for example, a sharp taste, a loud shirt) perhaps starting with Aristotle who noticed a “sort of parallelism between what is acute or grave to hearing and what is sharp or blunt to touch” (quoted in O’Malley, 1957, p.391).  Intersense metaphors such as “the sun is silent” (Dante quoted in O’Malley, 1957, p.409) and, more recently, “sound that makes the headphones edible” (from the lyrics of a popular rock band) may be, “a basic feature of language” natural for literature to incorporate (O’Malley, 1957, p.397), and to some “an essential component in the poetic sensibility” (Götlind, 1957, p.329).  Such “literary” synesthesia is therefore an important part of aesthetic criticism, as in Hellman’s (1977, p.287) discussion of musical styles, Masson’s analysis of acoustic associations (1953, p.222) and Ueda’s evaluation of cross-modal analogies in Haiku poetry which draw attention to “strange yet harmonious” combinations (1963, p.428).

Importantly, “the writer’s use of the ‘metaphor of the senses’” (O’Malley, 1957, p.391) is not to be confused with synesthesia as a sensory phenomenon, as repeatedly noted over the years by several philosophical works on poetry and aesthetics including Downey (1912, p.490), Götlind (1957, p.328) and O’Malley (1958, p.178).  Nevertheless, there are speculations about the connection between the two (for example, Smith, 1972, p.28; O’Malley, 1957, pp.395-396) and sensory synesthesia has been put forward as an important creative source in poetry (Downey, 1912, pp.490-491; Rayan, 1969), music and film (Brougher et al., 2005), painting (Tomas, 1969; Cazeaux, 1999; Ione, 2004) and artistic development generally (Donnell & Duignan, 1977).

That not all sensory matches work aesthetically—it seems awkward to speak of a loud smell or a salty color—might be significant in suggesting ties to perceptual synesthesia.  Perhaps they have more in common than is usually suspected (Marks, 1982; Day 1996).

Synesthetic metaphor is a “human universal” found in every culture and may be an expression of our shared nature (Pinker, 2002, p.439).  Maurer and Mondloch (2004) suggest that the fact that the cross-modal parings in synesthesias tend to be the same as the sensory matches manifest in common metaphors may reveal that non-synesthete adults share cross-modal activations with synesthetes, and synesthesia is a normal feature of early development.  Matey suggests that this lends credibility to the view that the cross-wiring present in synesthetes and non-synesthetes differs in degree and so we may draw conclusions about the types of representational contents possible of normal perceivers’ experiences based on the perceptual contents of synesthetes.

9. Synesthesia and Creativity

Ramachandran and Hubbard, among others, have been developing a number of hypotheses about the explanatory value of synesthesia towards creativity, the nature of metaphor, and even the origins of language (2001b, 2003a; see also Mulvenna, 2007; Hunt, 2005).  Like synesthesia, creativity seems to consist in, “linking two seemingly unrelated realms in order to highlight a hidden deep similarity” (Ramachandran & Hubbard, 2001b, p.17).  Ramachandran and Hubbard (2001b) conjecture that greater connectivity (or perhaps the absence of inhibitory processes) between functionally discrete brain regions might facilitate creative mappings between concepts, experiences, and behaviors in both artists and synesthetes.  These ideas are controversial and although there is some evidence that synethetes are more likely to be artists (for example, Ward et al., 2008; Rothen & Meier, 2010) the links between synesthesia and creativity remain tentative and conjectural.

10. References and Further Reading

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Author Information

Sean Allen-Hermanson
Email: hermanso@fiu.edu
Florida International University
U. S. A.

and

Jennifer Matey
Email: jmatey@fiu.edu
Florida International University
U. S. A.

René Girard (1923—2015)

Rene GirardRené Girard’s thought defies classification. He has written from the perspective of a wide variety of disciplines: Literary Criticism, Psychology, Anthropology, Sociology, History, Biblical Hermeneutics and Theology. Although he rarely calls himself a philosopher, many philosophical implications can be derived from his work. Girard’s work is above all concerned with Philosophical Anthropology (that is, ‘What is it to be human?’), and draws from many disciplinary perspectives. Over the years he has developed a mimetic theory. According to this theory human beings imitate each other, and this eventually gives rise to rivalries and violent conflicts. Such conflicts are partially solved by a scapegoat mechanism, but ultimately, Christianity is the best antidote to violence.

Perhaps Girard’s lack of specific disciplinary affiliation has promoted a slight marginalization of his work among contemporary philosophers. Girard is not on par with more well known French contemporary philosophers (for example Derrida, Foucault, Deleuze, Lyotard), but his work is becoming increasingly recognized in the humanities, and his commitment as a Christian thinker has given him prominence among theologians.

Table of Contents

  1. Life
  2. Mimetic Desire
    1. External Mediation
    2. Internal Mediation
    3. Metaphysical Desire
    4. The Oedipus Complex
  3. The Scapegoat Mechanism
    1. The Origins of Culture
    2. Religion
    3. Ritual
    4. Myth
    5. Prohibitions
  4. The Uniqueness of the Bible and Christianity
    1. The Hebrew Bible
    2. The New Testament
    3. Nietzsche’s Criticism of Christianity
    4. Apocalypse and Contemporary Culture
  5. Theological Implications
    1. God
    2. The Incarnation
    3. Satan
    4. Original Sin
    5. Atonement
  6. Criticisms
    1. Mimetic Theory Claims Too Much
    2. The Origins of Culture are Not Verifiable
    3. Girard Exaggerates the Contrast Between Myths and the Bible
    4. Christian Uniqueness Does Not Imply a Divine Origin
    5. Lack of a Precise Scientific Language
  7. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary
    2. Secondary

1. Life

René Girard was born on December 25, 1923, in Avignon, France. He was the son of a local archivist, and he went on to follow his father’s footsteps. He studied in Paris’ École Nationale des Chartes, and specialized in Medieval studies. In 1947, Girard took the opportunity to emigrate to America, and pursued a doctorate at Indiana University. His dissertation was on Americans’ opinions about France. Although his later work has had little to do with his doctoral dissertation, Girard has kept a live interest in French affairs.

