Consciousness

Explaining the nature of consciousness is one of the most important and perplexing areas of philosophy, but the concept is notoriously ambiguous. The abstract noun “consciousness” is not frequently used by itself in the contemporary literature, but is originally derived from the Latin con (with) and scire (to know). Perhaps the most commonly used contemporary notion of a conscious mental state is captured by Thomas Nagel’s famous “what it is like” sense (Nagel 1974). When I am in a conscious mental state, there is something it is like for me to be in that state from the subjective or first-person point of view. But how are we to understand this? For instance, how is the conscious mental state related to the body? Can consciousness be explained in terms of brain activity? What makes a mental state be a conscious mental state? The problem of consciousness is arguably the most central issue in current philosophy of mind and is also importantly related to major traditional topics in metaphysics, such as the possibility of immortality and the belief in free will. This article focuses on Western theories and conceptions of consciousness, especially as found in contemporary analytic philosophy of mind.

The two broad, traditional and competing theories of mind are dualism and materialism (or physicalism). While there are many versions of each, the former generally holds that the conscious mind or a conscious mental state is non-physical in some sense, whereas the latter holds that, to put it crudely, the mind is the brain, or is caused by neural activity. It is against this general backdrop that many answers to the above questions are formulated and developed. There are also many familiar objections to both materialism and dualism. For example, it is often said that materialism cannot truly explain just how or why some brain states are conscious, and that there is an important “explanatory gap” between mind and matter. On the other hand, dualism faces the problem of explaining how a non-physical substance or mental state can causally interact with the physical body.

Some philosophers attempt to explain consciousness directly in neurophysiological or physical terms, while others offer cognitive theories of consciousness whereby conscious mental states are reduced to some kind of representational relation between mental states and the world. There are a number of such representational theories of consciousness currently on the market, including higher-order theories which hold that what makes a mental state conscious is that the subject is aware of it in some sense. The relationship between consciousness and science is also central in much current theorizing on this topic: How does the brain “bind together” various sensory inputs to produce a unified subjective experience? What are the neural correlates of consciousness? What can be learned from abnormal psychology which might help us to understand normal consciousness? To what extent are animal minds different from human minds? Could an appropriately programmed machine be conscious?

Table of Contents

1. Terminological Matters: Various Concepts of Consciousness
2. Some History on the Topic
3. The Metaphysics of Consciousness: Materialism vs. Dualism
   1. Dualism: General Support and Related Issues
      1. Substance Dualism and Objections
      2. Other Forms of Dualism
   2. Materialism: General Support
      1. Objection 1: The Explanatory Gap and The Hard Problem
      2. Objection 2: The Knowledge Argument
      3. Objection 3: Mysterianism
      4. Objection 4: Zombies
      5. Varieties of Materialism
4. Specific Theories of Consciousness
   1. Neural Theories
   2. Representational Theories of Consciousness
      1. First-Order Representationalism
      2. Higher-Order Representationalism
      3. Hybrid Representational Accounts
   3. Other Cognitive Theories
   4. Quantum Approaches
5. Consciousness and Science: Key Issues
   1. The Unity of Consciousness/The Binding Problem
   2. The Neural Correlates of Consciousness (NCCs)
   3. Philosophical Psychopathology
6. Animal and Machine Consciousness
7. References and Further Reading

1. Terminological Matters: Various Concepts of Consciousness

The concept of consciousness is notoriously ambiguous. It is important first to make several distinctions and to define related terms. The abstract noun “consciousness” is not often used in the contemporary literature, though it should be noted that it is originally derived from the Latin con (with) and scire (to know). Thus, “consciousness” has etymological ties to one’s ability to know and perceive, and should not be confused with conscience, which has the much more specific moral connotation of knowing when one has done or is doing something wrong. Through consciousness, one can have knowledge of the external world or one’s own mental states. The primary contemporary interest lies more in the use of the expressions “x is conscious” or “x is conscious of y.” Under the former category, perhaps most important is the distinction between state and creature consciousness (Rosenthal 1993a). We sometimes speak of an individual mental state, such as a pain or perception, as conscious. On the other hand, we also often speak of organisms or creatures as conscious, such as when we say “human beings are conscious” or “dogs are conscious.” Creature consciousness is also simply meant to refer to the fact that an organism is awake, as opposed to sleeping or in a coma. However, some kind of state consciousness is often implied by creature consciousness, that is, the organism is having conscious mental states. Due to the lack of a direct object in the expression “x is conscious,” this is usually referred to as intransitive consciousness, in contrast to transitive consciousness where the locution “x is conscious of y” is used (Rosenthal 1993a, 1997). Most contemporary theories of consciousness are aimed at explaining state consciousness; that is, explaining what makes a mental state a conscious mental state.

It might seem that “conscious” is synonymous with, say, “awareness” or “experience” or “attention.” However, it is crucial to recognize that this is not generally accepted today. For example, though perhaps somewhat atypical, one might hold that there are even unconscious experiences, depending of course on how the term “experience” is defined (Carruthers 2000). More common is the belief that we can be aware of external objects in some unconscious sense, for example, during cases of subliminal perception. The expression “conscious awareness” does not therefore seem to be redundant. Finally, it is not clear that consciousness ought to be restricted to attention. It seems plausible to suppose that one is conscious (in some sense) of objects in one’s peripheral visual field even though one is only attending to some narrow (focal) set of objects within that visual field.

Perhaps the most fundamental and commonly used notion of “conscious” is captured by Thomas Nagel’s famous “what it is like” sense (Nagel 1974). When I am in a conscious mental state, there is “something it is like” for me to be in that state from the subjective or first-person point of view. When I am, for example, smelling a rose or having a conscious visual experience, there is something it “seems” or “feels” like from my perspective. An organism, such as a bat, is conscious if it is able to experience the outer world through its (echo-locatory) senses. There is also something it is like to be a conscious creature whereas there is nothing it is like to be, for example, a table or tree. This is primarily the sense of “conscious state” that will be used throughout this entry. There are still, though, a cluster of expressions and terms related to Nagel’s sense, and some authors simply stipulate the way that they use such terms. For example, philosophers sometimes refer to conscious states as phenomenal or qualitative states. More technically, philosophers often view such states as having qualitative properties called “qualia” (prounced like “kwal’ ee uh”; the singular is quale). There is significant disagreement over the nature, and even the existence, of qualia, but they are perhaps most frequently understood as the felt properties or qualities of conscious states.

Ned Block (1995) makes an often cited distinction between phenomenal consciousness (or “phenomenality”) and access consciousness. The former is very much in line with the Nagelian notion described above. However, Block also defines the quite different notion of access consciousness in terms of a mental state’s relationship with other mental states; for example, a mental state’s “availability for use in reasoning and rationality guiding speech and action” (Block 1995: 227). This would, for example, count a visual perception as (access) conscious not because it has the “what it’s likeness” of phenomenal states, but rather because it carries visual information which is generally available for use by the organism, regardless of whether or not it has any qualitative properties. Access consciousness is therefore more of a functional notion; that is, concerned with what such states do. Although this concept of consciousness is certainly very important in cognitive science and philosophy of mind generally, not everyone agrees that access consciousness deserves to be called “consciousnesses” in any important sense. Block himself argues that neither sense of consciousness implies the other, while others urge that there is a more intimate connection between the two.

Finally, it is helpful to distinguish between consciousness and self-consciousness, which plausibly involves some kind of awareness or consciousness of one’s own mental states (instead of something out in the world). Self-consciousness arguably comes in degrees of sophistication ranging from minimal bodily self-awareness to the ability to reason and reflect on one’s own mental states, such as one’s beliefs and desires. Some important historical figures have even held that consciousness entails some form of self-consciousness (Kant 1781/1965, Sartre 1956), a view shared by some contemporary philosophers (Gennaro 1996a, Kriegel 2004).

2. Some History on the Topic

Interest in the nature of conscious experience has no doubt been around for as long as there have been reflective humans. It would be impossible here to survey the entire history, but a few highlights are in order. In the history of Western philosophy, which is the focus of this entry, important writings on human nature and the soul and mind go back to ancient philosophers, such as Plato. More sophisticated work on the nature of consciousness and perception can be found in the work of Plato’s most famous student Aristotle (see Caston 2002), and then throughout the later Medieval period. It is, however, with the work of René Descartes (1596-1650) and his successors in the early modern period of philosophy that consciousness and the relationship between the mind and body took center stage. As we shall see, Descartes argued that the mind is a non-physical substance distinct from the body. He also did not believe in the existence of unconscious mental states, a view certainly not widely held today. Descartes defined “thinking” very broadly to include virtually every kind of mental state and urged that consciousness is essential to thought. Our mental states are, according to Descartes, infallibly transparent to introspection. John Locke (1689/1975) held a similar position regarding the connection between mentality and consciousness, but was far less committed on the exact metaphysical nature of the mind.

Perhaps the most important philosopher of the period explicitly to endorse the existence of unconscious mental states was G.W. Leibniz (1686/1991, 1720/1925). Although Leibniz also believed in the immaterial nature of mental substances (which he called “monads”), he recognized the existence of what he called “petit perceptions,” which are basically unconscious perceptions. He also importantly distinguished between perception and apperception, roughly the difference between outer-directed consciousness and self-consciousness (see Gennaro 1999 for some discussion). The most important detailed theory of mind in the early modern period was developed by Immanuel Kant. His main work Critique of Pure Reason (1781/1965) is as equally dense as it is important, and cannot easily be summarized in this context. Although he owes a great debt to his immediate predecessors, Kant is arguably the most important philosopher since Plato and Aristotle and is highly relevant today. Kant basically thought that an adequate account of phenomenal consciousness involved far more than any of his predecessors had considered. There are important mental structures which are “presupposed” in conscious experience, and Kant presented an elaborate theory as to what those structures are, which, in turn, had other important implications. He, like Leibniz, also saw the need to postulate the existence of unconscious mental states and mechanisms in order to provide an adequate theory of mind (Kitcher 1990 and Brook 1994 are two excellent books on Kant’s theory of mind.).

Over the past one hundred years or so, however, research on consciousness has taken off in many important directions. In psychology, with the notable exception of the virtual banishment of consciousness by behaviorist psychologists (e.g., Skinner 1953), there were also those deeply interested in consciousness and various introspective (or “first-person”) methods of investigating the mind. The writings of such figures as Wilhelm Wundt (1897), William James (1890) and Alfred Titchener (1901) are good examples of this approach. Franz Brentano (1874/1973) also had a profound effect on some contemporary theories of consciousness. Similar introspectionist approaches were used by those in the so-called “phenomenological” tradition in philosophy, such as in the writings of Edmund Husserl(1913/1931, 1929/1960) and Martin Heidegger (1927/1962). The work of Sigmund Freud was very important, at minimum, in bringing about the near universal acceptance of the existence of unconscious mental states and processes.

It must, however, be kept in mind that none of the above had very much scientific knowledge about the detailed workings of the brain.  The relatively recent development of neurophysiology is, in part, also responsible for the unprecedented interdisciplinary research interest in consciousness, particularly since the 1980s.  There are now several important journals devoted entirely to the study of consciousness: Consciousness and Cognition, Journal of Consciousness Studies, and Psyche.  There are also major annual conferences sponsored by world wide professional organizations, such as the Association for the Scientific Study of Consciousness, and an entire book series called “Advances in Consciousness Research” published by John Benjamins.  (For a small sample of introductory texts and important anthologies, see Kim 1996, Gennaro 1996b, Block et. al. 1997, Seager 1999, Chalmers 2002, Baars et. al. 2003, Blackmore 2004, Campbell 2005, Velmans and Schneider 2007, Zelazo et al. 2007, Revonsuo 2010.)

3. The Metaphysics of Consciousness: Materialism vs. Dualism

Metaphysics is the branch of philosophy concerned with the ultimate nature of reality. There are two broad traditional and competing metaphysical views concerning the nature of the mind and conscious mental states: dualism and materialism. While there are many versions of each, the former generally holds that the conscious mind or a conscious mental state is non-physical in some sense. On the other hand, materialists hold that the mind is the brain, or, more accurately, that conscious mental activity is identical with neural activity. It is important to recognize that by non-physical, dualists do not merely mean “not visible to the naked eye.” Many physical things fit this description, such as the atoms which make up the air in a typical room. For something to be non-physical, it must literally be outside the realm of physics; that is, not in space at all and undetectable in principle by the instruments of physics. It is equally important to recognize that the category “physical” is broader than the category “material.” Materialists are called such because there is the tendency to view the brain, a material thing, as the most likely physical candidate to identify with the mind. However, something might be physical but not material in this sense, such as an electromagnetic or energy field. One might therefore instead be a “physicalist” in some broader sense and still not a dualist. Thus, to say that the mind is non-physical is to say something much stronger than that it is non-material. Dualists, then, tend to believe that conscious mental states or minds are radically different from anything in the physical world at all.

a. Dualism: General Support and Related Issues

There are a number of reasons why some version of dualism has been held throughout the centuries. For one thing, especially from the introspective or first-person perspective, our conscious mental states just do not seem like physical things or processes. That is, when we reflect on our conscious perceptions, pains, and desires, they do not seem to be physical in any sense. Consciousness seems to be a unique aspect of the world not to be understood in any physical way. Although materialists will urge that this completely ignores the more scientific third-person perspective on the nature of consciousness and mind, this idea continues to have force for many today. Indeed, it is arguably the crucial underlying intuition behind historically significant “conceivability arguments” against materialism and for dualism. Such arguments typically reason from the premise that one can conceive of one’s conscious states existing without one’s body or, conversely, that one can imagine one’s own physical duplicate without consciousness at all (see section 3b.iv). The metaphysical conclusion ultimately drawn is that consciousness cannot be identical with anything physical, partly because there is no essential conceptual connection between the mental and the physical. Arguments such as these go back to Descartes and continue to be used today in various ways (Kripke 1972, Chalmers 1996), but it is highly controversial as to whether they succeed in showing that materialism is false. Materialists have replied in various ways to such arguments and the relevant literature has grown dramatically in recent years.

Historically, there is also the clear link between dualism and a belief in immortality, and hence a more theistic perspective than one tends to find among materialists. Indeed, belief in dualism is often explicitly theologically motivated. If the conscious mind is not physical, it seems more plausible to believe in the possibility of life after bodily death. On the other hand, if conscious mental activity is identical with brain activity, then it would seem that when all brain activity ceases, so do all conscious experiences and thus no immortality. After all, what do many people believe continues after bodily death? Presumably, one’s own conscious thoughts, memories, experiences, beliefs, and so on. There is perhaps a similar historical connection to a belief in free will, which is of course a major topic in its own right. For our purposes, it suffices to say that, on some definitions of what it is to act freely, such ability seems almost “supernatural” in the sense that one’s conscious decisions can alter the otherwise deterministic sequence of events in nature. To put it another way: If we are entirely physical beings as the materialist holds, then mustn’t all of the brain activity and behavior in question be determined by the laws of nature? Although materialism may not logically rule out immortality or free will, materialists will likely often reply that such traditional, perhaps even outdated or pre-scientific beliefs simply ought to be rejected to the extent that they conflict with materialism. After all, if the weight of the evidence points toward materialism and away from dualism, then so much the worse for those related views.

One might wonder “even if the mind is physical, what about the soul?” Maybe it’s the soul, not the mind, which is non-physical as one might be told in many religious traditions. While it is true that the term “soul” (or “spirit”) is often used instead of “mind” in such religious contexts, the problem is that it is unclear just how the soul is supposed to differ from the mind. The terms are often even used interchangeably in many historical texts and by many philosophers because it is unclear what else the soul could be other than “the mental substance.” It is difficult to describe the soul in any way that doesn’t make it sound like what we mean by the mind. After all, that’s what many believe goes on after bodily death; namely, conscious mental activity. Granted that the term “soul” carries a more theological connotation, but it doesn’t follow that the words “soul” and “mind” refer to entirely different things. Somewhat related to the issue of immortality, the existence of near death experiences is also used as some evidence for dualism and immortality. Such patients experience a peaceful moving toward a light through a tunnel like structure, or are able to see doctors working on their bodies while hovering over them in an emergency room (sometimes akin to what is called an “out of body experience”). In response, materialists will point out that such experiences can be artificially induced in various experimental situations, and that starving the brain of oxygen is known to cause hallucinations.

