Ethics and Contrastivism

A contrastive theory of some concept holds that the concept in question only applies or fails to apply relative to a set of alternatives. Contrastivism has been applied to a wide range of philosophically important topics, including several topics in ethics. Contrastivism about reasons, for example, holds that whether some consideration is a reason for some action depends on what we are comparing that action to. The fact that your guests are vegetarian is a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than make roast duck, but not a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than make mushroom risotto. Contrastivism about obligation holds that what agents are obligated to do can likewise vary with the alternatives. So, for example, you may be obligated to take the book back to the library rather than leave it on your shelf, but not obligated to take the book back to the library rather than send it to the library with a friend. The article begins by clarifying what contrastivism is more generally, in order to see what motivates philosophers to accept contrastivism about some topic. Along the way, challenges and choice points facing the contrastivist will be highlighted. Attention is then given to exploring arguments for, and applications of, contrastivism to topics in ethics, including obligations, reasons, and freedom and responsibility.

Table of Contents

  1. Contrastivism in General
    1. Contrastivism in Different Domains
      1. Epistemology
      2. Philosophy of Science
    2. Contrastivism and Questions
    3. Non-Exhaustivity and Resolution-Sensitivity
  2. Contrastivism in Ethics
    1. Contrastivism about Obligation
    2. Contrastivism and Freedom
    3. Contrastivism about Normative Reasons
  3. General Challenges
    1. Setting the Contrast Class
    2. Cross-Context Inferences
  4. Conclusion
  5. References and Further Reading

1. Contrastivism in General

In this section we will briefly introduce the broad range of topics that have received a contrastive treatment in areas outside of ethics, and see what kinds of arguments contrastivists about some concept deploy. This will give us a broad outline of contrastivism as a general kind of view in philosophy.

a. Contrastivism in Different Domains

i. Epistemology

One of the most well known applications of contrastivism relates to knowledge. There are also contrastive theories of justification and of belief, but I will focus here on knowledge. According to the traditional, non-contrastive conception of knowledge, it is a two-place relation holding between a subject and a proposition: Ksps knows that p. Contrastivism, on the other hand, holds that knowledge is a three-place relation holding between a subject, a proposition, and a contrast.

There are differences in conceptions of the contrast. Some contrastivists treat the contrast as a single proposition, q, incompatible with p, yielding Kspqs knows that p rather than q. Others treat the contrast as a set of mutually exclusive propositions, including p, Q, yielding KspQs knows that p out of Q, where Q may be {p, q, r, s}. This difference is non-essential, at least for most purposes, since we can translate from Kspq to KspQ by letting Q = {p, q}, and we can translate from KspQ to Kspq, where Q = {p, r, s, t}, by letting q = r˅s˅t. Many examples used in arguments for contrastivism involve the phrase “rather than”, which generally contrasts two propositions (“s knows that p rather than q”). So for these examples, the single proposition conception of the contrast is more natural. Nevertheless, we will adopt the set of alternatives conception. As we will see in the section Contrastivism and Questions, this conception more directly represents the important contrastivist idea that contrastivity can be thought of as question-relativity.

Contrastivism about knowledge has its roots in the relevant alternatives contextualist theory of knowledge, developed in, for example, Dretske (1970) and Lewis (1996). According to this theory, whether a knowledge ascription, “s knows that p”, is true in a context depends on which alternatives to p are relevant in that context, and whether s can rule them out. As the context varies, the relevant alternatives may vary, and so whether a knowledge ascription is true can also vary. Relevant alternatives theorists have worked to spell out what makes an alternative relevant in a context, but have not yet produced a very satisfying picture. Contrastivists claim to do better: the relevant alternatives are provided by a question under discussion, which we have independent reason to accept in our theory of communication. For example, linguists (for example, Roberts, 201)) have argued that positing such a question under discussion helps explain various linguistic phenomena.

Contrastivists about knowledge claim several advantages over non-contrastive conceptions. The first kind of argument for contrastivism is linguistic: the theory can make better sense of a range of knowledge ascriptions, including explicitly contrastive ascriptions (“Ann knows that it’s a zebra rather than an ostrich”), ascriptions involving intonational stress (“Ann knows that the zebra is in the pen”), and ascriptions with a wh-complement (“Ann knows where the zebra pen is”). All of these ascriptions are plausibly treated as making reference to a question under discussion, or set of alternatives.

A second kind of argument appeals to theoretical advantages of contrastivism. For example, contrastivism promises to provide a solution to puzzles that have haunted epistemology, like the closure paradox. Moore knows that he has hands, and knows that if he has hands, then he is not a brain in a vat. But Moore does not know that he is not a brain in a vat. How can this be? Well, Moore knows that he has hands rather than flippers, but he does not know that he has hands rather than that he is a brain in a vat. So according to the contrastivist, this seemingly intractable paradox actually relies on a fallacious equivocation: we cannot assume that because Moore knows that he has hands rather than flippers that he therefore knows that he has hands rather than that he’s a brain in a vat. One way to read the closure paradox is as a puzzle about knowledge ascriptions: why do we ascribe Moore knowledge that he has hands but not knowledge that he is not a brain in a vat? But there is also a nonlinguistic side to the puzzle: Moore’s knowledge that he has hands seems incompatible with his ignorance about whether he’s a brain in a vat, given a very plausible closure principle. This does not have anything directly to do with knowledge ascriptions (though obviously intuitions must be drawn out by presenting knowledge ascriptions). It rather points out something troubling about the concept of knowledge: either it does not apply where we think it does, or it does not obey the kind of logic we think it does. The contrastivist solution is to say that knowledge is a contrastive concept, so that the puzzling question is simply ill-conceived. Moore’s knowledge that he has hands is in fact not incompatible with his ignorance about whether he’s a brain in a vat. I call this a theoretical argument for contrastivism, rather than a linguistic one, because it involves showing how contrastivism can resolve paradoxes involving the concept of knowledge, not merely deliver attractive interpretations about a range of knowledge ascriptions.

There are other theoretical arguments for contrastivism about knowledge. First, the theory allows us to track inquiry (See Schaffer, 2005a). Inquiry involves answering questions and ruling out alternatives, and the contrast argument place lets us keep track of the question we are answering, and the alternatives we have ruled out. A further theoretical motivation for contrastivism about knowledge comes from the idea that the most important theoretical and practical function of knowledge is to identify good sources of information (see especially Craig, 1990; Schaffer, 2005a). The contrastivist can add to this claim the observation that when we are looking for good sources of information, we have a particular question in mind (though it may be a quite general question). A good informant for one question (for example, why is it raining rather than snowing?) may not be a good informant for a different question (for example, why is it raining rather than not precipitating at all?). So a contrastive concept of knowledge would best explain its primary function.

These arguments, like other theoretical arguments (for example, Morton, 2012) aim to show that contrastivism lets us best make sense of the theoretical, as well as practical, role of knowledge. The specifics of how these arguments go are less important for our purposes here; the important point is that there are two broad classes of arguments for contrastivism about some concept: (i) linguistic arguments and (ii) theoretical arguments. This pattern carries over to different domains, including ethics. The line between the two kinds of arguments will not be sharp. This is due in part to the fact, noted above, that often theoretical puzzles about some concept have to be drawn out by appealing to ascriptions of that concept. Though many of the clearest motivations for contrastivism do involve ascriptions of the target concept, it is nevertheless important to keep in mind that contrastivism is more than simply a linguistic thesis and has more than simply linguistic advantages.

A special case of contrastivism about knowledge—one that is especially relevant for this article—is Sinnott-Armstrong’s (2006) contrastive account of moral knowledge. Sinnott-Armstrong applies contrastivist ideas developed in his own earlier work and by contrastivists like Schaffer to moral epistemology. An interesting twist is that Sinnott-Armstrong uses contrastivism as a route to a kind of moral skepticism—the view that we do not have moral knowledge. Here is the basic idea: though many explicitly contrastive knowledge ascriptions, like “I know that it is morally wrong to terminate the pregnancy using non-sterilized equipment rather than to terminate the pregnancy using sterilized equipment”, may well be true, we should suspend judgment about the truth of non-contrastive ascriptions like “I know that it is morally wrong to terminate the pregnancy“. All knowledge ascriptions require some set of alternatives before they can be evaluated for truth. If one is not provided explicitly, Sinnott-Armstrong argues, we should understand the ascriptions as “I know that p out of the relevant contrast class”. And this is where the skeptical turn appears: Sinnott-Armstrong argues that we should be relevance skeptics—we should suspend judgment about what the relevant contrast class is. Hence, we cannot evaluate the truth of the unrelativized knowledge claims. This is not quite the dogmatic skeptical claim that we lack moral knowledge. Instead, this is a Pyrrhonian skeptical thesis: we should suspend judgment about the truth of unrelativized attributions of moral knowledge (and of knowledge more generally). Nevertheless, it is notable that other contrastivists appeal to contrastivism to resolve skeptical paradoxes, while Sinnott-Armstrong uses contrastivism in an argument for a kind of skepticism.

ii. Philosophy of Science

Contrastive theses have also been offered in the philosophy of science. Traditional theories of explanation hold that the explanatory relation holds between two relata: pEqp explains q. Contrastive theories of explanation hold that we need at least one, and possibly two, more argument places for contrasts. We may have pQEqp out of Q (or “rather than any other member of Q”) explains q; pEqQp explains q out of Q; or pQ1EqQ2p out of Q1 explains q out of Q2. Once again, there are both linguistic arguments and theoretical arguments for these contrastivist theories. For example, “The warm temperature explains why it is raining rather than snowing” may be true, while “The warm temperature explains why it is raining rather than not precipitating” may be false. (For more on contrastivism about explanation, see van Fraassen, 1980; Lipton, 1990 and Hitchcock, 1996.)

Relatedly, philosophers have offered contrastive theories of causation. Instead of holding that the causal relation is two place, eCfe causes f—contrastivists hold that we need at least one, and possibly two, more argument places. Either eQ1Cf, eCfQ2, or eQ1CfQ2. Contrastivism purports to solve several puzzles facing traditional non-contrastive theories of causation, including causation by absences and the puzzle of saying what the cause of some event is. (See, for example, Schaffer, 2005b, 2012;  and Hitchcock, 1996a, 1996b.)

Finally, philosophers have also offered contrastive theories of confirmation. According to this view, whether some evidence confirms a hypothesis depends on what we are comparing that hypothesis to. For example, the wet sidewalk confirms the hypothesis that it rained rather than that it was sunny all day, but does not confirm the hypothesis that it rained rather than that someone washed her bike on the sidewalk a few minutes ago. (See Chandler, 2007, 2013 and Fitelson, 2012 for discussion.)

b. Contrastivism and Questions

Contrastivists often claim that their theories are ones according to which the target concept is question-relative: relative to one question, the concept holds, while relative to another, it does not. For example, Schaffer (2005a, 2007a) argues that to know that p is to know that p as the answer to the contextually relevant question. So relative to a question like, “Is the bird a canary or a raven?”, you know that it is a canary—you know the answer to this question. But relative to the question, “Is the bird a canary or a goldfinch?”, you do not know that it is a canary—you do not know the answer to this second question.

Question-relativity is a natural idea for contrastivists. Questions—thought of as the informational contents of interrogative sentences, analogously to thinking of propositions as the informational contents of declarative sentences—are standardly treated as partitions over (some part of) logical space. These partitions divide logical space into cells, so that the possibilities are grouped in mutually exclusive classes. These partitions can also be thought of, then, as sets of mutually exclusive alternatives—each alternative in the set corresponds to one cell in the partition. Thus, relativizing a concept to questions simply amounts to relativizing it to sets of alternatives, which is exactly what the contrastivist wants to do. Different questions give us different partitions, and so correspond to different sets of alternatives.

To see this approach in action, return to the epistemological example. The question expressed by “Is the bird a canary or a raven?” is represented by the set of alternatives, {the bird is a canary, the bird is a raven}. Recall that this is a representation of a partition of (part of) logical space into two cells, one containing possibilities in which the bird is a canary and the other containing possibilities in which the bird is a raven. Similarly, the question expressed by “Is the bird a canary or a goldfinch?” is represented by the set of alternatives, {the bird is a canary, the bird is a goldfinch}. If we relativize knowledge to questions, then, we can explain why “You know the bird is a canary” is true when the relevant question is the first, but false when the relevant question is the second. For now, we will assume that in a given context, there is a relevant question which supplies the set of alternatives. In the section “Setting the Contrast Class” we will consider some problems for this assumption.

More directly relevant for ethics, contrastivists about normative concepts like “ought” and reasons have developed theories according to which these concepts are relativized to deliberative questions, or questions of what to do. In a given deliberative context—the kinds of context in which we ordinarily appeal to concepts like “ought” and reasons—there is some particular deliberative question we are trying to answer, since answering a deliberative question is just deciding what to do. This question supplies the set of alternatives relative to which claims about what we ought to do or have reason to do are interpreted.

c. Non-Exhaustivity and Resolution-Sensitivity

Thinking of a contrastive theory of some concept in terms of question-relativity helps bring out two important features of contrastivism. Both of these features are exploited by contrastivists.

