Mulla Sadra (c. 1572—1640)

Mulla Sadra made major contributions to Islamic metaphysics and to Shi’i theology during the Safavid period (1501-1736) in Persia. He started his career in the context of a rising culture that combined elements from the Persian past with the newly institutionalized Shi’ism and Sufi teachings. Mulla Sadra was heir to a long tradition of Islamic philosophy that from the beginning had accommodated the speculations of Greek philosophers, especially Neoplatonic philosophers, for the purpose of understanding the world, particularly in relation to the creator and the Islamic faith. Islamic philosophy originated in the rational endeavours to reconcile reason and revelation though the results did not always satisfy theologians, but ironically widened the gaps between reason and revelation.

Mulla Sadra, too, was deeply concerned about both reason and revelation, and he tried a new way of reconciliation by openly employing a synthetic methodology in which mysticism played an important part. For him and his followers, human knowledge is tenable only as long as it goes back to the indirect grasp of reality which in itself is not subject to conceptualization. Nevertheless, Mulla Sadra was dedicated to the traditional forms of logical arguments that are based on premises evident to the mind rather than on beliefs which come from religious faith and tradition. For example, his use of Qur’anic verses and religious ideas, though it is an important part of his system, is mainly confined to a secondary or supportive position. As for mysticism, the extensive use of mystical concepts and terminology is acceptable from the point of view of those thinkers who believe that mystical inspiration, intellectual intuition, and revelation, originate in one and the same source, hence their celebration of Mulla Sadra’s work as “prophetic philosophy.” As a result, the scope of Mulla Sadra’s work is wider than his predecessors. In addition to metaphysics, he wrote extensively on the Qur’an and the Tradition and no other major philosopher before him had been so productive in the field of religion.

While focusing on Mulla Sadra’s metaphysics including his ontology, epistemology, psychology, this article also brings to light the philosopher’s solutions to theological problems. Owing to these solutions, not only did Islamic philosophy manage to survive against religious and political odds, but also Shi’i theology never lost its foothold on the intellectual ground. Although the organic unity of Mulla Sadra’s system rests on all the various components of his thought, his independent works on exegesis, mystical treatises, and his commentaries on preceding philosophers, are outside the scope of this article.

Biography
Synthetic methodology
Ontology
Epistemology
1. Mental Being
2. Unity of the Knower and the Known
Soteriological Psychology
1. Substantial Motion and the Soul
2. The End of the Human Soul
Major Theological Issues
Commentaries on the Qur’an and Tradition
Legacy
References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Muhammad ibn Ibrahim ibn Yahya al-Qawami al-Shirazi, commonly known as Mulla Sadra, was born and grew up during the golden days of the Safavid period, Iran’s first Shi’ite dynasty (c. 1501-1736). As the only son of a noble family, he received both intellectual and financial support towards a good education that started in his home town, Shiraz, in southeastern Iran. Though Shiraz had a glorious past with regard to philosophy, in Mulla Sadra’s day it was not the best place for satisfying his intellectual desire. In his quest for advanced religious and philosophical training he left Shiraz for Qazvin and then moved to Isfahan where he studied with the most eminent intellectual figures of the day, Mir Damad (d. 1631) and Shaykh Baha’̓i (d. 1576) who were also affiliated with the court of the Safavid King, Shah Abbas I (c. 1587-1629). While Mulla Sadra’s philosophical character evolved in conversation and debates with Mir Damad, he owed to Shayk Baha’i his broad knowledge of exegesis (tafsir), tradition (hadith), mysticism (irfan) and jurisprudence (fiqh). There is yet no historical evidence that he ever studied with Mir Findiriski (d. 1640/1), the other leading intellectual of the time. However, the frequency of associating the two by scholars such as Henry Corbin (d. 1978) suggests an inclination on their part towards providing a perfect picture of the philosopher’s integration in the intellectual life of Isfahan with all the pivotal thinkers involved in shaping what has been called “the full flowering of prophetic philosophy” in Mulla Sadra’s hands (Nasr 2006).

In 1601, upon the death of his father, Mulla Sadra returned to Shiraz. Later he related his experience during the time spent in Shiraz in a doleful and critical voice denouncing the intellectual atmosphere of the city for being hostile, suppressive, and philistine with regard to philosophy (al-Asfar I 7). He decided to leave Shiraz for a life of solitude and contemplation in Kahak, a quiet village near the city of Qom. The peace and quiet of life in Kahak gave Mulla Sadra the opportunity to start the composition of his most foundational work, al-Hikmat al-muta ‘aliya fi’l-asfar al-‘aqliyya al-arba (Transcendent Wisdom in the Four Journeys of the Intellect). There he also found some of his life-long students who became well-known scholars of their own time.

This period was followed by several journeys between Shiraz, Isfahan, Qom, Kashan, and most importantly, seven pilgrimages to Mecca. Apparently, this itinerant stage played an important part in his intellectual and spiritual growth that is also suggested by the “journey” metaphor in the title and divisions of al-Asfar. It was also during this period that Mulla Sadra accepted the invitation to teach at Khan School, which was built in Shiraz on the order of the new governor, Allahwirdi Khan, in Mulla Sadra’s honour and for the purpose of his lectures.

Mulla Sadra had a family of six children, three sons and three daughters. All his sons became scholars and his daughters were married to three of Sadra’s students whom he treated as family even prior to the marriages. We know that two of these students Muhsin Fayz Kashani (d. 1679/80 ) and Abd al-Razzaq Lahiji (d. 1661/2 ) succeeded their father-in-law as two influential figures of their time though different to him in their philosophical orientation and working under more pressure due to the growing antagonism to philosophy and mysticism under Shah Abbas II (c. 1642-1666).

The intellectual network consisting of Mulla Sadra, his teachers and students that was later dubbed “the School of Isfahan” was formed in a unique political and religious context. Philosophers such as Mir Damad and Mulla Sadra managed to get their voices heard by their contemporaries and posterities in spite of the conservative religiosity of the newly established Shi’ite rule partly owing to the religious and political state of affairs. Since the Safavids strove to establish their identity as a Persian-Shi’ite state in contrast to the Sunni caliphate of the Turks and Arabs, they were in need of philosophy as a stronghold of knowledge that could reinforce, not to say generate, power through systematic thought. At least during the formative and golden days of the Safavid period the attacks on philosophers targeted their Sufi leanings rather than their endeavours to reconcile metaphysics with Shi’ite theology.

A prolific writer, Mulla Sadra composed a large number of treatises on ontology, epistemology, cosmology, psychology, eschatology, theology, mysticism, the Quran and the Tradition. However, many of his philosophical and theological works are repetitions of or elaborations on chapters from his magnum opus al-Hikmat al-mutaliyah fi’l-asfar al-arba‘a al-‘aqliyyah, commonly referred to as al-Asfar that is printed in nine volumes. Rather than simply holding Mulla Sadra’s theses, the latter work is an encyclopaedia of different schools of Islamic philosophy and theology. With the exception of Risala-yi si asl (Treatise on the Three Principles) which is in Persian, he wrote all his works in Arabic that was the lingua franca of the Muslim world at that time. He also wrote extensive commentaries on the Qur ‘an and the tradition among which respectively al-Mafatihal-ghayb (Keys to the Invisible) and his voluminous commentary on the famous collection of Shi’ite tradition, Usul al-kafi by Kulayni (d.939) are the most important.

After a pious life of dedication to acquiring and expanding philosophy and Islamic sciences, Mulla Sadra died in Basra on the way to his seventh pilgrimage to Mecca. His death was once believed to have occurred in 1640 with his body being buried in Basra. However, modern scholarship offers new evidence, though not conclusive evidence, in support of the date of 1635-6 and his burial being in Najaf (Rizvi 2007 30).

2. Synthetic methodology

Mulla Sadra was determined to construct a spacious house of “transcendental philosophy” that could accommodate the apparently conflicting paths in Islamic history towards the ultimate wisdom. He was also heir to a long tradition of philosophy in Persia which had adopted the methodology of Greek philosophy and interpreted it not only in accordance with the Islamic faith, but also implicitly and partly in continuation of the antique Persian traditions. Similar to his past philosophical masters Ibn Sina (d. 1037) and Suhrawardi (d. 1191), but unaware of Ibn Rushd‘s (d.1198) criticism of Neoplatonism in Islamic philosophy, Mulla Sadra relied on Neoplatonic precepts which had been taken for Aristotelian ideas by preceding philosophers. In particular, he followed Suhrawardi by adopting a holistic method of philosophy in which reason is accompanied by intuition, and intellection is the realization of the quintessence of the human soul, with prophecy (nubuwwa) and sainthood (wilaya) as the noblest manifestations of it. It is based on this holistic attitude that on the one hand, Mulla Sadra synthesizes the two main schools of Islamic philosophy, namely, the Peripatetic and Illuminationist schools, and on the other hand, bridges the gaps between philosophy, theology, and mysticism. While Mulla Sadra’s philosophical methodology is rational in the sense of building his arguments on premises that consist in evident propositional beliefs, he does not reduce philosophical process to mere abstract logical reasoning. The pivotal place of intuition in his philosophical methodology is especially reflected by the influence of Ibn Arabi (d. 1240) throughout his works and by the fact that he regarded Ibn Arabi’s writings as having a philosophical character with a “demonstrative force” (al-Asfar I 315). Whether we understand Mulla Sadra’s use of intuition as “a higher form of reason” in the Platonic sense (Rahman 1975, 6), or as a prophetic experience that turns philosophy into “theosophy” (Nasr 1997, 57), in reality there is no actual separation between reason and intuition in Mulla Sadra’s philosophy. Rather than considering ratiocination (that is, the process of exact thinking) and intuition as independent ways leading to different visions of the truth, for him they merge into one path complementing and completing each other.

Although no Islamic philosopher had ever announced reason and revelation, philosophy and prophecy in conflict with each other, in practice, several philosophical doctrines were regarded by theologians as blasphemous due to contradiction with the theological formulations of Quranic teachings. By synthesizing the findings of his predecessors and relying on his holistic methodology, Mulla Sadra addressed several controversial issues that had opened a wide gap between philosophy and theology, reason and faith. His conciliatory attitude is manifest in his writings that are replete with scriptural and theological references alongside and in harmony with the teachings of Ibn Sina, Suhrawardi, Ibn Arabi, and other Muslim thinkers.

3. Ontology

a. Primacy of Being

Although Aristotle identifies the external existence of a thing with its primary substance, he distinguishes between two questions we can ask with respect to everything: “What it is” and “whether it is (or exists)”. This conceptual distinction was later extended to the extra-mental realm of contingent beings by Islamic philosophers, most insistently Ibn Sina, and following him scholastic philosophers such as Aquinas (d. 1274). For Ibn Sina, essence, or quiddity (mahiyya), is universal in the mind while particular in the external world once being is bestowed on it by the Necessary Being who is identified with the God of Abrahamic faith. Except for God who exists in His own right, every other being is composed of essence and being, hence contingent in the sense of dependence on the Necessary Being for their existence.

The distinction was taken for granted after Ibn Sina but turned into a controversial issue when philosophers in the Illuminationist school questioned the external reality of being over and above essence. Suhrawardi and following him Mir Damad argued that being was only a mental construct and the distinction between essence and being was only possible in the conceptual domain. Since then, Islamic philosophers have roughly been categorized as adherents of either the primacy of essence or the primacy of being. Influenced by his philosophy master, Mulla Sadra started as an advocate of essentialism but soon diverged towards the opposite doctrine that he made famous as “the primacy of being” (asalat-i wujud). He built on this foundation the whole of his philosophical system.

Starting with the concept of being, Mulla Sadra attributes two major characteristics to it. Firstly, being is beyond logical analysis, hence indefinable, due to its simplicity and supra-categorical status. It is self-evident and prior to any other concept in the mind. Secondly, it is a univocal concept in the sense that it has one and the same meaning in all its applications, whether we apply it to God or to any other entity. The first characteristic seems to place being as such totally outside the grasp of discursive thought. The second one leaves the philosopher with the hope that in case he finds an alternative path towards being, he will be able to bridge the ontological gap made by certain theologians between the Creator and the created.

As for the reality of being in the external world, Mulla Sadra not only follows Ibn Sina in considering being as a reality, but adheres to his other master, Ibn’Arabi in considering being as the only reality, the doctrine which is commonly referred to as “the unity of being” (wahdat al-wujud). Nevertheless, Mulla Sadra’s ontological monism does not imply that essences are illusions, as it is held in radical forms of Sufism. For Mulla Sadra, though essences are not genuine in their existence, they still exist as delimitations of the Real Being that is the ground of all that exists. Using a poetic analogy, the indefinite Reality is a colorless light while essences are the colourful glasses through which the single light appears as diverse phenomena. Conceptual differentiation, without which thinking and speaking would be impossible, is owing to this semi-reality of essences. To sum up, while being is the principle of unity, essence or quiddity is the principle of difference.