Various paranormal and psychic phenomena, such as clairvoyance, faith healing, and mind-reading, are sometimes also cited as evidence for dualism. However, materialists (and even many dualists) will first likely wish to be skeptical of the alleged phenomena themselves for numerous reasons. There are many modern day charlatans who should make us seriously question whether there really are such phenomena or mental abilities in the first place. Second, it is not quite clear just how dualism follows from such phenomena even if they are genuine. A materialist, or physicalist at least, might insist that though such phenomena are puzzling and perhaps currently difficult to explain in physical terms, they are nonetheless ultimately physical in nature; for example, having to do with very unusual transfers of energy in the physical world. The dualist advantage is perhaps not as obvious as one might think, and we need not jump to supernatural conclusions so quickly.

i. Substance Dualism and Objections

Interactionist Dualism or simply “interactionism” is the most common form of “substance dualism” and its name derives from the widely accepted fact that mental states and bodily states causally interact with each other. For example, my desire to drink something cold causes my body to move to the refrigerator and get something to drink and, conversely, kicking me in the shin will cause me to feel a pain and get angry. Due to Descartes’ influence, it is also sometimes referred to as “Cartesian dualism.” Knowing nothing about just where such causal interaction could take place, Descartes speculated that it was through the pineal gland, a now almost humorous conjecture. But a modern day interactionist would certainly wish to treat various areas of the brain as the location of such interactions.

Three serious objections are briefly worth noting here. The first is simply the issue of just how does or could such radically different substances causally interact. How something non-physical causally interacts with something physical, such as the brain? No such explanation is forthcoming or is perhaps even possible, according to materialists. Moreover, if causation involves a transfer of energy from cause to effect, then how is that possible if the mind is really non-physical? Gilbert Ryle (1949) mockingly calls the Cartesian view about the nature of mind, a belief in the “ghost in the machine.” Secondly, assuming that some such energy transfer makes any sense at all, it is also then often alleged that interactionism is inconsistent with the scientifically well-established Conservation of Energy principle, which says that the total amount of energy in the universe, or any controlled part of it, remains constant. So any loss of energy in the cause must be passed along as a corresponding gain of energy in the effect, as in standard billiard ball examples. But if interactionism is true, then when mental events cause physical events, energy would literally come into the physical word. On the other hand, when bodily events cause mental events, energy would literally go out of the physical world. At the least, there is a very peculiar and unique notion of energy involved, unless one wished, even more radically, to deny the conservation principle itself. Third, some materialists might also use the well-known fact that brain damage (even to very specific areas of the brain) causes mental defects as a serious objection to interactionism (and thus as support for materialism). This has of course been known for many centuries, but the level of detailed knowledge has increased dramatically in recent years. Now a dualist might reply that such phenomena do not absolutely refute her metaphysical position since it could be replied that damage to the brain simply causes corresponding damage to the mind. However, this raises a host of other questions: Why not opt for the simpler explanation, i.e., that brain damage causes mental damage because mental processes simply are brain processes? If the non-physical mind is damaged when brain damage occurs, how does that leave one’s mind according to the dualist’s conception of an afterlife? Will the severe amnesic at the end of life on Earth retain such a deficit in the afterlife? If proper mental functioning still depends on proper brain functioning, then is dualism really in no better position to offer hope for immortality?

It should be noted that there is also another less popular form of substance dualism called parallelism, which denies the causal interaction between the non-physical mental and physical bodily realms. It seems fair to say that it encounters even more serious objections than interactionism.

ii. Other Forms of Dualism

While a detailed survey of all varieties of dualism is beyond the scope of this entry, it is at least important to note here that the main and most popular form of dualism today is called property dualism. Substance dualism has largely fallen out of favor at least in most philosophical circles, though there are important exceptions (e.g., Swinburne 1986, Foster 1996) and it often continues to be tied to various theological positions. Property dualism, on the other hand, is a more modest version of dualism and it holds that there are mental properties (that is, characteristics or aspects of things) that are neither identical with nor reducible to physical properties. There are actually several different kinds of property dualism, but what they have in common is the idea that conscious properties, such as the color qualia involved in a conscious experience of a visual perception, cannot be explained in purely physical terms and, thus, are not themselves to be identified with any brain state or process.

Two other views worth mentioning are epiphenomenalism and panpsychism. The latter is the somewhat eccentric view that all things in physical reality, even down to micro-particles, have some mental properties. All substances have a mental aspect, though it is not always clear exactly how to characterize or test such a claim. Epiphenomenalism holds that mental events are caused by brain events but those mental events are mere “epiphenomena” which do not, in turn, cause anything physical at all, despite appearances to the contrary (for a recent defense, see Robinson 2004).

Finally, although not a form of dualism, idealism holds that there are only immaterial mental substances, a view more common in the Eastern tradition. The most prominent Western proponent of idealism was 18th century empiricist George Berkeley. The idealist agrees with the substance dualist, however, that minds are non-physical, but then denies the existence of mind-independent physical substances altogether. Such a view faces a number of serious objections, and it also requires a belief in the existence of God.

b. Materialism: General Support

Some form of materialism is probably much more widely held today than in centuries past. No doubt part of the reason for this has to do with the explosion in scientific knowledge about the workings of the brain and its intimate connection with consciousness, including the close connection between brain damage and various states of consciousness. Brain death is now the main criterion for when someone dies. Stimulation to specific areas of the brain results in modality specific conscious experiences. Indeed, materialism often seems to be a working assumption in neurophysiology. Imagine saying to a neuroscientist “you are not really studying the conscious mind itself” when she is examining the workings of the brain during an fMRI. The idea is that science is showing us that conscious mental states, such as visual perceptions, are simply identical with certain neuro-chemical brain processes; much like the science of chemistry taught us that water just is H2O.

There are also theoretical factors on the side of materialism, such as adherence to the so-called “principle of simplicity” which says that if two theories can equally explain a given phenomenon, then we should accept the one which posits fewer objects or forces. In this case, even if dualism could equally explain consciousness (which would of course be disputed by materialists), materialism is clearly the simpler theory in so far as it does not posit any objects or processes over and above physical ones. Materialists will wonder why there is a need to believe in the existence of such mysterious non-physical entities. Moreover, in the aftermath of the Darwinian revolution, it would seem that materialism is on even stronger ground provided that one accepts basic evolutionary theory and the notion that most animals are conscious. Given the similarities between the more primitive parts of the human brain and the brains of other animals, it seems most natural to conclude that, through evolution, increasing layers of brain areas correspond to increased mental abilities. For example, having a well developed prefrontal cortex allows humans to reason and plan in ways not available to dogs and cats. It also seems fairly uncontroversial to hold that we should be materialists about the minds of animals. If so, then it would be odd indeed to hold that non-physical conscious states suddenly appear on the scene with humans.

There are still, however, a number of much discussed and important objections to materialism, most of which question the notion that materialism can adequately explain conscious experience.

i. Objection 1: The Explanatory Gap and The Hard Problem

Joseph Levine (1983) coined the expression “the explanatory gap” to express a difficulty for any materialistic attempt to explain consciousness. Although not concerned to reject the metaphysics of materialism, Levine gives eloquent expression to the idea that there is a key gap in our ability to explain the connection between phenomenal properties and brain properties (see also Levine 1993, 2001). The basic problem is that it is, at least at present, very difficult for us to understand the relationship between brain properties and phenomenal properties in any explanatory satisfying way, especially given the fact that it seems possible for one to be present without the other. There is an odd kind of arbitrariness involved: Why or how does some particular brain process produce that particular taste or visual sensation? It is difficult to see any real explanatory connection between specific conscious states and brain states in a way that explains just how or why the former are identical with the latter. There is therefore an explanatory gap between the physical and mental. Levine argues that this difficulty in explaining consciousness is unique; that is, we do not have similar worries about other scientific identities, such as that “water is H2O” or that “heat is mean molecular kinetic energy.” There is “an important sense in which we can’t really understand how [materialism] could be true.” (2001: 68)

David Chalmers (1995) has articulated a similar worry by using the catchy phrase “the hard problem of consciousness,” which basically refers to the difficulty of explaining just how physical processes in the brain give rise to subjective conscious experiences. The “really hard problem is the problem of experience…How can we explain why there is something it is like to entertain a mental image, or to experience an emotion?” (1995: 201) Others have made similar points, as Chalmers acknowledges, but reference to the phrase “the hard problem” has now become commonplace in the literature. Unlike Levine, however, Chalmers is much more inclined to draw anti-materialist metaphysical conclusions from these and other considerations. Chalmers usefully distinguishes the hard problem of consciousness from what he calls the (relatively) “easy problems” of consciousness, such as the ability to discriminate and categorize stimuli, the ability of a cognitive system to access its own internal states, and the difference between wakefulness and sleep. The easy problems generally have more to do with the functions of consciousness, but Chalmers urges that solving them does not touch the hard problem of phenomenal consciousness. Most philosophers, according to Chalmers, are really only addressing the easy problems, perhaps merely with something like Block’s “access consciousness” in mind. Their theories ignore phenomenal consciousness.

There are many responses by materialists to the above charges, but it is worth emphasizing that Levine, at least, does not reject the metaphysics of materialism. Instead, he sees the “explanatory gap [as] primarily an epistemological problem” (2001: 10). That is, it is primarily a problem having to do with knowledge or understanding. This concession is still important at least to the extent that one is concerned with the larger related metaphysical issues discussed in section 3a, such as the possibility of immortality.

Perhaps most important for the materialist, however, is recognition of the fact that different concepts can pick out the same property or object in the world (Loar 1990, 1997). Out in the world there is only the one “stuff,” which we can conceptualize either as “water” or as “H2O.” The traditional distinction, made most notably by Gottlob Frege in the late 19th century, between “meaning” (or “sense”) and “reference” is also relevant here. Two or more concepts, which can have different meanings, can refer to the same property or object, much like “Venus” and “The Morning Star.” Materialists, then, explain that it is essential to distinguish between mental properties and our concepts of those properties. By analogy, there are so-called “phenomenal concepts” which uses a phenomenal or “first-person” property to refer to some conscious mental state, such as a sensation of red (Alter and Walter 2007). In contrast, we can also use various concepts couched in physical or neurophysiological terms to refer to that same mental state from the third-person point of view. There is thus but one conscious mental state which can be conceptualized in two different ways: either by employing first-person experiential phenomenal concepts or by employing third-person neurophysiological concepts. It may then just be a “brute fact” about the world that there are such identities and the appearance of arbitrariness between brain properties and mental properties is just that – an apparent problem leading many to wonder about the alleged explanatory gap. Qualia would then still be identical to physical properties. Moreover, this response provides a diagnosis for why there even seems to be such a gap; namely, that we use very different concepts to pick out the same property. Science will be able, in principle, to close the gap and solve the hard problem of consciousness in an analogous way that we now have a very good understanding for why “water is H2O” or “heat is mean molecular kinetic energy” that was lacking centuries ago. Maybe the hard problem isn’t so hard after all – it will just take some more time. After all, the science of chemistry didn’t develop overnight and we are relatively early in the history of neurophysiology and our understanding of phenomenal consciousness. (See Shear 1997 for many more specific responses to the hard problem, but also for Chalmers’ counter-replies.)

ii. Objection 2: The Knowledge Argument

There is a pair of very widely discussed, and arguably related, objections to materialism which come from the seminal writings of Thomas Nagel (1974) and Frank Jackson (1982, 1986). These arguments, especially Jackson’s, have come to be known as examples of the “knowledge argument” against materialism, due to their clear emphasis on the epistemological (that is, knowledge related) limitations of materialism. Like Levine, Nagel does not reject the metaphysics of materialism. Jackson had originally intended for his argument to yield a dualistic conclusion, but he no longer holds that view. The general pattern of each argument is to assume that all the physical facts are known about some conscious mind or conscious experience. Yet, the argument goes, not all is known about the mind or experience. It is then inferred that the missing knowledge is non-physical in some sense, which is surely an anti-materialist conclusion in some sense.

Nagel imagines a future where we know everything physical there is to know about some other conscious creature’s mind, such as a bat. However, it seems clear that we would still not know something crucial; namely, “what it is like to be a bat.” It will not do to imagine what it is like for us to be a bat. We would still not know what it is like to be a bat from the bat’s subjective or first-person point of view. The idea, then, is that if we accept the hypothesis that we know all of the physical facts about bat minds, and yet some knowledge about bat minds is left out, then materialism is inherently flawed when it comes to explaining consciousness. Even in an ideal future in which everything physical is known by us, something would still be left out. Jackson’s somewhat similar, but no less influential, argument begins by asking us to imagine a future where a person, Mary, is kept in a black and white room from birth during which time she becomes a brilliant neuroscientist and an expert on color perception. Mary never sees red for example, but she learns all of the physical facts and everything neurophysiologically about human color vision. Eventually she is released from the room and sees red for the first time. Jackson argues that it is clear that Mary comes to learn something new; namely, to use Nagel’s famous phrase, what it is like to experience red. This is a new piece of knowledge and hence she must have come to know some non-physical fact (since, by hypothesis, she already knew all of the physical facts). Thus, not all knowledge about the conscious mind is physical knowledge.

The influence and the quantity of work that these ideas have generated cannot be exaggerated. Numerous materialist responses to Nagel’s argument have been presented (such as Van Gulick 1985), and there is now a very useful anthology devoted entirely to Jackson’s knowledge argument (Ludlow et. al. 2004). Some materialists have wondered if we should concede up front that Mary wouldn’t be able to imagine the color red even before leaving the room, so that maybe she wouldn’t even be surprised upon seeing red for the first time. Various suspicions about the nature and effectiveness of such thought experiments also usually accompany this response. More commonly, however, materialists reply by arguing that Mary does not learn a new fact when seeing red for the first time, but rather learns the same fact in a different way. Recalling the distinction made in section 3b.i between concepts and objects or properties, the materialist will urge that there is only the one physical fact about color vision, but there are two ways to come to know it: either by employing neurophysiological concepts or by actually undergoing the relevant experience and so by employing phenomenal concepts. We might say that Mary, upon leaving the black and white room, becomes acquainted with the same neural property as before, but only now from the first-person point of view. The property itself isn’t new; only the perspective, or what philosophers sometimes call the “mode of presentation,” is different. In short, coming to learn or know something new does not entail learning some new fact about the world. Analogies are again given in other less controversial areas, for example, one can come to know about some historical fact or event by reading a (reliable) third-person historical account or by having observed that event oneself. But there is still only the one objective fact under two different descriptions. Finally, it is crucial to remember that, according to most, the metaphysics of materialism remains unaffected. Drawing a metaphysical conclusion from such purely epistemological premises is always a questionable practice. Nagel’s argument doesn’t show that bat mental states are not identical with bat brain states. Indeed, a materialist might even expect the conclusion that Nagel draws; after all, given that our brains are so different from bat brains, it almost seems natural for there to be certain aspects of bat experience that we could never fully comprehend. Only the bat actually undergoes the relevant brain processes. Similarly, Jackson’s argument doesn’t show that Mary’s color experience is distinct from her brain processes.

Despite the plethora of materialist responses, vigorous debate continues as there are those who still think that something profound must always be missing from any materialist attempt to explain consciousness; namely, that understanding subjective phenomenal consciousness is an inherently first-person activity which cannot be captured by any objective third-person scientific means, no matter how much scientific knowledge is accumulated. Some knowledge about consciousness is essentially limited to first-person knowledge. Such a sense, no doubt, continues to fuel the related anti-materialist intuitions raised in the previous section. Perhaps consciousness is simply a fundamental or irreducible part of nature in some sense (Chalmers 1996). (For more see Van Gulick 1993.)

iii. Objection 3: Mysterianism

Finally, some go so far as to argue that we are simply not capable of solving the problem of consciousness (McGinn 1989, 1991, 1995). In short, “mysterians” believe that the hard problem can never be solved because of human cognitive limitations; the explanatory gap can never be filled. Once again, however, McGinn does not reject the metaphysics of materialism, but rather argues that we are “cognitively closed” with respect to this problem much like a rat or dog is cognitively incapable of solving, or even understanding, calculus problems. More specifically, McGinn claims that we are cognitively closed as to how the brain produces conscious awareness. McGinn concedes that some brain property produces conscious experience, but we cannot understand how this is so or even know what that brain property is. Our concept forming mechanisms simply will not allow us to grasp the physical and causal basis of consciousness. We are not conceptually suited to be able to do so.