After the completion of his doctorate, Girard began to take interest in Jean-Paul Sartre’s work. Although on a personal level Girard is still very much interested in Sartre’s philosophy, it has had little influence on his thought. Girard settled in America, and has taught at different institutions (Indiana University, State University of New York in Buffalo, Duke, Johns Hopkins, Bryn Mawr and Stanford) until his retirement in 1995. He died in 2015.

During the beginning of his career as lecturer, Girard was assigned to teach courses on European literature; he admits he was not at all familiar with the great works of European novelists. As Girard began to read the great European novels in preparation for the course, he became especially engaged with the work of five novelists in particular: Cervantes, Stendhal, Flaubert, Dostoyevsky and Proust.

His first book, Mensonge Romantique et Vérité Romanesque (1961), is a literary comment on the works of these great novelists. Until that time, Girard was a self-declared agnostic. As he researched the religious conversions of some of Dostoyevsky’s characters, he felt he had lived a similar experience, and converted to Christianity. Ever since, Girard has been a committed and practicing Roman Catholic.

After the publication of his first book, Girard turned his attention to ancient and contemporary sacrifice rituals, as well as Greek myth and tragedy. This led to another important book, La Violence et le Sacré (1972), for which he gained much recognition. On a personal level, he was a committed Christian, but his Christian views were not publicly expressed until the publication of Des Choses Cachées Depuis la Fondation du Monde (1978), his magnum opus, and best systematization of his thought. Ever since, Girard has written books that expand various aspects of his work. In 2005, Girard was elected to the Académie Française, a very important distinction among French intellectuals.

2. Mimetic Desire

Girard’s fundamental concept is ‘mimetic desire’. Ever since Plato, students of human nature have highlighted the great mimetic capacity of human beings; that is, we are the species most apt at imitation. Indeed, imitation is the basic mechanism of learning (we learn inasmuch as we imitate what our teachers do), and neuroscientists are increasingly reporting that our neural structure promotes imitation very proficiently (for example, ‘mirror neurons’).

However, according to Girard, most thinking devoted to imitation pays little attention to the fact that we also imitate other people’s desires, and depending on how this happens, it may lead to conflicts and rivalries. If people imitate each other’s desires, they may wind up desiring the very same things; and if they desire the same things, they may easily become rivals, as they reach for the same objects. Girard usually distinguishes ‘imitation’ from ‘mimesis’. The former is usually understood as the positive aspect of reproducing someone else’s behavior, whereas the latter usually implies the negative aspect of rivalry. It should also be mentioned that because the former usually is understood to refer to mimicry, Girard proposes the latter term to refer to the deeper, instinctive response that humans have to each other.

a. External Mediation

Girard calls ‘mediation’ the process in which a person influences the desires and preferences of another person. Thus, whenever a person’s desire is imitated by someone else, she becomes a ‘mediator’ or ‘model’. Girard points out that this is very evident in publicity and marketing techniques: whenever a product is promoted, some celebrity is used to ‘mediate’ consumers’ desires: in a sense, the celebrity is inviting people to imitate him in his desire of the product. The product is not promoted on the basis of its inherent qualities, but simply because of the fact that some celebrity desires it.

In his studies on literature, Girard highlights this type of relationship in his literary studies, as for example in his study of Don Quixote. Don Quixote is mediated by Amadis de Gaula. Don Quixote becomes an errant knight, not really because he autonomously desires so, but in order to imitate Amadis. Nevertheless, Amadis and Don Quixote are characters on different planes. They will never meet, and in such a manner, they never become rivals.

The same can be said of the relation between Sancho and Don Quixote. Sancho desires to be governor of an island, mostly because Don Quixote has suggested to Sancho that that is what he should desire. Again, although they interact continuously, Sancho and Don Quixote belong to two different worlds: Don Quixote is a very complex man, Sancho is simple in extreme. Girard calls ‘external mediation’ the situation when the mediator and the person mediated are on different planes. Don Quixote is an ‘external mediator’ to Sancho, inasmuch as he mediates his desires ‘from the outside’; that is, Don Quixote never becomes an obstacle in Sancho’s attempts to satisfy his desires.

External mediation does not carry the risk of rivalry between subjects, because they belong to different worlds. Although the source of Sancho’s desire to be governor of an island is in fact Don Quixote, they never desire the same object. Don Quixote desires things Sancho does not desire, and vice versa. Hence, they never become rivals. Girard believes ‘external mediation’ is a frequent feature of the psychology of desire: from our earliest phase as infants, we look up in imitation to our elders, and eventually, most of what we desire is mediated by them.

b. Internal Mediation

In ‘internal mediation’, the ‘mediator’ and the person mediated are no longer abysmally separated and hence, do not belong to different worlds. In fact, they come to resemble each other to the point that they end up desiring the same things. But, precisely because they are no longer on different worlds and now reach for the same objects of desire, they become rivals. We are fully aware that competition is fiercer when competitors resemble each other.

Thus, in internal mediation the subject imitates the model’s desires, but ultimately, unlike external mediation, the subject falls into rivalry with the model/mediator. Consider this example: a toddler imitates his father in his occupations, and he desires to pursue his father’s career when he grows up. This will hardly cause any rivalry (although it may account for Freud’s Oedipus Complex; see section 2.d). This is, as we have seen, a case of external mediation. But, now consider a PhD candidate that learns a great deal from his supervisor, and seeks to imitate every aspect of his work, and even his life. Eventually, they may become rivals, especially if both are looking for scholarly recognition. Or, consider further the case of a toddler that is playing with a toy, and another toddler that, out of imitation, desires that very same toy: they will eventually become rivals for the control of the toy. This is ‘internal mediation’; that is the person is mediated from the ‘inside’ of his world, and therefore, may easily become his mediator’s rival. This rivalry often has tragic consequences, and Girard considers this a major theme in modern novels. In Girard’s view, this literary theme is in fact a portrait of human nature: very often, people will desire something as a result of imitating other people, but eventually, this imitation will lead to rivalries with the very person imitated in the first place.

c. Metaphysical Desire

In Girard’s view, mimetic desire may grow to such a degree, that a person may eventually desire to be her mediator. Again, publicity is illustrative: sometimes, consumers do not just desire a product for its inherent qualities, but rather, desire to be the celebrity that promotes such a product. Girard considers that a person may desire an object only as part of a larger desire; that is, to be her mediator. Girard calls the desire to be other people, ‘metaphysical desire’. Furthermore, acquisitive desire leads to metaphysical desire, and the original object of desire becomes a token representing the “larger” desire of having the being of the model/rival.