Mulla Sadra has several arguments for the primacy of being and its unrivalled reality. The most comprehensive list of the arguments appears in his al-Mashair, a useful summary of his ontology, and several arguments are included in al-Asfar. For the premises of his arguments, Mulla Sadra relies on the classical understanding of essence as a universal without external effects within the mind. On this ground, the real horse can give you a ride while the universal horse in the mind is incapable of that because real particularity, external properties and real effects are owing to being and cannot be in the mind. In conclusion, being is the ground of reality, or better to say, reality itself, while essence only belongs to the conceptual realm and as Mulla Sadra put it “the term ‘existent’ is applied to essence only with respect to its relation to being [itself]” (al-Asfar VI 163).

b. Gradation of Being

The univocal concept of being applies to its instances in the same sense because of the unity of its reality, and conceptual differences are only due to essences. On the other hand, essences have no reality of their own. Based on these two premises, one could conclude that diversity is not real. Gradation, or modulation, of being (tashkik al-wujud) is Mulla Sadra’s way to avoid this counterintuitive result and to create a system in which the monistic worldview of Sufism is reconciled with the realistic pluralism of classical philosophy and our common sense. According to this doctrine, though one simple reality, being comes in grades, in a similar way that sunlight and candlelight are the same reality of different grades. In effect, there are only differences by degrees, while essences, as concepts in the mind, reflect gradations as contrasts. As Mulla Sadra put it,

The instances of being are different in terms of intensity and weakness as such, priority and posteriority as such; nobility and baseness as such, although the universal concepts applicable to it and abstracted from it, named quiddities, are in contrast essentially, in terms of genus, species, or accidents. (al-Asfar IX 186)

Before Mulla Sadra, Suhrawardi introduced the concept of gradation into the logic of definition and considered essence as capable of applying to instances by different degrees. For example, he regarded a horse more of an animal than a fly. His ontology was based on light as the hierarchical reality of universe with realms of existence as different ranks of it. Inspired by Suhrawardi’s challenge of classical philosophers such as Ibn Sina who would not allow gradation in the same essence, but in contrast to the former’s belief in the ontological primacy of essence or quiddity, Mulla Sadra replaced the hierarchical light of Suhrawardi with the hierarchical being. Accordingly, Reality is one and the same thing but possessed of different degrees of intensity, which justifies diversity within unity.

The doctrine of gradation not only supports the reality of diversity, but also points out the all-encompassing simplicity of being qua being. Hence the famous dictum that is frequently repeated in Mulla Sadra’s works, “the Simple Reality (basit al-haqiqa) is all things but none of those things in particular” (al-Asfar VI 111).

c. The Absolute and the Relational

Given that for Mulla Sadra reality consists in different grades of the same being, the nature of causality becomes an urgent question for him. Mulla Sadra’s formulation of causality reveals the strong influence of Ibn Arabi’s unity of being (wahdat al-wujud). Mulla Sadra begins with causality in the sense of existentiation (ijad) according to which contingent essences are brought into existence once their existence is necessitated by the Necessary Being. However, since in Mulla Sadra’s system, essences only belong in the conceptual domain, the relationship between cause and effect cannot be explained based on the metaphysical duality of being/essence. Therefore, he finally replaces this duality by the distinction he makes between two senses of being, the independent and the relational. At the cosmic level, the only independent being is the Absolute Being, while the rest, no matter of what intensity, are only relational.

Mulla Sadra’s introduction of this distinction into Islamic philosophy was inspired by the linguistic division between the meaning of “to be” in the sense of existence as a real predicate, and “to be” as a copula, the latter being nonexistent as a word in Arabic and only suggested though predication. Relational being is a “being-in-another” in the sense of being nothing other than a relation to another being. For example, in saying that “snow is white”, the predicative relation that is expressed by “is” has no existence apart from “snow” and “white”. Mulla Sadra regards all beings as nothing but an existential relation to the Absolute Being. For Him, “He is the Truth and the rest are His manifestations. He is the Light and the rest are the streaks of that Light…” (al-Masha’ir 450).

4. Epistemology

Mulla Sadra’s epistemology is not prior to but based on his findings about the nature of reality. Though this may sound like begging the question from the perspective of modern philosophy, it is consistent with the totality of Mulla Sadra’s system in which everything including knowledge itself is a form of being. It is for this reason that he studies knowledge as a subject of first philosophy, namely, the study of being qua being. He diverges from what he criticises in Ibn Sina as the negative process of abstraction (al-Asfar III 287) in favour of the positive presence of noetic or mental beings in the mind. For Mulla Sadra, knowledge is the realization of an immaterial being which corresponds to the extra-mental reality because it is the higher grade of the latter being.

Mulla Sadra’s main contribution to Islamic epistemology lies in his diversion from the Aristotelian dualism of subject and object, in other words, knower and the known (̒aqil wa ma’quil). He rejected the dominant theory of knowledge as the representation of the abstracted and universal form of particular objects to the mind. This innovation, though on a different ground and based on a different foundation, is comparable to the 20th century efforts made in the area of phenomenology and existentialism to get over the epistemological scepticism resulting from Cartesian dualism.

a. Mental Being

In classical Islamic epistemology knowledge is divided into “knowledge by presence” that consists only in the immediate access of the soul to itself in the sense of self-consciousness, and “knowledge by acquisition” that originates in sense perception and provides the subject with an abstracted representation of the external objects, that is, the intelligible universal at the level of intellect. In line with the Neoplatonic trend of thought adopted by Suhrawardi, Mulla Sadra replaced representation by direct presentation (hudur). For Mulla Sadra, all knowledge is, at bottom, knowledge by presence because our knowledge of the world is a direct access to what is called mental beings.

In contrast to the Peripatetic mental form or concept as a universal produced by abstraction, mental being is an immaterial and particular mode of existence with a higher intensity than the external object corresponding to it. According to Mulla Sadra, mental being is the key to the realization of all levels of knowledge including sense perception, imagination, and intellection. Upon encounter with the external world, the soul creates mental beings in a similar manner that God creates the world of substantial forms both material and immaterial (al-Shawahid al-rububiyya 43). Thus, rather than correspondence between the external object and its represented form in the mind, for Mulla Sadra the credibility of knowledge lies in the existential unity of different grades of the same being, one created by the soul and the other existing in the external world.

Although the human soul has the potentiality of creating modes of existence also in the absence of the matter, as in the case of miracles, for the average human soul, as long as she lives in the material world, contact with matter is necessary for activating the creative process of generating mental beings. In this respect, Mulla Sadra’s epistemology should not be conflated with subjective idealism in that for him the physical being is a reality though of a lesser intensity than its counterpart in the soul.

b. Unity of the Knower and the Known

Mulla Sadra revolutionized epistemology with regard to the relationship between the knowing subject and her object based on the doctrine of the unity of the knower and the known previously held by the Neoplatonic Porphyry (d. 305) but strongly rejected by Ibn Sina. Siding with the former, Mulla Sadra redefines the status of knowledge. Previously, mental form was defined as a psychic quality that occurs to the immaterial substance of the soul as a mere accident (̒arad), incapable of making any changes to the soul’s essence. Conversely, for Mulla Sadra, knowledge that is made up of mental beings functions as a substantial form that actualizes the potential faculties of the soul. Similar to form and matter in the physical world, there is no real separation between the knower (soul or mind) and the immediately known object of it, that is, the mental being. To put it in a nutshell, knowledge is a single reality that, in its potentiality, is called “the knower” (‘lim) or “the intellect” (‘aqil) while in its actuality, it is “the known” (ma’lum) or the “intelligible” (ma’quil). Owing to this unity, rather than being a fixed substratum for accidental mental forms, the mind in its reality is identical to the sum of all the mental beings that are realized in it. In other words, there is no such thing as an actual mind in the absence of knowledge.

This existential unification holds at all the levels of knowledge that is confined by Mulla Sadra to sense perception, imagination, and intellection. The faculty of sense perception is a potentiality of the soul that is unified with the perceptible forms (or beings) in the occasion of contact with the sensible world. Once sensible forms (beings) are realized, a higher grade of mental beings called “the imaginal beings” are actualized in unity with the imaginative faculty of the soul. The same unification holds at the level of intellection between the intelligible forms (beings) as the actual and the intellect as potential. From this level, the human soul is capable of acquiring higher degrees of knowledge that prepares her for the final unification with the Active Intellect that is the reservoir of all knowledge, and as a result, the activator of the human mind during the creative process of knowledge formation. This epistemic elevation is at the same time the journey of the soul towards higher grades of being and spiritualization.

5. Soteriological Psychology

In the pre-modern context, one should understand the term “psychology” in the sense of inquiry into the nature and mechanism of the metaphysical soul in its relation to the body. Moreover, informed by the Islamic doctrines and inspired by mysticism, Islamic philosophers regarded the human soul as capable of elevation through acquiring knowledge and spiritual practice. Mulla Sadra’s psychology is not an exception to this tradition; however, in his system, the human soul is given a more dominant role within the cosmic drama that unfolds along a salvific process of perfection.

a. Substantial Motion and the Soul

Mulla Sadra describes the soul as one simple but graded reality that in its unity includes diverse mental faculties. He also regards the soul as bodily in its origin, but spiritual in subsistence. This picture of the soul’s substance is unprecedented in the philosophy before Mulla Sadra. It is built on the doctrine of substantial motion that is one of the hallmarks of transcendental philosophy. According to this doctrine, all nature, including substances and accidents, is in motion. As bodily in its origin, the soul too moves from one form to another as long as it is living in this world. The substance of the soul is an existentially graded reality in which the changes take place through the superimposition of one form over the previous one rather than one replacing the other. Therefore, the unity of the soul is maintained despite the changes and her identity is preserved.

Though starting from the Aristotelian view of the soul as the form of the body, in his psychology, Mulla Sadra departs from the former in attributing to the human soul the power of growing out of the bodily attachment. Along with the expansion of knowledge and spiritual evolvement, the soul moves up to higher grades of being. The rational human soul is actualized when we reach maturity (around the age of forty), but this is not the end. At this stage, we are actually human but potentially angels or devils.

b. The End of the Human Soul

For Mulla Sadra, the ultimate happiness of the human souls is to join in the beatific life of the Intellects. This is in agreement not only with Aristotle’s definition of happiness, but also with a Neoplatonic doctrine according to which the individual souls are only particular determinations of the universal soul that descends to the imperfect level of nature by joining the bodies. Therefore, the individual human soul, though starting as a bodily being in the world, is still invested with an otherworldly spirituality due to the noble state of the universal soul before the descent. The inherent inclination toward reunion with the Active Intellect, that is, the realm of Divine Knowledge, puts the soul back on the “arch of ascent”. However, the ascent toward reunion is not guaranteed for each and every human soul since there are many phases that each soul should pass successfully in order to substantially evolve and reach up to higher ranks of being.

Mulla Sadra’s delineation of the soul’s journey resonates with ideas of Islamic mysticism which in turn is indebted for its theoretical formulation to Neoplatonic ideas. The title of his magnum opus, al-Asfar, together with its main divisions is a proof to the mystical attachment as the philosophical narrative unfolds in terms of the famous four journeys of the soul, namely, the quest in search of the ultimate Truth or God and the final reunion with Him. In al-Asfar, the first journey that is from the created to the Creator is devoted to the concept and reality of being. The second journey is from the Creator to the Creator through the Creator, and discusses essence. The third journey is from the Creator to the created with the Creator and is about God and His Attributes, and finally the journey from the created to the created with the Creator that is focused on the destiny of the humankind.

Furthermore, Mulla Sadra explains the afterlife of the human soul based on Ibn’Arabi’s metaphysics of imagination that introduces the imaginal world (̒alam al-mithal) in between the Intellectual realm on top and the material world at the bottom. In line with Ibn’Arabi and Suhrawardi, while in contrast to Ibn Sina, Mulla Sadra believes in a bipartite reality of imagination according to which imaginative forms can exist both as subjective, or attached to the human mind, and as objective, or independent, comprising the detached domain of imagination, that is, the imaginal world. The creative imagination of the human soul, which is the source of prophecy and miracles in this world, is also the key to the bodily resurrection of the soul in the next world. While in this world only the prophets and saints are capable of bringing their imagination into life, in the next world where the material bodies are no more existent, every soul will be capable of creating her imaginal body.

The bodily resurrection of the soul should not be conflated with any forms of reincarnation which is strongly rejected by Mulla Sadra. He uses the analogy of “reflections in the mirror” (al-Mazahir al-ilahiyya, 126) to show the necessary correlation between the otherworldly body and the spiritual grade of the individual soul. Rather than transmigrating into another body, the soul creates its very own body that becomes an objective image of her intentions and deeds in the previous life. That is the reason why the lesser souls will be resurrected as animals while the noble ones will simply join in the life of Intellect with no bodies at all. Thus, the hierarchy of resurrected souls in the next world corresponds to the hierarchy of souls in this world. There is a subtle problem here concerning the nature of imagination and the “mirror-like” nature of the soul in terms of eschatology. Mulla Sadra’s use of mirror imagery with respect to other-worldly bodies is his response to Suhrawardi on the same issue and draws on the endeavours of Ibn’Arabi and his commentator Dawoud al-Qaysari (d. 1350) to solve an earlier problem in Islamic philosophy (Rustom 2007).

6. Major Theological Issues

Islamic philosophy is rooted in the early endeavours of Mu’tazilite theologians who borrowed the instrument of Greek logic and terminology in order to formulate the doctrines of faith in a manner palatable for human reason. Of primary importance was proof to the existence and oneness of God, the nature and function of His Attributes, and the nature and mechanism of prophecy. Not only have different schools of theology offered divergent solutions to theological problems, but also theology has been in conflict with philosophy over several key issues. One of the novelties of Mulla Sadra’s work was the systematic effort to resolve long-held conflicts between philosophers and theologians. Moreover, unlike his philosophical predecessors, he did not leave any religious doctrine to mere faith and believed in the possibility of rational explanation for all. His proof for the doctrine of bodily resurrection is a good example of this positive attitude. On the whole, Mulla Sadra does not see a chasm between philosophy and theology; rather, his theology is both the continuation and the ultimate result of his philosophical doctrines.

Mulla Sadra dismissed all the previous proofs to the existence of God as resting on wrong assumptions, or at best insufficient. He even criticised Ibn Sina’s “proof of the righteous” (al–Asfar VI 13) because of its reliance on the concept rather than the reality of being. However, Mulla Sadra’s proof, which he calls by the same name, shares the a priori character of Ibn Sina’s proof. An a priori proof (burhan-i limmi) does not infer the existence of the Creator (cause) from the existence of any particular created thing (effect). For Mulla Sadra, the “proof of the righteous” is called by this name because it has the privilege of arguing for the existence of God through God Himself. Based on Mulla Sadra’s ontology, the reality of being is necessary, and it is of different grades. The delimited and imperfect grades do not exist in their own right, but only as relations to the most perfect or Absolute Being. Therefore, the Absolute Being or God must necessarily exist. Starting from the reality of being, this argument infers the existence of God from God Himself because “the real being and the Necessary Being apply to the same thing”, that is, God (al-Mabda’ wa’l-ma’ad 30).