McGinn does not entirely rest his argument on past failed attempts at explaining consciousness in materialist terms; instead, he presents another argument for his admittedly pessimistic conclusion. McGinn observes that we do not have a mental faculty that can access both consciousness and the brain. We access consciousness through introspection or the first-person perspective, but our access to the brain is through the use of outer spatial senses (e.g., vision) or a more third-person perspective. Thus we have no way to access both the brain and consciousness together, and therefore any explanatory link between them is forever beyond our reach.

Materialist responses are numerous. First, one might wonder why we can’t combine the two perspectives within certain experimental contexts. Both first-person and third-person scientific data about the brain and consciousness can be acquired and used to solve the hard problem. Even if a single person cannot grasp consciousness from both perspectives at the same time, why can’t a plausible physicalist theory emerge from such a combined approach? Presumably, McGinn would say that we are not capable of putting such a theory together in any appropriate way. Second, despite McGinn’s protests to the contrary, many will view the problem of explaining consciousness as a merely temporary limit of our theorizing, and not something which is unsolvable in principle (Dennett 1991). Third, it may be that McGinn expects too much; namely, grasping some causal link between the brain and consciousness. After all, if conscious mental states are simply identical to brain states, then there may simply be a “brute fact” that really does not need any further explaining. Indeed, this is sometimes also said in response to the explanatory gap and the hard problem, as we saw earlier. It may even be that some form of dualism is presupposed in McGinn’s argument, to the extent that brain states are said to “cause” or “give rise to” consciousness, instead of using the language of identity. Fourth, McGinn’s analogy to lower animals and mathematics is not quite accurate. Rats, for example, have no concept whatsoever of calculus. It is not as if they can grasp it to some extent but just haven’t figured out the answer to some particular problem within mathematics. Rats are just completely oblivious to calculus problems. On the other hand, we humans obviously do have some grasp on consciousness and on the workings of the brain — just see the references at the end of this entry! It is not clear, then, why we should accept the extremely pessimistic and universally negative conclusion that we can never discover the answer to the problem of consciousness, or, more specifically, why we could never understand the link between consciousness and the brain.

iv. Objection 4: Zombies

Unlike many of the above objections to materialism, the appeal to the possibility of zombies is often taken as both a problem for materialism and as a more positive argument for some form of dualism, such as property dualism. The philosophical notion of a “zombie” basically refers to conceivable creatures which are physically indistinguishable from us but lack consciousness entirely (Chalmers 1996). It certainly seems logically possible for there to be such creatures: “the conceivability of zombies seems…obvious to me…While this possibility is probably empirically impossible, it certainly seems that a coherent situation is described; I can discern no contradiction in the description” (Chalmers 1996: 96). Philosophers often contrast what is logically possible (in the sense of “that which is not self-contradictory”) from what is empirically possible given the actual laws of nature. Thus, it is logically possible for me to jump fifty feet in the air, but not empirically possible. Philosophers often use the notion of “possible worlds,” i.e., different ways that the world might have been, in describing such non-actual situations or possibilities. The objection, then, typically proceeds from such a possibility to the conclusion that materialism is false because materialism would seem to rule out that possibility. It has been fairly widely accepted (since Kripke 1972) that all identity statements are necessarily true (that is, true in all possible worlds), and the same should therefore go for mind-brain identity claims. Since the possibility of zombies shows that it doesn’t, then we should conclude that materialism is false. (See Identity Theory.)

It is impossible to do justice to all of the subtleties here. The literature in response to zombie, and related “conceivability,” arguments is enormous (see, for example, Hill 1997, Hill and McLaughlin 1999, Papineau 1998, 2002, Balog 1999, Block and Stalnaker 1999, Loar 1999, Yablo 1999, Perry 2001, Botterell 2001, Kirk 2005). A few lines of reply are as follows: First, it is sometimes objected that the conceivability of something does not really entail its possibility. Perhaps we can also conceive of water not being H2O, since there seems to be no logical contradiction in doing so, but, according to received wisdom from Kripke, that is really impossible. Perhaps, then, some things just seem possible but really aren’t. Much of the debate centers on various alleged similarities or dissimilarities between the mind-brain and water-H2O cases (or other such scientific identities). Indeed, the entire issue of the exact relationship between “conceivability” and “possibility” is the subject of an important recently published anthology (Gendler and Hawthorne 2002). Second, even if zombies are conceivable in the sense of logically possible, how can we draw a substantial metaphysical conclusion about the actual world? There is often suspicion on the part of materialists about what, if anything, such philosophers’ “thought experiments” can teach us about the nature of our minds. It seems that one could take virtually any philosophical or scientific theory about almost anything, conceive that it is possibly false, and then conclude that it is actually false. Something, perhaps, is generally wrong with this way of reasoning. Third, as we saw earlier (3b.i), there may be a very good reason why such zombie scenarios seem possible; namely, that we do not (at least, not yet) see what the necessary connection is between neural events and conscious mental events. On the one side, we are dealing with scientific third-person concepts and, on the other, we are employing phenomenal concepts. We are, perhaps, simply currently not in a position to understand completely such a necessary connection.

Debate and discussion on all four objections remains very active.

v. Varieties of Materialism

Despite the apparent simplicity of materialism, say, in terms of the identity between mental states and neural states, the fact is that there are many different forms of materialism. While a detailed survey of all varieties is beyond the scope of this entry, it is at least important to acknowledge the commonly drawn distinction between two kinds of “identity theory”: token-token and type-type materialism. Type-type identity theory is the stronger thesis and says that mental properties, such as “having a desire to drink some water” or “being in pain,” are literally identical with a brain property of some kind. Such identities were originally meant to be understood as on a par with, for example, the scientific identity between “being water” and “being composed of H2O” (Place 1956, Smart 1959). However, this view historically came under serious assault due to the fact that it seems to rule out the so-called “multiple realizability” of conscious mental states. The idea is simply that it seems perfectly possible for there to be other conscious beings (e.g., aliens, radically different animals) who can have those same mental states but who also are radically different from us physiologically (Fodor 1974). It seems that commitment to type-type identity theory led to the undesirable result that only organisms with brains like ours can have conscious states. Somewhat more technically, most materialists wish to leave room for the possibility that mental properties can be “instantiated” in different kinds of organisms. (But for more recent defenses of type-type identity theory see Hill and McLaughlin 1999, Papineau 1994, 1995, 1998, Polger 2004.) As a consequence, a more modest “token-token” identity theory has become preferable to many materialists. This view simply holds that each particular conscious mental event in some organism is identical with some particular brain process or event in that organism. This seems to preserve much of what the materialist wants but yet allows for the multiple realizability of conscious states, because both the human and the alien can still have a conscious desire for something to drink while each mental event is identical with a (different) physical state in each organism.

Taking the notion of multiple realizability very seriously has also led many to embrace functionalism, which is the view that conscious mental states should really only be identified with the functional role they play within an organism. For example, conscious pains are defined more in terms of input and output, such as causing bodily damage and avoidance behavior, as well as in terms of their relationship to other mental states. It is normally viewed as a form of materialism since virtually all functionalists also believe, like the token-token theorist, that something physical ultimately realizes that functional state in the organism, but functionalism does not, by itself, entail that materialism is true. Critics of functionalism, however, have long argued that such purely functional accounts cannot adequately explain the essential “feel” of conscious states, or that it seems possible to have two functionally equivalent creatures, one of whom lacks qualia entirely (Block 1980a, 1980b, Chalmers 1996; see also Shoemaker 1975, 1981).

Some materialists even deny the very existence of mind and mental states altogether, at least in the sense that the very concept of consciousness is muddled (Wilkes 1984, 1988) or that the mentalistic notions found in folk psychology, such as desires and beliefs, will eventually be eliminated and replaced by physicalistic terms as neurophysiology matures into the future (Churchland 1983). This is meant as analogous to past similar eliminations based on deeper scientific understanding, for example, we no longer need to speak of “ether” or “phlogiston.” Other eliminativists, more modestly, argue that there is no such thing as qualia when they are defined in certain problematic ways (Dennett 1988).

Finally, it should also be noted that not all materialists believe that conscious mentality can be explained in terms of the physical, at least in the sense that the former cannot be “reduced” to the latter. Materialism is true as an ontological or metaphysical doctrine, but facts about the mind cannot be deduced from facts about the physical world (Boyd 1980, Van Gulick 1992). In some ways, this might be viewed as a relatively harmless variation on materialist themes, but others object to the very coherence of this form of materialism (Kim 1987, 1998). Indeed, the line between such “non-reductive materialism” and property dualism is not always so easy to draw; partly because the entire notion of “reduction” is ambiguous and a very complex topic in its own right. On a related front, some materialists are happy enough to talk about a somewhat weaker “supervenience” relation between mind and matter. Although “supervenience” is a highly technical notion with many variations, the idea is basically one of dependence (instead of identity); for example, that the mental depends on the physical in the sense that any mental change must be accompanied by some physical change (see Kim 1993).

4. Specific Theories of Consciousness

Most specific theories of consciousness tend to be reductionist in some sense. The classic notion at work is that consciousness or individual conscious mental states can be explained in terms of something else or in some other terms. This section will focus on several prominent contemporary reductionist theories. We should, however, distinguish between those who attempt such a reduction directly in physicalistic, such as neurophysiological, terms and those who do so in mentalistic terms, such as by using unconscious mental states or other cognitive notions.

a. Neural Theories

The more direct reductionist approach can be seen in various, more specific, neural theories of consciousness. Perhaps best known is the theory offered by Francis Crick and Christof Koch 1990 (see also Crick 1994, Koch 2004). The basic idea is that mental states become conscious when large numbers of neurons fire in synchrony and all have oscillations within the 35-75 hertz range (that is, 35-75 cycles per second). However, many philosophers and scientists have put forth other candidates for what, specifically, to identify in the brain with consciousness. This vast enterprise has come to be known as the search for the “neural correlates of consciousness” or NCCs (see section 5b below for more). The overall idea is to show how one or more specific kinds of neuro-chemical activity can underlie and explain conscious mental activity (Metzinger 2000). Of course, mere “correlation” is not enough for a fully adequate neural theory and explaining just what counts as a NCC turns out to be more difficult than one might think (Chalmers 2000). Even Crick and Koch have acknowledged that they, at best, provide a necessary condition for consciousness, and that such firing patters are not automatically sufficient for having conscious experience.

b. Representational Theories of Consciousness

Many current theories attempt to reduce consciousness in mentalistic terms. One broadly popular approach along these lines is to reduce consciousness to “mental representations” of some kind. The notion of a “representation” is of course very general and can be applied to photographs, signs, and various natural objects, such as the rings inside a tree. Much of what goes on in the brain, however, might also be understood in a representational way; for example, as mental events representing outer objects partly because they are caused by such objects in, say, cases of veridical visual perception. More specifically, philosophers will often call such representational mental states “intentional states” which have representational content; that is, mental states which are “about something” or “directed at something” as when one has a thought about the house or a perception of the tree. Although intentional states are sometimes contrasted with phenomenal states, such as pains and color experiences, it is clear that many conscious states have both phenomenal and intentional properties, such as visual perceptions. It should be noted that the relation between intentionalilty and consciousness is itself a major ongoing area of dispute with some arguing that genuine intentionality actually presupposes consciousness in some way (Searle 1992, Siewart 1998, Horgan and Tienson 2002) while most representationalists insist that intentionality is prior to consciousness (Gennaro 2012, chapter two).

The general view that we can explain conscious mental states in terms of representational or intentional states is called “representationalism.” Although not automatically reductionist in spirit, most versions of representationalism do indeed attempt such a reduction. Most representationalists, then, believe that there is room for a kind of “second-step” reduction to be filled in later by neuroscience. The other related motivation for representational theories of consciousness is that many believe that an account of representation or intentionality can more easily be given in naturalistic terms, such as causal theories whereby mental states are understood as representing outer objects in virtue of some reliable causal connection. The idea, then, is that if consciousness can be explained in representational terms and representation can be understood in purely physical terms, then there is the promise of a reductionist and naturalistic theory of consciousness. Most generally, however, we can say that a representationalist will typically hold that the phenomenal properties of experience (that is, the “qualia” or “what it is like of experience” or “phenomenal character”) can be explained in terms of the experiences’ representational properties. Alternatively, conscious mental states have no mental properties other than their representational properties. Two conscious states with all the same representational properties will not differ phenomenally. For example, when I look at the blue sky, what it is like for me to have a conscious experience of the sky is simply identical with my experience’s representation of the blue sky.

i. First-Order Representationalism

A First-order representational (FOR) theory of consciousness is a theory that attempts to explain conscious experience primarily in terms of world-directed (or first-order) intentional states. Probably the two most cited FOR theories of consciousness are those of Fred Dretske (1995) and Michael Tye (1995, 2000), though there are many others as well (e.g., Harman 1990, Kirk 1994, Byrne 2001, Thau 2002, Droege 2003). Tye’s theory is more fully worked out and so will be the focus of this section. Like other FOR theorists, Tye holds that the representational content of my conscious experience (that is, what my experience is about or directed at) is identical with the phenomenal properties of experience. Aside from reductionistic motivations, Tye and other FOR representationalists often use the somewhat technical notion of the “transparency of experience” as support for their view (Harman 1990). This is an argument based on the phenomenological first-person observation, which goes back to Moore (1903), that when one turns one’s attention away from, say, the blue sky and onto one’s experience itself, one is still only aware of the blueness of the sky. The experience itself is not blue; rather, one “sees right through” one’s experience to its representational properties, and there is nothing else to one’s experience over and above such properties.

Whatever the merits and exact nature of the argument from transparency (see Kind 2003), it is clear, of course, that not all mental representations are conscious, so the key question eventually becomes: What exactly distinguishes conscious from unconscious mental states (or representations)? What makes a mental state a conscious mental state? Here Tye defends what he calls “PANIC theory.” The acronym “PANIC” stands for poised, abstract, non-conceptual, intentional content. Without probing into every aspect of PANIC theory, Tye holds that at least some of the representational content in question is non-conceptual (N), which is to say that the subject can lack the concept for the properties represented by the experience in question, such as an experience of a certain shade of red that one has never seen before. Actually, the exact nature or even existence of non-conceptual content of experience is itself a highly debated and difficult issue in philosophy of mind (Gunther 2003).  Gennaro (2012), for example, defends conceptualism and connects it in various ways to the higher-order thought theory of consciousness (see section 4b.ii). Conscious states clearly must also have “intentional content” (IC) for any representationalist. Tye also asserts that such content is “abstract” (A) and not necessarily about particular concrete objects. This condition is needed to handle cases of hallucinations, where there are no concrete objects at all or cases where different objects look phenomenally alike. Perhaps most important for mental states to be conscious, however, is that such content must be “poised” (P), which is an importantly functional notion. The “key idea is that experiences and feelings…stand ready and available to make a direct impact on beliefs and/or desires. For example…feeling hungry… has an immediate cognitive effect, namely, the desire to eat….States with nonconceptual content that are not so poised lack phenomenal character [because]…they arise too early, as it were, in the information processing” (Tye 2000: 62).

One objection to Tye’s theory is that it does not really address the hard problem of phenomenal consciousness (see section 3b.i). This is partly because what really seems to be doing most of the work on Tye’s PANIC account is the very functional sounding “poised” notion, which is perhaps closer to Block’s access consciousness (see section 1) and is therefore not necessarily able to explain phenomenal consciousness (see Kriegel 2002). In short, it is difficult to see just how Tye’s PANIC account might not equally apply to unconscious representations and thus how it really explains phenomenal consciousness.