First, questions may partition only part of, or some subspace of, logical space. Some possibilities may just not be relevant, for one reason for another, or may be ruled out by the presuppositions of the question. For example, if I ask which beer you want to try, possibilities in which you do not want to try any of the beers are plausibly not included. You can of course say that you do not want to try any beers, but this seems more like rejecting the question (admittedly in a conversationally cooperative way), rather than answering it—answering a question requires selecting one of the alternatives, or one cell of the partition. The relevance of this point for contrastivism is that the set of alternatives to which a concept is relativized may be non-exhaustive of logical space. This is most clear in the case of explicitly contrastive “rather than” ascriptions, like “You know that the bird is a canary rather than a raven”. Here, the contrastivist about knowledge will say that this sentence means that you know that the bird is a canary relative to the set {the bird is a canary, the bird is a raven}. Clearly there are many other possibilities—the bird could be a goldfinch, a crow, a robot made to look like a canary, or you could be dreaming. Relative to sets that include some of these other alternatives, you may not know that the bird is a canary. But since, on this view, knowledge claims are relativized to non-exhaustive sets of alternatives, it may still be true that you know that it is a canary relative to {the bird is a canary, the bird is a raven}.

Second, the possibilities that are partitioned can be grouped together in more or less fine-grained ways. Some distinctions between possibilities may be respected by the partition while others are smudged over. Compare the following two sets: {it’s a bird, it’s not a bird}, {it’s a canary, it’s a goldfinch, it’s a crow, it’s some other kind of bird, it’s a robot, it’s a hallucination, it’s some other kind of non-bird}. The second set makes distinctions between possibilities that are ignored in the first set. These sets differ in what Yalcin (2011) and Cariani (2013) call resolution: sets which make more fine-grained distinctions partition (parts of) logical space at a higher resolution. To say that some concept is resolution-sensitive, at least here, is to say that it is relativized to sets that may vary in resolution. Relative to a set at one resolution, the concept may hold of something, while relative to a set at a different resolution—either higher or lower—it may not.

2. Contrastivism in Ethics

While applications of contrastivism within epistemology and the philosophy of science are more well known, contrastivism has also been applied to a wide range of topics in ethics and normative philosophy more generally. We have already seen that contrastivist ideas have interesting applications in moral epistemology. This section introduces contrastivism about obligation, normative reasons, and freedom and moral responsibility. Having already introduced contrastivism more generally in the previous section, I will focus primarily on describing the specific motivations for the contrastive theories in ethics.

One application of contrastivist ideas in ethics that I will not discuss in detail is due to Driver (2012). Driver suggests a contrastive conception of luck, and makes use of this in her defense of a consequentialist treatment of moral luck. The central contrastivist claim is that no one, or no event, is lucky simpliciter. Rather, something is only lucky or unlucky relative to some contrasts. For example, a patient may be lucky to survive a serious illness rather than die from it, but not lucky to survive the serious illness, rather than not contract the illness in the first place.

a. Contrastivism about Obligation

The oldest application of contrastive ideas in ethics is contrastivism about obligation. Much of the work defending and developing contrastivism about obligation has focused primarily on developing contrastive semantic theories for the terms used to ascribe obligations, especially the deontic modal “ought”. This is not unexpected, since as we saw above, one important style of argument for contrastivism is linguistic in nature; contrastivism about obligation is no different. (Here I will conflate obligation and ought to stick more closely to the literature; the concept of obligation is better expressed using stronger deontic modals like “must” and “have to”.)

Contrastivism about obligation holds that what you ought to do can vary with the comparison being made. For example, though you ought to take the book back to the library rather than leave it on the shelf, it is not the case that you ought to take it back to the library rather than send it with me on my trip to the library.

It is important to distinguish the distinctive contrastivist claim from the much more widely accepted claim that what you ought to do depends on the available alternatives. If some option is the best one available, the non-contrastivist will say that it is what you ought to do. If circumstances change so that that option is no longer available, then obviously it is not the case that you ought to do it—it is not even an option. So what you ought to do has changed with the alternatives. But importantly, it has changed with the available alternatives. There is nothing surprising about this claim, and it is not the distinctive contrastivist claim. The distinctive contrastivist claim is that even holding the available alternatives fixed, what you ought to do can vary with the particular comparison. That is, claims about what you ought to do are only true or false relative to some particular set of alternatives, which may not include all of the available alternatives.

This puts us in a position to see one argument for contrastivism about obligation. Suppose that all of the following methods of getting to work are available: driving your SUV, taking the bus, riding your bike. The relevant factors here are environmental friendliness and getting some exercise. So riding your bike is best and driving your SUV is worst. The non-contrastivist will of course say that, in this case, you ought to ride your bike. And this is very plausible. But the following claim is also very plausible:

(1)   You ought to take the bus rather than drive your SUV.

But since taking the bus is not the best available alternative—riding your bike is also an available alternative—it is hard to see how the non-contrastivist can explain the truth of (1). The contrastivist, on the other hand, has an easy time explaining this. Out of the set of alternatives {take the bus, drive your SUV}, taking the bus is the best. And what you ought to do out of a set of alternatives is the best alternative in that set. So even if there are better available alternatives, we can still make true “ought” claims about suboptimal alternatives, as long as they are the best in the relevant set of alternatives; using a “rather than” claim as in (1) is one way of making a set the relevant one.

The non-contrastivist can of course try to reinterpret claims like (1) so that they do not require relativizing “ought” to sets of alternatives. For example, we may read (1) as saying something like, “If you are going to either take the bus or drive your SUV, you ought to take the bus”. One problem for this reply, as emphasized in an epistemic context by Schaffer (2008), is that this requires reading “rather than” as contributing some kind of conditional. But this is not a plausible general theory about the contribution of “rather than” clauses. It is much more linguistically plausible to treat “rather than” as making explicit the comparison being made, as the contrastivist does.

An even more important source of motivation for contrastivism about obligation comes from the puzzles of deontic logic, the logic of obligation. Many of these puzzles have the following form: acceptable “ought” claims lead, via plausible inference rules, to unacceptable “ought” claims. Here is just one example, called Ross’s Paradox, since it is originally due to Alf Ross (1941). Suppose you promise your friend that you will mail a letter for her. Then (2) is true:

(2)   You ought to mail the letter.

One inference rule that is validated by the standard semantics for “ought”, and by standard deontic logic, is the following:

Inheritance: If doing A entails doing B, then if you ought to do A, you ought to do B.

(This rule is usually stated treating “ought” as a propositional operator, read as “it ought to be that p”, instead of as (directly) ascribing an obligation, as in “you ought to A”. This goes beyond the scope of this article.) Besides being validated by orthodox treatments of “ought”, this inference rule has a lot of initial plausibility. One way to see this plausibility is to think of the special case in which doing B is a necessary means to doing A, and in that sense doing A entails doing B. If the only way to do something you ought to do requires doing B, then very plausibly, you thereby ought to do B. But inheritance leads to unacceptable results. Note that mailing the letter entails either mailing it or burning it, just because A entails (A or B), for any B. So from the acceptable “ought” claim (2), via Inheritance, (3) follows:

(3)   You ought to either mail the letter or burn it.

While (2) is acceptable, (3) is not. It ascribes an obligation to you, mailing the letter or burning it, that you can satisfy by burning the letter. But burning the letter is not a way to do anything you ought to do.

The standard reply to Ross’s Paradox is to accept the consequence, that (3) is true, but explain its apparent unacceptability pragmatically. The basic idea is that (3) is weaker than something else we are in a position to say, namely (2). This is to appeal to Grice’s (1989) maxim of quantity, that we should say the strongest thing we are in a position to say. Saying something weaker, like (3), suggests that we are not in a position to say something stronger, like (2). But in this case, we are in a position to say (2)—in fact, we derived (3) from (2). There have been various challenges to this line of reply; see in particular Cariani (2013).

The contrastivist offers a different solution. The outline of the solution is that the inference from (2) to (3) involves an illicit shift in the set of alternatives to which the “ought” claims are relativized—and hence is equivocal. To see why, remember that the alternatives in a set of alternatives must be mutually exclusive. Then notice that “mail the letter” and “mail the letter or burn it” are not mutually exclusive; so they cannot be members of the same set of alternatives. Thus, (2) and (3) cannot be relativized to the same set of alternatives. In an ordinary context, (2) would be relativized to a set like {mail the letter, leave the letter on the table, give the letter back to your friend, burn the letter}. (3), on the other hand, must be relativized to a set that includes “mail the letter or burn it” as an option, such as {mail the letter or burn it, leave the letter on the table, give the letter back to your friend}. In terms of our distinction between the non-exhaustivity of a set of alternatives, and the resolution of a set of alternatives, inferences like the one from (2) to (3) require a shift in resolution: the second set of alternatives lumps together two options—”mail the letter” and “burn the letter”—that are distinct in the first set. Since the contrastivist about obligation holds that obligation claims are sensitive to the resolution of the set of alternatives to which they are relativized, she can hold that the shift in resolution generates a shift in the truth of the obligation claim.

The first thing to see is that we simply cannot infer (3) from (2): to do so would be to equivocate, since the set of alternatives has shifted. It would be like inferring “Chris Paul is tall”, when he’s playing in a professional basketball game, from the truth of “Chris Paul is tall” when he’s at his family reunion (crucial background: Chris Paul is taller than most other members of his family, but shorter than most basketball players). The comparison class has shifted, and “tall” ascriptions are very plausibly relativized to comparison classes—to count as tall, you have to be taller than most members of the relevant comparison class.

The second thing to notice is that, not only can we not infer (3) from (2), we can also say that (3) is actually false. That is because, very plausibly, out of the set {mail the letter or burn it, leave the letter on the table, give the letter back to your friend}, it is not true that you ought to mail the letter or burn it—this is not the best option in the set.

This is the basic outline for one kind of contrastivist solution to puzzles of deontic logic. Cariani (2013) offers an interestingly different kind of contrastivist solution. Cariani takes up the task of blocking problematic inferences, such as Ross’s Paradox, while retaining intuitively acceptable ones that also seem to be supported by rules like inheritance.

b. Contrastivism and Freedom

Another implementation of contrastivist ideas in ethics is Sinnott-Armstrong’s (2012) contrastive account of freedom and moral responsibility. Central questions in this domain concern whether an agent’s act is free, and hence whether the agent is responsible for the act. Responsibility skeptics argue that since we can always trace the causal history of an act back to causes outside the agent, no one is ever responsible. Their opponents give various responses to this argument, including that freedom and responsibility do not require a lack of causation from outside the agent.

The first application of contrastivism is to what agents are free from. For example, an agent’s act may be free from external physical constraints (for example, chains or a shove) or internal compulsions (for example, addiction), but not free from all preceding causes (for example, the initial conditions of the universe). Such an act would be free rather than the result of a shove or addiction, but not free rather than caused (via a long chain) by the initial conditions of the universe. Adopting this contrastive conception of freedom helps clarify the dispute between responsibility skeptics and their opponents: the debate is over which kind of constraint is the relevant one for attributing responsibility. (Sinnott-Armstrong himself once again denies that there is any one relevant kind of constraint, and so does not take sides in the dispute between responsibility skeptics and their opponents.)

This contrastive picture also explains conflicting intuitions about whether a given act is free. Ordinarily, perhaps, we have in mind constraints like chains or addictions. Most acts in question in debates about freedom and responsibility are free, rather than being constrained by these kinds of things. But what the responsibility skeptic does, is to draw our attention to another kind of constraint—that of causes outside the agent. Actions are very plausibly not free, rather than being caused at all. If the contrastivist about freedom is right that freedom is a contrastive concept, and that both of these kinds of freedom—freedom from constraints and freedom from preceding causes—are legitimate, then this explains why we may be puzzled by questions about whether a given action is free.

The second application of contrastivism is to what agents are free to do. Sinnott-Armstrong’s illustrative example is of an alcoholic, Al. Suppose Al drinks some whisky at 8pm on Tuesday. We may ask whether this act was free. It seems to depend on the contrasts. Depending on how we specify the details of the case, all of the following may be true:

  1. Al’s drinking whisky rather than wine was free.
  2. Al’s drinking whisky at 8pm rather than at 9pm was free.
  3. Al’s drinking whisky rather than a non-alcoholic drink was not free.
  4. Al’s drinking whisky on Tuesday rather than waiting until Wednesday was not free.

As Sinnott-Armstrong sums up the point: “Addicts never have no control at all in any circumstances…most people are free to choose out of some contrast classes but not out of others.” (Sinnott-Armstrong, 2012:145). So the question of whether Al’s act was free is, for the contrastivist, incomplete. To say whether an action was free, we have to specify what the contrast is—relative to some contrasts, it may be free while relative to others it may not be. The important question then becomes which contrasts are relevant for which purposes. In particular, we can ask which contrasts are relevant for blaming and holding responsible. So contrastivism has helped us isolate the important questions in the debate about moral responsibility.