As for the oneness of God (tawhid), that is, the first article of faith in Islam, Mulla Sadra further relies on his ontological views to argue against both the intrinsic and extrinsic plurality with respect to God. His argument is based on the transcendental inclusiveness of the Absolute Being. God as the Absolute Being is a simple reality in the sense of being without parts while including all things. As the most intense and the only independent being, God is inclusive of every form of existence while excluding only the imperfections and contingencies. Therefore, to assume another being next to God would be logically absurd. In Mulla Sadra, the theological doctrine of Divine Oneness can be identified with the mystical-philosophical doctrine of the oneness of being that is the only way in which the oneness of God can be understood without wrongly imagining it as a numerical concept.

a. The Essence and the Attributes

The simplicity of the Absolute Being in the sense of being comprehensive of all is also the key to explaining God’s Attributes in relation to each other and to the Essence (dhat). Though the Attributes must be infinite in number and scope, human beings only know of a limited number of them through the Qur’an. The nature of Divine Attributes has been a subject of controversies between different theological schools. They differ over the objectivity of the Attributes in the sense of independence from God’s Essence. In al-Asfar and al-Mabda’ wa’l-ma ‘ad, Mulla Sadra has elaborated on several Attributes including Life, Knowledge, Will, Speech, Vision and Hearing. He tries to prove the reality of the Attributes in a way that would not defy the unity of God’s Essence. He resolves this theological paradox of diversity in unity with regard to God’s Essence by resorting to the simple reality of God’s Being. In a similar way to the unity of the soul with the diverse psychic properties like knowledge and will, all the Attributes of God are not only unified with the Essence, but unified with each other. The corollary to this conclusion is that, in its ontological unity with the infinite and necessary Reality of God, each Attribute must be infinite and necessary. For example, God has necessary and infinite knowledge of all. According to Mulla Sadra, God knows the world through the knowledge of Himself and as his Essence includes all, he has knowledge of all without any limits. Nevertheless, the objects of divine knowledge exist at the level of Essence in a state of existential togetherness (wujud al-jam’i) with a higher grade of being than their existence as distinct essences in the created world. This is the way Mulla Sadra tried to resolve a long-held conflict between philosophy and theology regarding God’s detailed knowledge of the world. In a similar fashion, Mulla Sadra redefines other Attributes of God in the context of transcendental philosophy with the hope of reconciling philosophy with theology.

b. Temporal Origin of the World

One of the earliest and harshest theological indictments of Islamic philosophy was carried out by the Ash’arite theologian, Abu Hamid Muhammad ibn Muhammad al-Ghazzali, (d. 1111) in his al-Tahafat al-falasifa (The Inconsistency of Philosophers). One of the most important faults he finds in philosophers such as Ibn Sina is the doctrine of the eternity of creation. According to this doctrine that was accepted by all Peripatetic philosophers the universe was created in eternity, which means that creation had no beginning in time. This doctrine has been criticised by theologians due to its conflict with the scriptural picture of creation, both in the Bible and the Qur’an.

Mulla Sadra takes a middle path between reason and revelation by resorting to his doctrine of substantial motion. According to Mulla Sadra, every particle of nature is in constant motion along their timeline which he regards as the fourth dimension of the bodily substance. Motion is not an accidental property given to nature over and above its substance; rather, it is essential to it and caused at the same ‘time’ with the creation of the bodily substance. Motion is by definition temporal, and substantial motion is the renewal of every particle of nature in time. Thus, Mulla Sadra concludes that every particle of nature is being recreated at every moment, which is the meaning of temporal origination. The world as a whole is nothing more than its parts, so the origination of the whole world in time is an absurd question.

c. Bodily Resurrection

Bodily resurrection is an article of Islamic faith that is regarded by theologians as a requisite for the fulfilment of the scriptural promises and threats regarding reward and punishment in the next world. As a theological issue, bodily resurrection has caused serious conflicts between philosophy and theology particularly following Ghazzali’s criticism of Ibn Sina on this issue. According to Ibn Sina, bodily resurrection is a matter of faith that Muslims must believe in, but from a logical point of view, it is impossible.

Mulla Sadra follows Ghazzali in holding that scepticism over bodily resurrection is not acceptable from either the religious or logical point of view (al-Mazahir al-ilahiyya 125). However, he reinterprets bodily resurrection in terms of the imaginative creation of the otherworldly body by the soul. Though immaterial, the imaginal body is possessed of the three dimensions of the physical body that make it subject to a variety of feelings similar to our dream-world experiences. This will especially serve the purpose of punishment for the imperfect souls who spoiled the prospect of an intellectual/heavenly life through their carnal obsessions in the previous world. Some souls may be pardoned after serving their time in Hell by God’s Grace and the intermission of angels and nobler souls. As for the others, they will stay in Hell with their imaginal bodies forever. Despite his efforts, Mulla Sadra’s picture of resurrection is not in complete conformity with that of theology. Especially, his intellectual Paradise is not different to that of the classical philosophers. Great souls are not satisfied with carnal pleasures even in this world, so their reward in the next world cannot be a carnal one.

d. Prophethood, Imamate, and Sainthood

Influenced by Ibn ‘Arabi’s doctrine of “the Perfect Human” and its incorporation into Shi’i imamate by Sayyid Haydar Amuli (d. 1385), Mulla Sadra explains prophethood, imamate, and sainthood as related aspects of the same reality. Prophets, Imams, and Saints are instances of the category of the Perfect Human (al-insan al-kamil) whose soul is inclusive of the three levels of creation, that is, the intellectual, the imaginal, and the sensory worlds. Mulla Sadra, regards prophethood as “exoteric guidance” (al-Shawahid al-rububiyya 492) which is necessary for the average people. Intellectual truths that are revealed to prophets through the unification of their intellect with the Angel of revelation, identical to the Active Intellect of philosophy, descend to the level of imagination and sense perception in order to be communicated to the people.

The esoteric side of prophecy is not only the innermost spiritual meaning of it, but also the purpose of creation. Although Muslims believe that Muhammad was the last prophet of God, according to Mulla Sadra, after the death of Muhammad, revelation continued in the form of inspiration that endows the Imam and Saint with the same infallibility as the Prophet. Thus, the content of the divine communication is the same in all three, but the form is slightly different. Prophets have a clearer vision of the Angel of revelation in comparison to the Imams and Saints (al-Shawahid al-rububiyya 480).

7. Commentaries on the Qur’an and Tradition

In many cases philosophers have resorted to the Qur’an in order to reinforce their philosophical arguments. On the other hand, there is a long tradition of Qur’anic exegesis ranging from technical linguistic analysis to rational and esoteric hermeneutics (ta’wῑl) that comprises a sophisticated and independent discipline. Mulla Sadra is a special case as a philosopher who has dedicated independent treatises to Qur’anic commentaries. Moreover, there is a mutual reinforcement between his philosophy and his reading of the Qur’an in the sense that not only his approach to the Qur’an is philosophical, but also his philosophy has a Qur’anic base (Rustom 2012). Mulla Sadra does not see any conflicts between the teachings of the Qur’an and his philosophical system. Apart from several commentaries on chapters and verses from the Qur’an, Mulla Sadra also wrote about the theoretical and practical criteria of exegesis. His major theoretical work is Mafatih al-ghayb (Keys to the Invisible).

As for Mulla Sadra’s work on the tradition (hadith), his monumental commentary on al-Usul al-kafi by Kulayni is the most important. Kulayni’s work is the first Shi‘i collection of Hadith and focuses on theology and jurisprudence. It has served as a textbook at the religious seminaries around the Shi’i world for centuries, and Mulla Sadra’s commentary on this work has secured him a good place among the experts in Hadith scholarship.

8. Legacy

Mulla Sadra’s influence on his immediate students, including his sons-in-law, Fayz Kashani and Lahiji, owed more to the mystical aspect of his works. As for his philosophical doctrines, he was only followed by the less famous among his students such as Husayn Tunikabuni (d.1693). Especially, in the late Safavid period due to the intellectually suppressive atmosphere created by influential clerics, most prominently Muhammad Baqir Majlisi (d. 1198), philosophical and particularly mystical thoughts were antagonized by the ruling system and the clerics alike.

Nevertheless, the legacy of the philosopher was kept alive until, in the Qajar period (c. 1785-1925), a more welcoming attitude facilitated the revival of his works in the hands of his followers who worked as Sadrian scholars. In addition to editing and expounding the latter’s works, as teachers they also initiated a chain of scholars that has continued until today. Among contemporary scholars and Sadrian philosophers, Muhammad Husayn Tabataba’i (d. 1981) is one of the most widely read. His books, which are based on Mulla Sadra’s philosophy with some modifications, are still being taught as compendiums of Islamic philosophy at the departments of philosophy in Iran. Mulla Sadra studies particularly flourished after the Islamic Revolution of 1979. Since then, he has been widely taught both at the religious seminaries and universities with governmental funds supporting the foundation of institutes and international conferences. Among these, Sadra Islamic Philosophy Research Institute, established in 1994 in Tehran, and the World Congress on Mulla Sadra in 1999 are the best examples.

After Mulla Sadra’s death, India was the first place outside Iran to show his influence. A remarkable number of expositions and commentaries have been written on one of his marginal works called Commentary on Sharh al-Hidayah in India where it has been taught as a course book of Islamic philosophy for several centuries. Later, the Shi’i seminaries of Iraq in the city of Najaf and some influential thinkers in Pakistan also welcomed Mulla Sadra’s philosophy.

Mulla Sadra was introduced into the West at the end of the nineteenth century by the German orientalist, Max Horten (d. 1945) with an emphasis on the mystical aspect of the philosopher’s work. Later during 1960’s and 70’s, the collaboration of the French scholar Henry Corbin (d. 1978) with Toshihiko Izutsu (d.1986 ) from Japan and Seyyed Hossein Nasr (b. 1933) from Iran, led to a full-fledged introduction of Mulla Sadra into Western academia as part of a wider project of reviving “perennial wisdom”. Following their work, Mulla Sadra has been translated, taught, and discussed in academic journals and circles both in Europe and North America. The contemporary generation of Mulla Sadra scholars, though approaching Mulla Sadra from different points of view, are illuminating various aspects of the philosopher’s work.

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Philosophical Works

Mulla Sadra, Risala-yi si asl. Seyyed Hossein Nasr (ed.). (Tehran: Mulla Sadra Research Institute, 1381AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Hikmat al-muta’aliya fi asfar al-aqliya al-arba’a. 5. Muhammad Reza Muzaffar (ed.). 9 vols. (Beirut: Dar al-ihya ‘ al-turath al-Arabi, 1999).
Mulla Sadra, al-Hikmat al-‘Arshiyya. Ghulam Ahani (ed.). (Isfahan: Isfahan University press, 1340 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, Sharh al-Hidaya.Ahmad Shirazi (ed.). (Facsimile repr. Qom: Intishsrat-i Bidar. 1313 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Mabda’ wa’l-ma’ad. Ahmad Hosseini Ardakani (ed.). (Tehran: Sitad-i Inqilab-i Farhangi, Markaz-i Nashr-i Danishgahi, 1983).
Mulla Sadra, Tafsir al-Qur’an al-karim. M. Khajavi (ed.). 7 vols. (Qom: Intisharat-i Bidar, 1988).
Mulla Sadra, al-Mazahir al-ilahiyya. 3. Sayyid Jalal al-Din Ashtiyani (ed.). (Qom: Office of Islamic Propagation of the Seminary of Qom, 1387 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Shawahid al-rububiyya. Javad Mosleh (trans.). (Tehran: Soroush Press, 2006).
Mulla Sadra, Majmu’a-yi rasa’il-i falsafi-yi Sadr al-muta’allihin. Hamid Naji Isfahani (ed.). (Tehran: Hikmat, 1385AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, al-Masha’ir.Sayyid Jalal al-Din Ashtiyani (ed.). (Qom: Office of Islamic Propagation of the Seminary of Qom, 1386 AH solar).
Mulla Sadra, Mafatih al-ghayb. Muhammad Khawjavi (ed.). (Beirut: Mu ‘assasat al-Tarikh al-Arabi, 2002 rpt).
Mulla Sadra, Sharh-i Usul al-Kafi. Muhammad Khawjavi (ed.). 4 vols. (Tehran: Pizhuhishgah-i Ulūm-i Insani va Mutala’at-i Farhangi, 2004).

b. English Translation of Primary Literature

Mahdi Dasht Bozorgi and Fazel Asadi Amjad, Divine Manifestations: Concerning the Secrets of the Sciences of Perfection (London: ICAS Press, 2010).
William Chittick, The Elixir of the Gnostics (Provo: Brigham Young University Press, 2003).
Ibrahim Kalin, Knowledge in Later Islamic Philosophy. Mulla Sadra on Existence, Intellect, and Intuition (New York: Oxford University Press, 2010).
T. Kirmani, The Manner of the Creation of Actions (Tehran: SIPRIn, 2004).
J. Lameer, Conception and Belief in Sadr al-Din Shirazi (Tehran: Iranian Academy of Philosophy, 2005).
Parviz Morewedge, The Metaphysics of Mulla Sadra: The Book of Metaphysical Prehensions (New York: Society for the Study of Islamic Philosophy and Science, 1992).
James Morris, The Wisdom of the Throne (Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1981).
Seyyed Hossein Nasr and Ibrahim Kalin, Metaphysical Penetrations: A Parallel English-Arabic Text by Mulla Sadra (Provo: Brigham Young Press, 2013).
Latimah Peerwani, On the Hermeneutics of the Light Verse of the Qur ‘an (London: ICAS Press, 2004).
Colin Turner, Challenging Islamic Fundamentalism: The Three Principles of Mulla Sadra (London: Routledge, 2011).