Other standard objections to Tye’s theory as well as to other FOR accounts include the concern that it does not cover all kinds of conscious states. Some conscious states seem not to be “about” anything, such as pains, anxiety, or after-images, and so would be non-representational conscious states. If so, then conscious experience cannot generally be explained in terms of representational properties (Block 1996). Tye responds that pains, itches, and the like do represent, in the sense that they represent parts of the body. And after-images, hallucinations, and the like either misrepresent (which is still a kind of representation) or the conscious subject still takes them to have representational properties from the first-person point of view. Indeed, Tye (2000) admirably goes to great lengths and argues convincingly in response to a whole host of alleged counter-examples to representationalism. Historically among them are various hypothetical cases of inverted qualia (see Shoemaker 1982), the mere possibility of which is sometimes taken as devastating to representationalism. These are cases where behaviorally indistinguishable individuals have inverted color perceptions of objects, such as person A visually experiences a lemon the way that person B experience a ripe tomato with respect to their color, and so on for all yellow and red objects. Isn’t it possible that there are two individuals whose color experiences are inverted with respect to the objects of perception? (For more on the importance of color in philosophy, see Hardin 1986.)

A somewhat different twist on the inverted spectrum is famously put forth in Block’s (1990) Inverted Earth case. On Inverted Earth every object has the complementary color to the one it has here, but we are asked to imagine that a person is equipped with color-inverting lenses and then sent to Inverted Earth completely ignorant of those facts. Since the color inversions cancel out, the phenomenal experiences remain the same, yet there certainly seem to be different representational properties of objects involved. The strategy on the part of critics, in short, is to think of counter-examples (either actual or hypothetical) whereby there is a difference between the phenomenal properties in experience and the relevant representational properties in the world. Such objections can, perhaps, be answered by Tye and others in various ways, but significant debate continues (Macpherson 2005). Intuitions also dramatically differ as to the very plausibility and value of such thought experiments. (For more, see Seager 1999, chapters 6 and 7. See also Chalmers 2004 for an excellent discussion of the dizzying array of possible representationalist positions.)

ii. Higher-Order Representationalism

As we have seen, one question that should be answered by any theory of consciousness is: What makes a mental state a conscious mental state? There is a long tradition that has attempted to understand consciousness in terms of some kind of higher-order awareness. For example, John Locke (1689/1975) once said that “consciousness is the perception of what passes in a man’s own mind.” This intuition has been revived by a number of philosophers (Rosenthal, 1986, 1993b, 1997, 2000, 2004, 2005; Gennaro 1996a, 2012; Armstrong, 1968, 1981; Lycan, 1996, 2001). In general, the idea is that what makes a mental state conscious is that it is the object of some kind of higher-order representation (HOR). A mental state M becomes conscious when there is a HOR of M. A HOR is a “meta-psychological” state, i.e., a mental state directed at another mental state. So, for example, my desire to write a good encyclopedia entry becomes conscious when I am (non-inferentially) “aware” of the desire. Intuitively, it seems that conscious states, as opposed to unconscious ones, are mental states that I am “aware of” in some sense. This is sometimes referred to as the Transitivity Principle. Any theory which attempts to explain consciousness in terms of higher-order states is known as a higher-order (HO) theory of consciousness. It is best initially to use the more neutral term “representation” because there are a number of different kinds of higher-order theory, depending upon how one characterizes the HOR in question. HO theories, thus, attempt to explain consciousness in mentalistic terms, that is, by reference to such notions as “thoughts” and “awareness.” Conscious mental states arise when two unconscious mental states are related in a certain specific way; namely, that one of them (the HOR) is directed at the other (M). HO theorists are united in the belief that their approach can better explain consciousness than any purely FOR theory, which has significant difficulty in explaining the difference between unconscious and conscious mental states.

There are various kinds of HO theory with the most common division between higher-order thought (HOT) theories and higher-order perception (HOP) theories. HOT theorists, such as David M. Rosenthal, think it is better to understand the HOR as a thought of some kind. HOTs are treated as cognitive states involving some kind of conceptual component. HOP theorists urge that the HOR is a perceptual or experiential state of some kind (Lycan 1996) which does not require the kind of conceptual content invoked by HOT theorists. Partly due to Kant (1781/1965), HOP theory is sometimes referred to as “inner sense theory” as a way of emphasizing its sensory or perceptual aspect. Although HOT and HOP theorists agree on the need for a HOR theory of consciousness, they do sometimes argue for the superiority of their respective positions (such as in Rosenthal 2004, Lycan 2004, and Gennaro 2012). Some philosophers, however, have argued that the difference between these theories is perhaps not as important or as clear as some think it is (Güzeldere 1995, Gennaro 1996a, Van Gulick 2000).

A common initial objection to HOR theories is that they are circular and lead to an infinite regress. It might seem that the HOT theory results in circularity by defining consciousness in terms of HOTs. It also might seem that an infinite regress results because a conscious mental state must be accompanied by a HOT, which, in turn, must be accompanied by another HOT ad infinitum. However, the standard reply is that when a conscious mental state is a first-order world-directed state the higher-order thought (HOT) is not itself conscious; otherwise, circularity and an infinite regress would follow. When the HOT is itself conscious, there is a yet higher-order (or third-order) thought directed at the second-order state. In this case, we have introspection which involves a conscious HOT directed at an inner mental state. When one introspects, one’s attention is directed back into one’s mind. For example, what makes my desire to write a good entry a conscious first-order desire is that there is a (non-conscious) HOT directed at the desire. In this case, my conscious focus is directed at the entry and my computer screen, so I am not consciously aware of having the HOT from the first-person point of view. When I introspect that desire, however, I then have a conscious HOT (accompanied by a yet higher, third-order, HOT) directed at the desire itself (see Rosenthal 1986).

Peter Carruthers (2000) has proposed another possibility within HO theory; namely, that it is better for various reasons to think of the HOTs as dispositional states instead of the standard view that the HOTs are actual, though he also understands his “dispositional HOT theory” to be a form of HOP theory (Carruthers 2004). The basic idea is that the conscious status of an experience is due to its availability to higher-order thought. So “conscious experience occurs when perceptual contents are fed into a special short-term buffer memory store, whose function is to make those contents available to cause HOTs about themselves.” (Carruthers 2000: 228). Some first-order perceptual contents are available to a higher-order “theory of mind mechanism,” which transforms those representational contents into conscious contents. Thus, no actual HOT occurs. Instead, according to Carruthers, some perceptual states acquire a dual intentional content; for example, a conscious experience of red not only has a first-order content of “red,” but also has the higher-order content “seems red” or “experience of red.” Carruthers also makes interesting use of so-called “consumer semantics” in order to fill out his theory of phenomenal consciousness. The content of a mental state depends, in part, on the powers of the organisms which “consume” that state, e.g., the kinds of inferences which the organism can make when it is in that state. Daniel Dennett (1991) is sometimes credited with an earlier version of a dispositional account (see Carruthers 2000, chapter ten). Carruthers’ dispositional theory is often criticized by those who, among other things, do not see how the mere disposition toward a mental state can render it conscious (Rosenthal 2004; see also Gennaro 2004, 2012; for more, see Consciousness, Higher Order Theories of.)

It is worth briefly noting a few typical objections to HO theories (many of which can be found in Byrne 1997): First, and perhaps most common, is that various animals (and even infants) are not likely to have to the conceptual sophistication required for HOTs, and so that would render animal (and infant) consciousness very unlikely (Dretske 1995, Seager 2004). Are cats and dogs capable of having complex higher-order thoughts such as “I am in mental state M”? Although most who bring forth this objection are not HO theorists, Peter Carruthers (1989) is one HO theorist who actually embraces the conclusion that (most) animals do not have phenomenal consciousness. Gennaro (1993, 1996) has replied to Carruthers on this point; for example, it is argued that the HOTs need not be as sophisticated as it might initially appear and there is ample comparative neurophysiological evidence supporting the conclusion that animals have conscious mental states. Most HO theorists do not wish to accept the absence of animal or infant consciousness as a consequence of holding the theory. The debate continues, however, in Carruthers (2000, 2005, 2008) and Gennaro (2004, 2009, 2012, chapters seven and eight).

A second objection has been referred to as the “problem of the rock” (Stubenberg 1998) and the “generality problem” (Van Gulick 2000, 2004), but it is originally due to Alvin Goldman (Goldman 1993). When I have a thought about a rock, it is certainly not true that the rock becomes conscious. So why should I suppose that a mental state becomes conscious when I think about it? This is puzzling to many and the objection forces HO theorists to explain just how adding the HO state changes an unconscious state into a conscious. There have been, however, a number of responses to this kind of objection (Rosenthal 1997, Lycan, 1996, Van Gulick 2000, 2004, Gennaro 2005, 2012, chapter four). A common theme is that there is a principled difference in the objects of the HO states in question. Rocks and the like are not mental states in the first place, and so HO theorists are first and foremost trying to explain how a mental state becomes conscious. The objects of the HO states must be “in the head.”

Third, the above leads somewhat naturally to an objection related to Chalmers’ hard problem (section 3b.i). It might be asked just how exactly any HO theory really explains the subjective or phenomenal aspect of conscious experience. How or why does a mental state come to have a first-person qualitative “what it is like” aspect by virtue of the presence of a HOR directed at it? It is probably fair to say that HO theorists have been slow to address this problem, though a number of overlapping responses have emerged (see also Gennaro 2005, 2012, chapter four, for more extensive treatment). Some argue that this objection misconstrues the main and more modest purpose of (at least, their) HO theories. The claim is that HO theories are theories of consciousness only in the sense that they are attempting to explain what differentiates conscious from unconscious states, i.e., in terms of a higher-order awareness of some kind. A full account of “qualitative properties” or “sensory qualities” (which can themselves be non-conscious) can be found elsewhere in their work, but is independent of their theory of consciousness (Rosenthal 1991, Lycan 1996, 2001). Thus, a full explanation of phenomenal consciousness does require more than a HO theory, but that is no objection to HO theories as such. Another response is that proponents of the hard problem unjustly raise the bar as to what would count as a viable explanation of consciousness so that any such reductivist attempt would inevitably fall short (Carruthers 2000, Gennaro 2012). Part of the problem, then, is a lack of clarity about what would even count as an explanation of consciousness (Van Gulick 1995; see also section 3b). Once this is clarified, however, the hard problem can indeed be solved. Moreover, anyone familiar with the literature knows that there are significant terminological difficulties in the use of various crucial terms which sometimes inhibits genuine progress (but see Byrne 2004 for some helpful clarification).

A fourth important objection to HO approaches is the question of how such theories can explain cases where the HO state might misrepresent the lower-order (LO) mental state (Byrne 1997, Neander 1998, Levine 2001, Block 2011). After all, if we have a representational relation between two states, it seems possible for misrepresentation or malfunction to occur. If it does, then what explanation can be offered by the HO theorist? If my LO state registers a red percept and my HO state registers a thought about something green due, say, to some neural misfiring, then what happens? It seems that problems loom for any answer given by a HO theorist and the cause of the problem has to do with the very nature of the HO theorist’s belief that there is a representational relation between the LO and HO states. For example, if the HO theorist takes the option that the resulting conscious experience is reddish, then it seems that the HO state plays no role in determining the qualitative character of the experience. On the other hand, if the resulting experience is greenish, then the LO state seems irrelevant.  Rosenthal and Weisberg hold that the HO state determines the qualitative properties even in cases when there is no LO state at all (Rosenthal 2005, 2011, Weisberg 2008, 2011a, 2011b).  Gennaro (2012) argues that no conscious experience results in such cases and wonders, for example, how a sole (unconscious) HOT can result in a conscious state at all.  He argues that there must be a match, complete or partial, between the LO and HO state in order for a conscious state to exist in the first place. This important objection forces HO theorists to be clearer about just how to view the relationship between the LO and HO states. Debate is ongoing and significant both on varieties of HO theory and in terms of the above objections (see Gennaro 2004a). There is also interdisciplinary interest in how various HO theories might be realized in the brain (Gennaro 2012, chapter nine).

iii. Hybrid Representational Accounts

A related and increasingly popular version of representational theory holds that the meta-psychological state in question should be understood as intrinsic to (or part of) an overall complex conscious state. This stands in contrast to the standard view that the HO state is extrinsic to (that is, entirely distinct from) its target mental state. The assumption, made by Rosenthal for example, about the extrinsic nature of the meta-thought has increasingly come under attack, and thus various hybrid representational theories can be found in the literature. One motivation for this movement is growing dissatisfaction with standard HO theory’s ability to handle some of the objections addressed in the previous section. Another reason is renewed interest in a view somewhat closer to the one held by Franz Brentano (1874/1973) and various other followers, normally associated with the phenomenological tradition (Husserl 1913/1931, 1929/1960; Sartre 1956; see also Smith 1986, 2004). To varying degrees, these views have in common the idea that conscious mental states, in some sense, represent themselves, which then still involves having a thought about a mental state, just not a distinct or separate state. Thus, when one has a conscious desire for a cold glass of water, one is also aware that one is in that very state. The conscious desire both represents the glass of water and itself. It is this “self-representing” which makes the state conscious.

These theories can go by various names, which sometimes seem in conflict, and have added significantly in recent years to the acronyms which abound in the literature. For example, Gennaro (1996a, 2002, 2004, 2006, 2012) has argued that, when one has a first-order conscious state, the HOT is better viewed as intrinsic to the target state, so that we have a complex conscious state with parts. Gennaro calls this the “wide intrinsicality view” (WIV) and he also argues that Jean-Paul Sartre’s theory of consciousness can be understood in this way (Gennaro 2002). Gennaro holds that conscious mental states should be understood (as Kant might have today) as global brain states which are combinations of passively received perceptual input and presupposed higher-order conceptual activity directed at that input. Higher-order concepts in the meta-psychological thoughts are presupposed in having first-order conscious states. Robert Van Gulick (2000, 2004, 2006) has also explored the alternative that the HO state is part of an overall global conscious state. He calls such states “HOGS” (Higher-Order Global States) whereby a lower-order unconscious state is “recruited” into a larger state, which becomes conscious partly due to the implicit self-awareness that one is in the lower-order state. Both Gennaro and Van Gulick have suggested that conscious states can be understood materialistically as global states of the brain, and it would be better to treat the first-order state as part of the larger complex brain state. This general approach is also forcefully advocated by Uriah Kriegel (Kriegel 2003a, 2003b, 2005, 2006, 2009) and is even the subject of an entire anthology debating its merits (Kriegel and Williford 2006). Kriegel has used several different names for his “neo-Brentanian theory,” such as the SOMT (Same-Order Monitoring Theory) and, more recently, the “self-representational theory of consciousness.” To be sure, the notion of a mental state representing itself or a mental state with one part representing another part is in need of further development and is perhaps somewhat mysterious. Nonetheless, there is agreement among these authors that conscious mental states are, in some important sense, reflexive or self-directed. And, once again, there is keen interest in developing this model in a way that coheres with the latest neurophysiological research on consciousness. A point of emphasis is on the concept of global meta-representation within a complex brain state, and attempts are underway to identify just how such an account can be realized in the brain.