A related position is contrastivism about legal responsibility. Schaffer (2010) applies his contrastive account of causation (described in the section Philosophy of Science) to the notion of legal causation. If we accept that there is a close connection between the claim that someone caused, in the legally relevant sense, some outcome and the claim that she is legally responsible for that outcome, this contrastive account of causation in the law leads naturally to a contrastive theory of legal responsibility.

c. Contrastivism about Normative Reasons

The last application of contrastivism to ethics is contrastivism about normative reasons. A normative reason for an action is a consideration that counts in favor of performing that action. For example, the fact that you promised to return the book is a reason to return it, and the fact that you are causing me pain is a reason to get off of my foot. Many philosophers think reasons are central to ethics, and to normativity more generally. If that is correct, then contrastivism about normative reasons will likely have widespread implications throughout ethics.

As with most other implementations of contrastivism, contrastivism about reasons can be motivated by linguistic considerations:

  1. The fact that my guest is vegetarian is a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than roast duck.
  2. The fact that my guest is vegetarian is not a reason to make vegetable lasagna rather than mushroom risotto.

Both of these contrastive claims are true. But now we might want to know, “Is the fact that my guest is vegetarian a reason to make vegetable lasagna or not?”. This is to ask whether this fact is a non-contrastive reason. This question is hard to answer. What this seems to show is that whether this fact is a reason or not depends on the alternatives—that it is a contrastive reason.

There are various ways for the non-contrastivist to respond to this argument. In particular, she may try to provide non-contrastive analyses of these contrastive claims. For example, we may appeal to the fact that reasons have strengths or weights, and hold that some consideration is a reason to do A rather than B when it is a stronger (non-contrastive) reason to do A than it is to do B. In this way, we can explain the truth of claims like (4) and (5) without adopting a contrastive view of reasons.

There are various problems with this kind of strategy. For just one, recall the similar strategy for dealing with contrastive obligation claims discussed in the section ”Contrastivism About Obligation”. The idea there was to say that the “rather than” in these claims should be analyzed out as a conditional. The problem was that this is not particularly linguistically plausible, since “rather than” does not ordinarily contribute a conditional. This strategy for dealing with contrastive reason claims faces a similar problem. “Rather than” does not ordinarily mean “stronger than”; instead, “rather than” should be understood as introducing contrasts.

Besides linguistic arguments, the second major kind of argument for contrastivism in some domain is theoretical. Recall that these kinds of arguments are not based primarily on contrastivism’s ability to give attractive interpretations of ascriptions of the target concept—in this case, reasons. Rather, they aim to show that given some theoretical role or property of the target the concept would be best explained by a contrastive view of the concept. A theoretical argument for contrastivism about reasons is that it best makes sense of the connection between reasons and the promotion of various objectives, like desires or values. A schematic statement of this very common idea is the following:

Promotion: Consideration R is a reason to perform act A if R explains why A-ing would promote objective O.

Again, an objective is some valuable thing to be promoted. Different theories will say different things: desire-based theories think reasons are tied to the promotion of the objects of desires, value-based theories think reasons are tied to the promotion of values like justice or goodness, and so on. No matter which of these theories we accept, we have to say what it takes for some action to promote an objective.

Snedegar (2014b) argues that the best way to do this is to adopt a contrastive picture. Relative to some contrasts an action may promote an objective, while relative to another, it may not. Suppose the relevant objective is contributing to the relief of hunger in the third world. This objective is not promoted by donating to an unreliable charity (they only get the money where it should go 20% of the time) rather than donating to a reliable charity. But it is promoted by donating to an unreliable charity rather than spending the money on an expensive dinner for myself. Hence, this objective gives me a reason to donate to the unreliable charity rather than spend the money on an expensive dinner, but does not give me a reason to donate to the unreliable charity rather than donate to the reliable charity. Non-contrastive views of promotion will deliver the verdict that this objective gives me no reason whatsoever to donate to the unreliable charity. So it is hard for them to explain the fact that it gives me a reason to donate to the unreliable charity rather than spending the money on an expensive dinner.

We have seen both linguistic and theoretical motivations for contrastivism about reasons. As we saw at the beginning of this section, reasons are often taken to be central to ethics and normativity more generally. So contrastivism about reasons is likely to have many upshots throughout ethics and normative philosophy. One nice thing about this is that it gives us a huge swathe of philosophy against which to test contrastivism about reasons: contrastivism may lead to exciting insights in normative philosophy, or it may lead to unacceptable results. Either way, this seems to be a fruitful area for research.

3. General Challenges

To close, consider some general challenges facing contrastivism of any variety. The specific form of these challenges, and the plausible responses, will likely vary from domain to domain. When it is necessary to apply the challenge to a concrete contrastivist theory, one from ethics will be chosen. As much as possible, however, the article remains at a general level, because it is instructive to think about the general shape of the challenges, as they face the contrastivist qua contrastivist.

a. Setting the Contrast Class

The first few challenges are interrelated, and have to do with setting the relevant contrast class. First, contrastivists face the challenge of saying what set of alternatives a given claim should be relativized to. For explicitly contrastive ascriptions of a concept, for example those using “rather than”, it is straightforward: the “rather than” clause makes the alternatives explicit. But for ascriptions that are not explicitly contrastive, the contrastivist has to provide some way of settling what the relevant set of alternatives is, or else admit that these unrelativized claims are not truth-evaluable, or at least that we should suspend judgment about their truth. To be satisfactory, this should be done in a relatively principled way. Otherwise, the contrastivist may face charges of fixing the contrasts in an ad hoc way to get the results she wants.

We have already seen one popular way to answer this challenge. This is to appeal to a question under discussion in the context. Linguists and philosophers of language have given arguments independent of contrastivism for the inclusion of such a device in our theory of communication. For example, it is useful in interpreting intonational stress (see Rooth, 1992) and in explaining several kinds of pragmatic phenomena (see Roberts, 2012). The contrastivist can exploit this: the question under discussion fixes the set of alternatives relative to which the ascription is interpreted.

But there are other options. Rather than appealing to a question under discussion, the contrastivist may instead appeal to the speaker’s intention, to features of the assessor’s context, or even to features of the subject (of the ascription) or her context. As we have already seen, one prominent contrastivist, Walter Sinnott-Armstrong, argues for a very different solution to the problem of determining the contrast class. Sinnott-Armstrong (2004, 2006) argues that no way of determining relevance is correct, and that we should instead be relevance skeptics. We should simply suspend judgment about the content and truth of non-relativized claims employing a contrastive concept. Sinnott-Armstrong’s arguments are challenging, and if the contrastivist wants to avoid his skepticism, she needs to grapple with them. One way to gain traction here, though this goes beyond the scope of this article, is to seek independent evidence for the existence of a relevant question under discussion in explanations of natural language phenomena. Linguists have developed powerful explanatory theories of various natural language phenomena using questions under discussion. So even if specific proposals about how to determine the relevant contrast class, or question under discussion, face challenges, we at least have some reason to be optimistic that there is such a relevant contrast class or question.

A second and related challenge is that contrastivism delivers apparently objectionable results, as long as the relevant contrast class is set up in the right way. This problem is perhaps sharpest for the contrastivist about obligation. You may be obligated to do all kinds of terrible or crazy things, because the contrast class is crazy. For example, the contrastivist about obligation will say that you are obligated to burn down your neighbor’s house while she is at work—as long as the relevant alternatives are worse than this. So you are obligated to burn down her house while she is at work rather than burn it down with her inside. This is even more objectionable when we remember that these need not be the only options open to you—it may be perfectly possible for you to take her a plate of freshly baked cookies, or to simply stay at home and watch television, instead. Still, the contrastivist will say that you are obligated to burn down her house while she is at work, as long as the relevant alternative is burning it down with her inside.

The contrastivist about obligation is committed to this result, when paired with any plausible theory about what an agent is obligated to do out of a given contrast class. But it is not clear how serious this problem actually is. The explicitly contrastive claim, “You are obligated to burn down her house while she’s at work rather than burn it down when she’s inside” is not obviously false. After all, burning it down while she’s at work is clearly better than burning it down while she’s inside. The bare, non-contrastive claim, “You are obligated to burn down her house while she’s at work” does sound obviously false. But the contrastivist is only committed to the truth of this claim when the only relevant alternatives are things like “burn it down while she’s inside” (or even worse alternatives). In any ordinary context—for example, a context in which you could take her a plate of freshly baked cookies, instead—these will not be the only relevant alternatives. In fact, they are unlikely to be relevant alternatives at all, at least before they are mentioned. In these ordinary contexts, the contrastivist about obligation will not be committed to the truth of the objectionable non-contrastive claim. The details of this solution will depend on what our theory tells us about fixing the relevant set of alternatives, but it should be clear that the contrastivist has options here.

A closely related problem is raised against contrastive theories of moral reasons by Andrew Jordan. Jordan argues that some actions should be, and are, performed in a whole-hearted way—that is, without considering alternatives at all. The virtuous person will simply see that taking her sick pet to the vet is the thing to do and will not consider alternatives, or take into account reasons for alternatives, for example, the potentially high cost. So the reasons favoring the whole-hearted action do not seem to be relativized to any contrast class at all.

This problem only arises if the contrastivist about reasons holds that the contrast class is fixed by the options the subject is considering. But as we have seen, there are many more options for the contrastivist. It is not clear, for example, how this problem could arise on a speaker contextualist theory. So this is not a problem for the contrastivist as such.

Though these last two challenges are not serious problems for contrastivism as such, they are useful in thinking about the first challenge—that of saying what fixes the contrast class for a given claim. The problem of crazy verdicts resulting from crazy contrast classes puts pressure on a very simple version of speaker contextualism, according to which the relevant contrast class is wholly fixed by the speaker’s intentions. As long as the speaker intends a crazy contrast class, the objectionable ascriptions may come out true. This kind of contrastivist would then need to try to explain why this result is not actually objectionable. Jordan’s problem of whole-hearted action puts pressure on a version of contrastivism according to which the relevant contrast class is wholly determined by what the agent is considering—if the virtuous agent is not considering any alternatives, then this version of contrastivism could not supply a contrast class.

Another problem in this vein is harder to articulate in a sharp way. It stems from the idea that there must be an answer to whether the concept really applies, over and above whether it applies relative to any particular set of alternatives. In the case of “ought”, for example, there is a feeling that there must be something that we really ought to do. We can imagine the objector saying, in an exasperated tone, “I know I ought to take the bus rather than drive my SUV. What I want to know is, ought I take the bus?”. Read straightforwardly, this objection is just a rejection of the central thesis of contrastivism. Read in that way, there is not much the contrastivist can say.

There is another, more contrastivist-friendly way to construe this idea. The idea may be that, though there are lots of true claims about when I ought to or have reason to perform some action rather than some other action, in certain kinds of deliberation and theorizing, we are interested in “oughts” and in reasons with some kind of special status. The contrastivist can accommodate this idea by identifying special contrast classes, and claiming that they are relevant in the cases the objector has in mind. Some good candidates include (i) a trivial contrast class, {A, ~A}, (ii) an exhaustive contrast class that includes every possibility open to the agent, (iii) a maximally fine-grained contrast class, and (iv) a contrast class that makes all morally relevant distinctions. These are not mutually exclusive options, of course—for example, all four could be construed as exhaustive sets of alternatives. The contrastivist can hold that some reasons or obligations, for example, moral reasons or obligations, are always relativized to one of these special kinds of contrast class, while other reasons and obligations are not. This is all perfectly consistent with contrastivism, and lets us capture something very close to the idea that there is something we really ought to do or really have reason to do.

b. Cross-Context Inferences

A very different kind of challenge involves cross-context inferences. The central feature of contrastivism, that lets it solve puzzles facing non-contrastive theories, is that a concept may apply relative to one set of alternatives without applying relative to others. For example, just because we know that you ought to A rather than B, that does not tell us anything about whether you ought to A rather than C. This central feature leads to a very important challenge: sometimes, knowing that a concept applies relative to some alternatives should tell us whether it applies relative to certain other alternatives. For example, if I know that I ought to A rather than either of B or C (out of {A, B, C}), our theory should guarantee that I ought to A rather than B (out of {A, B}). Similarly, if I ought to A rather than B and I ought to B rather than C, then our theory should guarantee that I ought to A rather than C.

The advantages of contrastivism come from letting the application of a concept vary with the alternatives. What this problem shows is that we have to constrain this variation in certain ways. The strategy adopted by contrastivists who have addressed this problem is to appeal to some non-contrastive foundation on which the application of the concept depends. For example, contrastivists about “ought” who have addressed this problem appeal to a contrast-invariant ranking of alternatives, and let the application of “ought” depend on this ranking in ways that deliver the necessary constraints.