Whereas external mediation does not lead to rivalries, internal mediation does lead to rivalries. But, metaphysical desire leads a person not just to rivalry with her mediator; actually, it leads to total obsession with and resentment of the mediator. For, the mediator becomes the main obstacle in the satisfaction of the person’s metaphysical desire. Inasmuch as the person desires to be his mediator, such desire will never be satisfied. For nobody can be someone else. Eventually, the person developing a metaphysical desire comes to appreciate that the main obstacle to be the mediator is the mediator himself.

According to Girard, metaphysical desire can be a very destructive force, as it promotes resentment against others. Girard considers that the anti-hero of Dostoyevsky’s Notes From the Underground is the quintessential victim of metaphysical desire: the unnamed character eventually goes on a crusade against the world, as he is disillusioned with everything around him. Girard believes that the origin of his alienation is his dissatisfaction with himself, and his obsession to be someone else; that is, an impossible task.

d. The Oedipus Complex

Girard’s career has been mostly devoted to literary criticism, and the analysis of fictional characters. Girard believes that the great modern novelists (such as Stendhal, Flaubert, Proust and Dostoevsky) have understood human psychology better than the modern field of Psychology does. And, as a complement of his literary criticism, he has developed a psychology in which the concept of ‘mimetic desire’ is central. Inasmuch as human beings constantly seek to imitate others, and most desires are in fact borrowed from other people, Girard believes that it is crucial to study how personality relates to others.

Departing from the main premise of mimetic desire, Girard has sought to reformulate some of psychology’s long-held assumptions. In particular, Girard seeks to reconsider some of Freud’s concepts. Although Girard has been careful enough to warn that Freud’s thought may be highly misleading in many ways, he has been engaged with Freud’s work in a number of ways. Girard admits that Freud and his followers had some good initial intuitions, but criticizes Freudian psychoanalytic theory on the grounds that it tends to obviate the role that other individuals have on the development of personality. In other words, psychoanalysis tends to assume that human beings are largely autonomous, and hence, do not desire in imitation of others.

Girard grants that Freud was a superb observer, but was not a good interpreter. And, in a sense, Girard accepts that there is such a thing as the Oedipus Complex: the child will eventually come to unconsciously have a sexual desire for his mother, and a desire to kill his father; and indeed, perhaps this complex will endure throughout adulthood. But, Girard considers that the Oedipus Complex is the result of a mechanism very different from the one outlined by Freud.

According to Freud, the child has an innate sexual desire towards the mother, and eventually, discovers that the father is an obstacle to the satisfaction of that desire. Girard, on the other hand, reinterprets the Oedipus Complex in terms of mimetic desire: the child becomes identified with his father and imitates him. But, inasmuch as he imitates his father, the child imitates the sexual desire for his mother. Then, his father becomes his model and rival, and that explains the ambivalent feelings so characteristic of the Oedipus Complex.

3. The Scapegoat Mechanism

In Girard’s psychology, internal mediation and metaphysical desire eventually lead to rivalry and violence. Imitation eventually erases the differences among human beings, and inasmuch as people become similar to each other, they desire the same things, which leads to rivalries and a Hobbesian war of all against all. These rivalries soon bear the potential to threaten the very existence of communities. Thus, Girard asks: how is it possible for communities to overcome their internal strife?

Whereas the philosophers of the 18th century would have agreed that communal violence comes to an end due to a social contract, Girard believes that, paradoxically, the problem of violence is frequently solved with a lesser dose of violence. When mimetic rivalries accumulate, tensions grow ever greater. But, that tension eventually reaches a paroxysm. When violence is at the point of threatening the existence of the community, very frequently a bizarre psychosocial mechanism arises: communal violence is all of the sudden projected upon a single individual. Thus, people that were formerly struggling, now unite efforts against someone chosen as a scapegoat. Former enemies now become friends, as they communally participate in the execution of violence against a specified enemy.

Girard calls this process ‘scapegoating’, an allusion to the ancient religious ritual where communal sins were metaphorically imposed upon a he-goat, and this beast was eventually abandoned in the desert, or sacrificed to the gods (in the Hebrew Bible, this is especially prescribed in Leviticus 16).The person that receives the communal violence is a ‘scapegoat’ in this sense: her death or expulsion is useful as a regeneration of communal peace and restoration of relationships.

However, Girard considers it crucial that this process be unconscious in order to work. The victim must never be recognized as an innocent scapegoat (indeed, Girard considers that, prior to the rise of Christianity, ‘innocent scapegoat’ was virtually an oxymoron; see section 4.b below); rather, the victim must be thought of as a monstrous creature that transgressed some prohibition and deserved to be punished. In such a manner, the community deceives itself into believing that the victim is the culprit of the communal crisis, and that the elimination of the victim will eventually restore peace.

a. The Origins of Culture

Girard believes that the scapegoat mechanism is the very foundation of cultural life. Natural man became civilized, not through some sort of rational deliberation embodied in a social contract, (as it was fashionable to think among 18th century philosophers) but rather, through the repetition of the scapegoat mechanism. And, very much as many philosophers of the 18th Century believed that their descriptions of the natural state were in fact historical, Girard believes that, indeed, Paleolithic men continually used the scapegoat mechanism, and it was precisely this feature what allowed them to lay the foundations of culture and civilization.