It is worth mentioning that this idea was also briefly explored by Thomas Metzinger who focused on the fact that consciousness “is something that unifies or synthesizes experience” (Metzinger 1995: 454). Metzinger calls this the process of “higher-order binding” and thus uses the acronym HOB. Others who hold some form of the self-representational view include Kobes (1995), Caston (2002), Williford (2006), Brook and Raymont (2006), and even Carruthers’ (2000) theory can be viewed in this light since he contends that conscious states have two representational contents. Thomas Natsoulas also has a series of papers defending a similar view, beginning with Natsoulas 1996. Some authors (such as Gennaro 2012) view this hybrid position to be a modified version of HOT theory; indeed, Rosenthal (2004) has called it “intrinsic higher-order theory.” Van Gulick also clearly wishes to preserve the HO is his HOGS. Others, such as Kriegel, are not inclined to call their views “higher-order” at all and call it, for example, the “same-order monitoring” or “self-representational” theory of consciousness. To some extent, this is a terminological dispute, but, despite important similarities, there are also key subtle differences between these hybrid alternatives. Like HO theorists, however, those who advocate this general approach all take very seriously the notion that a conscious mental state M is a state that subject S is (non-inferentially) aware that S is in. By contrast, one is obviously not aware of one’s unconscious mental states. Thus, there are various attempts to make sense of and elaborate upon this key intuition in a way that is, as it were, “in-between” standard FO and HO theory. (See also Lurz 2003 and 2004 for yet another interesting hybrid account.)

c. Other Cognitive Theories

Aside from the explicitly representational approaches discussed above, there are also related attempts to explain consciousness in other cognitive terms. The two most prominent such theories are worth describing here:

Daniel Dennett (1991, 2005) has put forth what he calls the Multiple Drafts Model (MDM) of consciousness. Although similar in some ways to representationalism, Dennett is most concerned that materialists avoid falling prey to what he calls the “myth of the Cartesian theater,” the notion that there is some privileged place in the brain where everything comes together to produce conscious experience. Instead, the MDM holds that all kinds of mental activity occur in the brain by parallel processes of interpretation, all of which are under frequent revision. The MDM rejects the idea of some “self” as an inner observer; rather, the self is the product or construction of a narrative which emerges over time. Dennett is also well known for rejecting the very assumption that there is a clear line to be drawn between conscious and unconscious mental states in terms of the problematic notion of “qualia.” He influentially rejects strong emphasis on any phenomenological or first-person approach to investigating consciousness, advocating instead what he calls “heterophenomenology” according to which we should follow a more neutral path “leading from objective physical science and its insistence on the third person point of view, to a method of phenomenological description that can (in principle) do justice to the most private and ineffable subjective experiences.” (1991: 72)

Bernard Baars’ Global Workspace Theory (GWT) model of consciousness is probably the most influential theory proposed among psychologists (Baars 1988, 1997). The basic idea and metaphor is that we should think of the entire cognitive system as built on a “blackboard architecture” which is a kind of global workspace. According to GWT, unconscious processes and mental states compete for the spotlight of attention, from which information is “broadcast globally” throughout the system. Consciousness consists in such global broadcasting and is therefore also, according to Baars, an important functional and biological adaptation. We might say that consciousness is thus created by a kind of global access to select bits of information in the brain and nervous system. Despite Baars’ frequent use of “theater” and “spotlight” metaphors, he argues that his view does not entail the presence of the material Cartesian theater that Dennett is so concerned to avoid. It is, in any case, an empirical matter just how the brain performs the functions he describes, such as detecting mechanisms of attention.

Objections to these cognitive theories include the charge that they do not really address the hard problem of consciousness (as described in section 3b.i), but only the “easy” problems. Dennett is also often accused of explaining away consciousness rather than really explaining it. It is also interesting to think about Baars’ GWT in light of the Block’s distinction between access and phenomenal consciousness (see section 1). Does Baars’ theory only address access consciousness instead of the more difficult to explain phenomenal consciousness? (Two other psychological cognitive theories worth noting are the ones proposed by George Mandler 1975 and Tim Shallice 1988.)

d. Quantum Approaches

Finally, there are those who look deep beneath the neural level to the field of quantum mechanics, basically the study of sub-atomic particles, to find the key to unlocking the mysteries of consciousness. The bizarre world of quantum physics is quite different from the deterministic world of classical physics, and a major area of research in its own right. Such authors place the locus of consciousness at a very fundamental physical level. This somewhat radical, though exciting, option is explored most notably by physicist Roger Penrose (1989, 1994) and anesthesiologist Stuart Hameroff (1998). The basic idea is that consciousness arises through quantum effects which occur in subcellular neural structures known as microtubules, which are structural proteins in cell walls. There are also other quantum approaches which aim to explain the coherence of consciousness (Marshall and Zohar 1990) or use the “holistic” nature of quantum mechanics to explain consciousness (Silberstein 1998, 2001). It is difficult to assess these somewhat exotic approaches at present. Given the puzzling and often very counterintuitive nature of quantum physics, it is unclear whether such approaches will prove genuinely scientifically valuable methods in explaining consciousness. One concern is simply that these authors are trying to explain one puzzling phenomenon (consciousness) in terms of another mysterious natural phenomenon (quantum effects). Thus, the thinking seems to go, perhaps the two are essentially related somehow and other physicalistic accounts are looking in the wrong place, such as at the neuro-chemical level. Although many attempts to explain consciousness often rely of conjecture or speculation, quantum approaches may indeed lead the field along these lines. Of course, this doesn’t mean that some such theory isn’t correct. One exciting aspect of this approach is the resulting interdisciplinary interest it has generated among physicists and other scientists in the problem of consciousness.

5. Consciousness and Science: Key Issues

Over the past two decades there has been an explosion of interdisciplinary work in the science of consciousness. Some of the credit must go to the ground breaking 1986 book by Patricia Churchland entitled Neurophilosophy. In this section, three of the most important such areas are addressed.

a. The Unity of Consciousness/The Binding Problem

Conscious experience seems to be “unified” in an important sense; this crucial feature of consciousness played an important role in the philosophy of Kant who argued that unified conscious experience must be the product of the (presupposed) synthesizing work of the mind. Getting clear about exactly what is meant by the “unity of consciousness” and explaining how the brain achieves such unity has become a central topic in the study of consciousness. There are many different senses of “unity” (see Tye 2003; Bayne and Chalmers 2003, Dainton 2000, 2008, Bayne 2010), but perhaps most common is the notion that, from the first-person point of view, we experience the world in an integrated way and as a single phenomenal field of experience. (For an important anthology on the subject, see Cleeremans 2003.) However, when one looks at how the brain processes information, one only sees discrete regions of the cortex processing separate aspects of perceptual objects. Even different aspects of the same object, such as its color and shape, are processed in different parts of the brain. Given that there is no “Cartesian theater” in the brain where all this information comes together, the problem arises as to just how the resulting conscious experience is unified. What mechanisms allow us to experience the world in such a unified way? What happens when this unity breaks down, as in various pathological cases? The “problem of integrating the information processed by different regions of the brain is known as the binding problem” (Cleeremans 2003: 1). Thus, the so-called “binding problem” is inextricably linked to explaining the unity of consciousness. As was seen earlier with neural theories (section 4a) and as will be seen below on the neural correlates of consciousness (5b), some attempts to solve the binding problem have to do with trying to isolate the precise brain mechanisms responsible for consciousness. For example, Crick and Koch’s (1990) idea that synchronous neural firings are (at least) necessary for consciousness can also be viewed as an attempt to explain how disparate neural networks bind together separate pieces of information to produce unified subjective conscious experience. Perhaps the binding problem and the hard problem of consciousness (section 3b.i) are very closely connected. If the binding problem can be solved, then we arguably have identified the elusive neural correlate of consciousness and have, therefore, perhaps even solved the hard problem. In addition, perhaps the explanatory gap between third-person scientific knowledge and first-person unified conscious experience can also be bridged. Thus, this exciting area of inquiry is central to some of the deepest questions in the philosophical and scientific exploration of consciousness.

b. The Neural Correlates of Consciousness (NCCs)

As was seen earlier in discussing neural theories of consciousness (section 4a), the search for the so-called “neural correlates of consciousness” (NCCs) is a major preoccupation of philosophers and scientists alike (Metzinger 2000). Narrowing down the precise brain property responsible for consciousness is a different and far more difficult enterprise than merely holding a generic belief in some form of materialism. One leading candidate is offered by Francis Crick and Christof Koch 1990 (see also Crick 1994, Koch 2004). The basic idea is that mental states become conscious when large numbers of neurons all fire in synchrony with one another (oscillations within the 35-75 hertz range or 35-75 cycles per second). Currently, one method used is simply to study some aspect of neural functioning with sophisticated detecting equipments (such as MRIs and PET scans) and then correlate it with first-person reports of conscious experience. Another method is to study the difference in brain activity between those under anesthesia and those not under any such influence. A detailed survey would be impossible to give here, but a number of other candidates for the NCC have emerged over the past two decades, including reentrant cortical feedback loops in the neural circuitry throughout the brain (Edelman 1989, Edelman and Tononi 2000), NMDA-mediated transient neural assemblies (Flohr 1995), and emotive somatosensory haemostatic processes in the frontal lobe (Damasio 1999). To elaborate briefly on Flohr’s theory, the idea is that anesthetics destroy conscious mental activity because they interfere with the functioning of NMDA synapses between neurons, which are those that are dependent on N-methyl-D-aspartate receptors. These and other NCCs are explored at length in Metzinger (2000). Ongoing scientific investigation is significant and an important aspect of current scientific research in the field.

One problem with some of the above candidates is determining exactly how they are related to consciousness. For example, although a case can be made that some of them are necessary for conscious mentality, it is unclear that they are sufficient. That is, some of the above seem to occur unconsciously as well. And pinning down a narrow enough necessary condition is not as easy as it might seem. Another general worry is with the very use of the term “correlate.” As any philosopher, scientist, and even undergraduate student should know, saying that “A is correlated with B” is rather weak (though it is an important first step), especially if one wishes to establish the stronger identity claim between consciousness and neural activity. Even if such a correlation can be established, we cannot automatically conclude that there is an identity relation. Perhaps A causes B or B causes A, and that’s why we find the correlation. Even most dualists can accept such interpretations. Maybe there is some other neural process C which causes both A and B. “Correlation” is not even the same as “cause,” let alone enough to establish “identity.” Finally, some NCCs are not even necessarily put forth as candidates for all conscious states, but rather for certain specific kinds of consciousness (e.g., visual).

c. Philosophical Psychopathology

Philosophers have long been intrigued by disorders of the mind and consciousness. Part of the interest is presumably that if we can understand how consciousness goes wrong, then that can help us to theorize about the normal functioning mind. Going back at least as far as John Locke (1689/1975), there has been some discussion about the philosophical implications of multiple personality disorder (MPD) which is now called “dissociative identity disorder” (DID). Questions abound: Could there be two centers of consciousness in one body? What makes a person the same person over time? What makes a person a person at any given time? These questions are closely linked to the traditional philosophical problem of personal identity, which is also importantly related to some aspects of consciousness research. Much the same can be said for memory disorders, such as various forms of amnesia (see Gennaro 1996a, chapter 9). Does consciousness require some kind of autobiographical memory or psychological continuity? On a related front, there is significant interest in experimental results from patients who have undergone a commisurotomy, which is usually performed to relieve symptoms of severe epilepsy when all else fails. During this procedure, the nerve fibers connecting the two brain hemispheres are cut, resulting in so-called “split-brain” patients (Bayne 2010).

Philosophical interest is so high that there is now a book series called Philosophical Psychopathology published by MIT Press. Another rich source of information comes from the provocative and accessible writings of neurologists on a whole host of psychopathologies, most notably Oliver Sacks (starting with his 1987 book) and, more recently, V. S. Ramachandran (2004; see also Ramachandran and Blakeslee 1998). Another launching point came from the discovery of the phenomenon known as “blindsight” (Weiskrantz 1986), which is very frequently discussed in the philosophical literature regarding its implications for consciousness. Blindsight patients are blind in a well defined part of the visual field (due to cortical damage), but yet, when forced, can guess, with a higher than expected degree of accuracy, the location or orientation of an object in the blind field.

There is also philosophical interest in many other disorders, such as phantom limb pain (where one feels pain in a missing or amputated limb), various agnosias (such as visual agnosia where one is not capable of visually recognizing everyday objects), and anosognosia (which is denial of illness, such as when one claims that a paralyzed limb is still functioning, or when one denies that one is blind). These phenomena raise a number of important philosophical questions and have forced philosophers to rethink some very basic assumptions about the nature of mind and consciousness. Much has also recently been learned about autism and various forms of schizophrenia. A common view is that these disorders involve some kind of deficit in self-consciousness or in one’s ability to use certain self-concepts. (For a nice review article, see Graham 2002.) Synesthesia is also a fascinating abnormal phenomenon, although not really a “pathological” condition as such (Cytowic 2003). Those with synesthesia literally have taste sensations when seeing certain shapes or have color sensations when hearing certain sounds. It is thus an often bizarre mixing of incoming sensory input via different modalities.

One of the exciting results of this relatively new sub-field is the important interdisciplinary interest that it has generated among philosophers, psychologists, and scientists (such as in Graham 2010, Hirstein 2005, and Radden 2004).

6. Animal and Machine Consciousness

Two final areas of interest involve animal and machine consciousness. In the former case it is clear that we have come a long way from the Cartesian view that animals are mere “automata” and that they do not even have conscious experience (perhaps partly because they do not have immortal souls). In addition to the obviously significant behavioral similarities between humans and many animals, much more is known today about other physiological similarities, such as brain and DNA structures. To be sure, there are important differences as well and there are, no doubt, some genuinely difficult “grey areas” where one might have legitimate doubts about some animal or organism consciousness, such as small rodents, some birds and fish, and especially various insects. Nonetheless, it seems fair to say that most philosophers today readily accept the fact that a significant portion of the animal kingdom is capable of having conscious mental states, though there are still notable exceptions to that rule (Carruthers 2000, 2005). Of course, this is not to say that various animals can have all of the same kinds of sophisticated conscious states enjoyed by human beings, such as reflecting on philosophical and mathematical problems, enjoying artworks, thinking about the vast universe or the distant past, and so on. However, it still seems reasonable to believe that animals can have at least some conscious states from rudimentary pains to various perceptual states and perhaps even to some level of self-consciousness. A number of key areas are under continuing investigation. For example, to what extent can animals recognize themselves, such as in a mirror, in order to demonstrate some level of self-awareness? To what extent can animals deceive or empathize with other animals, either of which would indicate awareness of the minds of others? These and other important questions are at the center of much current theorizing about animal cognition. (See Keenan et. al. 2003 and Beckoff et. al. 2002.) In some ways, the problem of knowing about animal minds is an interesting sub-area of the traditional epistemological “problem of other minds”: How do we even know that other humans have conscious minds? What justifies such a belief?

The possibility of machine (or robot) consciousness has intrigued philosophers and non-philosophers alike for decades. Could a machine really think or be conscious? Could a robot really subjectively experience the smelling of a rose or the feeling of pain? One important early launching point was a well-known paper by the mathematician Alan Turing (1950) which proposed what has come to be known as the “Turing test” for machine intelligence and thought (and perhaps consciousness as well). The basic idea is that if a machine could fool an interrogator (who could not see the machine) into thinking that it was human, then we should say it thinks or, at least, has intelligence. However, Turing was probably overly optimistic about whether anything even today can pass the Turing Test, as most programs are specialized and have very narrow uses. One cannot ask the machine about virtually anything, as Turing had envisioned. Moreover, even if a machine or robot could pass the Turing Test, many remain very skeptical as to whether or not this demonstrates genuine machine thinking, let alone consciousness. For one thing, many philosophers would not take such purely behavioral (e.g., linguistic) evidence to support the conclusion that machines are capable of having phenomenal first person experiences. Merely using words like “red” doesn’t ensure that there is the corresponding sensation of red or real grasp of the meaning of “red.” Turing himself considered numerous objections and offered his own replies, many of which are still debated today.

Another much discussed argument is John Searle’s (1980) famous Chinese Room Argument, which has spawned an enormous amount of literature since its original publication (see also Searle 1984; Preston and Bishop 2002). Searle is concerned to reject what he calls “strong AI” which is the view that suitably programmed computers literally have a mind, that is, they really understand language and actually have other mental capacities similar to humans. This is contrasted with “weak AI” which is the view that computers are merely useful tools for studying the mind. The gist of Searle’s argument is that he imagines himself running a program for using Chinese and then shows that he does not understand Chinese; therefore, strong AI is false; that is, running the program does not result in any real understanding (or thought or consciousness, by implication). Searle supports his argument against strong AI by utilizing a thought experiment whereby he is in a room and follows English instructions for manipulating Chinese symbols in order to produce appropriate answers to questions in Chinese. Searle argues that, despite the appearance of understanding Chinese (say, from outside the room), he does not understand Chinese at all. He does not thereby know Chinese, but is merely manipulating symbols on the basis of syntax alone. Since this is what computers do, no computer, merely by following a program, genuinely understands anything. Searle replies to numerous possible criticisms in his original paper (which also comes with extensive peer commentary), but suffice it to say that not everyone is satisfied with his responses. For example, it might be argued that the entire room or “system” understands Chinese if we are forced to use Searle’s analogy and thought experiment. Each part of the room doesn’t understand Chinese (including Searle himself) but the entire system does, which includes the instructions and so on. Searle’s larger argument, however, is that one cannot get semantics (meaning) from syntax (formal symbol manipulation).