4. Conclusion

Contrastivism has been applied across much of philosophy, and it is no wonder why. It promises to resolve the closure paradox in epistemology, provide the best theory of explanation, perhaps the central concept in philosophy and science, and finally give a true theory of causation. And that is before we even broach the field of ethics. There, contrastivism promises to resolve—or at least shed serious light on—the paradoxes of deontic logic, the problem of determinism, and provide an account of reasons for action. There is much more work to be done in making good on these promises. But at the very least, this appears to be a very fruitful research program—especially in ethics, where less work has been done.

5. References and Further Reading

  • Baumann, P. 2008. “Problems for Sinnott-Armstrong’s Moral Contrastivism.” The Philosophical Quarterly 58(232): 463-470.
    • Argues that contrastivism about knowledge makes bad predictions in cases of “crazy contrast classes”.
  • Blaauw, M. (ed.) 2012. Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge.
    • A collection of papers demonstrating the breadth of the contrastivist program in philosophy, including several in ethics.
  • Cariani, F. 2013. “Ought and Resolution Semantics.” Noûs 47(3): 534-558.
    •  Develops a sophisticated contrastive semantic theory for “ought”.
  •  Chandler, J. 2007. “Solving the Tacking Problem with Contrast Classes.” British Journal for the Philosophy of Science 58(3): 489-502.
    • Uses contrastive confirmation to solve an important problem in confirmation theory.
  • Chandler, J. 2013. “Contrastive Confirmation: Some Competing Accounts.” Synthese 190(1): 129-138.
  • Craig, W. 1990. Knowledge and the State of Nature: An Essay in Conceptual Synthesis. Oxford University Press.
    • Argues that the central function of the concept of knowledge is to identify good sources of information, and develops a theory of knowledge based on this conception.
  •  Dretske, F. 1970. “Epistemic Operators.” Journal of Philosophy 67: 1007-1023.
    • Early version of the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, direct predecessor of contrastivism.
  • Driver, J. 2012. “Luck and Fortune in Moral Evaluation.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 154-172.
    • Sketches a contrastive account of luck, and applies it to the problem of moral luck.
  • Finlay, S. 2009. “Oughts and Ends.” Philosophical Studies 143(3): 315-340.
  • Finlay, S. 2014. Confusion of Tongues: A Theory of Normative Language. Oxford University Press.
    • Develops a theory of “ought” which makes use of contrastivist machinery in the service of providing a comprehensive theory of normativity.
  • Finlay, S. and Snedegar, J. 2014. “One Ought Too Many.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 89(1): 102-124.
    • Defends a uniform, propositional operator semantics for “ought”, making crucial use of contrastivism.
  • Fitelson, B. 2012. “Contrastive Bayesianism.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 64-87.
    • Discussion of contrastive theories of confirmation.
  • van Fraassen, B. 1980. The Scientific Image. Oxford University Press.
    • Influential development of a contrastive theory of explanation.
  • Grice, H. P. 1989. “Logic and Conversation.” In Grice, Studies in the Way of Words. Harvard University Press, 22-40.
    • Classic discussion of conversational implicature, where speakers communicate more than they literally say.
  • Groenendijk, J. and Stokhof, M. 1997. “Questions.” In van Benthem, J. and ter Meulen, A. (eds.), Handbook of Logic and Language. Elsevier Science Publishers, 1055-1124.
    • Detailed discussion of the semantics of questions, including the partition/set of alternatives semantics.
  • Hamblin, C. L. 1958. “Questions.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 36: 159-168.
    • Early development of the partition semantics for questions.
  • Higginbotham, J. 1996. “The Semantics of Questions.” In Lappin, S. (ed.), The Handbook of Contemporary Semantic Theory. Oxford University Press, 361-383.
  • Hitchcock, C. 1996a. “The Role of Contrast in Causal and Explanatory Claims.” Synthese 107: 395-419.
  • Hitchcock, C. 1996b. “Farewell to Binary Causation.” Canadian Journal of Philosophy 26: 267-282.
    • Development of a contrastive theory of causation.
  • Jackson, F. 1985. “On the Semantics and Logic of Obligation.” Mind 94(374): 177-195.
    • Development of a contrastive theory of obligation, motivated by puzzles from deontic logic.
  • Jackson, F. and Pargetter, R. 1986. “Oughts, Options, and Actualism.” Philosophical Review 95(2): 233-255.
    • Development of a contrastive theory of obligation.
  • Jordan, A. 2014. “Whole-Hearted Motivation and Relevant Alternatives: A Problem for the Contrastivist Account of Moral Reasons.” Ethical Theory and Moral Practice 17(5): 835-845.
  • Karjalainen, A. and Morton, A. 2003. “Contrastive Knowledge.” Philosophical Explorations 6(2): 74-89.
    • Argues for a contrastive conception of knowledge.
  • Lewis, D. 1996. “Elusive Knowledge.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 74: 549-567.
    • Influential development of the relevant alternatives theory of knowledge, a direct predecessor of contrastivism about knowledge.
  • Lipton, P. 1990. “Contrastive Explanation.” Royal Institute for Philosophy Supplement 27: 247-266.
    • Development of a contrastive theory of explanation.
  • McNamara, P. 2014. “Deontic Logic.” In Zalta (ed.), Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
    • Detailed overview of deontic logic, including the puzzles that motivate contrastivism about obligation.
  • Morton, A. 2012. “Contrastive Knowledge.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 101-115.
    • Gives primarily theoretical, rather than linguistic, arguments for contrastivism about knowledge.
  • Roberts, C. 2012. “Information Structure in Discourse: Towards an Integrated Formal Theory of Pragmatics.” Semantics and Pragmatics 5: 1-69.
    • Detailed development of a formal pragmatic theory making crucial use of questions under discussion.
  • Rooth, M. 1992. “A Theory of Focus Interpretation.” Natural Language Semantics 1: 75-116.
    • Develops a theory for interpreting focus (for example, intonational stress) in natural language, making crucial use of sets of alternatives.
  • Ross, J. 2009. Acceptance and Practical Reason. PhD Thesis, Rutgers University, Chapter 9.
    • Gives arguments for a contrastive treatment of normative reasons.
  • Schaffer, J. 2004. “From Contextualism to Contrastivism.” Philosophical Studies 119(1-2): 73-104.
    • Argues that contrastivism about knowledge is superior to standard forms of contextualism.
  • Schaffer, J. 2005a. “Contrastive Knowledge.” In Gendler and Hawthorne (eds.), Oxford Studies in Epistemology, Vol. 1. Oxford University Press, 235-271.
    • Argues for and develops a contrastive theory of knowledge.
  • Schaffer, J. 2005b. ‘Contrastive Causation.’ The Philosophical Review 114: 327-358.
    • Argues for and develops a contrastive theory of causation.
  • Schaffer, J. 2007a. “Knowing the Answer.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 75(2): 383-403.
    • Argues for and develops a contrastive theory of knowledge, based primarily on knowledge-wh ascriptions—for example, “knows who”, “knows whether”.
  • Schaffer, J. 2007b. “Closure, Contrast, and Answer.” Philosophical Studies 133(2): 233-255.
    • Shows how a contrastivist about knowledge can explain inferences supported by closure principles, even though the contrastivist has to reject standard closure principles.
  • Schaffer, J. 2008. “The Contrast-Sensitivity of Knowledge Ascriptions.” Social Epistemology 22(3): 235-245.
    • Argues against non-contrastivist treatments of the linguistic data used to motivate contrastivism.
  • Schaffer, J. 2010. “Contrastive Causation in the Law.” Legal Theory 16: 259-297.
    • Applies contrastivism about causation to causation as appealed to in judgments of legal responsibility.
  • Schaffer, J. 2012. “Causal Contextualisms.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 35-63.
    • Discussion of contrastivism about causation, with a somewhat pessimistic conclusion for its ultimate prospects.
  • Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2004. “Classy Pyrrhonism.” In W. Sinnott-Armstrong (ed.), Pyrrhonian Skepticism. Oxford University Press, 188-207.
    • Argues for contrastivism about knowledge, but uses this theory to support Pyrrhonian skepticism about unrelativized knowledge claims by arguing for skepticism about the notion of a “relevant” contrast class.
  • Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2006. Moral Skepticisms. Oxford University Press.
    • Applies the ideas in Sinnott-Armstrong (2004) to moral epistemology.
  • Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2008a. “A Contrastivist Manifesto.” Social Epistemology 22(3): 257-270.
    • An overview of contrastivism across philosophy.
  • Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2008b. “Replies to Hough, Baumann, and Blaauw.” Philosophical Quarterly 58(232): 478-488.
    • Replies to Baumann’s (2008) “crazy contrast class” objection to contrastivism about knowledge.
  • Sinnott-Armstrong, W. 2012. “Free Contrastivism.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 134-153.
    • Shows how a contrastive account of freedom can clarify disputes in discussions of determinism and moral responsibility.
  • Sloman, A. 1970. “Ought and Better.” Mind 79(315): 385-394.
    • Early development of a contrastive view of obligation.
  • Snedegar, J. 2012. “Contrastive Semantics for Deontic Modals.” In Blaauw (ed.), Contrastivism in Philosophy. Routledge, 116-133.
    • Argues for a contrastive treatment of deontic modals like “ought”, “must”, and “may”.
  • Snedegar, J. 2013a. “Negative Reason Existentials.” Thought 2(2): 108-116.
    • Shows how to use contrastivism to solve a puzzle about claims like “There’s no reason to cry over spilled milk.”
  • Snedegar, J. 2013b. “Reason Claims and Contrastivism about Reasons.” Philosophical Studies 166(2): 231-242.
    • Argues for contrastivism about normative reasons on the basis of reason claims employing “rather than”.
  • Snedegar, J. 2014a. “Deontic Reasoning across Contexts.” In F. Cariani, and others (eds.), Deontic Logic and Normative Systems, Vol. 12, Springer Lecture Notes in Computer Science, 2014a: 208-223.
    • Shows how a contrastivist about obligation can recapture intuitive inferences supported by inference rules the contrastivist rejects.
  • Snedegar, J. 2014b. “Contrastive Reasons and Promotion.” Ethics 125 (2014b): 39-63.
    • Argues for and develops a version of contrastivism, based on the idea that normative reasons are tied to the promotion of objectives.
  • Yalcin, S. 2011. “Nonfactualism about Epistemic Modality.” In Egan, A. and Weatherson, B. (eds.), Epistemic Modality. Oxford University Press, 295-332.
    • Introduces the idea of resolution-sensitivity in a discussion of epistemic modality.

 

Author Information

Justin Snedegar
Email: js280@st-andrews.ac.uk
University of St Andrews
United Kingdom

Leibniz: Logic

LeibnizThe revolutionary ideas of Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716) on logic were developed by him between 1670 and 1690. The ideas can be divided into four areas: the Syllogism, the Universal Calculus, Propositional Logic, and Modal Logic.

These revolutionary ideas remained hidden in the Archive of the Royal Library in Hanover until 1903 when the French mathematician Louis Couturat published the Opuscules et fragments inédits de Leibniz. Couturat was a great admirer of Leibniz’s thinking in general, and he saw in Leibniz a brilliant forerunner of modern logic. Nevertheless he came to the conclusion that Leibniz’s logic had largely failed and that in general the so-called “intensional” approach to logic was necessarily bound to fail. Similarly, in their standard historiography of logic, W. & M. Kneale (1962) maintained that Leibniz “never succeeded in producing a calculus which covered even the whole theory of the syllogism”. Even in recent years, scholars like Liske (1994), Swoyer (1995), and Schupp (2000) argued that Leibniz’s intensional conception must give rise to inconsistencies and paradoxes.

On the other hand, starting with Dürr (1930), Rescher (1954), and Kauppi (1960), a certain rehabilitation of Leibniz’s intensional logic may be observed which was by and by supported and supplemented by Poser (1969), Ishiguro (1972), Rescher (1979), Burkhardt (1980), Schupp (1982), and Mugnai (1992). However, the full wealth of Leibniz’s logical ideas became visible only in Lenzen (1990), (2004a), and (2004b), where the many pieces and fragments were joined together to an impressive system of four calculi:

  • The algebra of concepts L1 (which turns out to be deductively equivalent to the Boolean algebra of sets)
  • The quantificational system L2 (where “indefinite concepts” function as quantifiers ranging over concepts)
  • A propositional calculus of strict implication (obtained from L1 by the strict analogy between the containment-relation among concepts and the inference-relation among propositions)
  • The so-called “Plus-Minus-Calculus” (which is to be viewed as a theory of set-theoretical containment, “addition,” and “subtraction”).