c. Secondary Books in European Languages

Alparslan Açikgenç, Being and Existence in Sadra and Heidegger: A Comparative Ontology (Kuala Lumpur: International Institute of Islamic Thought and Civilization, 1993).
Reza Akbarian, The Fundamentals of Mulla Sadra’s Transcendent Philosophy (London: Xlibris, 2009).
Reza Akbarian, Islamic Philosophy: Mulla Sadra and the Quest of “Being” (London: Xlibris, 2009).
Cécile Bonmariage, Le Réel et les réalités: Mulla Sadra Shirazi et la structure de la réalité (Paris: Vrin, 2008).
Maria Massi Dakake,”Hierarchies of Knowing in Mulla Sadra’s Commentary on Usul al-Kafi.” Journal of Islamic Philosophy 6 (2010).
Mahdi Dehbashi, Transubstantial Motion and the Natural World (London: ICAS Press, 2010).
Max Horten, Das philosophische System von Schirázi (Strasbourg: Trübner, 1913).
Christian Jambet, The Act of Being: The Philosophy of Revelation in Mulla Sadra. Jeff Fort (trans.). (New York: Zone Books, 2006).
Christian Jambet, Mort et résurrection en islam: L’audelàselon Mulla Sadra (Paris: Albin Michel, 2008).
Christian Jambet, Se rendre immortel (Saint Clémentde Rivière: Fata Morgana, 2002).
Ibrahim Kalin, Knowledge in Later Islamic Philosophy. Mulla Sadra on Existence, Intellect, and Intuition (New York: Oxford University Press, 2010).
Muhammad Kamal. From Essence to Being: The Philosophy of Mulla Sadra and Martin Heidegger (London: ICAS Press, 2010).
Muhammad Kamal, Mulla Sadra’s Transcendent Philosophy (Aldershot: Ashgate, 2006).
Sayeh Meisami, Mulla Sadra (Oxford: Oneworld, 2013).
Mahmoud Khatami, From a Sadrean POint of View: Toward an Ontetic Elimination of the Subjectivistic Self (London: London Academy of Iranian Studies, 2004).
Megawati Moris, Mulla Sadra’s Doctrine of the Primacy of Existence ( KualaLumpur: ISTAC, 2003).
Zailan Moris, Revelation, Intellectual Intuition and Reason in the Philosophy of Mulla Sadra: An Analysis of the al-Hikmahal‘Arshiyyah (London: RoutledgeCurzon, 2002).
Seyyed Hossein Nasr, Sadr al-Din Shirazi and His Transcendent Theosophy. 2nd ed. (Tehran: Institute for Humanities and Cultural Studies, 1997).
Fazlur Rahman, The Philosophy of Mulla Sadra (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1975).
Sajjad Rizvi, Mulla Sadra Shirazi: His Life and Works and the Sources for Safavid Philosophy (Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2007).
Sajjad Rizvi, Mulla Sadra and Metaphysics: Modulation of Being (London: Routledge, 2009).
Mohammed Rustom, “Psychology, Eschatology, Imagination, in Mulla Sadra Shirazi’s Commentary on the Hadith of Awakening,” Islam & Science, vol 5 (summer 2007) No 1.
Mohammed Rustom, The Triumph of Mercy: Philosophy and Scripture in Mulla Sadra (Albany: State University of New York Press, 2012).
Mahdi Ha’iri Yazdi, The Principles of Epistemology in Islamic Philosophy: Knowledge by Presence (Albany: State University of New York Press, 1992).

Author Information

Sayeh Meisami
Email: smeisami1@udayton.edu
University of Dayton

Zhang Junmai (Carsun Chang, 1887—1969)

Zhang Junmai (Chang Chun-mai), also known as Carsun Chang, was an important twentieth-century Chinese thinker and a representative of modern Chinese philosophy. Zhang’s participation in “The Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists” of 1923, in which he defended his Neo-Confucian views against those of Chinese progressives and scientists, made a strong philosophical impression on an entire generation of Chinese intellectuals by championing the value of traditional Confucian truth claims and asserting the limits of scientific knowledge. Subsequently, Zhang’s two-volume study of The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought (1957) and his Manifesto for the Reappraisal of Chinese Culture (1958) cemented his identification with Confucianism, and the view of Confucianism as compatible with modernity, in the English-speaking philosophical world. Despite his association with Confucianism, Zhang was deeply influenced by the work of the French thinker Henri Bergson and exponents of German Idealism, particularly Immanuel Kant and Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel. Zhang is best known today, however, not for his original philosophical work but rather for his political activities during China’s Republican era (1912-1949), through which he and his “Third Force” party attempted to mediate between the polarized Nationalist and Communist factions in the Chinese political landscape, as well as his promotion of Neo-Confucian studies in the West. His personal motto was, “Do not forget philosophy because of politics, and do not forget politics because of philosophy.” Due perhaps to his acknowledgment of Western influences as well as his involvement in politics, Zhang remains one of the modern Confucian movement’s most understudied figures, especially in comparison to his contemporaries Feng Youlan and Mou Zongsan. Yet his dual participation in both philosophy and politics makes him an exemplary Confucian and an embodiment of the Neo-Confucian ideal of “the unity of knowledge and action” (zhixing heyi).

Early Life
The Debate of 1923 and Zhang’s Moral Metaphysics
Political Philosophy
Confucianism and Chinese Modernity
Influence and Key Interpreters
References and Further Reading
1. Primary Works
2. Secondary Studies

1. Early Life

The man known as Zhang Junmai was born Zhang Jiasen, son of a merchant family in the Jiading district of China’s Jiangsu Province, on January 18, 1887. His early education included the memorization of the Four Books and Five Classics of traditional Confucianism. At the age of eleven, however, his forward-thinking family sent him to study Western history and science as well as the English language, although he continued to read the work of influential Neo-Confucian thinkers such as Zhu Xi. At the age of fifteen, he passed the district-level civil service examination and earned the basic shengyuan or xiucai degree, which entitled its bearers to exemption from corvée labor and corporal punishments and granted them access to local government facilities. After continuing his studies for a few more years, Zhang taught English in Hunan Province for two years before traveling to Tōkyō, Japan in 1906 and enrolling in Waseda University’s undergraduate program in economics and political science. Like many other Chinese intellectuals of that era, he intended to take advantage of Japan’s recent and rapid modernization by studying Western thought while remaining within an East Asian cultural context.

In Japan, Zhang befriended the constitutional monarchist Liang Qichao (1873-1929), a political reformer whose activities led to his exile in 1898. Zhang began to publish articles in Liang’s biweekly, New Citizen (Xinmin Congbao), including translations of excerpts from John Stuart Mill’s Considerations on Representative Government. Zhang’s other activities within expatriate Chinese circles included participation in the creation of the Political Information Society (Zhengwen she), which competed with Sun Yat-sen’s United League (Tongmeng hui) for the hearts and minds of reform-minded Chinese of the period. After graduating from Waseda in 1911, he returned to China and successfully passed the entrance examination for the Hanlin Academy, a prestigious Confucian college founded in the eighth century. However, the Hanlin Academy, like other official Confucian institutions, soon fell victim to the Chinese Revolution, which swept away this and other vestiges of imperial rule in favor of a more democratic and scientifically-minded “New China.” Unable to pursue his dream of becoming a government official, Zhang returned to his ancestral home, where he was appointed chairman of the local parliament. Soon afterward, Zhang’s publication of an article critical of government policy toward Mongolia led to his proscription, and he fled to Germany to avoid repression.

In Germany, as in Japan, Zhang once more pursued academic studies, registering at the University of Berlin for preparatory coursework that would lead to enrollment in the University’s doctoral program in law and political science. World events disrupted his plans yet again when the First World War broke out in 1914. Zhang turned his attention to the ongoing conflict, publishing articles in about the European political and military situations in Chinese newspapers. In 1915, Zhang traveled to England before returning to China one year later to assume the editorship of the newspaper New Current Affairs (Shishi xinbao) and teach law at Beijing University. With the conclusion of hostilities in 1919, Zhang toured Europe in the company of Liang Qichao and other Chinese intellectuals and attempted to intervene in the transfer of sovereignty over China’s Shandong Province (the home region of Confucius) from Germany to Japan by the Peace Conference of Versailles that ended the war. Having recently produced a Chinese translation of the American president Woodrow Wilson’s “Fourteen Points,” which justified the Allies’ use of force in the name of democracy and national self-determination, Zhang was devastated and rapidly lost interest in politics, turning his attention “from social sciences to philosophy,” as he later called this crucial transition in his life.

In January 1921, Zhang met with Rudolf Eucken (1846–1926) in Jena, Germany. This encounter was perhaps one of the most important turning points in Zhang’s life. After a brief interview, Zhang decided to stay in Jena to learn philosophy under Eucken’s patronage. Studying with Eucken opened Zhang’s mind to new sets of ideas, especially those of Henri Bergson (1859-1941), and questions of life, ethics and culture gained a more important place in his thought. In 1922, Zhang collaborated with Eucken in the writing of a book in German entitled Das Lebensproblem in China und in Europa (The Problem of Human Life in China and Europe). The first half of the book, written by Eucken, was a short introduction to the history of European conceptions of life, while the second half, written by Zhang, dealt with the outlooks on life found in the work of major Chinese philosophers. Although Zhang’s treatment of Chinese thought was mainly historical in perspective, this text marks the first occasion on which he drew parallels between Confucian traditions and the philosophy of Kant. Here, Zhang argued that Confucius’ dictum that “what the superior man seeks is in himself, while what the petty man seeks is in others” (Analects 15:21) was comparable to Kant’s claim that the sources of morality are to be found within oneself. Thus, in Zhang’s view, both Confucianism and Kantianism see human morality as grounded in human nature and thus autonomous.

Despite Zhang’s immersion in philosophical studies, he remained active in politics. During his time in Germany, he met with many activists and leaders, including the social democrat Philip Scheidemann (1865–1939) and the architect of Germany’s post-war constitution, Hugo Preuss (1860–1925). These encounters with Weimar Republic intellectuals helped to form Zhang’s conceptions of socialism and exerted a lasting influence on his dual life in politics and philosophy. Both aspects of this dual life were expressed in his participation in “the Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists” of 1923.

2. The Debate of 1923 and Zhang’s Moral Metaphysics

Having returned to China, in February 1923 Zhang gave a speech at Beijing’s Qinghua School (later Qinghua University) about the differences between science and what he called “outlooks on life” (rensheng guan). In this speech, Zhang claimed that the former is characterized by “objectivity,” “logic,” “analytic methods,” “causality,” and “uniform phenomena,” while the latter are “subjective,” “intuitive,” and “synthetic,” based on “free will.” Moreover, he defended the idea that, in her path to modernization, China should not only consider the sciences but also ought to define a new way, based on the “outlooks on life” of ancient Chinese sages. Zhang’s position drew considerable criticism from intellectuals associated with the anti-traditional May Fourth Movement, especially the famous geologist Ding Wenjiang (1887–1936). The difference of opinion between Zhang and Ding developed into a major political and philosophical event in the intellectual history of Republican China and became known as “the Debate between Metaphysicians and Scientists.” This debate played an important role in the emergence of a neo-conservative trend in modern Chinese thought by raising the questions of what place science ought to have in modern Chinese society and whether scientism and positivism ought to influence modern Chinese worldviews. The debate also played an important role in the development of Zhang’s philosophy insofar as it prompted the first publication of Zhang’s philosophical views in Chinese.

By 1923, Zhang’s conception of himself as a “realist idealist” (weishi de weixin zhuyi)—one who refused to sacrifice empirical issues for the sake of his deeply-held ideals—was fully established. Because of Zhang’s attraction to the thought of Bergson and Eucken, he was often criticized as an “anti-rationalist” (fan lixing zhuyi zhe). What his critics appear to have had in mind was not an opposition to reason on Zhang’s part, but rather his concern to avoid the over-use of the “process of abstraction” (chouxiang licheng). On Zhang’s view, when considering abstractions such as “Humanity” or “Nature,” one should always keep in mind that they are real and in front of us. Instead of building abstract systems and concepts, Zhang wanted to construct a philosophy that would embrace the reality and the fullness of the universe.

Zhang founded his “realist idealist” philosophy on the basis of a classically dualistic conception of the world. On the one hand, there is matter (wuzhi or wu); on the other hand, there is spirit (jingshen) or mind (xin). Zhang rejected monistic conceptions of the world as incoherent, going so far as to translate the English philosopher C. E. M. Joad’s Mind and Matter, which advocated the same position, in 1926. Zhang’s dichotomy between mind and matter is a structural division in his philosophy, which generates a series of opposing notions: matter is outside (wai) of the self and is fixed (ding), while mind or spirit is always inside (nei) the self and in motion (dong). The material world of nature is governed by causality, while the spiritual world of humanity is conducted by free will (ziyou yizhi). In later years, when discussing the relation between liberty (ziyou) and power (quanli) in political philosophy, Zhang categorized the former as belonging to the realm of spirit and the latter as relative to matter. His division between science and “outlooks on life” thus is an extension of these binary oppositions that are basic to his thought.

Zhang regarded science (kexue) as a plural signifier and subdivided it into two types: “material sciences” (wuzhi kexue) and “spiritual sciences” (jingshen kexue). This opposition was based on the German distinction between “natural sciences” (Naturwissenschaften or Exactewissenchaften) and “spiritual sciences” (Geistwissenchaften). While his opponents advocated science as one universal epistemology based on specific methodology, Zhang argued that one should consider sciences according to their objects, which could be any of three types: “inert” (si zhi wu), “alive” (huo zhi wu), or “alive and thinking” (youhuo yousi zhi wu). Incapable of moving by themselves, inert objects are bound to follow the rules of causality. Their movements can be explained by natural laws, and it is the purpose of material sciences to discover and analyze these laws. For instance, astronomy aims at explaining how planets gravitate around the sun. On Zhang’s account, physics and astronomy are the most archetypal material sciences.