Despite heavy criticism of the argument, two central issues are raised by Searle which continue to be of deep interest. First, how and when does one distinguish mere “simulation” of some mental activity from genuine “duplication”? Searle’s view is that computers are, at best, merely simulating understanding and thought, not really duplicating it. Much like we might say that a computerized hurricane simulation does not duplicate a real hurricane, Searle insists the same goes for any alleged computer “mental” activity. We do after all distinguish between real diamonds or leather and mere simulations which are just not the real thing. Second, and perhaps even more important, when considering just why computers really can’t think or be conscious, Searle interestingly reverts back to a biologically based argument. In essence, he says that computers or robots are just not made of the right stuff with the right kind of “causal powers” to produce genuine thought or consciousness. After all, even a materialist does not have to allow that any kind of physical stuff can produce consciousness any more than any type of physical substance can, say, conduct electricity. Of course, this raises a whole host of other questions which go to the heart of the metaphysics of consciousness. To what extent must an organism or system be physiologically like us in order to be conscious? Why is having a certain biological or chemical make up necessary for consciousness? Why exactly couldn’t an appropriately built robot be capable of having conscious mental states? How could we even know either way? However one answers these questions, it seems that building a truly conscious Commander Data is, at best, still just science fiction.

In any case, the growing areas of cognitive science and artificial intelligence are major fields within philosophy of mind and can importantly bear on philosophical questions of consciousness. Much of current research focuses on how to program a computer to model the workings of the human brain, such as with so-called “neural (or connectionist) networks.”

7. References and Further Reading

• Alter, T. and S.Walter, eds. Phenomenal Concepts and Phenomenal Knowledge: New Essays on Consciousness and Physicalism.  New York: Oxford University Press, 2007.
• Armstrong, D. A Materialist Theory of Mind. London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1968.
• Armstrong, D. “What is Consciousness?” In The Nature of Mind. Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1981.
• Baars, B. A Cognitive Theory of Consciousness. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1988.
• Baars, B. In The Theater of Consciousness. New York: Oxford University Press, 1997.
• Baars, B., Banks, W., and Newman, J. eds. Essential Sources in the Scientific Study of Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 2003.
• Balog, K. “Conceivability, Possibility, and the Mind-Body Problem.” In Philosophical Review 108: 497-528, 1999.
• Bayne, T. & Chalmers, D. “What is the Unity of Consciousness?” In Cleeremans, 2003.
• Bayne, T. The Unity of Consciousness. New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.
• Beckoff, M., Allen, C., and Burghardt, G. The Cognitive Animal: Empirical and Theoretical Perspectives on Animal Cognition. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 2002.
• Blackmore, S. Consciousness: An Introduction. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2004.
• Block, N. “Troubles with Functionalism.” In Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Volume 1, Ned Block, ed., Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1980a.
• Block, N. “Are Absent Qualia Impossible?” Philosophical Review 89: 257-74, 1980b.
• Block, N. “Inverted Earth.” In Philosophical Perspectives, 4, J. Tomberlin, ed., Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview Publishing Company, 1990.
• Block, N. “On a Confusion about the Function of Consciousness.” In Behavioral and Brain Sciences 18: 227-47, 1995.
• Block, N. “Mental Paint and Mental Latex.” In E. Villanueva, ed. Perception. Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview, 1996.
• Block, N. “The higher order approach to consciousness is defunct.” Analysis 71: 419-431, 2011.
• Block, N, Flanagan, O. & Guzeledere, G. eds. The Nature of Consciousness. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1997.
• Block, N. & Stalnaker, R. “Conceptual Analysis, Dualism, and the Explanatory Gap.” Philosophical Review 108: 1-46, 1999.
• Botterell, A. “Conceiving what is not there.” In Journal of Consciousness Studies 8 (8): 21-42, 2001.
• Boyd, R. “Materialism without Reductionism: What Physicalism does not entail.” In N. Block, ed. Readings in the Philosophy of Psychology, Vol.1. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1980.
• Brentano, F. Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint. New York: Humanities, 1874/1973.
• Brook, A. Kant and the Mind. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1994.
• Brook, A. & Raymont, P. 2006. A Unified Theory of Consciousness. Forthcoming.
• Byrne, A. “Some like it HOT: Consciousness and Higher-Order Thoughts.” In Philosophical Studies 86:103-29, 1997.
• Byrne, A. “Intentionalism Defended.” In Philosophical Review 110: 199-240, 2001.
• Byrne, A. “What Phenomenal Consciousness is like.” In Gennaro 2004a.
• Campbell, N. A Brief Introduction to the Philosophy of Mind. Ontario: Broadview, 2004.
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Author Information

Rocco J. Gennaro
Email: rjgennaro@usi.edu
University of Southern Indiana
U. S. A.

The Hard Problem of Consciousness

The hard problem of consciousness is the problem of explaining why any physical state is conscious rather than nonconscious.  It is the problem of explaining why there is “something it is like” for a subject in conscious experience, why conscious mental states “light up” and directly appear to the subject.  The usual methods of science involve explanation of functional, dynamical, and structural properties—explanation of what a thing does, how it changes over time, and how it is put together.  But even after we have explained the functional, dynamical, and structural properties of the conscious mind, we can still meaningfully ask the question, Why is it conscious? This suggests that an explanation of consciousness will have to go beyond the usual methods of science.  Consciousness therefore presents a hard problem for science, or perhaps it marks the limits of what science can explain.  Explaining why consciousness occurs at all can be contrasted with so-called “easy problems” of consciousness:  the problems of explaining the function, dynamics, and structure of consciousness.  These features can be explained using the usual methods of science.  But that leaves the question of why there is something it is like for the subject when these functions, dynamics, and structures are present.  This is the hard problem.

In more detail, the challenge arises because it does not seem that the qualitative and subjective aspects of conscious experience—how consciousness “feels” and the fact that it is directly “for me”—fit into a physicalist ontology, one consisting of just the basic elements of physics plus structural, dynamical, and functional combinations of those basic elements.  It appears that even a complete specification of a creature in physical terms leaves unanswered the question of whether or not the creature is conscious.  And it seems that we can easily conceive of creatures just like us physically and functionally that nonetheless lack consciousness.  This indicates that a physical explanation of consciousness is fundamentally incomplete:  it leaves out what it is like to be the subject, for the subject.  There seems to be an unbridgeable explanatory gap between the physical world and consciousness.  All these factors make the hard problem hard.

The hard problem was so-named by David Chalmers in 1995.  The problem is a major focus of research in contemporary philosophy of mind, and there is a considerable body of empirical research in psychology, neuroscience, and even quantum physics.  The problem touches on issues in ontology, on the nature and limits of scientific explanation, and on the accuracy and scope of introspection and first-person knowledge, to name but a few.  Reactions to the hard problem range from an outright denial of the issue  to naturalistic reduction to panpsychism (the claim that everything is conscious to some degree) to full-blown mind-body dualism.

Table of Contents

1. Stating the Problem
   1. Chalmers
   2. Nagel
   3. Levine
2. Underlying Reasons for the Problem
3. Responses to the Problem
   1. Eliminativism
   2. Strong Reductionism
   3. Weak Reductionism
   4. Mysterianism
   5. Interactionist Dualism
   6. Epiphenomenalism
   7. Dual Aspect Theory/Neutral Monism/Panpsychism
4. References and Further Reading

1. Stating the Problem

a. Chalmers

David Chalmers coined the name “hard problem” (1995, 1996), but the problem is not wholly new, being a key element of the venerable mind-body problem.  Still, Chalmers is among those most responsible for the outpouring of work on this issue.  The problem arises because “phenomenal consciousness,” consciousness characterized in terms of “what it’s like for the subject,” fails to succumb to the standard sort of functional explanation successful elsewhere in psychology (compare Block 1995).   Psychological phenomena like learning, reasoning, and remembering can all be explained in terms of playing the right “functional role.”  If a system does the right thing, if it alters behavior appropriately in response to environmental stimulation, it counts as learning.  Specifying these functions tells us what learning is and allows us to see how brain processes could play this role.  But according to Chalmers,

What makes the hard problem hard and almost unique is that it goes beyond problems about the performance of functions. To see this, note that even when we have explained the performance of all the cognitive and behavioral functions in the vicinity of experience—perceptual discrimination, categorization, internal access, verbal report—there may still remain a further unanswered question:  Why is the performance of these functions accompanied by experience? (1995, 202, emphasis in original).

Chalmers explains the persistence of this question by arguing against the possibility of a “reductive explanation” for phenomenal consciousness (hereafter, I will generally just use the term ‘consciousness’ for the phenomenon causing the problem).  A reductive explanation in Chalmers’s sense (following David Lewis (1972)), provides a form of deductive argument concluding with an identity statement between the target explanandum (the thing we are trying to explain) and a lower-level phenomenon that is physical in nature or more obviously reducible to the physical.  Reductive explanations of this type have two premises.  The first presents a functional analysis of the target phenomenon, which fully characterizes the target in terms of its functional role.  The second presents an empirically-discovered realizer of the functionally characterized target, one playing that very functional role.  Then, by transitivity of identity, the target and realizer are deduced to be identical.  For example, the gene may be reductively explained in terms of DNA as follows:

1. The gene = the unit of hereditary transmission.  (By analysis.)
2. Regions of DNA = the unit of hereditary transmission.  (By empirical investigation.)
3. Therefore, the gene = regions of DNA. (By transitivity of identity, 1, 2.)

Chalmers contends that such reductive explanations are available in principle for all other natural phenomena, but not for consciousness.  This is the hard problem.

The reason that reductive explanation fails for consciousness, according to Chalmers, is that it cannot be functionally analyzed.  This is demonstrated by the continued conceivability of what Chalmers terms “zombies”—creatures physically (and so functionally) identical to us, but lacking consciousness—even in the face of a range of proffered functional analyses.  If we had a satisfying functional analysis of consciousness, zombies should not be conceivable.  The lack of a functional analysis is also shown by the continued conceivability of spectrum inversion (perhaps what it looks like for me to see green is what it looks like when you see red), the persistence of the “other minds” problem, the plausibility of the “knowledge argument” (Jackson 1982) and the manifest implausibility of offered functional characterizations.  If consciousness really could be functionally characterized, these problems would disappear.  Since they retain their grip on philosophers, scientists, and lay-people alike, we can conclude that no functional characterization is available.  But then the first premise of a reductive explanation cannot be properly formulated, and reductive explanation fails.  We are left, Chalmers claims, with the following stark choice:  either eliminate consciousness (deny that it exists at all) or add consciousness to our ontology as an unreduced feature of reality, on par with gravity and electromagnetism.  Either way, we are faced with a special ontological problem, one that resists solution by the usual reductive methods.

b. Nagel

Thomas Nagel sees the problem as turning on the “subjectivity” of conscious mental states (1974, 1986).  He argues that the facts about conscious states are inherently subjective—they can only be fully grasped from limited types of viewpoints.  However, scientific explanation demands an objective characterization of the facts, one that moves away from any particular point of view.  Thus, the facts about consciousness elude science and so make “the mind-body problem really intractable” (Nagel 1974, 435).

Nagel argues for the inherent subjectivity of the facts about consciousness by reflecting on the question of what it is like to be a bat—for the bat.  It seems that no amount of objective data will provide us with this knowledge, given that we do not share its type of point of view (the point of view of a creature able to fly and echolocate).  Learning all we can about the brain mechanisms, biochemistry, evolutionary history, psychophysics, and so forth, of a bat still leaves us unable to discover (or even imagine) what it’s like for the bat to hunt by echolocation on a dark night.  But it is still plausible that there are facts about what it’s like to be a bat, facts about how things seem from the bat’s perspective.  And even though we may have good reason to believe that consciousness is a physical phenomenon (due to considerations of mental causation, the success of materialist science, and so on), we are left in the dark about the bat’s conscious experience.  This is the hard problem of consciousness.

c. Levine

Joseph Levine argues that there is a special “explanatory gap” between consciousness and the physical (1983, 1993, 2001).  The challenge of closing this explanatory gap is the hard problem.  Levine argues that a good scientific explanation ought to deductively entail what it explains, allowing us to infer the presence of the target phenomenon from a statement of laws or mechanisms and initial conditions (Levine 2001, 74-76).  Deductive entailment is a logical relation where if the premises of an argument are true, the conclusion must be true as well.  For example, once we discover that lightning is nothing more than an electrical discharge, knowing that the proper conditions for a relevantly large electrical discharge existed in the atmosphere at time t allows us to deduce that lightning must have occurred at time t.  If such a deduction is not possible, there are three possible reasons, according to Levine.  One is that we have not fully specified the laws or mechanisms cited in our explanation.  Two is that the target phenomenon is stochastic in nature, and the best that can be inferred is a conclusion about the probability of the occurrence of the explanatory target.  The third is that there are as yet unknown factors at least partially involved in determining the phenomenon in question.  If we have adequately specified the laws and mechanisms in question, and if we have adjusted for stochastic phenomena, then we should possess a deductive conclusion about our explanatory target, or the third possibility is in effect.  But the third possibility is “precisely an admission that we don’t have an adequate explanation” (2001, 76).

And this is the case with consciousness, according to Levine.  No matter how detailed our specification of brain mechanisms or physical laws, it seems that there is an open question about whether consciousness is present.  We can still meaningfully ask if consciousness occurred, even if we accept that the laws, mechanisms, and proper conditions are in place.  And it seems that any further information of this type that we add to our explanation will still suffer from the same problem.  Thus, there is an explanatory gap between the physical and consciousness, leaving us with the hard problem.

2. Underlying Reasons for the Problem

But what it is about consciousness that generates the hard problem?  It may just seem obvious that consciousness could not be physical or functional.  But it is worthwhile to try and draw a rough circle around the problematic features of conscious experience, if we can.  This both clarifies what we are talking about when we talk about consciousness and helps isolate the data a successful theory must explain.

Uriah Kriegel (2009; see also Levine 2001) offers a helpful conceptual division of consciousness into two components.  Starting with the standard understanding of conscious states as states there is something it’s like for the organism to be in, Kriegel notes that we can either focus on the fact that something appears for the organism or we can focus on what it is that appears, the something it’s like.  Focusing on the former, we find that subjects are aware of their conscious states in a distinctive way.  Kriegel labels this feature the subjective component of consciousness.    Focusing on the latter we find the experienced character of consciousness—the “redness of red” or the painfulness of pain— often termed “qualia” or “phenomenal character” in the literature (compare Crane 2000).  Kriegel labels this the qualitative component of consciousness.

Subdividing consciousness in this way allows us to concentrate on how we are conscious and what we are conscious of.  When we focus on the subjective “how” component, we find that conscious states are presented to the subject in a seemingly immediate way.  And when we focus on the qualitative “what” component, we find that consciousness presents us with seemingly indescribable qualities which in principle can vary independently of mental functioning.  These features help explain why consciousness generates the hard problem.

The first feature, which we can call immediacy, concerns the way we access consciousness from the first-person perspective.  Conscious states are accessed in a seemingly unmediated way.  It appears that nothing comes between us and our conscious states.  We seem to access them simply by having them—we do not infer their presence by way of any evidence or argument.  This immediacy creates the impression that there is no way we could be wrong about the content of our conscious states.  Error in perception or error in reasoning can be traced back to poor perceptual conditions or to a failure of rational inference.  But in the absence of such accessible sources of error, it seems that there is no room for inaccuracy in the introspective case.  And even if we come to believe we are in error in introspection, the evidence for this will be indirect and third-personal—it will lack the subjective force of immediacy.  Thus, there is an intuition of special accuracy or even infallibility when it comes to knowing our own conscious states.  We might be wrong that an object in the world is really red, but can we be wrong that it seems red to us?  But if we cannot be wrong about how things seem to us and conscious states seem inexplicable, then they really are inexplicable.  In this way, the immediacy of the subjective component of consciousness underwrites the hard problem.