Table of Contents

  1. Leibniz’s Logical Works
  2. Works on the Theory of the Syllogism
    1. Axiomatization of the Theory of the Syllogism
    2. The Semantics of “Characteristic Numbers”
    3. Linear Diagrams and Euler-circles
  3. Works on the Universal Calculus
    1. The Algebra of Concepts L1
    2. The Quantificational System L2
    3. The Plus-Minus-Calculus
  4. Leibniz’s Calculus of Strict Implication
  5. Works on Modal Logic
    1. Possible-Worlds-Semantics for Alethic Modalities
    2. Basic Principles of Deontic Logic
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Abbreviations for Leibniz’s works
    2. Secondary Literature

1. Leibniz’s Logical Works

Throughout his life (beginning in 1646 in Leipzig and ending in 1716 in Hanover), Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz did not publish a single paper on logic, except perhaps for the mathematical dissertation “De Arte Combinatoria” and the juridical disputa­tion “De Conditionibus” (GP 4, 27-104 and AE IV, 1, 97-150; the abbrevi­ations for Leibniz’s works are resolved in section 6). The former work deals with some issues in the theory of the syllogism, while the latter contains investigations of what is nowadays called deontic logic. Leibniz’s main aim in logic, however, was to extend the traditional syllogistic to a “Universal Calculus.” Although there exist several drafts of such a calculus which seem to have been composed for publication, none of them was eventually sent to press. So Leibniz’s logical essays appeared only posthumously. The early editions of his philosophical works, however, contained only a small selection of logical papers. It was not before the beginning of the 20th century that the majority of his logical fragments became generally accessible by the valuable edition of Louis Couturat.

Since only few manuscripts were dated by Leibniz, his logical oeuvre shall not be described here in chronological order but from a merely systematic point of view by distinguishing four groups:

  1. Works on the Theory of the Syllogism
  2. Works on the Universal Calculus
  3. Works on Propositional Logic
  4. Works on Modal Logic.

2. Works on the Theory of the Syllogism

Leibniz’s innovations within the theory of the syllogism comprise at least three topics:

(a)   An “Axiomatization” of the theory of the syllogism, that is, a reduction of the traditional inferences to a small number of basic laws which are sufficient to derive all other syllogisms.

(b)   The development of the semantics of so-called “characteristic num­bers” for evaluating the logical validity of a syllogistic inference.

(c)    The invention of two sorts of graphical devices, that is to say, linear diagrams and (later) so-called “Euler-circles,” as a heuristic for checking the validity of a syllogism.

a. Axiomatization of the Theory of the Syllogism

In the 17th century, logic was still strongly influenced, if not dominated, by syllogistic, that is, by the traditional theory of the four categorical forms:

Universal affirmative proposition (UA)        Every S is P          SaP

Universal negative proposition (UN)              No S is P               SeP

Particular affirmative proposition (PA)         Some S is P          SiP

Particular negative proposition (PN)              Some S isn’t P      SoP

A typical textbook of that time is the famous “Logique de Port Royal” (Arnauld & Nicole (1683)) which, apart from an introductory investigation of ideas, concepts, and propositions in general, basically consists of:

(i)       The theory of the so-called “simple” laws of subalternation, oppo­sition, and conversion;

(ii)      The theory of the syllogistic “moods” which are classified into four different “figures” for which specific rules hold.

As Leibniz defines it, a “subalternation takes place whenever a particular proposition is inferred from the corresponding universal proposition” (Cout, 80), that is:

SUB 1            SaP → SiP

SUB 2            SeP → SoP.

According to the modern analysis of the categorical forms in terms of first order logic, these laws are not strictly valid but hold only under the assumption that the subject term S is not empty. This problem of “existential import” will be discussed below.

The theory of opposition first has to determine which propositions are contradictories of each other in the sense that they can neither be together true nor be together false. Clearly, the PN is the contradictory, or negation, of the UA, while the PA is the negation of the UN:

OPP 1            ¬SaP ↔ SoP

OPP 2            ¬SeP ↔ SiP.

The next task is to determine which propositions are contraries to each other in the sense that they cannot be together true, while they may well be together false. As Leibniz states in “Theorem 6: The universal affirmative and the universal negative are contrary to each other” (Cout, 82). Finally, two propositions are said to be subcontraries if they cannot be together false while it is possible that are together true. As Leibniz notes in another theorem, the two particular propositions, SiP and SoP, are logically related to each other in this way. The theory of subalternation and opposition is often summarized in the familiar “Square of Opposition”:

leibniz_logic_graphic1

In the paper “De formis syllogismorum Mathematice definiendis” written around 1682 (Cout, 410-416, and the text-critical edition in AE VI, 4, 496-505) Leibniz tackled the task of “axiomatizing” the theory of the syllogistic figures and moods by reducing them to a small number of basic principles. The “Fundamentum syllogisticum”, that is, the axiomatic basis of the theory of the syllogism, is the “Dictum de omni et nullo” (The saying of ‘all’ and ‘none’):

If a total C falls within another total D, or if the total C falls outside D, then whatever is in C, also falls within D (in the former case) or outside D (in the latter case) (Cout, 410-411).

These laws warrant the validity of the following “perfect” moods of the “First Figure”:

BARBARA        CaD, BaC → BaD

CELARENT      CeD, BaC → BeD

DARII                 CaD, BiC → BiD

FERIO                 CeD, BiC → BoD.

On the one hand, if the second premise of the affirmative moods BARBARA and DARII is satisfied, that is, if B is either totally or partially contained in D, then, according to the “Dictum de Omni”, also B must be either totally or partially contained in D since, by the first premise, C is entirely contained in D. Similarly the negative moods CELARENT and FERIO follow from the “Dictum de Nullo”: “B is either totally or partially contained in C; but the entire C falls outside D; hence also B either totally or partially falls outside D” (Cout, 411).

Next Leibniz derives the laws of subalternation from the syllogisms DARII and FERIO by substituting ‘B’ for ‘C’ and ‘C’ for ‘D’, respectively. This derivation (and hence also the validity of the laws of subalternation) tacitly presupposes the following principle which Leibniz considered as an “identity”:

SOME             BiB.

With the help of the laws of subalternation, BARBARA and CELARENT may be “weakened” into

BARBARI      CaD, BaC → BiD

CELARO        CeD, BaC → BoD.

Thus the First Figure altogether has six valid moods, from which one obtains six moods of the Second and six of the Third Figure by means of a logical inference-scheme called “Regressus”:

REGRESS      If a conclusion Q logically follows from premises P1, P2, but if Q is false, then one of the premises must be false.

When Leibniz carefully carries out these derivations, he presupposes the laws of opposition, Opp 1, Opp 2. Finally, six valid moods of the Fourth Figure can be derived from corresponding moods of the First Figure with the help of the laws of conversions.According to traditional doctrines, the PA and the UN may be converted “simpliciter”, while the UA can only be converted “per accidens”:

CONV 1          BiD → DiB

CONV 2          BeD → DeB

CONV 3          BaD → DiB.

As Leibniz shows, these laws can in turn be derived from some previously proven syllogisms with the help of the “identical” proposition:

ALL                BaB.

Furthermore one easily obtains another law of conversion according to which the UN can also be converted “accidentally”:

CONV 4          BeD → DoB.

The announced derivation of the moods of the Fourth Figure was not carried out in the fragment “De formis syllogismorum Mathematice definiendis” which just breaks off with a reference to “Figura Quarta”. It may, however, be found in the manuscript LH IV, 6, 14, 3 which, unfortunately, was only partially edited in Cout, 204. At any rate, Leibniz managed to prove that all valid moods can be reduced to the “Fundamentum syllogisticum” in conjunction with the laws of opposition, the inference scheme “Regressus”, and the “identical” propositions SOME and ALL.

Now while ALL is an identity or theorem of first order logic, ∀x(Bx → Bx), SOME is nowadays interpreted as ∃x(Bx ∧ Bx). This formula is equivalent to ∃x(Bx), that is, to the assumption that there “exists” at least one x such that x is B. Hence the laws of subalternation presuppose that each concept B (which can occupy the position of the subject of a categorical form) is “non-empty”. Leibniz discussed this problem of “existential import” in a paper entitled “Difficultates quaedam logicae” (GP 7, 211-217) where he distinguished two kinds of “existence”: Actual existence of the individuals inhabiting our real world vs. merely possible subsistence of individuals “in the region of ideas”. According to Leibniz, logical inferences should always be evaluated with reference to “the region of ideas”, that is, the larger set of all possible individuals. Therefore all that is required for the validity of subalternation is that the term B occupying the position of the subject of a categorical form has a non-empty extension within the domain of possible individuals. As will turn out below (compare the definition of an extensional interpretation of L1 in section 3.1), this weak condition of “existential import” becomes tantamount to the assumption that the respective concept B is self-consistent!

b. The Semantics of “Characteristic Numbers”

In a series of papers of April 1679, Leibniz elaborated the idea of assigning natural numbers to the subject and predicate of a proposition a in such a way that the truth of a can be “read off” from these numbers. Apparently Leibniz was hoping that mankind might once discover the “true” characteristic numbers which would enable one to determine the truth of arbitrary propositions just by mathematical calculations! In the essays of April 1679, however, he pursued only the much more modest goal of defining appropriate arithmetical conditions for determining whether a syllogistic inference is logically valid. This task was guided by the idea that a term composed of concepts A and B gets assigned the product of the numbers assigned to the components:

For example, since ‘man’ is ‘rational animal’, if the number of ‘animal’, a, is 2, and the number of ‘rational’, r, is 3, then the number of ‘man’, m, will be the same as a*r, in this example 2*3 or 6. (LLP, 17).

Now a UA like ‘All gold is metal’ can be understood as maintaining that the concept ‘gold’ contains the concept ‘metal’ (because ‘gold’ can be defined as ‘the heaviest metal’). Therefore it seems obvious to postulate that in general ‘Every S is P’ is true if and only if s, the characteristic number assigned to S, contains p, the number assigned to P, as a prime factor; or, in other words, s must be divisible by p. In a first approach, Leibniz thought that the truth-conditions for the particular proposition ‘Some S are P’ might be construed similarly by requiring that either s can be divided by p or conversely p can be divided by s. But this was mistaken. After some trials and errors, Leibniz found the following more complicated solution:

(i)     To every term T, a pair of natural numbers <+t1;-t2> is assigned such that t1 and t2 are relatively prime, that is, they don’t have a common divisor.

(ii)    The UA ‘Every S is P’ is true (relative to the assignment (i)) if and only if +s1 is divisible by +p1 and -s2 is divisible by -p2.

(iii)   The UN ‘No S is P’ is true if and only if +s1 and -p2 have a common divisor or +p1 and -s2 have a common divisor.

(iv)   The PA ‘Some S is P’ is true if and only if condition (iii) is not satisfied.

(v)    The PN ‘Some S isn’t P’ is true if and only if condition (ii) is not satisfied.

(vi)   An inference from premises P1, P2 to the conclusion C is logically valid if and only if for each assignment of numbers satisfying condition (i), C becomes true whenever both P1 and P2 are true.

As was shown by Lukasiewicz (1951), this semantics satisfies the simple inferences of opposition, subalternation, and conversion, as well as all (and only) the syllogisms which are commonly regarded as valid. Leibniz tried to generalize this semantics for the entire algebra of concepts, but he never found a way to cope with negative concepts. This problem has only been solved by contemporary logicians; compare Sanchez-Mazas (1979), Sotirov (1999).

c. Linear Diagrams and Euler-circles

In the paper “De Formae Logicae Comprobatione per Linearum ductus” probably written after 1686 (Cout, 292-321), Leibniz elaborated two methods for representing the content of categorical propositions. The UA, for example, ‘Every man is an animal’, can be represented either by two nested circles or by two horizontal lines which symbolize that the extension of B is contained in the extension of C (the subsequent graphics are scans from Cout, 292-295):

leibniz_logic_graphic2

In the case of a UN like ‘No man is a stone’, one obtains the following diagrams which symbolize that the extension of B is set-theoretically disjoint from the extension of C:

leibniz_logic_graphic3

Similarly, the following circles and lines symbolize that, in the case of a PA like ‘Some men are wise’, the extensions of B and C overlap:

leibniz_logic_graphic4

Finally, in the case of a PN like ‘Some men are not ruffians’, the diagrams are meant to symbolize that the extension of B is partially disjoint from the extension of C,that is, that some elements of B are not elements of C:

leibniz_logic_graphic5

These diagrams may then be used to check whether a given inference is valid. Thus, for example, the validity of FERIO can be illustrated as follows:

leibniz_logic_graphic6

Here the conclusion ‘Some D is not B’ follows from the premises ‘No C is B’ and ‘Some D is C’ because the elements of D which are in C can’t be elements of B. On the other hand, invalid syllogisms as, for example, the mood “AOO” of the Fourth Figure, can be refuted as follows:

leibniz_logic_graphic7

As the diagram illustrates, the truth of the premises ‘Every B is C’ and ‘Some C is not D’ is compatible with a situation where the conclusion ‘Some D is not B’ is false, that is, where ‘Every D is B’ is true.

Of course, Leibniz’s diagrams which were re-discovered in the 18th century among others by Euler (1768) are not without problems. In particular, the circles for the PA and the PN are somewhat inaccurate because they basic­ally visualize one and the same state of affairs, namely that (i) some B are C, and (ii) some B are not C, and also (iii) some C are not B. The need to distinguish between different situations such as ((i) & (ii)) in contrast to ((i) & not (ii)) led to improvements of the method of “Euler-circles” as suggested by Venn (1881), Hamilton (1861), and others. Note, incidentally, that, in the GI, Leibniz himself improved the linear diagrams for the UA, PA and PN by drawing perpendicular lines symbolizing the “maximum”,that is, “the limits beyond which the terms cannot, and within which they can, be extended”. At the same time he used a double horizontal line to symbolize “the minimum, that is, that which cannot be taken away without affecting the relation of the terms” (LLP, 73-4, fn. 2).