Although plants and animals lack “mind” in Zhang’s sense, they are alive nonetheless, so for Zhang, their analysis raises further issues. Unlike inert objects, plants and animals can move on their own, so despite the fact that causality applies to them, it doesn’t explain everything. But Zhang insisted that the presence of life in itself couldn’t be questioned by science. Following the ideas of the German vitalist Hans Driesch (1867–1941)—who was at that time visiting in China, where Zhang served as his translator—Zhang seems to believe that there is an entelechy, a driving principle that directs life and its development without being part of the soul or the organism, the existence of which precludes questioning its manifestation. To Zhang, the very foundations of life were completely impossible to analyze. Therefore, biology was not literally “the science of what is alive” but only the science that analyzes the material structure and development of living animals and plants

As for what Zhang called “spiritual sciences”—by which he meant something like social sciences—these moved beyond the realm of matter and were capable of analyzing humanity itself. Yet all the natural laws that could be found in those sciences were always linked to a material aspect of life. For instance, Zhang accepted that there were laws of development in economy; economy and society were at some point to follow specific patterns. But he insisted that these laws could only be found because there are material and fixed data to analyze. Economics, for example, deals with manufactured goods. On Zhang’s account, spiritual sciences could discover and analyze laws of nature only if their object was somehow linked to something material. Even if there are laws that condition the development of social phenomena, human beings still can use their minds and free will to modify the situation. For that reason, social laws or historical patterns can only be sought in the past. Following Bergson, Zhang noted that the human spirit is in perpetual transformation (xin zhi wanbian): it is impossible to divide thought into fixed mental states, as our minds are always on the move (dong). Having no place to settle, no analysis can be made. Therefore, for Zhang, there cannot be any real psychology, but only physiology, a study of the relation between stimuli and the mind. According to Zhang, science cannot predict the future of humanity, which is why he rejected Marxism.

In contrast to such “sciences,” Zhang outlined his understanding of “outlooks on life” as a coherent alternative to claiming that everything could be understood and controlled by Science. In her fight for a new culture (xin wenhua), China was to cast away naturalism and positivism, and develop a new “outlook on life,” based on both Western modernity and the teachings of the ancient Chinese sages, that did not exclude or condemn metaphysics. Zhang even claimed that the introduction of Bergson’s and Eucken’s philosophies to China could give birth to “Neo-Song [Dynasty] Learning” (xin songxue 新宋學), just as the introduction of Buddhism to China had permitted the emergence of the original Neo-Confucianism of the Song dynasty (songxue).

In Eucken’s philosophy, humanity is a being at the frontier of matter and spirit, and is in a perpetual struggle to achieve a spiritual life that can overcome his material nature. By promoting metaphysics, Zhang wished to foster human spiritual life and dismiss a scientistic conception of the world that would bind human beings in the web of material causality. Borrowing from Eucken’s Die Lebenschauungen der grossen denker (Outlooks on Life of the Great Thinkers, 1890), Zhang defined “outlook on life” as follows:

The observations, holds, hopes, and demands that I have toward the persons and the objects external to myself—that’s what I call an outlook on life. (Zhang 1981, p. 935)

Outlooks on life are not under the control of sciences. They find their source in the self (wo). Considering that “toward the world, man’s life is inner as spirit and outer as matter” (ibid.), outlooks on life are in fact what link our spiritual life with the material world. Even if people of the past can be models to follow (Zhang 1981, p. 913), everyone ought to develop his own outlook on life according to what his heart-mind (xin) tells him. That is what Zhang called the mandate of moral conscience (liangxin zhi ming). For Zhang as for other Confucians, the heart-mind is the center of the self; every moral thought and volition is generated from it. Having three principal functions, knowledge (zhi 智), emotions (qing 情) and will (zhi 志), it is what makes us human. In total opposition to the view defended by Hu Shi (1891-1962) at that time, Zhang argued that the difference between humans and animals is qualitative, not quantitative. The use of such concepts and terminology shows how deep the influence of Mencius’ and Wang Yangming’s moral thought on Zhang was. As a thinker who was steeped in Confucian tradition, Zhang considered human beings to be good by nature and wanted to promote Neo-Confucian metaphysics as a means to cultivate oneself (xiushen).

Finally, a word should be said about Zhang’s debt to Kant, which was the result of his lifelong infatuation with this eighteenth-century German thinker. Zhang’s epistemology was mainly drawn from Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason (1781); he considered Kant to be the man who “had succeeded in harmonizing British empiricism and German rationalism” (Zhang 1981, p. 949). For Zhang, knowledge is the result of an encounter between material sense information and the innate categories of the mind. Human beings have innate categories or “concepts of reason” (lixing zhi gainian) that enable them to understand, classify, and aggregate all of their sensations (ganjue). It is these concepts of reason that link sensations to meanings (yiyi). Later, Zhang suggested that knowledge, built up from the encounter of sensations and concepts of reason, is always internal to one’s mind. For instance, in 1957, he wrote that the Song dynasty Confucian thinker Ch’eng I’s statement ”Human nature is reason” [(xing ji li ye], “means nothing other than the rationalist doctrine that forms of thought exist a priori in the mind” (Chang 1957, p. 35). For Zhang, the key philosophical question was that of the relationship between a mind able of knowing (zhizhi zhi xin) and the myriad things (wanwu zhi you) or phenomenal universe, through which knowledge of all that exists, materially and spiritually, could be integrated. Assuming that the principle of mind (xin li) is universal, Zhang anticipated that the development of thought ought to be somehow similar in every culture. This argument would form the basis of his claim that a genuine Chinese modernity was possible.

3. Political Philosophy

Despite Zhang’s leap “from social sciences to philosophy,” he did not abandon political life. On the contrary, he participated in the drafting of a new Chinese constitution and wrote

On the Meaning of Constitutions (1921). He struggled to introduce socialism in China. Very much taken with the newly-established Weimar Republic in Germany, Zhang wished to establish a very similar political system in China. In 1923, he opened a “Political Institute” in the suburbs of Shanghai, the aim of which was to form a new political elite that would be able to shape the nation’s affairs in future years. Under its auspices, Chinese students were exposed to political philosophy, economics, sociology, and international relations as well as Zhang’s critiques of both the Chinese Communist Party and the Guomindang (Kuomintang, KMT) or Chinese Nationalist Party, which contended against each other for political and later military supremacy throughout the 1920s, ’30s, and ’40s. After the KMT occupation of Shanghai in 1927, Zhang was forced to close the Institute and ventured into underground political activities. With Li Huang (1895—1991), a leader of the Chinese Youth Party (Zhongguo qingnian dang), he illegally published a journal, The New Way (Xinlu), in which he proclaimed his political values:

[D]emocratic government, opposition to both one-class and one-party dictatorships, freedom of speech and association, opposition to the denial of these basic human rights under the pretext of party or military rule, the opposition to party control of education, of judicial affairs, of civil servants, and the use of the army for personal or party purposes. (Chi, p. 141)

These points can be regarded as the key ideas of Zhang’s political thought at the time. In opposition to nationalist and communist conceptions of the political power in China, Zhang totally forbade the political parties to indoctrinate their members, to use military force or to practice dictatorial politics—all of which may have prevented Zhang’s own political parties from ever succeeding in the brutal political climate of China during the 1930s. Frustrated by chronic repression at the hands of the KMT, Zhang fled China once again and returned to Germany, where he obtained a position as Professor of Chinese Philosophy at the University of Jena through the assistance of Eucken’s former students. Eventually, he returned to China just before Japanese invasion of Manchuria in September 1931. In this politically-charged and highly unstable climate, Zhang assumed professorial duties in philosophy at Yanjing University in Beijing, teaching mostly about Hegel, before being ejected from his position as a result of his critical stance vis-a-vis the KMT government. Siding with the warlord Chen Jitang, the de facto ruler of Guangdong Province, Zhang again found work as a professor of philosophy, this time teaching Neo-Confucianism—first at Sun Yat-sen University and later at his own Learning Ocean Academy (Xuehai Shuyuan).

At this institution, which blended traditional Confucian education with what Zhang saw as the best of Western learning (humanities, social sciences, and physical education), he was able to put into practice what he had defended during the debate of 1923: an education that would place equal and shared emphasis on the humanities (especially metaphysics), the arts, sports, and of course the sciences. In 1939, Zhang opened another such school: the Institute of National Culture (Minzu Wenhua Xueyuan), the guiding documents of which stated:

The objectives of this academy are as follows: one, to achieve one’s personality; two, to temper and foster intelligence in order to contribute to the world scholarship; three, to deploy these activities, in which moral and knowledge are one, to participate grandly in the ordering of the world (or statecraft). (Zhang 1981, p. 1435)

To participate in the world, either as politicians or as scholars, students were first to develop their personality. For Zhang, such psychological development, along with physical ability and intellectual knowledge, were all necessary to become a full human being. Self-cultivation through education, in turn, was key to the development of Chinese democracy, which was Zhang’s primary political commitment. In his political philosophy, there is a very strong bond between the people and the idea of the State. Democracy should not be implemented from above, but rather it should arise from the heart-minds of citizens. Influenced by Confucian ethics, Zhang appears to have viewed democracy through the prism of the canonical Confucian text known as the Daxue (Great Learning), which states:

To bring the world at peace, one should first govern one’s State; to govern one’s State, one should first order one’s family; to order one’s family, one should first cultivate oneself.

Zhang believed that the Chinese people would permit the emergence of democracy as the result of their own self-cultivation. For him, the State was no longer understood as a simple technical term of political science. It was the realization of the spirit of a people, founded on the basis of law and morality. Borrowing the Hegelian idea that “State is the realization of the Spirit [or Reason]” (guojia zhe jingshen zhi shixian ye), Zhang linked the question of the State with a certain humanism and a valorization of Chinese culture. The emergence of a new political system was to be the result of a New Culture (xin wenhua), from which would emerge a new outlook on life. Unfortunately, Zhang’s academies never stayed open very long. The Ocean Learning Academy was active for only two years, while the Institute of National Culture was closed in 1942, after three years of operation.

4. Confucianism and Chinese Modernity

As was the case with Zhang’s moral metaphysics and political philosophy, so also in his understanding of culture did Zhang cleave closely to his Confucian heritage. His philosophy of culture upheld a certain conservatism, according to which both Chinese cultural unity and Chinese social development could proceed organically from a shared basis in Neo-Confucian thought. In The Chinese Culture of Tomorrow (1936), which can be regarded as a response to Liang Shuming’s Eastern and Western Cultures and Their Philosophies (1921), Zhang defended this view:

Spiritual freedom [jingshen ziyou] is the foundation of a national culture [minzu wenhua] and therefore it should be the central principle to direct the politics, the sciences and the arts of China from now on. (Zhang 2006b, p. 1)

Zhang argued that a culture is a spiritual entity that is created by, and evolved through, the free contributions of its people—not a static expression of an ahistorical will, as Liang claimed. The nation is in fact the group of persons that build a cultural unity and live together within it. The influence of the Western philosophers of history Oswald Spengler (1880-1936) and Arnold Toynbee (1889-1975) can be seen in Zhang’s view. Zhang understood European modernity to be the result of a threefold historical process, which consisted of (1) religious reform (zongjiao gaige), (2) scientific development (kexue fazhan), and (3) the emergence of democratic government (minzhu zhengzhi). The challenge for China, therefore, lay not with importing European modernity, but rather with completing its own historical process of development in evolutionary terms specific to Chinese culture.

Like many Chinese intellectuals of the early twentieth century, Zhang advocated the need for a “New Culture”; like his rival Liang, Zhang believed that Chinese culture would become the global culture of the future. However, Zhang believed that this “New Culture” would develop only in response to the intellectual challenge represented by the West, just as Neo-Confucianism had developed in response to the intellectual challenge represented by the introduction of Buddhism from India—an historical event to which Zhang repeatedly referred as a positive precedent for China’s ability to adapt to foreign systems of thought. As “the culture of harmony,” Chinese culture would find the middle way (zhezhong) between all global philosophical and cultural trends—but only if she initiated the first step in the threefold historical process by rediscovering and reviving the “Chinese national spirit” (Zhonghua minzu jingshen), which Zhang identified with Neo-Confucianism. After China revived the quintessence of her past culture—that is, Neo-Confucianism as interpreted by Zhang—she would be able to formulate a new outlook on life, which in turn would give birth to a new culture. From this new culture, a new political system and a new economic organization soon would follow.

However, unlike many Chinese intellectuals of the era who defended a racial conception of the nation, Zhang had no interest in the question of blood lineage. As he pointed out in The Chinese Culture of Tomorrow (1936) and The Way to Establish the State (1938), one could not find any racial unity in China; since various “barbarian” invasions had produced a “blood mix” in the population, the blood of the Han ethnic majority was no longer “pure.” Constructing a blood-based nationalism would be irrelevant and self-destructive, but constructing a culture-based nationalism was another matter:

I won’t dare say that in History there was such a thing as a pure blood Han nation, however I can attest that there is a Han Culture, which embodies the language spoken, the characters used, the calendar, the customs, the rites and so on. (Zhang 2006d, p. 9)

Zhang’s activity as a non-aligned political thinker was curtailed by the end of cooperation between the KMT and the Chinese Communist Party in 1941, and he was placed under house arrest because of his opposition to KMT policies. In 1944, he was released and traveled to the United States, where he attended the founding meeting of the United Stations. While in the United States, Zhang renewed his interest in constitutionalism and spent much of his time studying the American Constitution. After returning to China in 1946, he began to argue that a conception of human rights, or at least its seeds, could be found in the Chinese intellectual tradition, especially in the thought of Mencius. His work became the basis of the Constitution of the Republic of China adopted in 1946, which is still in effect in Taiwan today. The implementation of the Constitution failed to resolve China’s ongoing civil war, however, and with the triumph of Communist forces in 1949, Zhang fled to a life of exile in Hong Kong.