But what we access may be even more problematic than how we access it:  we might, after all, have had immediate access to the physical nature of our conscious states (see P.M. Churchland 1985).  But conscious experience instead reveals various sensory qualities—the redness of the visual experience of an apple or the painfulness of a stubbed toe, for example.  But these qualities seem to defy informative description.  If one has not experienced them, then no amount of description will adequately convey what it’s like to have such an experience with these qualities.  We can call this feature of the qualitative component of consciousness indescribability. If someone has never seen red (a congenitally blind person, for example), it seems there is nothing informative we could say to convey to them the true nature of this quality.  We might mention prototypical red objects or explain that red is more similar to purple than it is to green, but such descriptions seem to leave the quality itself untouched.  And if experienced qualities cannot be informatively described, how could they be adequately captured in an explanatory theory?  It seems that by their very nature, conscious qualities defy explanation.  This difficulty lies at the heart of the hard problem.

A further problematic feature of what we access is that we can easily imagine our conscious mental processes occurring in conjunction with different conscious qualities or in the absence of consciousness altogether.  The particular qualities that accompany specific mental operations—like the reddish quality accompanying our detection and categorization of an apple, say—seem only contingently connected to the functional processes involved in detection and categorization.  We can call this feature of what is accessed independence.  Independence is the apparent lack of connection between conscious qualities and anything else, and it underwrites the inverted and absent qualia thought experiments used by Chalmers to establish the hard problem (compare Block 1980).  If conscious qualities really are independent in this way, then there seems to be no way to effectively tie them to the rest of reality.

The challenge of the hard problem, then, is to explain consciousness given that it seems to give us immediate access to indescribable and independent qualities.  If we can explain these underlying features, then we may see how to fit consciousness into a physicalist ontology.  Or it perhaps taking these features seriously motivates a rejection of physicalism and the acceptance of conscious qualities as fundamental features of our ontology.  The following section briefly surveys the range of responses to the hard problem, from eliminativism and reductionism to panpsychism and full-blown dualism.

3. Responses to the Problem

a. Eliminativism

Eliminativism holds that there is no hard problem of consciousness because there is no consciousness to worry about in the first place.  Eliminativism is most clearly defended by Rey 1997, but see also Dennett 1978, 1988, Wilkes 1984, and Ryle 1949.  On the face of it, this response sounds absurd:  how can one deny that conscious experience exists?  Consciousness might be the one thing that is certain in our epistemology.  But eliminativist views resist the idea that what we call experience is equivalent to consciousness, at least in the phenomenal, “what it’s like” sense.  They hold that consciousness so-conceived is a philosopher’s construction, one that can be rejected without absurdity.  If it is definitional of consciousness that it is nonfunctional, then holding that the mind is fully functional amounts to a denial of consciousness.  Alternately, if qualia are construed as nonrelational, intrinsic qualities of experience, then one might deny that qualia exist (Dennett 1988).  And if qualia are essential to consciousness, this, too, amounts to an eliminativism about consciousness.

What might justify consciousness eliminativism?  First, the very notion of consciousness, upon close examination, may not have well-defined conditions of application—there may be no single phenomenon that the term picks out (Wilkes 1984).  Or the term may serve no use at all in any scientific theory, and so may drop out of a scientifically-fixed ontology (Rey 1997).  If science tells us what there is (as some naturalists hold), and science has no place for nonfunctional intrinsic qualities, then there is no consciousness, so defined.  Finally, it might be that the term ‘consciousness’ gets its meaning as part of a falsifiable theory, our folk psychology. The entities posited by a theory stand or fall with the success of the theory.  If the theory is falsified, then the entities it posits do not exist (compare P.M. Churchland 1981).  And there is no guarantee that folk psychology will not be supplanted by a better theory of the mind, perhaps a neuroscientific or even quantum mechanical theory, at some point.  Thus, consciousness might be eliminated from our ontology.  If that occurs, obviously there is no hard problem to worry about.  No consciousness, no problem!

But eliminativism seems much too strong a reaction to the hard problem, one that throws the baby out with the bathwater.  First, it is highly counterintuitive to deny that consciousness exists.  It seems extremely basic to our conception of minds and persons.  A more desirable view would avoid this move.  Second, it is not clear why we must accept that consciousness, by definition, is nonfunctional or intrinsic.  Definitional, “analytic” claims are highly controversial at best, particularly with difficult terms like ‘consciousness’ (compare Quine 1951, Wittgenstein 1953).  A better solution would hold that consciousness still exists, but it is functional and relational in nature.  This is the strong reductionist approach.

b. Strong Reductionism

Strong reductionism holds that consciousness exists, but contends that it is reducible to tractable functional, nonintrinsic properties.  Strong reductionism further claims that the reductive story we tell about consciousness fully explains, without remainder, all that needs to be explained about consciousness.  Reductionism, generally, is the idea that complex phenomena can be explained in terms of the arrangement and functioning of simpler, better understood parts.  Key to strong reductionism, then, is the idea that consciousness can be broken down and explained in terms of simpler things.  This amounts to a rejection of the idea that experience is simple and basic, that it stands as a kind of epistemic or metaphysical “ground floor.”  Strong reductionists must hold that consciousness is not as it prima facie appears, that it only seems to be marked by immediacy, indescribability, and independence and therefore that it only seems nonfunctional and intrinsic.  Consciousness, according to strong reductionism, can be fully analyzed and explained in functional terms, even if it does not seem that way.

A number of prominent strongly reductive theories exist in the literature.  Functionalist approaches hold that consciousness is nothing more than a functional process.  A popular version of this view is the “global workspace” hypothesis, which holds that conscious states are mental states available for processing by a wide range of cognitive systems (Baars 1988, 1997; Dehaene & Naccache 2001).  They are available in this way by being present in a special network—the “global workspace.”  This workspace can be functionally characterized and it also can be given a neurological interpretation.  In answer to the question “why are these states conscious?” it can be replied that this is what it means to be conscious.  If a state is available to the mind in this way, it is a conscious state (see also Dennett 1991).  (For more neuroscientifically-focused versions of the functionalist approach, see P.S Churchland 1986; Crick 1994; and Koch 2004.)

Another set of views that can be broadly termed functionalist is “enactive” or “embodied” approaches (Hurley 1998, Noë 2005, 2009).  These views hold that mental processes should not be characterized in terms of strictly inner processes or representations.  Rather, they should be cashed out in terms of the dynamic processes connecting perception, bodily and environmental awareness, and behavior.  These processes, the views contend, do not strictly depend on processes inside the head; rather, they loop out into the body and the environment.  Further, the nature of consciousness is tied up with behavior and action—it cannot be isolated as a passive process of receiving and recording information.  These views are cataloged as functionalist because of the way they answer the hard problem:  these physical states (constituted in part by bodily and worldly things) are conscious because they play the right functional role, they do the right thing.

Another strongly reductive approach holds that conscious states are states representing the world in the appropriate way (Dretske 1995, Tye 1995, 2000).  This view, known as “first-order representationalism,” contends that conscious states make us aware of things in world by representing them.  Further, these representations are “nonconceptual” in nature:  they represent features even if the subject in question lacks the concepts needed to cognitively categorize those features.  But these nonconceptual representations must play the right functional role in order to be conscious.  They must be poised to influence the higher-level cognitive systems of a subject.  The details of these representations differ from theorist to theorist, but a common answer to the hard problem emerges.  First-order representational states are conscious because they do the right thing:  they make us aware of just the sorts of features that make up conscious experience, features like the redness of an apple, the sweetness of honey, or the shrillness of a trumpet.  Further, such representations are conscious because they are poised to play the right role in our understanding of the world—they serve as the initial layer of our epistemic contact  with reality, a layer we can then use as the basis of our more sophisticated beliefs and theories.

A further point serves to support the claims of first-order representationalism.  When we reflect on our experience in a focused way, we do not seem to find any distinctively mental properties.  Rather, we find the very things first-order representationalism claims we represent:  the basic sensory features of the world.  If I ask you to reflect closely on your experience of a tree, you do not find special mental qualities.  Rather, you find the tree, as it appears to you, as you represent it.  This consideration, known as “transparency,” seems to undermine the claim that we need to posit special intrinsic qualia, seemingly irreducible properties of our experiences (Harman 1990, though see Kind 2003).  Instead, we can explain all that we experience in terms of representation.  We have a red experience because we represent physical red in the right way.  It is then argued that representation can be given a reductive explanation.  Representation, even the sort of representation involved in experience, is no more than various functional/physical processes of our brains tracking the environment.  It follows that there is no further hard problem to deal with.

A third type of strongly reductive approach is higher-order representationalism (Armstrong 1968, 1981; Rosenthal 1986, 2005; Lycan 1987, 1996, 2001; Carruthers 2000, 2005).  This view starts with the question of what accounts for the difference between conscious and nonconscious mental states.  Higher-order theorists hold that an intuitive answer is that we are appropriately aware of our conscious states, while we are unaware of our nonconscious states.  The task of a theory of consciousness, then, is to explain the awareness accounting for this difference.  Higher-order representationalists contend that the awareness is a product of a specific sort of representation, a representation that picks out the subject’s own mental states.  These “higher-order” representations (representations of other representations) make the subject aware of her states, thus accounting for consciousness.  In answer to the hard problem, the higher-order theorist responds that these states are conscious because the subject is appropriately aware of them by way of higher-order representation.  The higher-order representations themselves are held to be nonconscious.  And since representation can plausibly be reduced to functional/physical processes, there is no lingering problem to explain (though see Gennaro 2005 for more on this strategy).

A final strongly reductive view, “self-representationalism,” holds that troubles with the higher-order view demand that we characterize the awareness subjects have of their conscious states as a kind of self-representation, where one complex representational state is about both the world and that very state itself (Gennaro 1996, Kriegel 2003, 2009, Van Gulick 2004, 2006, Williford 2006).  It may seem paradoxical to say that a state can represent itself, but this can dealt with by holding that the state represents itself in virtue of one part of the state representing another, and thereby coming to indirectly represent the whole.  Further, self-representationalism may provide the best explanation of the seemingly ubiquitous presence of self-awareness in conscious experience.  And, again, in answer to the question of why such states are conscious, the self-representationalist can respond that conscious states are ones the subject is aware of, and self-representationalism explains this awareness.  And since self-representation, properly construed, is reducible to functional/physical processes, we are left with a complete explanation of consciousness.  (For more details on how higher-order/self-representational views deal with the hard problem, see Gennaro 2012, chapter 4.)

However, there remains considerable resistance to strongly reductive views.  The main stumbling block is that they seem to leave unaddressed the pressing intuition that one can easily conceive of a system satisfying all the requirements of the strongly reductive views but still lacking consciousness (Chalmers 1996, chapter 3).  It is argued that an effective theory ought to close off such easy conceptions.  Further, strong reductivists seem committed to the claim that there is no knowledge of consciousness that cannot be grasped theoretically.  If a strongly reductive view is true, it seems that a blind person can gain full knowledge of color experience from a textbook.  But surely she still lacks some knowledge of what it’s like to see red, for example?  Strongly reductive theorists can contend that these recalcitrant intuitions are merely a product of lingering confused or erroneous views of consciousness.  But in the face of such worries, many have felt it better to find a way to respect these intuitions while still denying the potentially unpleasant ontological implications of the hard problem.  Hence, weak reductionism.

c. Weak Reductionism

Weak reductionism, in contrast to the strong version, holds that consciousness is a simple or basic phenomenon, one that cannot be informatively broken down into simpler nonconscious elements.  But according to the view we can still identify consciousness with physical properties if the most parsimonious and productive theory supports such an identity (Block 2002, Block & Stalnaker 1999, Hill 1997, Loar 1997, 1999, Papineau 1993, 2002, Perry 2001).  What’s more, once the identity has been established, there is no further burden of explanation.  Identities have no explanation:  a thing just is what it is.  To ask how it could be that Mark Twain is Sam Clemens, once we have the most parsimonious rendering of the facts, is to go beyond meaningful questioning.  And the same holds for the identity of conscious states with physical states.

But there remains the question of why the identity claim appears so counterintuitive and here weak reductionists generally appeal to the “phenomenal concepts strategy” (PCS) to make their case (compare Stoljar 2005).  The PCS holds that the hard problem is not the result of a dualism of facts, phenomenal and physical, but rather a dualism of concepts picking out fully physical conscious states.  One concept is the third-personal physical concept of neuroscience.  The other concept is a distinctively first-personal “phenomenal concept”—one that picks out conscious states in a subjectively direct manner.  Because of the subjective differences in these modes of conceptual access, consciousness does not seem intuitively to be physical.  But once we understand the differences in the two concepts, there is no need to accept this intuition.

Here is a sketch of how a weakly reductive view of consciousness might proceed.  First, we find stimuli that reliably trigger reports of phenomenally conscious states from subjects.  Then we find what neural processes are reliably correlated with those reported experiences.  It can then be argued on the basis of parsimony that the reported conscious state just is the neural state—an ontology holding that two states are present is less simple than one identifying the two states.  Further, accepting the identity is explanatorily fruitful, particularly with respect to mental causation.  Finally, the PCS is appealed to in order to explain why the identity remains counterintuitive.  And as to the question of why this particular neural state should be identical to this particular phenomenal state, the answer is that this is just the way things are.  Explanation bottoms out at this point and requests for further explanation are unreasonable.

But there are pressing worries about weak reductionism.  There seems to be an undischarged phenomenal element within the weakly reductive view (Chalmers 2006).  When we focus on the PCS, it seems that we lack a plausible story about how it is that phenomenal concepts reveal what it’s like for us in experience.  The direct access of phenomenal concepts seems to require that phenomenal states themselves inform us of what they are like. A common way to cash out the PCS is to say that the phenomenal properties themselves are embedded in the phenomenal concepts, and that alone makes them accessible in the seemingly rich manner of introspected experience.  When it is asked how phenomenal properties might underwrite this access, the answer given is that this is in the nature of phenomenal properties—that is just what they do.  Again, we are told that explanation must stop somewhere.  But at this point, it seems that there is little to distinguish that weak reductionist from the various forms of nonreductive and dualistic views cataloged below.  They, too, hold that it is in the nature of phenomenal properties to underwrite first-person access.  But they hold that there is no good reason to think that properties with this sort of nature are physical.  We know of no other physical property that possesses such a nature.  All that we are left with to recommend weak reductionism is a thin claim of parsimony and an overly-strong fealty to physicalism.  We are asked to accept a brute identity here, one that seems unprecedented in our ontology given that consciousness is a macro-level phenomenon.  Other examples of such brute identity—of electricity and magnetism into one force, say—occur at the foundational level of physics.  Neurological and phenomenal properties do not seem to be basic in this way.  We are left with phenomenal properties inexplicable in physical terms, “brutally” identified with neurological properties in a way that nothing else seems to be.  Why not take all this as an indication that phenomenal properties are not physical after all?

The weak reductionist can respond that the question of mental causation still provides a strong enough reason to hold onto physicalism.  A plausible scientific principal is that the physical world is causally closed:  all physical events have physical causes.  And since our bodies are physical, it seems that denying that consciousness is physical renders it epiphenomenal.  The apparent implausibility of epiphenomenalism may be enough to motivate adherence to weak reductionism, even with its explanatory short-comings.  Dualistic challenges to this claim will be discussed in later sections.

It is possible, however, to embrace weak reductionism and still acknowledge that some questions remain to be answered.  For example, it might be reasonable to demand some explanation of how particular neural states correlate with differences in conscious experience.  A weak reductionist might hold that this is a question we at present cannot answer.  It may be that one day we will be in a position to so, due to a radical shift in our understanding of consciousness or physical reality.  Or perhaps this will remain an unsolvable mystery, one beyond our limited abilities to decipher.  Still, there may be good reasons to hold at present that the most parsimonious metaphysical picture is the physicalist picture.  The line between weak reductionism and the next set of views to be considered, mysterianism, may blur considerably here.

d. Mysterianism

The mysterian response to the hard problem does not offer a solution; rather, it holds that the hard problem cannot be solved by current scientific method and perhaps cannot be solved by human beings at all.  There are two varieties of the view.  The more moderate version of the position, which can be termed “temporary mysterianism,” holds that given the current state of scientific knowledge, we have no explanation of why some physical states are conscious (Nagel 1974,  Levine 2001).  The gap between experience and the sorts of things dealt with in modern physics—functional, structural, and dynamical properties of basic fields and particles—is simply too wide to be bridged at present.  Still, it may be that some future conceptual revolution in the sciences will show how to close the gap.  Such massive conceptual reordering is certainly possible, given the history of science.  And, indeed, if one accepts the Kuhnian idea of shifts between incommensurate paradigms, it might seem unsurprising that we, pre-paradigm-shift, cannot grasp what things will be like after the revolution.  But at present we have no idea how the hard problem might be solved.