In fact, Girard believes that this process goes farther back in the evolution of Homo sapiens: hominids probably were engaged in scapegoating. But, it was precisely scapegoating what allowed a minimum of communal peace among early hominid groups. Hominids could eventually develop their main cultural traits due to the efficiency of the scapegoat mechanism. The murder of a victim brought forth communal peace, and this peace promoted the flourishing of the most basic cultural institutions.

Once again, Girard takes deep inspiration from Freud, but reinterprets his observations. Freud’s Totem and Taboo presents a thesis that the origins of culture are founded upon the original murder of a father figure by his sons. Girard considers that Freud’s observations were only partially correct. Freud is right in pointing out that indeed, culture is founded upon a murder. But, this murder is not due to the oedipal themes Freud was so fond of. Instead, the founding murder is due to the scapegoat mechanism. The horde murdered a victim (not necessarily a father figure) in order to project upon her all the violence that was threatening the very existence of the community.

However, as mimetic desire has been a constant among human beings, scapegoating has never been entirely efficient. Nevertheless, human communities need to periodically recourse to the scapegoating mechanism in order to maintain social peace.

b. Religion

According to Girard, the scapegoat mechanism brings about unexpected peace. But, this moment is so marvelous, that it soon acquires a religious overtone. Thus, the victim is immediately consecrated. Girard is in the French sociological tradition of Durkheim, who considered that religion essentially accomplishes the function of social integration. In Girard’s view, inasmuch as the deceased victim brings forth communal peace and restores social order and integration, she becomes sacred.

At first, while living, victims are considered to be monstrous transgressors that deserve to be punished. But, once they die, they bring peace to the community. Then, they are not monsters any longer, but rather gods. Girard highlights that, in most primitive societies, there is a deep ambivalence towards deities: they hold high virtues, but they are also capable of performing some very monstrous deeds. That is how, according to Girard, primitive gods are sanctified victims.

In such a manner, all cultures are founded upon a religious basis. The function of the sacred is to offer protection for the stability of communal peace. And, to do this, it ensures that the scapegoat mechanism provides its effects through the main religious institutions.

c. Ritual

Girard considers rituals the earliest cultural and religious institution. In Girard’s view, ritual is a reenactment of the original scapegoating murder. Although, as anthropologists are quick to assert, rituals are very diverse, Girard considers that the most popular form of ritual is sacrifice. When a victim is ritually killed, Girard believes, the community is commemorating the original event that promoted peace.

The original victim was most likely a member of the community. Girard considers that, probably, earliest sacrificial rituals employed human victims. Thus, Aztec human sacrifice may have impacted Western conquistadors and missionaries upon its discovery, but this was a cultural remnant of a popular ancient practice. Eventually, rituals promoted sacrificial substitution, and animals were employed. In fact, Girard considers that hunting and the domestication of animals arose out of the need to continually reenact the original murder with substitute animal victims.

d. Myth

Following the old school of European anthropologists, Girard believes that myths are the narrative corollary of ritual. And, inasmuch as rituals are mainly a reenactment of the original murder, myths also recapitulate the scapegoating themes.

Now, Girard’s crucial point about the necessary unconsciousness of scapegoating: must be kept in mind in order for this mechanism to work, its participants must not recognize it as such. That is to say, the victim must never appear as what it really is: a scapegoat that is no guiltier of disturbance, than other members of the community.

The way to assure that scapegoats are not recognized as what they really are is by distorting the story of the events that led to their death. This is accomplished by telling the story from the perspective of the scapegoaters. Myths will usually tell a story of someone doing a terrible thing and, thus, deserving to be punished. The victim’s perspective will never be incorporated into the myth, precisely because this would spoil the psychological effect of the scapegoating mechanism. The victim will always be portrayed as a culprit whose deeds brought about social chaos, but whose death or expulsion brought about social peace.

Girard’s most recurrent example of myths is that of Oedipus. According to the myth, Oedipus was expelled from Thebes because he murdered his father and married his mother. But, according to Girard, the myth should be read as a chronicle written by a community that chose a scapegoat, blamed him of some crime, punished him, and once expelled, peace returned. Under Girard’s interpretation, the fact that there was a pest in Thebes is suggestive of a social crisis. To solve the crisis, Oedipus is selected as a scapegoat. But, he is never presented as such: quite the contrary, he is accused of parricide and incest, and this justifies his persecution. Thus, Oedipus’ perspective as a victim is suppressed from the myth.

Furthermore, Girard believes that, as myths evolve, later versions will tend to dissimulate the scapegoating violence (for example, instead of presenting a victim who dies by drowning, the myth will just claim that the victim went to live to the bottom of the sea), in order to avoid feeling compassion for the victim. Indeed, Girard considers that the evolution of myths may even reach a point where no violence is present. But, Girard insists, all myths are founded upon violence, and if no violence is found in a myth, it must be because the community made it disappear.

Myths are typical of archaic societies, but Girard thinks that modern societies have the equivalent of myths: persecution texts. Especially during the witch-hunts and persecution of Jews during the Middle Ages, there were plenty of chronicles written from the perspective of the mobs and witch-hunters. These texts told the story of a crisis that appeared as the consequence of some crime committed by a person or a minority. The author of the chronicle is part of the persecuting mob, as he projects upon the victim all the typical accusations, and justifies the mob’s actions. Modern lynching accounts are another prominent example of such persecutory dynamics.

e. Prohibitions

Inasmuch as, under the scapegoaters’ view, there are no innocent scapegoats, an accusation must be made. In the case of Oedipus, he was accused of parricide and incest, and these are recurrent accusations to justify persecution (for example Maria Antoinette), but many other accusations are found (for example blood libels, witchcraft, and so forth). After the victim is executed, Girard claims, a prohibition falls upon the action allegedly perpetrated by the scapegoat. By doing so, the scapegoaters believe they restore social order. Thus, along with ritual and myths, prohibitions derive from the scapegoat mechanism.

Girard also considers that prior to the scapegoating mechanism, communities go through a process he calls a ‘crisis of differences’. Mimetic desire eventually makes every member resemble each other, and this lack of differentiation generates chaos. Traditionally, this indifferentiation is represented through various symbols typically associated with chaos and disorder (plagues, monstrous animals, and so forth). The death of the scapegoat mechanism restores order and, by extension, differentiation. Thus, everything returns to its place. In such a manner, social differentiation and order in general is also derived from the scapegoat mechanism.