In Hong Kong, Zhang produced The Third Force in China and initiated the modern Chinese discourse on democracy’s roots in Chinese tradition. Having identified elements of democratic sensibilities in ancient Chinese texts, Zhang held out hope that the establishment of democracy in China still was possible despite the victory of Communism on the mainland. He even suggested that the Enlightenment and the development of democratic ideas in the West during the eighteenth century were made possible due to the introduction of Confucian thought to Europe by Jesuit missionaries a century earlier. Thus, in Zhang’s view, Confucius and Mencius were the hidden sources of the West’s Enlightenment. Moreover, Zhang regarded Marxism as being in total opposition to the “Chinese outlook on life,” and anticipated the eventual decline of Communist ideology in China. In 1957 and 1962, he issued in English the two volumes of his magnum opus on the intellectual history of China, The Development of Neo-Confucian Thought, which opens with the following sentence:

China is the land of Confucianism. (Chang 1957, p.15)

In Zhang’s biographically-focused and comparatively-oriented account of Neo-Confucianism, rooted in his conception of “outlooks on life” in the East and the West, he criticized Communism as an alien system of thought that would not take root in Chinese culture, which he believed was characterized by Confucianism despite the influence of other traditions. Identifying himself as a twentieth century “Neo-Confucian,” Zhang continued to advocate what he saw as a genuine Chinese Confucian modernity until his death at age eighty-two in the United States in 1969, which also marked the height of the Communists’ “Cultural Revolution” campaign against Confucianism and other emblems of Chinese tradition.

5. Influence and Key Interpreters

Zhang’s involvement in the production of A Manifesto on the Reappraisal of Chinese Culture (1958), a document that aimed to promote an appreciation of Chinese culture among Western intellectuals, marks him as one of the key influences on the modern “New Confucian” movement, which seeks to promote Confucianism as a spiritual tradition that is fully compatible with democracy, science, and other aspects of modernity. Zhang’s participation in this movement probably stands as his foremost legacy in the world of contemporary Chinese philosophy.

Despite Zhang’s stature as a founder of New Confucianism and a promoter of Neo-Confucian studies in the West, he is little studied today, especially by Western scholars. Most Western research on Zhang’s thought has focused on his political philosophy and activism—an approach exemplified by the work of Roger B. Jeans (1997). Studies that depart from this rule include those of Umberto Bresciani (2001) and Edmund S.K. Fung (2003). German scholars have taken a particular interest in the ways in which Zhang’s work might apply to resolving modern problems, such as the deterioration of social relationships and the spiritual vacuum perceived in contemporary societies. Werner Messner (1994) has devoted attention to the tension between the process of modernization and the will to find a specific way (Sonderweg) for China in the thought of modern Chinese philosophers, especially Zhang.

Unsurprisingly, interest in Zhang’s work has been greater in the Chinese-speaking world, especially outside of mainland China. Zhang’s friends and associates produced much of the early scholarship on his thought. Xue Huayuan’s 1993 study of Zhang’s political activity ranks with Jeans’ work among the major research on Zhang produced to date. Within mainland China, for many years Zhang’s thought was proscribed because his idealist views and “bourgeois” background. Even after studies of Zhang by mainland Chinese scholars began to appear in the 1990s, many—such as those by Lü Xichen and Chen Ying (1996)—were harshly critical of his shortcomings as seen from a Marxist perspective. More recently, Zheng Dahua (1997, 1999) has produced more sympathetic scholarship on Zhang’s thought, while Chai Wenhua (2004) has explored Zhang’s conception of culture in particular. Most recently, Weng Hekai’s work (2010) focuses on Zhang’s contributions to the question of Chinese nation-building, especially the influence of John Stuart Mill to Zhang’s thinking about this issue. As interest in Zhang’s special concerns, such as Chinese cultural unity, constitutionalism, and an authentically Chinese modernity, intensifies in contemporary China, interest in Zhang’s legacy is sure to increase there and elsewhere.

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

Chang, Carsun. The Third Force in China, New York: Bookman Associates, 1952.
Chang, Carsun. The Development of Neo-Confucian thought. 2 vols. New York: Bookman Associates, 1957-1962.
Chang, Carsun. Wang Yang-ming: Idealist Philosopher of Sixteenth-Century China. Jamaica, NY: St. John’s University Press, 1962.
Chang, Carsun, and Rudolf Eucken. Das Lebensproblem in China und in Europa, Leipzig: Quelle & Meyer, 1922.
Chang, Carsun, and Kalidas Nag. China and Gandhian India. Calcutta: The Book Company, 1956.
Zhang, Junmai. Guoxian yi (1921). In Xian Zheng zhi dao (Beijing: Qianghua daxue chubanshe, 2006a).
Zhang, Junmai. Minzu fuxing de xueshu jichu (1935). Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006b.
Zhang, Junmai. Mingri zhi Zhongguo wenhua (1936). Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006c.
Zhang, Junmai. Li guo zhi dao (1938). In Xian Zheng zhi dao (Beijing: Qianghua daxue chubanshe, 2006d).
Zhang, Junmai. Yili xue shi jiang gangyao (1955). Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006.
Zhang, Junmai. Bijiao Zhong Ri Yangming xue. Taibei: Taiwan shangwu yinshu guan, 1955.
Zhang, Junmai. Bianzheng weiwu zhuyi bolun. Hong Kong: Youlian chubanshe, 1958.
Zhang, Junmai. Zhongguo zhuanzhi junzhu zhengzhi pingyi. Taibei: Hongwen guan chubanshe, 1986.
Zhang, Junmai. Rujia zhexue zhi fuxing. Beijing: Zhongguo renmin daxue chubanshe, 2006.
Zhang, Junmai, and Wenxi Cheng. Zhong Xi Yin zhexue wenji. 2 vols. Taibei: Taiwan xuesheng shuju, 1970.
Zhang, Junmai, and Huayuan Xue. Yijiusijiu nian yihou Zhang Junmai yanlun ji. Taibei : Daoxiang chubanshe, 1989.

b. Secondary Studies

Bresciani, Umberto. Reinventing Confucianism: The New Confucian Movement. Taipei: Taipei Ricci Institute for Chinese Studies, 2001.
Chai, Wenhua. Xiandai xin ruxue wenhua guan yanjiu. Beijing: Xinhua shudian, 2004.
Chen, Huifen. “Minzu xing, Shidai xing, Zizhu xing: 1930 niandai Zhang Junmai de wenhua jueze.” Taiwan shida lishi xuebao 28 (June 2000): 109–158.
Chen, Xianchu. Jingshen ziyou yu minzu fuxing – Zhang Junmai sixiang zonglun. Changsha: Hunan Jiaoyu chubanshe, 1999.
Chi, Wen-shun. Ideological conflicts in Modern China: Democracy and Authoritarianism. New Brunswick: Transaction Books, 1986.
Fang, Shiduo, ed. Zhang Junmai zhuanji ziliao. 8 vols. Taibei: Tianyi, 1979-1981.
Frohlich, Thomas. Staatsdenken im China der Republikzeit (1912–1949): Die Instrumentalisierung philosophischer Ideen bei chinesischen Intellektuellen. Frankfurt: Campus Verlag, 2000.
Fung, Edmund S.K. “New Confucianism and Chinese Democratization: The Thought and Predicament of Zhang Junmai.” Twentieth Century China 28/2 (April 2003): 41-71.
He, Xinquan (Ho Hsin-Chuan). “Zhang Junmai de Xinruxue qimeng jihua : yi ge xiandai vs. Houxiandai shidu.” Taiwan dongya wenming yanjiu xuekan 8/1/15 (July 2011): 209-234.
Hung, Mao-hsiung. Carsun Chang (1887–1969) und seine Vorstellung vom Sozialismus in China. Ph.D. diss. Ludwig-Maximilians-Universität, 1980.
Jeans, Roger B. Syncretism in Defense of Confucianism: An Intellectual and Political Biography of Early Years of Chang Chünmai, 1887-1923. Ph.D. diss., George Washington University, 1974.
Jeans, Roger B. Democracy and socialism in Republican China: the politics of Zhang Junmai (Carsun Chang), 1906-1941. Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield, 1997.
Jiang, Yongzhen. “Zhang Junmai.” In Shounan Wang, ed., Zhongguo lidai sixiang jia (Taipei: Taiwan shangwu yinshu guan faxing, 1987), 10: 6230-6352.
Liu, Yilin, and Qingfeng Luo. Zhang Junmai pinglun. Nanchang: Bai hua zhou wenyi chubanshe, 1996.
Lü, Xichen, and Ying Chen. Xin ruxue: Zhang Junmai sixiang yanjiu. Tianjin: Tianjin renmin chubanshe, 1996.
Meissner, Werner. China zwischen nationalem “Sonderweg”, und universaler Modernisierung – Zur Rezeption westlichen Denkens in China. Munich: Wilhelm Fink Verlag, 1994.
Peterson, Kent McLean. A Political Biography of Zhang Junmai, 1887-1949. Ph.D. diss., Princeton University, 1999.
Tan, Chester C. Chinese Political Thought in the 20^th Century. Melbourne: Wren Pub., 1972.
Weng, Hekai. Xiandai Zhongguo de Ziyou minzu zhuyi: Zhang Junmai Minzu jianguo sixiang pingzhuan. Beijing: Falü chubanshe, 2010.
Xu, Jilin. Wuqiong de kunhuo: Huang Yanpei, Zhang Junmai yu xiandai Zhongguo. Shanghai: Sanlian shudian, 1998.
Xue, Huayuan. Minzhu xianzheng yu minzu zhuyi de bianzheng fazhan: Zhang Junmai sixiang yanjiu. Taibei: Daohe chubanshe, 1993.
Yang, Yongqian. Zhonghua minguo xianfa zhi fu: Zhang Junmai zhuanji. Taibei: Tangshan, 1993.
Ye, Qizhong (Yap Key-chong). “Cong Zhang Junmai he Ding Wenjiang liang ren he Renshengguan yi wen kan 1923 nian ‘Ke Xuan lunzhan’ de baofa yu kuozhan.” Zhongyang yanjiu yuan jindai shi yanjiu shuo jikan 25 (June 1996): 211-267.
Zhang, Rulun. “Zhongguo xiandai sixiang shang de Zhang Junmai.” In Jilin Xu, ed., Ershi Shiji Zhongguo sixiang shi lun (Shanghai: Dongfang chuban zhongxin, 2000), 2:124-153.
Zheng, Dahua. Zhang Junmai zhuan. Beijing: Zhonghua shuju, 1997.
Zheng, Dahua. Zhang Junmai xueshu sixiang pingzhuan. Beijing: Beijing Tushuguan chubanshe, 1999a.
Zheng Dahua. Liangqi qicai – Mingren bixia de Zhang Junmai. Shanghai: Dongfang chuban zhongxin, 1999b.
Zheng, Jiadong. Xiandai xin rujia gailun. Nanning: Guangxi renmin chubanshe, 1990.

Author Information

Joseph Ciaudo
Email: jo.ciaudo@hotmail.fr
Institute of Eastern Languages and Civilizations
France

Music and Social Justice

Protests demanding social justice as the alternative to an unacceptable status quo have been mounted in response to war, political and social inequality, poverty, and other constraints on economic and development opportunities. Although social justice is typically thought of as a political agenda, many justice movements have used music as a way of inviting and maintaining broad-based participation in their initiatives.

Some of this integration of music and social justice has become so deeply embedded in the identity and culture frameworks of particular groups that it is understood today primarily as culturally constitutive. For instance, the tradition of the blues is widely recognized as a distinctively African-American contribution to music, but is not always recognized for its role helping to shape the political consciousness of African-American communities emerging from Reconstruction in the nineteenth century and migrating out of the American South in the twentieth century. The same is true of the interplay between the free jazz of the 1960s and the black-nationalist movement it helped to nurture. Other moments in music and social justice appear in our social and historical narratives less as integration than as accidental convergences which we do not always notice or remember. Examples of music dropping out of the politics, rather than politics dropping out of the music, include cultural inattention to the role music has played in later social protests taking place under the banners of the Occupy movement and UK-Uncut, and to the crucial role that music played in the anti-apartheid movement in South Africa. The paradigm for reciprocity of musical expression and commitment to social justice, on the other hand, is the political protest culture of the United States in the 1960s: the Civil Rights Movement and the anti-Vietnam War movement, in particular.

In his book Rhythm and Resistance, p. 39, Ray Pratt observes that “No music alone can organize one’s ability to invest affectively in the world, [but] one can note powerful contributions of music to temporary emotional states.” It is because of the way music feeds into our emotional lives and because of the sense of social well-being we get from sharing emotional states with others that music so frequently accompanies movements that build, and depend upon, solidarity. This is a contingent association, to be sure, but the absence of logical necessity does not diminish the powerful role music plays in our efforts to build a better world.

Musical Traditions
Contemporary Protest
Academic Attention to Music-Politics Links
References and Further Reading

1. Musical Traditions

Social transformation effected through music—so-called Peace through Art—is an approach that has been under-theorized. One of the few theorizers and practitioners who seeks to advance our understanding of social justice through art and music is John Paul Lederach, whose peace-building work focuses on conflict transformation through sonic capacities to promote social healing. His work with fractured communities emphasizes the restoration of voice, a concept he has found particularly resonant with people who are struggling to repair their violent communities (110, 89). The music and poetry that can aid in this repair is various and highly contextual; to be meaningful to the community who is seeking social justice, the music that accompanies justice-building must be—or be connected to—an organic part of the community’s everyday life. In the interest of providing a sense of the sonic diversity of effective musical backdrops, this account of music and social justice is introduced through a discussion of musical types and traditions.

a. Origins and Impacts of Blues and Jazz

One of the most influential historians of the blues is Amiri Baraka who, writing as Leroi Jones in his first book Blues People, explores the African-American experience of the nation through music. The blues, he explains, is the response of African abductees to their American enslavement, a cultural outpouring developed from work songs and spirituals which represents in microcosm the entire range and nuance of a people’s adaptation to a foreign land they were given no choice but to make into a home. This history of adaptation Baraka traces is one in which the songs become more complex and more secular, leaving aside the theme of deliverance into heaven that characterized African-American musical production in slavery in favor of a more immediately empowering emphasis on self-determination. The blues thus functioned as a repository of cultural engagement, its lyrical content evolving over time to reflect whatever social challenges African-American communities were facing at the time. One notable instance of blues reflecting African-American struggles for respect and legitimacy in the public sphere was the 1941 collaboration between jazz great Count Basie and author Richard Wright (of Native Son fame) on a piece called King Joe (The Joe Louis Blues) that valorized the boxer as the pride of his community at the same moment that anti-lynching campaigns were finally starting to gain traction in the Jim Crow South.