Thomas Nagel, in sketching his version of this idea, calls for a future “objective phenomenology” which will “describe, at least in part, the subjective character of experiences in a form comprehensible to beings incapable of having those experiences” (1974, 449).  Without such a new conceptual system, Nagel holds, we are left unable to bridge the gap between consciousness and the physical.  Consciousness may indeed be a physical, but we at present have no idea how this could be so.

It is of course open for both weak and strong reductionists to accept a version of temporary mysterianism.  They can agree that at present we do not know how consciousness fits into the physical world, but the possibility is open that future science will clear up the mystery.  The main difference between such claims by reductionists and by mysterians is that the mysterians reject the idea that current reductive proposals do anything at all to close the gap.  How different the explanatory structure must be to count as truly new and not merely an extension of the old is not possible to gauge with any precision.  So the difference between a very weak reductionist and a temporary, though optimistic mysterian may not amount to much.

The stronger version of the position, “permanent mysterianism,” argues that our ignorance in the face of the hard problem is not merely transitory, but is permanent, given our limited cognitive capacities (McGinn 1989, 1991).  We are like squirrels trying to understand quantum mechanics:  it just is not going to happen.  The main exponent of this view is Colin McGinn, who argues that a solution to the hard problem is “cognitively closed” to us.  He supports his position by stressing consequences of a modular view of the mind, inspired in part by Chomsky’s work in linguistics.  Our mind just may not be built to solve this sort of problem.  Instead, it may be composed of dedicated, domain-specific “modules” devoted to solving local, specific problems for an organism.  An organism without a dedicated “language acquisition device” equipped with “universal grammar” cannot acquire language.  Perhaps the hard problem requires cognitive apparatus we just do not possess as a species.  If that is the case, no further scientific or philosophical breakthrough will make a difference.  We are not built to solve the problem:  it is cognitively closed to us.

A worry about such a claim is that it is hard to establish just what sorts of problems are permanently beyond our ken.  It seems possible that the temporary mysterian may be correct here, and what looks unbridgeable in principle is really just a temporary roadblock.  Both the temporary and permanent mysterian agree on the evidence.  They agree that there is a real gap at present between consciousness and the physical and they agree that nothing in current science seems up to the task of solving the problem.  The further claim that we are forever blocked from solving the problem turns on controversial claims about the nature of the problem and the nature of our cognitive capacities.  Perhaps those controversial claims will be made good, but at present, it is hard to see why we should give up all hope, given the history of surprising scientific breakthroughs.

e. Interactionist Dualism

Perhaps, though, we know enough already to establish that consciousness is not a physical phenomenon.   This brings us to what has been, historically speaking, the most important response to the hard problem and the more general mind-body problem: dualism, the claim that consciousness is ontologically distinct from anything physical.  Dualism, in its various forms, reasons from the explanatory, epistemological, or conceptual gaps between the phenomenal and the physical to the metaphysical conclusion that the physicalist worldview is incomplete and needs to be supplemented by the addition of irreducibly phenomenal substance or properties.

Dualism can be unpacked in a number of ways.  Substance dualism holds that consciousness makes up a distinct fundamental “stuff” which can exist independently of any physical substance.  Descartes’ famous dualism was of this kind (Descartes 1640/1984).  A more popular modern dualist option is property dualism, which holds that the conscious mind is not a separate substance from the physical brain, but that phenomenal properties are nonphysical properties of the brain.  On this view, it is metaphysically possible that the physical substrate occurs without the phenomenal properties, indicating their ontological independence, but phenomenal properties cannot exist on their own.  The properties might emerge from some combination of nonphenomenal properties (emergent dualism—compare Broad 1925) or they might be present as a fundamental feature of reality, one that necessarily correlates with physical matter in our world, but could in principle come apart from the physical in another possible world.

A key question for dualist views concerns the relationship between consciousness and the physical world, particularly our physical bodies.  Descartes held that conscious mental properties can have a causal impact upon physical matter—this is known as interactionist dualism.  Recent defenders of interactionist dualism include Foster 1991, Hodgson 1991, Lowe 1996, Popper and Eccles 1977, H. Robinson 1982, Stapp 1993, and Swinburne 1986.  However, interactionist dualism requires rejecting the “causal closure” of the physical domain, the claim that every physical event is fully determined by a physical cause.  Causal closure is a long-held principle in the sciences, so its rejection marks a strong break from current scientific orthodoxy (though see Collins 2011).  Another species of dualism accepts the causal closure of physics, but still holds that phenomenal properties are metaphysically distinct from physical properties.  This compatibilism is achieved at the price of consciousness epiphenomenalism, the view that conscious properties can be caused by physical events, but they cannot in turn cause physical events.  I will discuss interactionist dualism in this section, including a consideration of how quantum mechanics might open up a workable space for an acceptable dualist interactionist view.   I will discuss epiphenomenalism in the following section.

Interactionist dualism, of both the substance and property type, holds that consciousness is causally efficacious in the production of bodily behavior.  This is certainly a strongly intuitive position to take with regard to mental causation, but it requires rejecting the causal closure of the physical.  It is widely thought that the principle of causal closure is central to modern science, on par with basic conservation principles like the conservation of energy or matter in a physical reaction (see, for example, Kim 1998).  And at macroscopic scales, the principle appears well-supported by empirical evidence.  However, at the quantum level it is more plausible to question causal closure.  On one reading of quantum mechanics, the progression of quantum-level events unfolds in a deterministic progression until an observation occurs.  At that point, some views hold that the progression of events becomes indeterminstic.  If so, there may be room for consciousness to influence how such “decoherence” occurs—that is, how the quantum “wave function” collapses into the classical, observable macroscopic world we experience.  How such a process occurs is the subject of speculative theorizing in quantum theories of consciousness.  It may be that such views are better cataloged as physicalist:  the properties involved might well be labeled as physical in a completed science (see, for example, Penrose 1989, 1994; Hameroff 1998).  If so, the quantum view is better seen as strongly or weakly reductive.

Still, it might be that the proper cashing out of the idea of “observation” in quantum theory requires positing consciousness as an unreduced primitive.  Observation may require something intrinsically conscious, rather than something characterized in the relational terms of physical theory.   In that case, phenomenal properties would be metaphysically distinct from the physical, traditionally characterized, while playing a key role in physical theory—the role of collapsing the wave function by observation.  Thus, there seems to be theoretical space for a dualist view which rejects closure but maintains a concordance with basic physical theory.

Sill, such views face considerable challenges.  They are beholden to particular interpretations of quantum mechanics and this is far from a settled field, to put it mildly.  It may well be that the best interpretation of quantum mechanics rejects the key assumption of indeterminacy here (see Albert 1993 for the details of this debate).  Further, the kinds of indeterminacies discoverable at the quantum level may not correspond in any useful way to our ordinary idea of mental causes.  The pattern of decoherence may have little to do with my conscious desire to grab a beer causing me to go to the fridge.  Finally, there is the question of how phenomenal properties at the quantum level come together to make up the conscious experience we have.  Our conscious mental lives are not themselves quantum phenomenon—how, then, do micro-phenomenal quantum-level properties combine to constitute our experiences?  Still, this is an alluring area of investigation, bringing together the mysteries of consciousness and quantum mechanics.  But such a mix may only compound our explanatory troubles!

f. Epiphenomenalism

A different dualistic approach accepts the causal closure of physics by holding that phenomenal properties have no causal influence on the physical world (Campbell 1970, Huxley 1874, Jackson 1982, and W.S. Robinson 1988, 2004).  Thus, any physical effect, like a bodily behavior, will have a fully physical cause.  Phenomenal properties merely accompany causally efficacious physical properties, but they are not involved in making the behavior happen.  Phenomenal properties, on this view, may be lawfully correlated with physical properties, thus assuring that whenever a brain event of a particular type occurs, a phenomenal property of a particular type occurs.  For example, it may be that bodily damage causes activity in the amygdala, which in turn causes pain-appropriate behavior like screaming or cringing.   The activity in the amygdala will also cause the tokening of phenomenal pain properties.  But these properties are out of the causal chain leading to the behavior.  They are like the activity of a steam whistle relative to the causal power of the steam engine moving a train’s wheels.

Such a view has no obvious logical flaw, but it is in strong conflict with our ordinary notions of how conscious states are related to behavior.  It is extremely intuitive that our pains at times cause us to scream or cringe.  But on the epiphenomenalist view, that cannot be the case.  What’s more, our knowledge of our conscious states cannot be caused by the phenomenal qualities of our experiences.  On the epiphenomenalist view, my knowledge that I’m in pain is not caused by the pain itself.  This, too, seems absurd:  surely, the feeling of pain is causally implicated in my knowledge of that pain!  But the epiphenomenalist can simply bite the bullet here and reject the commonsense picture.  We often discover odd things when we engage in serious investigation, and this may be one of them.  Denying commonsense intuition is better than denying a basic scientific principle like causal closure, according to epiphenomenalists.  And it may be that experimental results in the sciences undermine the causal efficacy of consciousness as well, so this is not so outrageous a claim (See Libet, 2004; Wegner 2002, for example).  Further, the epiphenomenalist can deny that we need a causal theory of first-person knowledge.  It may be that our knowledge of our conscious states is achieved by a unique kind of noncausal acquaintance.  Or maybe merely having the phenomenal states is enough for us to know of them—our knowledge of consciousness may be constituted by phenomenal states, rather than caused by them.  Knowledge of causation is a difficult philosophical area in general, so it may reasonable to offer alternatives to the causal theory in this context.  But despite these possibilities, epiphenomenalism remains a difficult view to embrace because of its strongly counterintuitive nature.

g. Dual Aspect Theory/Neutral Monism/Panpsychism

A final set of views, close in spirit to dualism, hold that phenomenal properties cannot be reduced to more basic physical properties, but might reduce to something more basic still, a substance that is both physical and phenomenal or that underwrites both.  Defenders of such views agree with dualists that the hard problem forces a rethinking of our basic ontology, but they disagree that this entails dualism.  There are several variations of the idea.  It may be that there is a more basic substance underlying all physical matter and this basic substance possesses phenomenal as well as physical properties (dual aspect theory:  Spinoza 1677/2005, P. Strawson 1959, Nagel 1986).  Or it may be that this more basic substance is “neutral”—neither phenomenal nor physical, yet somehow underlying both (neutral monism:  Russell 1926, Feigl 1958, Maxwell 1979, Lockwood 1989, Stubenberg 1998, Stoljar 2001, G. Strawson 2008).  Or it may be that phenomenal properties are the intrinsic categorical bases for the relational, dispositional properties described in physics and so everything physical has an underlying phenomenal nature (panpsychism:  Leibniz 1714/1989, Whitehead 1929, Griffin 1998, Rosenberg 2005, Skrbina 2007).  These views have all received detailed elaboration in past eras of philosophy, but they have seen a distinct revival as responses to the hard problem.

There is considerable variation in how theorists unpack these kinds of views, so it is only possible here to give generic versions of the ideas.  All three views make consciousness more basic or as basic as physical properties; this is something they share with dualism.  But they disagree about the right way to spell out the metaphysical relations between the phenomenal, the physical, and any more basic substance there might be.  The true differences between the views are not always clear even to the views’ defenders, but we can try to tease them apart here.

A dual-aspect view holds that there is one basic underlying stuff that possesses both physical and phenomenal properties.  These properties may only be instantiated when the right combinations of the basic substance are present, so panpsychism is not a necessary entailment of the view.  For example, when the basic substance is configured in the form of a brain, it then realizes phenomenal as well as physical properties.  But that need not be the case when the fundamental stuff makes up a table.  But in any event, phenomenal properties are not themselves reducible to physical properties.  There is a fine line between such views and dualist views, mainly turning on the difference between constitution and lawful correlation.

Neutral monist views hold that there is a more basic neutral substance underlying both the phenomenal and the physical.  ‘Neutral’ here means that the underlying stuff really is neither phenomenal nor physical, so there is a good sense in which such a position is reductive:  it explains the presence of the phenomenal by reference to something else more basic.  This distinguishes it from the dual-aspect approach—on the dual-aspect view, the underlying stuff already possesses phenomenal (and physical) properties, while on neutral monism it does not.  That leaves neutral monism with the challenge of explaining this reductive relationship, as well as explaining how the neutral substance underlies physical reality without itself being physical.

Panpsychism holds that the phenomenal is basic to all matter.  Such views hold that the phenomenal somehow underwrites the physical or is potentially present at all times as a property of a more basic substance.  This view must explain what it means to say that everything is conscious in some sense.  Further, it must explain how it is that the basic phenomenal (or “protophenomenal”) elements combine to form the sorts of properties we are acquainted with in consciousness.  Why is it that some combinations form the experiences we enjoy and others (presumably) do not?

One line of support for these types of views comes from the way that physical theory defines its basic properties in terms of their dispositions to causally interact with each other.  For example, what it is to be a quark of a certain type is just to be disposed to behave in certain ways in the presence of other quarks.  Physical theory is silent about what stuff might underlie or constitute the entities with these dispositions—it deals only in extrinsic or relational properties, not in intrinsic properties.  At the same time, there is reason to hold that consciousness possesses nonrelational intrinsic qualities.  Indeed, this may explain why we cannot know what it’s like to be a bat—that requires knowledge of an intrinsic quality not conveyable by relational description.  Putting these two ideas together, we find a motivation for the sorts of views canvassed here.  Basic physics is silent about the intrinsic categorical bases underlying the dispositional properties described in physical theory.  But it seems plausible that there must be such bases—how could there be dispositions to behave thus-and-so without some categorical base to ground the disposition?  And since we already have reason to believe that conscious qualities are intrinsic, it makes sense to posit phenomenal properties as the categorical bases of basic physical matter. Or we can posit a neutral substance to fill this role, one also realizing phenomenal properties when in the right circumstances.

These views all seem to avoid epiphenomenalism.  Whenever there is a physical cause of behavior, the underlying phenomenal (or neutral) basis will be present to do the work.  But that cause might itself be constituted by the phenomenal, in the senses laid out here.  What’s more, there is nothing in conflict with physics—the properties posited appear at a level below the range of relational physical description.  And they do not conflict with or preempt anything present in physical theory.

But we are left with several worries.  First, it is again the case that phenomenal properties are posited at an extreme micro-level.  How it is that such micro-phenomenal properties cohere into the sorts of experiential properties present in consciousness is unexplained.  What’s more, if we take the panpsychic route, we are faced with the claim that every physical object has a phenomenal nature of some kind.  This may not be incoherent, but it is a counterintuitive result.  But if we do not accept panpsychism, we must explain how the more basic underlying substance differs from the phenomenal and yet instantiates it in the right circumstances.  Simply saying that this just is the nature of the neutral substance is not an informative answer.  Finally, it is unclear how these views really differ from a weakly reductionist account.  Both hold that there is a basic and brute connection between the physical brain and phenomenal consciousness.  On the weakly reductionist account, the connection is one of brute identity.  On the dual-aspect/neutral monist/panpsychic account, it is one of brute constitution, where two properties, the physical and the phenomenal, constantly co-occur (because the one constitute the categorical base of the other, or they are aspects of a more basic stuff, etc.), though they are held to be metaphysically distinct.  Is there any evidence that could decide between the views?  The apparent differences here may be more one of style than of substance, despite the intricacies of these metaphysical debates.

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Author Information

Josh Weisberg
Email: jweisberg@uh.edu
University of Houston
U. S. A.