3. Works on the Universal Calculus

In the period between, roughly, 1679 and 1690, Leibniz spent much effort to generalize the traditional logic to a “Universal Calculus”. At least three different calculi may be distinguished:

(a) The algebra of concepts which is provably equivalent to the Boolean algebra of sets;

(b)   A fragmentary quantificational system in which the quantifiers range over concepts but in which quantification over individuals may be introduced by definition;

(c) The so-called “Plus-Minus-calculus” which constitutes an abstract system of “real addition” and “subtraction”. When this calculus is applied to concepts, it yields a weaker logic than the full algebra (a).

a. The Algebra of Concepts L1

The algebra of concepts grows out of the syllogistic framework by three achievements. First, Leibniz drops the informal quantifier expression ‘every’ and formulates the UA simply as “A is B” or, equivalently, as “A contains B”. This fundamental proposition shall here be symbolized as A∈B while its negation will be abbreviated as A∉B. Second, Leibniz introduces an operator of conceptual conjunction which combines two concepts A and B into AB (sometimes also written as “A+B”). Third, Leibniz allows the unrestricted use of conceptual negation which shall here be symbolized as ~A (“Not-A”). Hence, in particular, one can form the inconsistent concept A~A (“A Not-A”) and its tautological counterpart ~(A~A).

Identity or coincidence of concepts might be defined as mutual containment:

DEF 1            (A = B) =df (A∈B) ∧ (B∈A).

Alternatively, the algebra of concepts can be built up with ‘=’ as a primitive operator while ‘∈’ is defined by:

DEF 2            (A∈B) =df (A = AB).

Another important operator may be introduced by definition. Concept B is possible if B does not contain a contradiction like A~A:

DEF 3            P(B) =df (B∉A~A).

Leibniz uses many different locutions to express the self-consistency of a concept A. Instead of ‘A est possibile’ he often says ‘A est res’, ‘A est ens’; or simply ‘A est’. In the opposite case of an impossible concept he also calls A a “false term” (“terminus falsus”).

Identity can be axiomatized by the law of reflexivity in conjunction with the rule of substitutivity:

IDEN 1            A = A

IDEN 2            If A = B, then α[A] ↔ α[B].

By means of these principles, one easily derives the following corollaries:

IDEN 3            A = B → B = A

IDEN 4            A = B ∧ B = C → A = C

IDEN 5            A = B → ~A = ~B

IDEN 6            A = B → AC = BC.

The following laws express the reflexivity and the transitivity of the containment relation:

CONT 1          A∈A

CONT 2          A∈B ∧ B∈C → A∈C.

The most fundamental principle for the operator of conceptual conjunction says: “That A contains B and A contains C is the same as that A contains BC” (LLP, 58, fn. 4), that is,

CONJ 1          A∈BC ↔ A∈B ∧ A∈C.

Conjunction then satisfies the following laws:

CONJ 2          AA = A

CONJ 3          AB = BA

CONJ 4          AB∈A

CONJ 5          AB∈B.

The next operator is conceptual negation, ‘not’. Leibniz had serious problems with finding the proper laws governing this operator. From the tradition, he knew little more than the “law of double negation”:

NEG 1            ~~A = A

One important step towards a complete theory of conceptual negation was to transform the informal principle of contraposition, ‘Every A is B, therefore Every Not-B is Not-A’ into the following principle:

NEG 2            A∈B ↔ ~B∈~A.

Furthermore Leibniz discovered various variants of the “law of consistency”:

NEG 3            A ≠ ~A

NEG 4            A = B → A ≠ ~B.

NEG 5*           A∉~A

NEG 6*           A∈B → A∉~B.

In the GI, these principles are formulated as follows: “A proposition false in itself is ‘A coincides with Not-A’” (§ 11); “If A = B, then A ≠ Not-B” (§ 171); “It is false that B contains Not-B, that is, B doesn’t contain Not-B” (§ 43); and “A is B, therefore A isn’t Not-B” (§ 91).

Principles NEG 5* and NEG 6* have been marked with a ‘*’ in order to indicate that the laws as stated by Leibniz are not absolutely valid but have to be restricted to self-consistent terms:

NEG 5            P(A) → A∉~A

NEG 6            P(A) → (A∈B → A∉~B).

The following two laws describe some characteristic relations between the possibility-operator P and the other operators of L1:

POSS 1           A∈B ∧ P(A) → P(B)

POSS 2           A∈B ↔ ¬P(A~B).

All these principles have been discovered by Leibniz himself who thus provided an almost complete axiomatization of L1. As a matter of fact, the “intensional” algebra of concept can be proven to be equivalent to Boole’s extensional algebra of sets provided that one adds the following counterpart of the “ex contradictorio quodlibet”:

NEG 7            (A~A)∈B.

As regards the relation of conceptual containment, A∈B, it is important to observe that Leibniz’s standard formulation ‘A contains B’ expresses the so-called “intensional” view of concepts as ideas, while we here want to develop an extensional interpretation in terms of the sets of individuals that fall under the concepts. Leibniz explained the mutual relationship between the “intensional” and the extensional point of view in the following passage from the “New Essays on Human understanding”:

The common manner of statement concerns individuals, whereas Aristotle’s refers rather to ideas or universals. For when I say Every man is an animal I mean that all the men are included among all the animals; but at the same time I mean that the idea of animal is included in the idea of man. ‘Animal’ comprises more individuals than ‘man’ does, but ‘man’ comprises more ideas or more attributes: one has more instances, the other more degrees of reality; one has the greater extension, the other the greater intension. (NE, Book IV, ch. XVII, § 8; compare the original French version in GP 5, 469).

If ‘Int(A)’ and ‘Ext(A)’ abbreviate the “intension” and the extension of a concept A, respectively, then the so-called law of reciprocity can be formalized as follows:

RECI               Int(A) ⊆ Int (B) ↔ Ext(A) ⊇ Ext(B).

From this it immediately follows that two concepts A, B have the same “intension” iff they have the same extension. This somewhat surprising result might seem to unveil an inadequacy of Leibniz’s conception. However, “intensionality” in the sense of traditional logic must not be mixed up with intensionality in the modern sense. Furthermore, in Leibniz’s view, the extension of a concept A is not just the set of actually existing individuals, but rather the set of all possible individuals that fall under concept A. Therefore one may define the concept of an extensional interpretation of L1 in accordance with Leibniz’s ideas as follows:

DEF 4      Let U be a non-empty set (the domain of all possible indi­viduals), and let ϕ be a function such that ϕ(A) ⊆ U for each concept-letter A. Then ϕ is an extensional interpretation of L1 if and only if:

(1) ϕ(A∈B) = true iff ϕ(A) ⊆ ϕ(B);

(2) ϕ(A=B) = true iff ϕ(A) = ϕ(B);

(3) ϕ(AB) = ϕ(A) ∩ ϕ(B);

(4) ϕ(~A) = complement of ϕ(A);

(5) ϕ(P(A)) = true iff ϕ(A) ≠ ∅.

Conditions (1) and (2) are straightforward consequences of RECI. Condition (3) also is trivial since it expresses that an individual x belongs to the extension of AB just in case that x belongs to the extension of both concepts (and hence to their intersection). According to condition (4), the extension of the negative concept ~A is just the set of all individuals which do not fall under the concept A. Condition (5) says that a concept A is possible if and only if it has a non-empty extension.

At first sight, this requirement appears inadequate, since there are certain concepts – such as that of a unicorn – which happen to be empty but which may nevertheless be regarded as possible, that is, not involving a contradiction. However, the universe of discourse underlying the extensional interpretation of L1 does not consist of actually existing objects only, but instead comprises all possible individuals. Therefore the non-emptiness of the extension of A is both necessary and sufficient for guaranteeing the self-consistency of A. Clearly, if A is possible, then there must be at least one possible individual x that falls under concept A.

It has often been noted that Leibniz’s logic of concepts lacks the operator of disjunction. Although this is by and large correct, it doesn’t imply any defect or any incompleteness of the system L1 because the operator A∨B may simply be introduced by definition:

DISJ 1            A∨B =df ~(~A ~B).

On the background of the above axioms of negation and conjunction, the standard laws for disjunction, for example

DISJ 2            A∈(A∨B)

DISJ 3            B∈(A∨B)

DISJ 4            A∈C ∧ B∈C → (A∨B)∈C,

then become provable (Lenzen (1984)).

b. The Quantificational System L2

Leibniz’s quantifier logic L2 emerges from L1 by the introduction of so-called “indefinite concepts”. These concepts are symbolized by letters from the end of the alphabet X, Y, Z …, and they function as quantifiers ranging over concepts. Thus, in the GI, Leibniz explains:

(16) An affirmative proposition is ‘A is B’ or ‘A contains B’ […]. That is, if we substitute the value for A, one obtains ‘A coincides with BY’. For example, ‘Man is an animal’, that is, ‘Man’ is the same as ‘a … animal’ (namely, ‘Man’ is ‘rational animal’). For by the sign ‘Y’ I mean something undetermined, so that ‘BY’ is the same as ‘Some B’, or ‘A … animal’ […], or ‘A certain animal’. So ‘A is B’ is the same as ‘A coincides with some B’, that is, ‘A = BY’.

With the help of the modern symbol for the existential quantifier, the latter law can be expressed more precisely as follows:

CONT 3          A∈B ↔ ∃Y(A = BY).

As Leibniz himself noted, the formalization of the UA according to CONT 3 is provably equivalent to the simpler representation according to DEF 2:

It is noteworthy that for ‘A = BY’ one can also say ‘A = AB’ so that there is no need to introduce a new letter. (Cout, 366; compare also LLP, 56, fn. 1.)

On the one hand, according to the rule of existential generalization,

EXIST 1          If α[A], then ∃Yα[Y],

A = AB immediately entails ∃Y(A = YB). On the other hand, if there exists some Y such that A = YB, then according to IDEN 6, AB = YBB, that is, AB = YB and hence (by the premise A = YB) AB = A. (This proof incidentally was given by Leibniz himself in the important paper “Primaria Calculi Logic Fundamenta” of August 1690; Cout, 235).

Next observe that Leibniz often used to formalize the PA ‘Some A is B’ by means of the indefinite concept Y as ‘YA∈B’. In view of CONT 3, this repre­sentation might be transformed into the (elliptic) equation YA = ZB. However, both formalizations are somewhat inadequate because they are easily seen to be theorems of L2! According to CONJ 4, BA contains B, hence by EXIST 1:

CONJ 6          ∃Y(YA∈B).

Similarly, since, according to CONJ 3, AB = BA, a twofold application of EXIST 1 yields:

CONJ 7          ∃Y∃Z(YA = BZ).

These tautologies, of course, cannot adequately represent the PA which for an appropriate choice of concepts A and B may become false! In order to resolve these difficulties, consider a draft of a calculus probably written between 1686 and 1690 (compare Cout, 259-261, and the text-critical edition in AE, VI, 4, # 171), where Leibniz proved principle:

NEG 8*           A∉B ↔ ∃Y(YA∈~B).

On the one hand, it is interesting to see that after first formulating the right hand side of the equivalence, “as usual”, in the elliptic way ‘YA is Not-B’, Leibniz later paraphrased it by means of the explicit quantifier expression “there exists a Y such that YA is Not-B”. On the other hand, Leibniz discovered that NEG 8* has to be improved by requiring more exactly that there exists a Y such that YA contains ~B and YA is possible, that is, Y must be compatible with A:

NEG 8            A∉B ↔ ∃Y(P(YA) ∧ YA∈~B).

Leibniz’s proof of this important law is quite remarkable:

(18) […] to say ‘A isn’t B’ is the same as to say ‘there exists a Y such that YA is Not-B’. If ‘A is B’ is false, then ‘A Not-B’ is possible by [POSS 2]. ‘Not-B’ shall be called ‘Y’. Hence YA is possible. Hence YA is Not-B. Therefore we have shown that, if it is false that A is B, then QA is Not-B. Conversely, let us show that if QA is Not-B, ‘A is B’ is false. For if ‘A is B’ would be true, ‘B’ could be substituted for ‘A’ and we would obtain ‘QB is Not-B’ which is absurd. (Cout, 261)

To conclude the sketch of L2, let us consider some of the rare passages where an indefinite concept functions as a universal quantifier. In the above quoted draft (Cout, 260), Leibniz put forward principle “(15) ‘A is B’ is the same as ‘If L is A, it follows that L is B’”:

CONT 4          A∈B ↔ ∀Y(Y∈A → Y∈B).

Furthermore, in § 32 GI, Leibniz at least vaguely recognized that just as A∈B (according to CONJ 6) is equivalent to ∃Y(A = YB), so the negation A∉B means that, for any indefinite concept Y, A ≠ BY:

CONT 5          A∉B ↔ ∀Y(A ≠ YB).