4. The Uniqueness of the Bible and Christianity

Girard’s Christian apologetics departs from a comparison of myths and the Bible. According to Girard, whereas myths are caught under the dynamics of the scapegoat mechanism by telling the foundational stories from the perspective of the scapegoaters, the Bible contains plenty of stories that tell the story from the perspective of the victims.

In myths, those who are collectively executed are presented as monstrous culprits that deserve to be punished. In the Bible, those who are collectively executed are presented as innocent victims that are unfairly accused and persecuted. Thus, Girard recapitulates the old Christian apologetic tradition of insisting upon the Bible’s singularity. But, instead of making emphasis on the Bible’s popularity, or fulfillment of prophecies, or consistency, Girard thinks the Bible is unique in its defense of victims.

However, according to Girard, this is not merely a shift in narrative perspective. It is in fact something much more profound. Inasmuch as the Bible presents stories from the perspective of the victims, the Biblical authors reveal something not understood by previous mythological traditions. And, by doing so, they make scapegoating inoperative. Once scapegoats are recognized for what they truly are, the scapegoating mechanism no longer works. Thus, the Bible is a remarkably subversive text, inasmuch as it shatters the scapegoating foundations of culture.

a. The Hebrew Bible

Girard thinks that the Hebrew Bible is a text in travail. There are plenty of stories that are still told from the perspective of the scapegoaters. And, more importantly, it continuously presents a wrathful God that sanctions violence. However, Girard appreciates some important shifts in some narratives from the Bible, especially when they are compared to myths that present similar structures.

For example, Girard contrasts the story of Cain and Abel with the myth of Remus and Romulus. In both stories, there is rivalry between the brothers. In both stories, there is a murder. But, in the Roman myth, Romulus is justified in killing Remus, as the latter transgressed the territorial limits they had earlier agreed upon. In the Biblical story, Cain is never justified in killing Abel. And, indeed, the blood of Abel is evoked as the blood of the innocent victims that have been murdered throughout history, and that God will vindicate.

Girard is also fond of comparing the story of Oedipus with the story of Joseph. Oedipus is accused of incest, and the myth accepts this accusation, therefore justifying his expulsion from Thebes. Joseph is also accused of incest (he allegedly attempted to rape Potiphar’s wife, his de facto step mother). But, the Bible never accepts such an accusation.

In Girard’s views, the Hebrew Bible is also crucial in its rejection of ritual sacrifice. Some prophets vehemently denounced the grotesque ritual killing of sacrificial victims, although, of course, the ritual requirement of sacrificial rituals permeates much of the Old Testament. Girard understands this as a complementary approach to the defense of victims. The prophets promote a new concept of the divinity: God is no longer pleased with ritual violence. This is evocative of Hosea’s plea from God: “I want mercy, not sacrifices”. Thus, the Hebrew Bible takes a twofold reversal of culture’s violent foundation: on the one hand, it begins to present the foundational stories from the perspective of the victims; on the other hand, it begins to present a God that is not satisfied with violence and, therefore, begins to dissociate the sacred from the violent.

b. The New Testament

Under Girard’s interpretation, the New Testament is the completion of the process that the Hebrew Bible had begun. The New Testament fully endorses the victims’ perspective, and satisfactorily dissociates the sacred from the violent.

The Passion story is central in the New Testament, and it is the complete reversal of traditional myth’s structure. Amidst a huge social crisis, a victim (Jesus) is persecuted, blamed of some fault, and executed. Even the apostles succumb to the collective pressure and abandon Jesus, tacitly becoming part of the scapegoating crowd. This is emblematic in the story of Peter’s denial of Jesus.

Nevertheless, the evangelists never succumb to the collective pressure of the scapegoating mob. The evangelists adhere to Jesus’ innocence throughout the whole story. Alas, Jesus is finally recognized as what he really is: an innocent scapegoat, the Lamb of God that was taken to the slaughterhouse, although no fault was in him. According to Girard, this is the completion of a slow process begun in the Hebrew Bible. Once and for all, the New Testament reverses the violent psychosocial mechanism upon which human culture has been founded.

Aside from that, Jesus’ ethical message is complementary. Under Girard’s interpretation, humanity has achieved social peace by performing violent acts of scapegoating. Jesus’ solution is much more radical and efficient: to turn the other cheek, to abstain from violent retribution. Scapegoating is not an efficient means to bring about peace, as it always depends on the periodic repetition of the mechanism. The real solution is in the total withdrawal from violence, and that is the bulk of Jesus’ message.

c. Nietzsche’s Criticism of Christianity

Girard is bothered by the possibility that his readers may fail to appreciate the uniqueness of the Bible and Christianity. In this sense, Girard is very critical of classical anthropologists such as Sir James Frazer, who saw the relevance of scapegoating in primitive rituals and myths, but, according to Girard, failed to see that the Christian story is fundamentally different from other scapegoating myths.

Indeed, Girard resents the fact that Christianity is usually considered to be merely one among many other religions. However, ironically, Girard seeks help from a powerful opponent of Christianity: Friedrich Nietzsche. Nietzsche criticized Christianity for its ‘slave morality’; that is, its tendency to side with the weak. Nietzsche recognized that, above other religions, Christianity promoted mercy as a virtue. Nietzsche interpreted this as a corruption of the human vital spirit, and advocated a return to the pre-Christian values of power and strength.

Girard is, of course, opposed to the Nietzschean disdain for mercy and antipathy towards the weak and victims. But, Girard considers Nietzsche a genius, inasmuch as the German philosopher saw what, according to Girard, most people (including the majority of Christians) fail to see: Christianity is unique in its defense of victims. Thus, in a sense, Girard claims that his Christian apologetics is for the most part a reversal of Nietzsche: they both agree that Christianity is singular, but whereas Nietzsche believed this singularity corrupted humanity, Girard believes this singularity is the manifestation of a power that reverses the violent foundations of culture.

d. Apocalypse and Contemporary Culture

Girard acknowledges that, on the surface, not everything in the New Testament is about peace and love. Indeed, there are some frightening passages in Jesus’ preaching, perhaps the most emblematic “I come not to bring peace, but a sword”. This is part of the apocalyptic worldview prevalent in Jesus’ days. But, much more than that, Girard believes that the apocalyptic teachings to be found in the New Testament are a warning about future human violence.