Both Baraka and Albert Murray, another prominent African-American historian of uniquely American music, tell the story of jazz in such a way as to underscore its birth out of the blues. For Baraka, one of the more coherent ways of defining jazz is as a synthesis of European instrumentation and the African-derived polyrhythms that, fundamentally, are the blues—even as jazz developed its own trajectory. Murray’s tracing of this history in Stomping the Blues reiterates this common heritage but concentrates so much on jazz and jazz musicians that a reader who comes to his book looking for an analysis of the blues may feel shortchanged. Yet another treatment of the emergence of the blues and jazz, in Frank Kofsky’s Black Nationalism and the Revolution in Music, tells the story of jazz through a narrative reminiscent of Thomas Kuhn’s Structure of Scientific Revolutions, a story of problem-solving within paradigms that finally, inevitably, break down and must be replaced—as in the case of the shift of musicians like John Coltrane and Ornette Coleman from trying to work their ideas out in bebop to an embrace of free jazz.

Kofsky too endorses the thesis that music and socio-political relations go hand in hand, arguing that we can see in the free jazz that emerged in the early 1960s a kind of “proto-nationalism” which presaged the black nationalist messages of Malcolm X, the Black Panthers, and other “do for self” movements in African-American communities during the 1960s. These movements stressed the need for community self-sufficiency in the face of a systemically racist white majoritarian society and although the black nationalist (a.k.a. black separatist) message was often simplistically opposed to the integrationism attributed to Martin Luther King and the Civil Rights Movement, their community development efforts—after-school arts programs for children, musical benefits to feed people struggling with food insecurity, “neighborhood watch” security efforts—still stand as tangible models for grassroots solidarity. The self-sufficiency message Kofsky finds in jazz proto-nationalism is a celebration of a unique African-American aesthetic, one that contested the aesthetic imperialism of the white critics who promoted the value and determined the negotiating power of the mostly black musicians within the system of white-owned recording and performance institutions. At the height of the free jazz movement, self-sufficiency imperatives were the driving force behind the independent recording facilities and cooperatively owned performance venues with which Coltrane, Coleman, and Charles Mingus, among others, experimented. They were also a factor in the political stances taken by many of the free jazz musicians—anti-war, anti-colonialism, anti-enslavement, and broadly supportive of the Pan-Africanism that flourished in the wake of African decolonization movements. Its most enduring legacy, however, was the credence it gave to a counter-narrative about what constituted aesthetic value. White critics used a theoretical framework developed for Western art music (so-called classical music) to evaluate the originality, authenticity, and artistic complexity of a musical tradition that came out of the African-American experience. But, as a reading of Kofsky’s history together with Henry Louis Gates Jr.’s literary theory in The Signifying Monkey makes clear, the black musicians immersed in the jazz world were developing their own aesthetic—a conception of, for instance, the value of originality that rejects the Eurocentric ideal of the original (as something that has never before been seen in this world) in favor of an understanding that one makes an original contribution when one adds one’s own perspective to an existing cultural product. This revision of what originality means implicates the individual empowerment and attention to existing and nascent community networks that black nationalism’s later advocacy of self-sufficiency promoted.

b. Folk Music, Rock Music, and Protest Songs

The protest songs of folk music have a long history of engagement with social justice struggles for abolition of slavery, universal suffrage, and other human rights agendas, but really began to assert their power during the unionization drives emerging out of the industrialization of wealthy societies. In the United States, some of the most recognizable of these songs that came out of the labor movement include “John Henry” and “Which Side Are You On?” While folk music developed its reputation as the voice of social justice in America in no small part due to the music of Woody Guthrie, Pete Seeger, and Bob Dylan, perhaps the protest song that has had the most profound effect on American political life is the anti-lynching song “Strange Fruit.”

This song’s lyrics were written Jewish schoolteacher Abel Meeropol (who adopted the orphaned sons of Julius and Ethel Rosenberg, the couple executed in 1953 by the US government on the charge that they passed atomic secrets to the Soviet Union) in the 1930s as a response to a grisly photograph of a lynching. Recorded by Billie Holiday and performed as one of her signature pieces, “Strange Fruit” became a widely-heard protest against social injustice, a schooling of audiences about the realities of African-American lives (and deaths) in parts of the United States that practiced lynching (“Strange Fruit: The film” Independent Lens). Jazz critic Leonard Feather once said of “Strange Fruit” that it was “the first significant protest in words and music, the first unmuted cry against racism” (Margolick). Given the history of African-American activism and oratory, Feather’s claim about its ‘first-ness’ is best parsed as hyperbole, but there is no denying the impact this song had on Holiday’s audiences. Margolick recounts fights breaking out in nightclubs after it was performed and Billie Holiday herself being attacked by distraught and traumatized patrons. Despite the emotional toll that singing “Strange Fruit” had on her, Holiday apparently felt a duty to perform it. “I have to sing it,” Margolick quotes her as saying; “[it] goes a long way in telling how they mistreat Negroes down South.” And the impact of the song did play a part in efforts at changing social policy: some of the people who endorsed passage of federal anti-lynching laws sent recordings of “Strange Fruit” to members of Congress, presumably because they felt hearing it would produce an awakening of the legislators’ moral outrage. “Strange Fruit” holds its power, even with the passage of time, and has been called “one of the 10 songs that actually changed the world” (see the November 2003 issue of Q Magazine, a British music magazine).

In the world of rock music—the style that emerged from mainstream white America’s assimilation of rhythm and blues—there is another paradigmatic intersection of music and social justice that can be understood as a rock parallel to folk music’s “Strange Fruit.” More than forty years ago, Jimi Hendrix and the somewhat thrown-together band that was forming in the wake of the Jimi Hendrix Experience played a two hour set as the final musical act of the Woodstock Festival, a performance most remembered for their improvisation upon the American national anthem, “The Star-Spangled Banner” (Daley 52, 55). This moment that has come to symbolize the essence of Woodstock was a masterful performance, and critique, of an anthem whose lyrics valorize the resilience of a people under attack. Shifting between faithful rendition and strategic distortion, Hendrix forcefully shows his audience the moral inconsistency of a nation that sang this song at the same time as it dropped bombs on the people of other nations. The sounds Hendrix pulls out of the guitar in that iconic performance are reminiscent of explosions and squeals of horror at exactly the points one who is singing along would get to “the rockets’ red glare” and “bombs bursting in air.” The message that seems to have entered the popular imagination as a result of Hendrix’s improvisation on “The Star-Spangled Banner” at Woodstock is very clearly an anti-war, anti-imperialist one. In his book Crosstown Traffic, British music journalist Charles Murray concludes that Hendrix’s performance “depicts, as graphically as a piece of music can possibly do, both what the Americans did to the Vietnamese and what they did to themselves” (C. Murray 24; quoted in Daley 57).

c. Post-industrial Musical Contestation: Disco, Punk, and Hip-hop

The music that accompanied industrial decline in Western industrialized nations—notably the United States and the United Kingdom—articulated two distinct responses to the foreclosure of empowerment and idealism that the counterculture of the 1960s had nurtured. Disco, with its elaborate costumes, exhibitionist focus on dance, and attendant drug culture, represented a turning away from political challenges, a refusal to deal with social problems, and a desire for momentary pleasures. Punk, on the other hand, was a howl of rage from working class youth who saw, and rejected in no uncertain terms, the hypocrisy of the social establishment and the increasing inaccessibility of economic opportunities for the socio-economically disadvantaged. Disco was stereotypically identified with African-American performers (albeit predominantly white consumers) whereas punk was typed as a British phenomenon, although, in fact, both musical constituencies could be found in any of the wealthy nations that were starting in the 1970s to wrestle with de-industrialization, wage stagnation, and the corporate restructuring now known as outsourcing.

Elements of both of these musical responses to social marginalization and injustice are synthesized in hip-hop, the most popular musical form for expression of protest worldwide in the following period. In Black Noise: Rap Music and Black Culture in Contemporary America, sociologist Tricia Rose theorizes the hip-hop universe of her youth as emerging from a post-industrial nightmare in which the ethnic poor were being crowded out of public space, and creative protest was fostered in the effort to reclaim for the people the neighborhoods that were being torn apart to build expressways into the city for affluent suburban commuters (31-33). Into this unacknowledged war on the poor and the marginalized came the interplay of technology, economics, and culture at the origin of hip-hop, what Rose describes as a practice of appropriating cultural refuse for pleasure (22-23). Subways, street corners, abandoned parks were occupied by listeners and dancers as political spaces. The elements of “flow, layering, and rupture” both reflect and contest social marginalization, Rose says; in its origins, the music was both articulating and symbolizing the lived experience of people struggling to hold onto a community identity in the face of “urban development” and gentrification processes (22). The struggle, she insists, was not a final, futile gesture of victims of urban apocalypse, but was the formation of an alternative, communally-forged identity by producers of a conscious “take back the public spaces” movement (Rose 33). It was an intransigent, unapologetic assertion of the right of all human beings to take up public space, to interact with each other and with the music that informed these politicized, reclaimed spaces.

2. Contemporary Protest

As noted in the previous section, much of the protest of injustice that is expressed musically in the early 21^st century is done so through hip-hop. There is, for instance, a Hungarian rapper by the name of Dopeman who performs his discontent with the political homogenization of the country’s post-communist regime. And in Haiti, there was a nationwide rap contest in June 2006, the “Concours Pwojè Lari Pwòp,” in which young people submitted original raps on the topic of cleaning up the environment and the nation voted for their favorite recordings made by twelve finalists—a sort of socially conscious “Haitian Idol” program (Yéle Haiti, 2006). But the resonance that hip-hop has for youth in many different cultures should not blind us to the diversity of music—traditional and improvised—through which justice appeals speak to people. For instance, Foucaultian scholar Ladelle McWhorter opens her book Racism and Sexual Oppression in Anglo-America with an anecdote about attending a vigil for Matthew Shepard, the young college student in Wyoming whose 1998 death was an anti-gay hate crime, recalling that some attendees felt inspired to sing the Civil Rights-era anthem “We Shall Overcome” as an expression of their stand against homophobia. The discussions in this section should therefore be read not as a comprehensive overview, but as a selection of examples that showcase the diversity of musical styles that are speaking justice around the world.

a. Communal and Community-based Music Making in Democratic States

One of the most inspiring instances of music expressing the ethos to which a community aspires can be found in the response of the Norwegian people to the shocking mass murder committed in the summer of 2011 by right-wing extremist Anders Behring Breivik. To the extent that a motivation has emerged for Breivik’s actions—killing 77 people and wounding 200 more in attacks on government buildings in Oslo and a summer camp on the nearby island of Utoeya—he seems to have been driven by a hatred of the multiculturalism Norway has embraced and by a belief that immigration—Muslim immigration, in particular—has had a contaminating effect on society. One of the elements of Norwegian multiculturalism that he cited as the object of his hatred was a song that is taught to children in schools, “Children of The Rainbow.” This song is a Norwegian version of folk singer Pete Seeger’s anti-war song “My Rainbow Race” and it embodies for many Norwegians their shared social commitments to celebrating the diversity of human beings and to teaching their children a similar appreciation.

One might expect a community that has been devastated by mass-murder to react with rage and calls for harsh punishment for the perpetrator, especially given that many of his victims were young people. One might also expect heated public debates about gun control and the need for better early diagnosis and intervention in matters of mental health. What one might not expect to see, but did in fact happen in April 2012, is a gathering of thousands of people in the capital to sing both Norwegian and English versions of the song as a defiant refusal of Breivik’s hate-fueled politics of racial purity. This community response took place in a public square close to the courthouse in which Breivik was being tried, and some participants spoke of their hope that he could hear their response. The larger point, though, was to reaffirm the values of peace and love that the song represents, to reaffirm the community’s commitment to each other in the face of efforts to divide them and distance them from their values.

b. Building Social Solidarity against Neo-liberalism

While the Norwegian example demonstrates the expression of shared existing values, music also has considerable constructive power. It can bind a community or movement which is in the process of being built to the values or ideals that are inspiring the emergent community, a dialectical performance of communities and commitments through music. One such example is the 2012 student protest movement in the Canadian province of Quebec. The student protests began in March as demonstrations against an announced hike in tuition fees at the public universities and colleges, an increase of 75% to be phased in over five years, that would have brought Quebec’s historically much lower tuitions into line with those paid by students in the rest of Canada. This harmonization attempt, apparently reasonable in the eyes of many observers, struck members and representatives of Quebec’s student unions as a violation of the social contract governing the province and a direct assault on their stated goal of low-cost—preferably tuition-free—and accessible post-secondary education. Students at some Montreal institutions refused to attend classes, going on strike to demand a rollback of the announced increases. They began marching in the streets, wearing and displaying in apartment windows or on apartment balconies the sign of the protest, the carré rouge (a red square, usually of felt or wool).