According to AE, VI, 4, 753, Leibniz had written: “(32) Propositio Negativa. A non continet B, seu A esse (continere) B falsum est, seu A non coincidit BY”. Unfortunately, the last passage ‘seu A non coincidit BY’ had been overlooked by Couturat and it is therefore also missing in Parkinson’s translation in LLP! Anyway, with the help of ‘∀’, one can formalize Leibniz’s conception of individual concepts as maximally-consistent concepts as follows:

IND 1             Ind(A) ↔df P(A) ∧ ∀Y(P(AY) → A∈Y).

Thus A is an individual concept iff A is “self-consistent and A contains every concept Y which is compatible with A. The underlying idea of the complete­ness of individual concepts had been formulated in § 72 GI as follows:

So if BY is [“being”], and the indefinite term Y is superfluous, that is, in the way that ‘a certain Alexander the Great’ and ‘Alexander the Great’ are the same, then B is an individual. If the term BA is [“being”] and if B is an individual, then A will be superfluous; or if BA=C, then B=C (LLP 65, § 72 + fn. 1; for a closer interpretation of this idea, see Lenzen (2004c)).

Note, incidentally, that IND 1 might be simplified by requiring that, for each concept Y, A either contains Y or contains ~Y:

IND 2             Ind(A) ↔ ∀Y(A∈~Y ↔ A∉Y).

As a corollary it follows that the invalid principle

NEG 9*          A∉B → A∈~B,

which Leibniz again and again had considered as valid, in fact holds only for individual concepts:

NEG 9            Ind(A) → (A∉B → A∈~B).

Already in the “Calculi Universalis Investigationes” of 1679, Leibniz had pointed out:

…If two propositions are given with exactly the same singular [!] subject, where the predicate of the one is contradictory to the predicate of the other, then necessarily one proposition is true and the other is false. But I say: exactly the same [singular] subject, for example, ‘This gold is a metal’, ‘This gold is a not-metal.’ (AE VI, 4, 217-218).

The crucial issue here is that NEG 9* holds only for an individual concept like, for example, ‘Apostle Peter’, but not for general concepts as, for example, ‘man’. The text-critical apparatus of AE reveals that Leibniz was somewhat diffident about this decisive point. He began to illustrate the above rule by the correct example “if I say ‘Apostle Peter was a Roman bishop’, and ‘Apostle Peter was not a Roman bishop’” and then went on, erroneously, to generalize this law for arbitrary terms: “or if I say ‘Every man is learned’ ‘Every man is not learned’.” Finally he noticed this error “Here it becomes evident that I am mistaken, for this rule is not valid.” The long story of Leibniz’s cardinal mistake of mixing up ‘A isn’t B’ and ‘A is not-B’ is analyzed in detail in Lenzen (1986).

There are many different ways to represent the categorical forms by formulas of L1 or L2. The most straightforward formalization would be the following “homogenous” schema in terms of conceptual containment:

UA   A∈B                                    UN   A∈~B

PA   A∉~B                                  PN   A∉B.

The “homogeneity” consists in two facts:

(a)   The formula for the UN is obtained from that of the UA by replacing the predicate B with its negation, ~B. This is the formal counterpart of the traditional principle of obversion according to which, for example, ‘No A is B’ is equivalent to ‘Every A is not-B’.

(b)  In accordance with the traditional laws of opposition, the formulas for the particular propositions are just taken as the negations of corresponding universal propositions.

In view of DEF 2, the first schema may be transformed into

UA   A = AB                                UN   A = A~B

PA   A ≠ A~B                               PN   A ≠ AB.

Similarly, by means of the fundamental law POSS 2, one obtains

UA   ¬P(A~B)                              UN   ¬P(AB)

PA   P(AB)                                   PN   P(A~B).

Furthermore, with the help of indefinite concepts, one can formulate, for example,

UA   ∃Y(A = YB)                          UN   ∃Y(A = Y~B)

PA   ∀Y(A ≠ Y~B)                        PN   ∀Y(A ≠ YB).

Leibniz used to work with various elements of these representations, often combining them into complicated inhomogeneous schemata such as:

“A = YB           is the UA, where the adjunct Y is like an additional unknown term: ‘Every man’ is the same as ‘A certain animal’.

YA = ZB           is the PA. ‘Some man’ or ‘Man of a certain kind’ is the same as ‘A certain learned’.

A = Y not-B      [is the UN] No man is a stone, that is, Every man is a not-stone, that is, ‘Man’ and ‘A certain not-stone’ coincide.

YA = Z not-B    [is the PN] A certain man isn’t learned or is not-learned, that is, ‘A certain man’ and ‘A certain not-learned’ coincide” (Cout, 233-234).

But the representations of PA and PN of this schema are inadequate because the formulas ‘[∃Y∃Z](YA = ZB)’ and ‘[∃Y∃Z](YA = Z~B)’ are theorems of L2! These conditions may, however, easily be corrected by adding the require­ment that YA is self-consistent:

UA   ∃Y(A = YB)                                  UN   ∃Y(A = Y~B)

PA   ∃Y∃Z(P(YA) ∧ YA = ZB)        PN   ∃Y∃Z(P(YA) ∧ YA = Z~B).

Already in the paper “De Formae Logicae Comprobatione per Linearum ductus”, Leibniz had made numerous attempts to prove the basic laws of syllogistic with the help of these schemata. He continued these efforts in two interesting fragments of August 1690 dealing with “The Primary Bases of a Logical Calculus” (LLP, 90 – 92 + 93-94; compare also the closely related essays “Principia Calculi rationalis” in Cout, 229-231 and the untitled fragments Cout, 259-261 + 261-264). In the end, however, Leibniz remained unsatisfied with his attempts.

To be sure, a complete proof of the theory of the syllogism could easily be obtained by drawing upon the full list of “axioms” for L1 and L2 as stated above. But Leibniz more ambitiously tried to find proofs which presuppose only a small number of “self-evident” laws for identity. In particular, he was not willing to adopt principle

(17) Not-B = not-B not-(AB), that is, Not-B contains Not-AB, or Not-B is not-AB

as a fundamental axiom which therefore needs not itself be demonstrated. Although Leibniz realized that (17) is equivalent to the law of contraposition repeated in the subsequent §

(19) ‘A = AB’ and ‘Not-B = Not-B Not-A’ are equivalent. This is conversion by contraposition (Cout, 422),

he still thought it necessary to prove this “axiom”: “This remains to be demonstrated in our calculus”!

c. The Plus-Minus-Calculus

The so-called Plus-Minus-Calculus was mainly developed in the paper “Non inelegans specimen demonstrandi in abstractis” of around 1686/7 (compare GP 7, ## XIX, XX and the text-critical edition in AE VI, 4, ## 177, 178; English translations are provided in LLP, 122-130 + 131-144). Strictly speaking, the Plus-Minus-Calculus is not a logical calculus but rather a much more general calculus which admits of different applications and interpretations. In its abstract form, it should be regarded as a theory of set-theoretical containment, set-theoretical “addition”, and set-theoretical “subtraction”. Unlike modern systems of set-theory, however, Leibniz’s calculus has no counterpart of the relation ‘x is an element of A’; and it also lacks the operator of set-theoretical “negation”, that is, set-theoretical complement! The complement of set A might, though, be defined with the help of the subtraction operator as (U-A) where the constant ‘U’ designates the universe of discourse. But, in Leibniz’s calculus, this additional logical element is lacking.

Leibniz’s drafts exhibit certain inconsistencies which result from the experi­mental character of developing the laws for “real” addition and subtraction in close analogy to the laws of arithmetical addition and subtraction. The genesis of this idea is described in detail in Lenzen (1989). The incon­sistencies might be removed basically in two ways. First, one might restrict A-B to the case where B is contained in A; such a conservative reconstruction of the Plus-Minus-Calculus has been developed in Dürr (1930). The second, more rewarding alternative consists in admitting the operation of “real subtraction” A-B also if B is not contained in A. In any case, however, one has to give up Leibniz’s idea that subtraction might yield “privative” entities which are “less than nothing”.

In the following reconstruction, Leibniz’s symbols ‘+’ for the addition (that is, union) and ‘-’ for the subtraction of sets are adopted, while his informal expressions ‘Nothing’ (“nihil”) and ‘is in’ (“est in”) are replaced by the modern symbols ‘∅’ and ‘⊆’. Set-theoretical identity may be treated either as a primitive or as a defined operator. In the former case, inclusion can be defined either by A⊆B =df ∃Y(A+Y = B) or simpler as A⊆B =df (A+B = B). If, conversely, inclusion is taken as primitive, identity can be defined as mutual inclusion: A=B =df (A⊆B) ∧ (B⊆A) (see, for example, Definition 3, Propositions 13 +14 and Proposition 17 in LLP, 131-144).

Set-theoretical addition is symmetric, or, as Leibniz puts it, “transposition makes no difference here” (LLP, 132):

PLUS 1           A+B = B+A.

The main difference between arithmetical addition and “real addition” is that the addition of one and the same “real” thing (or set of things) doesn’t yield anything new:

PLUS 2           A+A = A.

As Leibniz puts it (LLP, 132): “A+A = A […] that is, repetition changes nothing. (For although four coins and another four coins are eight coins, four coins and the same four already counted are not)”.

The “real nothing”, that is, the empty set ∅, is characterized as follows: “It does not matter whether Nothing is put or not, that is, A+Nih. = A” (Cout, 267):

NIHIL 1           A+∅ = A.

In view of the relation (A⊆B) ↔ (A+B = B), this law can be transformed into:

NIHIL 2           ∅⊆A.

“Real” subtraction may be regarded as the converse operation of addition: “If the same is put and taken away […] it coincides with Nothing. That is, A […] – A […] = N” (LLP, 124, Axiom 2):

MINUS 1         A-A = ∅.

Leibniz also considered the following principles which in a stronger form express that subtraction is the converse of addition:

MINUS 2*       (A+B)-B = A

MINUS 3*       (A+B) = C → C-B = A.

But he soon recognized that these laws do not hold in general but only in the special case where the sets A and B are “uncommunicating” (Cout, 267, # 29: “Therefore if A+B = C, then A = C-B […] but it is necessary that A and B have nothing in common”.) The new operator of “communicating” sets has to be understood as follows:

If some term, M, is in A, and the same term is in B, this term is said to be ‘common’ to them, and they will be said to be ‘communicating’. (LLP, 123, Definition 4)

Hence two sets A and B have something in common if and only if there exists some set Y such that Y⊆A and Y⊆B. Now since, trivially, the empty set is included in every set A (NIHIL 2), one has to add the qualification that Y is not empty:

COMMON 1     Com(A,B) ↔df ∃Y(Y≠∅ ∧ Y⊆A ∧ Y⊆B).

The necessary restriction of MINUS 2* and MINUS 3* can then be formalized as follows:

MINUS 2         ¬Com(A,B) → ((A+B)-B = A)

MINUS 3         ¬Com(A,B) ∧ (A+B = C) → (C-B = A).

Similarly, Leibniz recognized (LLP, 130) that from an equation A+B = A+C, A may be subtracted on both sides provided that C is “uncommunicating” both with A and with B, that is,

MINUS 4         ¬Com(A,B) ∧ ¬Com(A,C) → (A+B = A+C → B=C).

Furthermore Leibniz discovered that the implication in MINUS 2 may be converted (and hence strengthened into a biconditional). Thus one obtains the following criterion: Two sets A, B are “uncommunicating” if and only if the result of first adding and then subtracting B coincides with A. Inserting negations on both sides of this equivalence one obtains:

COMMON 2     Com(A,B) ↔ ((A+B)-B) ≠ A.

Whenever two sets A, B are communicating or “have something in common”, the intersection of A and B, in modern symbols A∩B, is not empty (LLP, 127, Case 2 of Theorem IX: “Let us assume meanwhile that E is everything which A and G have in common – if they have something in common, so that if they have nothing in common, E = Nothing”), that is,

COMMON 3     Com(A,B) ↔ A∩B ≠ ∅.

Furthermore, “What has been subtracted and the remainder are un­communicating” (LLP, 128, Theorem X), that is,

COMMON 4     ¬Com(A-B,B).

Leibniz further discovered the following formula which allows one to “calculate” the intersection or “commune” of A and B by a series of additions and subtractions: A∩B = B-((A+B)-A). In a small fragment (Cout, 250) he explained:

Suppose you have A and B and you want to know if there exists some M which is in both of them. Solution: combine those two into one, A+B, which shall be called L […] and from L one of the constituents, A, shall be subtracted […] let the rest be N; then, if N coincides with the other constituent, B, they have nothing in common. But if they do not coincide, they have something in common which can be found by subtracting the rest N […] from B […] and there remains M, the commune of A and B, which was looked for.