Girard considers that, inasmuch as the New Testament overturns the old scapegoating practices, humanity no longer has the capacity to return to the scapegoating mechanism in order to restore peace. Once victims are revealed as innocent, scapegoating can no longer be relied upon to restore peace. And, in such a sense, there is now an even greater threat of violence. According to Girard, Jesus brings a sword, not in the sense that he himself is going to execute violence, but in the sense that, through his work and the influence of the Bible, humanity will not have the traditional violent means to put an end to violence. The inefficacy of the scapegoat mechanism will bring even more violence. The way to restore peace is not through the scapegoat mechanism, but rather, through the total withdrawal of violence.

Thus, Girard believes that, ironically, Christianity has brought about even more violence. But, once again, this violence is not attributable to Christianity itself, but rather, to the stubbornness of human beings who do not want to follow the Christian admonition and insist on putting an end to violence through traditional scapegoating.

Girard believes that, 20th and 21st centuries are more than ever an apocalyptic age. And, once again, he acknowledges a 19th century German figure as a precursor of these views: Carl von Clausewitz. According to Girard, the great Prussian war strategist realized that modern war would no longer be an honorable enterprise, but rather, a brutal activity that has the potential to destroy all of humanity. Indeed, Girard believes 20th and 21st centuries are apocalyptic, but not in the fundamentalist sense. The ‘signs’ of apocalypse are not numerical clues such as 666, but rather, signs that humanity has not found an efficient way to put an end to violence, and unless the Christian message of repentance and withdrawal from violence is assumed, we are headed towards doomsday; not a Final Judgment brought forth by a punishing God, but rather, a doomsday brought about by our own human violence.

5. Theological Implications

Girard claims not to be a theologian, but rather, a philosophical anthropologist. But, echoing Simone Weil, he believes that the gospels, inasmuch as they reveal the nature of human beings, also indirectly reveal the nature of God. Thus, Girard’s work has great implications for theologians, and his work has generated new ways to interpret the traditional Christian doctrines.

a. God

Girard is little concerned with the classical theistic attempt to prove the existence of God (for example Aquinas, Plantinga, Craig and Swinburne). But, he does seem to assume that the only way to explain the Bible’s uniqueness in its rejection of scapegoating distortion and its refusal to succumb to the mob’s influence, is by proposing the intervention of a higher celestial power. So, in a weak sense, Girard’s apologetic works try to prove that the Bible is divinely inspired and, therefore, that God exists.

More importantly, Girard believes that the Bible reveals that the true God is far removed from violence, whereas gods that sanction violence are false gods, that is, idols. By revealing how human violence works, Girard claims, the Bible reveals that this violence does not come from God; rather, God sympathizes with victims and wants nothing to do with victimizers.

b. The Incarnation

Furthermore, the doctrine of Incarnation becomes especially important under Girard’s interpretation. For God himself incarnates in the person of Jesus, in order to become himself a victim. Thus, God is so far removed from aggressors and scapegoaters, He himself becomes a victim in order to show humanity that He sides with innocent victims. Thus, the way to overturn the scapegoat mechanism is not only by telling the stories from the perspective of the victim, but also by telling the story that the victim itself is God incarnate.

c. Satan

Most liberal contemporary Christians pay little attention to Satan, but Girard wishes to keep its relevance. Girard has little patience for the literal mythological interpretation of Satan as the red, horned creature. According to Girard, the concept of Satan and the Devil most frequently referred to in the gospels is what it etymologically expresses: the opponent, the accuser. And, in this sense, Satan is the scapegoating mechanism itself (or, perhaps more precisely, the accusing process); that is, the psychological processes in which human beings are caught up by the lynching mob, and eventually succumb to its influence and participate in the collective violence against the scapegoat.

Likewise, the Holy Spirit in Girard’s interpretation is the reverse of Satan. Again, Girard recurs to etymology: the Paraclete etymologically refers to the spirit of defense. Thus, Satan accuses victims, and the Paraclete mercifully defends victims. Thus, the Holy Spirit is understood by Girard as the overturning of the old scapegoating practices.

d. Original Sin

In the old Pelagian-Augustinian debate over original sin, Girard’s work clearly sides with Augustine. Under Girard’s interpretation, there is a twofold sense of original sin: 1) human beings are born with the propensity to imitate each other and, eventually, be led to violence; 2) human culture was laid upon the foundations of violence. Thus, human nature is tainted by an original sin, but it can be saved through repentance materialized in the withdrawal from violence.

The complementary aspect of the original sin debate, that is, free will, has not been tackled by Girard. But, being a Roman Catholic, it is presumable that Girard would not accept the Calvinist concepts of total depravity, irresistible grace and predestination. He seems to believe that human beings are born with sin, but they have the capacity to do something about it through repentance.

e. Atonement

Girard’s vision of Christianity also brings forth a new interpretation of the doctrine of atonement, that is, that Christ died for our sins. Anselm’s traditional account (God’s honor was offended by the sins of mankind, His honor was reestablished with the death of His own son), or other traditional interpretations (mankind was kidnapped by the Devil, God offered Christ as a ransom; Jesus died so God could show humanity what He is capable of doing if we do not repent, and so forth) are deemed inadequate by Girard. Under Girard’s interpretation, Jesus saved us by becoming a victim and overturning once and for all the scapegoat mechanism. Thanks to Jesus’ salvific mission, human beings now have the capacity to understand what scapegoats really are, and have the golden opportunity to achieve enduring social peace.