They also began making “music,” a discordant but coordinated noise-making that was adapted from Chilean protests against the Pinochet dictatorship. Every evening at 8pm, people were invited to go out on their balconies and bang pots and pans in a display that was dubbed les casseroles. The purpose of the noise-making in Chilean protests had been to signal that the population was refusing to live in fear of the dictatorship, but in Quebec the point was to assert membership in the community of those who believe that accessible education is a crucial foundation of social egalitarianism. Participation in les casseroles was not limited to protesting students; ordinary citizens took part also as a way of demonstrating their solidarity with the student groups in defending Quebec’s noticeably left-wing social consensus. This sustained protest resulted in an electoral defeat for the premier of the province in September, the historic election of the province’s first female leader, and her announcement that the new government would cancel plans to hike tuition.

c. Confrontations with Authoritarian Regimes

Even when there is no existing or emergent solidarity, there is still a role for music in social protests. For some time, Russian society has been treated to various improvised musical protests against Vladimir Putin’s extra-democratic election triumphs by an all-female punk band known as “Pussy Riot.” These young women performed in masks and mini-dresses at politically-inflected sites in Moscow, and recently faced arrest and a high-profile trial for their performances. They persisted, despite initial warnings, because they have a point to make about the threat to democracy that the Putin oligarchy represents. Most recently they have been in prison for five months and have been sentenced to a two-year-long prison term in a labor camp as the result of a number of impromptu performances in Moscow, in early spring 2012. During one such performance, they took over a rooftop in Red Square opposite a prison where dissidents are incarcerated (BBC America, GMT, 28 February 2012). The most controversial, and the one that has most clearly motivated the charges of “hooliganism,” was a performance in a revered Orthodox church, where they stormed the altar and sang a “punk prayer” that called upon the Virgin Mary to assert herself as a feminist icon and save the nation from Putin. The incarceration they face for their performances has inspired solidarity protests outside Russian embassies in other countries, and seems to have rattled the oligarchy to the point that Putin himself called for leniency in sentencing on the very charges he insisted be brought against them. His public call for mercy is widely seen as political theater, however, and the harshness of their sentence is seen by some commentators on Russian public opinion as a possible spur to building a more outspoken opposition to his rule.

3. Academic Attention to Music-Politics Links

For all of the time in which music has played an integral role in movements for social progress, it is only recently that academic theorizing has begun to take notice of these links. The three major areas of attention to aesthetics-politics overlap are the discourse in social aesthetics (or relational aesthetics) in cultural studies, the broadly interdisciplinary area of improvisation theory, and the “Peace through Art” strand of peace studies. Not all of the scholars working in these areas look primarily at questions of music, but valuable theoretical insights are being produced.

a. Social Aesthetics

Social aesthetics starts with a consideration of the extent to which one’s membership in community—that is, one’s social identity—shapes one’s approach to art-making and art appreciation. This approach is exemplified by French sociologist Pierre Bourdieu’s critical rebuttal of Kantian aesthetics on the grounds that “taste” is not a universal trait which identifies a single standard of artistic merit but is instead indexed to one’s class position. Bourdieu offers a detailed, fine-grained argument for this hypothesis in his 1984 book Distinction, which discusses the results of surveys of respondents from a cross-section of social classes in France of the 1970s. Contrasting working class, bourgeois, and elite preferences in entertaining, decorating, leisure activities, music, and film, Bourdieu argues that what we find beautiful is indeed demonstrably shaped by our class positions and trajectories. This reveals aesthetic preferences as socially-inflected, hence political, regardless of how natural they might seem to their bearers. The net effect of Bourdieu’s intervention is repudiation of a universalist aesthetic hierarchy in which the cultural preferences of the elite class are judged as better than those of the working class, in favor of a relativist indexing of artistic productions to class positions.

While much of the research into musical tastes that explicitly engages the notion of class is being done in the European context, it is not hard to see how this discourse asserts itself in American accounts of taste. The concepts of “highbrow” music—Western art music, or “classical”—and “lowbrow” music—popular, mass-marketed productions, from jazz in the 1930s to rock in the 1950s through 1980s and, most recently, hip-hop—link tastes to education and income levels, which appear in the American lexicon as stand-ins for the concept of class. Understanding this linguistic translation makes it possible for us to employ a social aesthetics reading of some of the claims in the history of American musical production that otherwise seem unmotivated. In particular, John Coltrane’s rejection of the label “jazz” for his music, and his preference for labeling jazz “America’s classical music” can, through this lens, be interpreted as a contestation of the class position to which jazz musicians and their art-making had be relegated. This contestation does not achieve the relativism of Bourdieu’s inventory, but it does underscore the connection between social identity, or community membership, and aesthetic taste.

b. Improvisation Theory

While much of the work in social aesthetics/relational aesthetics is taking place in the discipline of cultural studies, improvisation theory is asserting itself as a self-consciously interdisciplinary endeavor. It draws together musicians, musicologists, philosophers, historians, and cultural theorists, among others, to consider questions of how and why improvisation as both a musical and social practice contributes to social organization overall.

Another developing area is the ethics of improvisation. Tracey Nicholls argues that the examination and adoption of the norms and values that flourish in communities of improvising musicians—those who improvise in the “free jazz” tradition, in particular—can help us to build more responsive, more democratic political societies. To be part of an improvising ensemble demands an openness to others, a willingness to listen carefully, closely, and charitably, and to respond in constructive ways that advance the musical “conversation.” This requires capacities for self-trust and respect for others on the part of every participant. The payoff is an expanded ability to engage difference creatively, instead of through an attitude of fear and hostility, and this in turn leads to a greater ability to deal with the complexity of a fast paced, globalized world. The ideal actor, in both musical improvisation and the sphere of grassroots popular political action, is the figure Cornel West dubs “the jazz freedom fighter”—an individual who pits his or her creative vision and talents against other members of a group in a way that is both competitive and collaborative. As West puts it, “individuality is promoted in order to sustain and increase the creative tension with the group—a tension that yields higher levels of performance to achieve the aim of the collective project” (italics in original, 150-151). In developing our capacities for openness to difference and living with risk (that, for instance, our attempts to negotiate and communicate might fail), this ethics of improvisation grounds subsidiary virtues that are not otherwise encouraged by our social status quo (a way of thinking that teaches us to refrain from taking chances if failure is a live option). Virtues like generosity towards others, willingness to support their risk-taking and their struggles to find creative ways out of impasses, commitment to an enhanced capacity to forgive the mis-steps that inevitably happen in these struggles, and greater respect for the ability to integrate, adopt, or even switch between different perspectives and different types of tools are also encouraged. This is not to suggest that we should dispense with planning but, given that our best-laid plans may fail, there is an enormous value to developing our individual capacities for improvisatory action. In this way, improvisation in music points the way to more resilient and more just societies.

c. Peace through Art

Peace through Art, in particular, social transformation effected through music, is an approach to music and social justice that shares with improvisation theory its inter-disciplinarity. One of the theorizers and practitioners of peace-building who not only takes seriously the role of art and music, but also seeks to advance our understanding of it, is John Paul Lederach whose peace-building work focuses on conflict transformation through social healing—in particular, the question of “how sonic phenomena might be applied to contexts of social change” (90). Lederach’s work with fractured communities emphasizes the restoration of voice, a concept he finds particularly resonant with people who are struggling to repair their violent communities (110, 89). What “voice”—understood both as the individual regaining his or her voice, and the community engaging in meaningful conversation (Lederach 109)—requires is “a container or space within which people [feel] safe but [are] also close enough to hear and receive the echo of each other’s voices” (Lederach 89).

The particular metaphor Lederach favors in his representations of peace processes is one that brings together voice and container: the Tibetan singing bowl. He observes that social healing, like musical resonance, “does not arise from the individual. It emerges from the interaction of many vibrations, individual and collective, held within a community context. In other words, social healing and reconciliation emerge in and around the container that holds collective processes” (Lederach 101). Elaborating on the bowl metaphor, Lederach points to some of the distinguishing characteristics of the multi-directionality that the bowl shares with sound (94). The first is circular movement: “[g]oing in circles and repeating them over and again is not,” he insists, “… a movement of going nowhere,” but has instead “a ritualistic quality … creating a certain kind of space and moment” (Lederach 94). The second is the container itself: “the bowl creates the space or location from which the sound is coaxed and held, but in terms of movement the sensation is one of going deep, made possible by the circling” (Lederach 94). “Deepening becomes a directional focus of the container,” says Lederach (94). The third directional characteristic that makes the bowl a compelling metaphor is rising: “[s]ound not only seems to rise from the bowl,” he explains; “it expands, moves out, touches and surrounds the space within its reach. Sound moves in all directions…. sound is multi-directional and non-linear in its movement” and offers the experience of “feelings of being touched and held” (Lederach 94).

Circling, deepening, and rising are all aspects of percussion that make instruments like drums and the singing bowl often function as “the heartbeat” of musical performances. They are also important aspects of the genuine, voluntary, non-imposed community reconciliation that Lederach prefers to discuss as “conflict transformation.” Going around, repeating over and over, is a way of gathering grassroots support within a community; each time an outreach effort is made, space is created for community members who had previously not been involved to join the movement. The descending movement can be understood as a way of describing the process of developing, through a repetition that may well become ritualized, an emotional loyalty to something that starts out as a social commitment—internalizing the peace-building ambition. And the rising movement can similarly be understood as the inexorable pressure that a fully committed, mobilized grassroots community can exert on a wider population—regional, national, or international—a bending of the discourse to the demands of the grassroots in the same way that the expanding, enveloping musical note arising from the bowl captures the attention of people in the audience who may not have been giving the performance their full attention.

4. References and Further Reading

Attali, Jacques. Noise: The Political Economy of Music. Trans. Brian Massumi. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1985.
- A history of the interplay of music and political life.
Baraka, Amiri [Leroi Jones]. Blues People: Negro Music in White America. New York: Quill/William Morrow, 1999 [1963].
- A classic text in African-American cultural studies.
BBC America. GMT. 28 February 2012.
- A television report on Pussy Riot performances.
Born, Georgina and David Hesmondhalgh. Western Music and Its Others: Difference, Representation, and Appropriation in Music. Berkeley: University of California Press, 2000.
- A collection of essays on difference and culture-crossing in global musical exchanges.
Bourdieu, Pierre. Distinction: A Social Critique of the Judgement of Taste. Trans. Richard Nice. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1984.
- A sociological rebuttal of philosophy of art that identifies an attitude of disinterest as the mark of aesthetic appreciation.
“Breivik trial: Norwegians rally around peace song.” BBC News. 26 April 2012.
- A news report about people’s responses to the trial.
Clibbon, Jennifer. “How a student uprising is reshaping Quebec.” CBC News. 29 May 2012.
- An interview with three cultural commentators on the historical context and current significance.
Daley, Mike. “Land of the free. Jimi Hendrix: Woodstock Festival, August 18, 1969.” Performance and Popular Music: History, Place and Time. Ed. Ian Inglis. Hampshire UK: Ashgate, 2006. 52-57.
- An essay on how this iconic performance shaped the development of popular music.
Gates, Jr., Henry Louis. The Signifying Monkey: A Theory of African-American Literary Criticism. New York: Oxford UP, 1988.
- A scholarly survey of the culturally-distinct communicative practices shaping African-American artistic production.
Kofsky, Frank. Black Nationalism and the Revolution in Music. New York: Pathfinder, 1970.
- A history of the free jazz movement of the 1960s and its socio-political commitments.
Lederach, John Paul and Angela Jill Lederach. When Blood and Bones Cry Out: Journeys through the Soundscape of Healing and Reconciliation. New York: Oxford University Press, 2010.
- An account of peace-building in conflict zones through local musical traditions.
Margolick, David. “Strange Fruit.” Vanity Fair Magazine, September 1998.
- A journalistic account of the history of the Billie Holliday song.
Monson, Ingrid. Saying Something: Jazz Improvisation and Interaction. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1996.
- A musician and music theorist’s account of the transformative effects of music.
“Moscou: les trois Pussy Riot condamnées à deux ans de prison chacune.” métro. 17 August 2012.
- An Associated Press story in a Montréal free daily newspaper.
Murray, Albert. Stomping The Blues. Cambridge MA: Da Capo Press, 1976.
- An analysis of the aesthetic merits of jazz and blues music on their own terms.
Nicholls, Tracey. An Ethics of Improvisation: Aesthetic Possibilities for a Political Future. Lanham MD: Lexington, 2012.
- An argument for the transferability of norms shaping improvising musicians’ communities to political communities, and their transformative possibilities.
Pratt, Ray. Rhythm and Resistance: Explorations in the Political Uses of Popular Music. New York: Praeger, 1990.
- A study of the political uses of popular music by marginalized communities.
Rose, Tricia. Black Noise: Rap Music and Black Culture in Contemporary America. Middletown CT: Wesleyan University Press, 1994.
- An exploration of the history, aesthetics, and political commitments of hip-hop culture, with an emphasis on its musical production.
“Strange Fruit.” Independent Lens.
- A Public Broadcasting System (PBS) documentary exploring the origins and impact of Billie Holiday’s most famous song.
Yéle Haiti Foundation, 2006.
- The grassroots social rebuilding movement organized by Haitian-American rapper Wyclef Jean.

Author Information

Tracey Nicholls
Email: tracey.j.nicholls@gmail.com
Massey University
U. S. A.

Mulla Sadra (c. 1572—1640)

Table of Contents

1. Biography

2. Synthetic methodology

3. Ontology

a. Primacy of Being

b. Gradation of Being

c. The Absolute and the Relational

4. Epistemology

a. Mental Being

b. Unity of the Knower and the Known

5. Soteriological Psychology

a. Substantial Motion and the Soul

b. The End of the Human Soul

6. Major Theological Issues

a. The Essence and the Attributes

b. Temporal Origin of the World

c. Bodily Resurrection

d. Prophethood, Imamate, and Sainthood

7. Commentaries on the Qur’an and Tradition

8. Legacy

9. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Philosophical Works

b. English Translation of Primary Literature

c. Secondary Books in European Languages

Author Information

Zhang Junmai (Carsun Chang, 1887—1969)

Table of Contents

1. Early Life

2. The Debate of 1923 and Zhang’s Moral Metaphysics

3. Political Philosophy

4. Confucianism and Chinese Modernity

5. Influence and Key Interpreters

6. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Works

b. Secondary Studies

Author Information

Music and Social Justice

Table of Contents

1. Musical Traditions

a. Origins and Impacts of Blues and Jazz

b. Folk Music, Rock Music, and Protest Songs

c. Post-industrial Musical Contestation: Disco, Punk, and Hip-hop

2. Contemporary Protest

a. Communal and Community-based Music Making in Democratic States

b. Building Social Solidarity against Neo-liberalism

c. Confrontations with Authoritarian Regimes

3. Academic Attention to Music-Politics Links

a. Social Aesthetics

b. Improvisation Theory

c. Peace through Art

4. References and Further Reading

Author Information

An encyclopedia of philosophy articles written by professional philosophers.