6. Criticisms

An important source of criticisms against Girard is his apologetic commitment to Christianity. Most critics argue that he has a tendency to twist interpretations of classical texts and myths in order to favor Christian doctrine. Girard has frequently asserted that he was not a Christian for the early part of his life, but that his work as a humanist eventually drove him to Christianity. Also, Girard has been seen with contempt by postmodernist critics who, on the whole, are suspicious of objective truth.

a. Mimetic Theory Claims Too Much

The first point of criticism directed at Girard is that he is too ambitious. His initial plausible interpretations of mimetic psychology and anthropology are eventually transformed into a grandiose theoretical system that attempts to explain every aspect of human nature.

Consequently, in such a manner, his methods have been questioned. His theories regarding mimetic desire are derived, not from a careful study of subjects and the implementation of tests, but rather, from the reading of works of fiction. The fact that his theory seems to coincide with what many neuroscientists are informing us about mirror neurons is immaterial: his was just a lucky guess.

The same critique may be extended to his work on the origins of culture. Again, his scapegoating thesis may be plausible, in as much as it is easy to find many examples of scapegoating processes in human culture. But, to claim that all human culture ultimately relies on scapegoating, and that the fundamental cultural institutions (myths, rituals, hunting, domestication of animals, and so forth), are ultimately derived from an original murder, is perhaps too much.

Thus, in a sense, Girard’s work is subject to the same criticism of many of the great theoretical systems of the human sciences in the 19th century (Hegel, Freud, Marx, and so forth): his sole concentration on his favorite themes makes him overlook equally plausible alternate explanations for the phenomena he highlights.

b. The Origins of Culture are Not Verifiable

As a corollary of the previous objection, empirically-minded philosophers would object that Girard’s theses are not verifiable in a meaningful way. There is little possibility to know what may have happened during Paleolithic times, apart from what paleontology and archaeology might tell us.

In some instances, Girard claims that his theses have indeed been verified. There have been plenty of archaeological remains that suggest ritual human sacrifice, and plenty of contemporary rituals and myths that suggest scapegoating violence. But, then again, the number of rituals and myths that do not display violence is even greater. Girard does not see this as a great obstacle to his theses, because according to him, cultures have a tendency to erase the track of original violence.

But, in such a case, the empirically-minded philosopher may argue that Girard’s work is not falsifiable in Popper’s sense. There seems to be no possibility of a counter-example that will refute Girard’s thesis. If a violent myth or ritual is considered, Girard will argue that this piece of evidence confirms his hypotheses. If, on the other hand, a non-violent myth or ritual is considered, Girard will once again argue that this piece of evidence confirms his evidence, because it proves that cultures erase tracks of violence in myths and rituals. Thus, Girard is open to the same Popperian objection leveled against Freud: both sexual and non-sexual dreams confirm psychoanalytic theory; therefore, there is no possible way to refute it, and in such a manner, it becomes a meaningless theory.

c. Girard Exaggerates the Contrast Between Myths and the Bible

Girard is also open to criticism inasmuch as his Christian apologetics seems to rely on an already biased comparison of myths and the Bible. It has been objected that he is not thoroughly fair in the application of standards when contrasting the Bible and myths. Girard’s hermeneutic goes to great lengths to highlight violence in rituals when, in fact, it is not all that evident. He may be accused of being predisposed to find sanctioned violence in myths and, based upon that predisposition, he interprets as sanctioned violence mythical elements that, under another interpretative lens, would not be violent at all. Metaphorically speaking, when studying many myths, Girard is just seeing faces in the clouds, and projecting upon myths some elements that are far from being clear.

In the same manner, one may object that Girard’s treatment of the Bible, and especially the New Testament, is too benevolent. Most secular historians would agree that there are some hints of persecution against the Jews in the gospels (for example, an exaggeration of Jewish guilt in the arrest and execution of Jesus), and that the historical Jesus’ apocalyptic preaching is not just a warning of future human violence, but rather, an announcement of imminent divine wrath.

d. Christian Uniqueness Does Not Imply a Divine Origin

Even if Girard’s thesis about the uniqueness of Christianity were accepted, it needn’t prove a divine origin. Perhaps Christianity is unique due to a set of historical and sociological circumstances that drove biblical authors to sympathize with victims (indeed, Max Weber’s explanation is as follows: the Bible’s authors sympathize with victims because they were themselves victims as subjects of the great empires of the Near East). In such a manner, Girard may be accused of incurring an ad ignorantiam fallacy. The fact that we cannot currently explain a given phenomenon does not imply that such phenomenon’s origins are supernatural.

e. Lack of a Precise Scientific Language

Even if one were to accept that the Bible reveals a profound nature about human beings, scientifically-minded philosophers would object that Girard’s language is too obscure and too religiously-based for scientific purposes. Perhaps the Bible does reveal some interesting insights about the nature of scapegoating. But, to name such a process ‘Satan’, or to name the human tendency to incur in rivalries ‘sin’, bears a great potential for confusion. Whenever most readers encounter the word ‘Satan’, they are prone to imagine the nasty horned tailed creature, and not in some sort of abstract psychological mechanism that gives rise to scapegoating violence. So, even if Girard’s use of those terms is metaphoric, they are easily open to confusion, and perhaps should be abandoned.

7. References and Further Reading

a. Primary

  • Deceit, Desire, and the Novel: Self and Other in Literary Structure. Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins University Press, 1965.
  • Resurrection from the Underground: Feodor Dostoevsky. New York: Crossroad, 1997.
  • Violence and the Sacred. Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins University Press, 1977.
  • Things Hidden since the Foundation of the World. Research undertaken in collaboration with Jean-Michel Oughourlian and Guy Lefort. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1987.
  • “To Double Business Bound”: Essays on Literature, Mimesis, and Anthropology. Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins University Press, 1978.
  • The Scapegoat. Baltimore: The Johns Hopkins University Press, 1986.
  • Job: The Victim of His People. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1987
  • A Theater of Envy: William Shakespeare. St. Augustine’s Press, 2004.
  • Quand ces choses commenceront…Entretiens avec Michel Treguer. Paris: Arléa, 1994.
  • The Girard Reader. Edited by James G. Williams. New York: Crossroad, 1996.
  • I See Satan Fall like Lightning. Maryknoll, NY: Orbis Books, 2001.
  • Celui par qui le scandale arrive: Entretiens avec Maria Stella Barberi. Paris: Brouwer, 2001.
  • Oedipus Unbound: Selected Writings on Rivalry and Desire. Edited by Mark Anspach. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2004.
  • Evolution and Conversion: Dialogues on the Origins of Culture. With Pierpaolo Antonello and Joao Cezar de Castro Rocha. London: T&T Clark/Continuum, 2007
  • Christianity, Truth, and Weakening Faith: A Dialogue. René Girard and Gianni Vattimo. Edited by Pierpaolo Antonello and translated by William McCuaig. New York: Columbia University Press, 2010
  • Battling to the End: Conversations with Benoît Chantre. East Lansing, MI: Michigan State University Press, 2010.
  • Anorexie et désir mimétique. Herne, 2008.

b. Secondary

  • ALBERG, Jeremiah. A Reinterpretation of Rousseau: A Religious System. Foreward by René Girard. Palgrave Macmillan, 2007. Hardcover
  • ALISON, James. Broken Hearts and New Creations: Intimations of a Great Reversal. New York: Continuum, 2010.
  • ALISON, James. Faith Beyond Resentment: Fragments Catholic and Gay. New York: Crossroad, 2001
  • ALISON, James. The Joy of Being Wrong: Original Sin Through Easter Eyes. New York: Crossroad, 1998.
  • ANDRADE, Gabriel. René Girard: Um retrato intellectual. E realizacaoes. 2011.
  • ASTELL, Ann W. Joan of Arc and Sacrificial Authorship. South Bend, IN: University of Notre Dame Press, 2003
  • BAILIE, Gil. Violence Unveiled: Humanity at the Crossroads. New York: Crossroad, 1995. Paper.
  • BANDERA, Cesáreo. The Humble Story of Don Quixote: Reflections on the Birth of the Modern Novel. Catholic University of America Press, 2006.
  • BANDERA, Cesáreo. The Sacred Game. Penn State Press. 2004.
  • BARTLETT, Anthony. Cross Purposes: The Violent Grammar of Christian Atonement. Valley Forge, PA: Trinity Press International, 2001.
  • BELLINGER, Charles K. The Genealogy of Violence: Reflections on Creation, Freedom, and Evil. Oxford University Press, 2001.
  • DALY, Robert J., S. J. Sacrifice Unveiled: The True Meaning of Christian Sacrifice. London: T&T Clark / New York: Continuum, 2009.
  • DUMOCHEL, Paul, ed. Violence and Truth: on the Work of René Girard. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1988.
  • FINAMORE, Stephen. God, Order, and Chaos: René Girard and the Apocalypse. Eugene, OR: Wipf & Stock, 2009.
  • FLEMING, Chris. René Girard: Violence and Mimesis. Cambridge, Eng.: Polity Press, 2004.
  • FREUD, Sigmund. Totem and Taboo. Create Space. 2011.
  • GOLSAN, Richard J. René Girard and Myth: An Introduction. New York: Routledge, 2001
  • GOODHART, Sandor; Jorgensen, Jorgen; Ryba, Thomas; Williams, James G.; eds. For René Girard: Essays in Friendship and in Truth. East Lansing, MI: Michigan State University Press, 2009.
  • GOODHART, Sandor; Jorgensen, Jorgen; Ryba, Thomas; Williams, James G.; eds. Sacrificing Commentary: Reading the End of Literature. Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1996.
  • GRANDE, Per Bjørnar. Mimesis and Desire: An Analysis of the Religious Nature of Mimesis and Desire in the Work of René Girard. LAP Lambert Academic Publishing, 2009. Paperback: 224 pages.
  • GROTE, Jim and McGeeney, John. Clever as Serpents: Business Ethics and Office Politics. Collegeville, MN: The Liturgical Press, 1997. Paperback, 149 pages.
  • HAMERTON-KELLY, Robert G, ed. Politics & Apocalypse. East Lansing, MI: Michigan State University Press, 2007.
  • HAMERTON-KELLY, Robert G, ed. Sacred Violence: Paul’s Hermeneutic of the Cross. Minneapolis: Fortress Press, 1992 .
  • HAMERTON-KELLY, Robert G, ed. The Gospel and the Sacred: Poetics of Violence in Mark. Minneapolis: Fortress Press, 1994
  • of the victim.”
  • HOBBES, Thomas. Leviathan. Oxford UP. 2009.
  • KIRK-DUGGAN, Cheryl A. Refiner’s Fire: A Religious Engagement with Violence. Minneapolis: Fortress Press, 2001
  • KIRWAN, Michael. Discovering Girard. Cambridge, MA: Cowley Publications, 2005.
  • LEFEBURE, Leo D. Revelation, the Religions, and Violence. Maryknoll, NY: Orbis Books, 2000.
  • MCKENNA, Andrew J. Violence and Difference: Girard, Derrida, and Deconstruction. Chicago: University of Illinois Press, 1992.
  • OUGHOURLIAN, Jean-Michel. The Genesis of Desire. E. Lansing, MI: Michigan State University Press, 2010.
  • Chicago: University of Illinois Press, 1992.
  • OUGHOURLIAN, Jean-Michel. The Puppet of Desire: The Psychology of Hysteria, Possession, and Hypnosis. Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1991.
  • SCHWAGGER, Raymund, S.J. Banished from Eden: Original Sin and Evolutionary Theory in the Drama of Salvation. Gracewing, 2006.
  • SWARTLEY, Willard M., editor. Violence Renounced: René Girard, Biblical Studies, and Peacemaking. Response by René Girard and Foreward by Diana M. Culbertson. Telford, PA: Cascadia Publishing House, 2000.
  • WILLIAMS, James G. The Bible, Violence, and the Sacred: Liberation from the Myth of Sanctioned Violence. Foreword by René Girard. Eugene, OR: Wipf & Stock, 2007.

 

Author Information

Gabriel Andrade
Email: gabrielernesto2000@yahoo.com
University of Zulia
Venezuela