4. Leibniz’s Calculus of Strict Implication

It is a characteristic feature of Leibniz’s logic that when he states and proves the laws of concept logic, he takes the requisite rules and laws of propositional logic for granted. Once the former have been established, however, the latter can be obtained from the former by observing a strict analogy between concepts and propositions which allows one to re-interpret the conceptual connectives as propositional connectives. Note, incidentally, that in the 19th century George Boole in roughly the same way first presupposed propositional logic to develop his algebra of sets, and only afterwards derived the propositional calculus out of the set-theoretical calculus. While Boole thus arrived at the classical, two-valued propositional calculus, Leibniz’s approach instead yields a modal logic of strict implication.

Leibniz outlined a simple, ingenious method to transform the algebra of concepts into an algebra of propositions. Already in the “Notationes Generales” written between 1683 and 1685 (AE VI, 4, # 131), he pointed out to the parallel between the containment relation among concepts and the implication relation among propositions. Just as the simple proposition ‘A is B’ is true, “when the predicate [A] is contained in the subject” B, so a conditional proposition ‘If A is B, then C is D’ is true, “when the consequent is contained in the antecedent” (AE VI, 4, 551). In later works Leibniz compressed this idea into formulations such as “a proposition is true whose predicate is contained in the subject or more generally whose consequent is contained in the antecedent” (Cout, 401). The most detailed explanation of this idea was given in §§ 75, 137 and 189 of the GI:

If, as I hope, I can conceive all propositions as terms, and hypotheticals as categoricals and if I can treat all propositions universally, this promises a wonderful ease in my symbolism and analysis of concepts, and will be a discovery of the greatest importance […]

We have, then, discovered many secrets of great importance for the analysis of all our thoughts and for the discovery and proof of truths. We have discovered […] how absolute and hypothetical truths have one and the same laws and are contained in the same general theorems […]

Our principles, therefore, will be these […] Sixth, whatever is said of a term which contains a term can also be said of a proposition from which another proposition follows (LLP, 66, 78, and 85).

To conceive all propositions in analogy to concepts means in particular that the conditional ‘If a then b’ will be logically treated like the containment relation between concepts, ‘A contains B’. Furthermore, as Leibniz explained elsewhere, negations and conjunctions of propositions are to be conceived just as negations and conjunctions of concepts. Thus one obtains the following mapping of the primitive formulas of the algebra of concepts into formulas of the algebra of propositions:

A∈B              α → β

A=B               α ↔ β

~A                 ¬α

AB                 α∧β

P(A)              ◊α

As Leibniz himself explained, the fundamental law POSS 2 does not only hold for the containment-relation between concepts but also for the entailment relation between propositions:

‘A contains B’ is a true proposition if ‘A non-B’ entails a contradiction. This applies both to categorical and to hypothetical propositions (Cout, 407).

Hence A∈B ↔ ¬P(A~B) may be “translated” into (α→β) ↔ ¬◊(α∧¬β). This formula unmistakably shows that Leibniz’s conditional is not a material but rather a strict implication. As Rescher already noted in (1954: 10), Leibniz’s account provides a definition of “entailment in terms of negation, conjunction, and the notion of possibility”, which coincides with the modern definition of strict implication put forward, for example, in Lewis & Langford (1932: 124): “The relation of strict implication can be defined in terms of negation, possibility, and product […] Thus ‘p implies q’ […] is to mean ‘It is false that it is possible that p should be true and q false’”. This definition is almost identical with Leibniz’s explanation in “Analysis Particularum”: “Thus if I say ‘If L is true it follows that M is true’, this means that one cannot suppose at the same time that L is true and that M is false” (AE VI, 4, 656).

Given the above “translation”, the basic axioms and theorems of the algebra of concepts can be transformed into the following laws of the algebra of propositions:

IMPL 1            α → α

IMPL 2            (α → β) ∧ (β→γ) → (α→γ)

IMPL 3            (α → β) ↔ (α ↔ α∧β)

CONJ 1          (α → β∧γ) ↔ ((α→β) ∧ (α→γ))

CONJ 2          α∧β → α

CONJ 3          α∧β → β

CONJ 4          α∧α ↔ α

CONJ 5          α∧β ↔ β∧α

NEG 1            ¬¬α ↔ α

NEG 2            ¬(α ↔ ¬α)

NEG 3            (α → β) ↔ (¬β→ ¬α)

NEG 4            ¬α → ¬(α∧β)

NEG 5            ◊α → ((α → β) → ¬(α → ¬β))

NEG 6            (α ∧¬α) → β

POSS 1           (α → β) ∧ ◊α → ◊β

POSS 2           (α → β) ↔ ¬◊(α ∧ ¬β)

POSS 3           ¬◊(α ∧ ¬α)

5. Works on Modal Logic

When people credit Leibniz with having anticipated “Possible-worlds-seman­tics”, they mostly refer to his philosophical writings, in particular to the “Nouveaux Essais sur l’entendement humain” (NE) and to the metaphysical speculations of the “Essais de theodicée” (Theo) of 1710. Leibniz argues there that while there are infinitely many ways how God might have created the world, the real world that God finally decided to create is the best of all possible worlds. As a matter of fact, however, Leibniz has much more to offer than this over-optimistic idea (which was rightly criticized by Voltaire and, for example, in part 2 of chapter 8 of Hume’s “An Enquiry concerning Human Under­standing”). In what follows we briefly consider some of Leibniz’s early logical works where

(1)  the idea that a necessary proposition is true in each possible world (while a possible proposition is true in at least one possible world) is formally elaborated, and where

(2)  the close relation between alethic and deontic modalities is unveiled.

a. Possible-Worlds-Semantics for Alethic Modalities

The fundamental logical relations between necessity, ☐, possibility, ◊, and impossibility can be expressed, for example, by:

NEC 1            ☐(α) ↔ ¬◊(¬α)

NEC 2            ¬◊(α) ↔ ☐(¬α).

These laws were familiar already to logicians long before Leibniz. However, Leibniz “proved” these relations by means of an admirably clear analysis of modal operators in terms of “possible cases”, that is, possible worlds:

Possible is whatever can happen or what is true in some cases

Impossible is whatever cannot happen or what is true        in no […] case

Necessary is whatever cannot not happen or what is true in every […] case

Contingent is whatever can not happen or what is [not] true in some case. (AE VI, 1, 466).

As this quotation shows, Leibniz uses the notion of contingency not in the modern sense of ‘neither necessary nor impossible’ but as the simple negation of ‘necessary’. The quoted analysis of the truth-conditions for modal propositions entails the validity not only of NEC 1, 2, but also of:

NEC 3            ☐α → ◊(α)

NEC 4            ¬◊(α) → ¬(α).

Leibniz “proves” these laws by reducing them to corresponding laws for quantifiers such as: If α is true in each case, then α is true in at least one case. In the “Modalia et Elementa Juris Naturalis” of around 1679, Leibniz mentions NEC 3 and NEC 4 in passing: “Since everything which is necessary is possible, so everything that is impossible is contingent, that is, can fail to happen” (AE IV, 4, 2759). A very elliptic “proof” of these laws was already sketched in the “Elementa juris naturalis” of 1669/70 (AE VI, 1, 469).

It cannot be overlooked, however, that Leibniz’s semi-formal truth conditions, even when combined with his later views on possible worlds, fail to come up to the standards of modern possible worlds semantics, since nothing in Leibniz’s considerations corresponds to an accessibility relation among worlds.

b. Basic Principles of Deontic Logic

As has already been pointed out by Schepers (1972) and Kalinowski (1974), Leibniz saw very clearly that the logical relations between the deontic modalities obligatory, permitted and forbidden exactly mirror the corresponding relations between necessary, possible and impossible, and that therefore all laws and rules of alethic modal logic may be applied to deontic logic as well.

Just like ‘necessary’, ‘contingent’, ‘possible’ and ‘impossible’ are related to each other, so also are ‘obligatory’, ‘not obligatory’, ‘permitted’, and ‘forbidden’ (AE VI, 4, 2762).

This structural analogy goes hand in hand with the important discovery that the deontic notions can be defined by means of the alethic notions plus the additional “logical” constant of a morally perfect man (“vir bonus”). Such a virtuous man is characterized by the requirements that he strictly obeys all laws, always acts in such a way that he does no harm to anybody, and is benevolent to all other people. Given this understanding of a “vir bonus”, Leibniz explains:

Obligatory is what is necessary for the virtuous man as such.

Not obligatory is what is contingent for the virtuous man as such.

Permitted is what is possible for the virtuous man as such.

Forbidden is what is impossible for the virtuous man as such (Grua, 605).

If we express the restriction of the modal operators ☐ and ◊ to the virtuous man by means of a subscript ‘v’, these definitions can be formalized as follows (where the letter ‘E’ reminding of the German notion ‘erlaubt’ is taken instead of ‘P’ for ‘permitted’ in order to avoid confusions with the operator of possibility):

DEON 1          O(α) ↔ ☐v(α)

DEON 2          E(α) ↔ ◊v(α)

DEON 3          F(α) ↔ ¬◊v(α).

Now, as Leibniz mentioned in passing, all that is unconditionally necessary will also be necessary for the virtuous man:

NEC 5             ☐(α) → ☐v(α).

Hence (as was shown in more detail in Lenzen (2005)), Leibniz’s derivation of the fundamental laws for the deontic operators from corresponding laws of the alethic modal operators proceeds in much the same way as the modern reduction of deontic logic to alethic modal logic “rediscovered” almost 300 years after Leibniz by Anderson (1958).

6. References and Further Reading

a. Abbreviations for Leibniz’s works

  • AE       German Academy of Science (ed.), G. W. Leibniz, Sämtliche Schriften und Briefe, Series VI, „Philosophische Schriften“, Darmstadt 1930, Berlin 1962 ff.
  • Cout   Louis Couturat (ed.), Opuscules et fragments inédits de Leibniz, Paris (Presses universitaires de France) 1903, reprint Hildesheim (Olms) 1961.
  • GI      Generales Inquisitiones de Analysi Notionum et Veritatum; first edited in Cout, 356-399; text-critical edition in A, VI 4, 739-788; English trans­lation in LLP, 47-87.
  • GP     C. I. Gerhardt (ed.), Die philosophischen Schriften von G. W. Leibniz, seven volumes Berlin/Halle 1875-90, reprint Hildesheim (Olms) 1965.
  • Grua   Gaston Grua (ed.), G. W. Leibniz – Textes Inédits, two Volumes, Paris (Presses Universitaires de France) 1948.
  • LH       Eduard Bodemann (ed.), Die Leibniz-Handschriften der Königlichen Öffentlichen Bibliothek zu Hannover, Hannover 1895, reprint Hildesheim (Olms) 1966.
  • LLP   G. H. R. Parkinson (ed.), Leibniz Logical Papers – A Selection, Oxford (Clarendon Press), 1966.
  • NE      Nouveaux Essais sur l’entendement humain – Par l’Auteur du Système de l’Harmonie Preestablie, in GP 5, 41-509.
  • Theo  Essais de Theodicée sur la Bonté de Dieu, la Liberté de l’Homme et l’Origine du Mal, in GP 6, 21-436.

b. Secondary Literature

  • Anderson, Alan Ross (1958): “A Reduction of Deontic Logic to Alethic Modal Logic”, in Mind LXVII, 100-103.
  • Arnauld, Antoine & Nicole, Pierre (1683) : La Logique ou L’Art de Penser, 5th edition, reprint 1965 Paris (Presses universitaires de France).
  • Burkhardt, Hans (1980): Logik und Semiotik in der Philosophie von Leibniz, München (Philosophia Verlag).
  • Couturat, Louis (1901): La Logique de Leibniz d’après des documents inédits, Paris (Félix Alcan).
  • Dürr, Karl (1930): Neue Beleuchtung einer Theorie von Leibniz – Grundzüge des Logikkalküls, Darmstadt.
  • Euler, Leonhard (1768): Lettres à une princesse d’Allemagne sur quelques sujets de physique et de philosophie, St Petersburg, 1768–1772.
  • Hamilton, William (1861): Lectures on Metaphysics and Logic, ed. by H.L. Mansel & J. Veitch, Edinburgh, London (William Blackwood); reprint Stuttgart Bad Cannstadt 1969.
  • Ishiguro, Hidé (1972): Leibniz’s Philosophy of Logic and Language, London (Duckworth).
  • Kalinowski, George (1974): “Un logicien déontique avant la lettre: Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz”, in Archiv für Rechts- und Sozialphilosophie 60, 79-98.
  • Kauppi, Raili (1960): Über die Leibnizsche Logik mit besonderer Berücksichti­gung des Problems der Intension und der Extension, Helsinki (Acta Philosophica Fennica).
  • Kneale, William and Martha (1962): The Development of Logic, Oxford (Clarendon).
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (1984): “Leibniz und die Boolesche Algebra”, in Studia Leibnitiana 16, 187-203.
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (1986): “‘Non est’ non est ‘est non’ – Zu Leibnizens Theorie der Negation”, in Studia Leibnitiana 18, 1-37.
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (1989): “Arithmetical vs. ‘Real’ Addition – A Case Study of the Relation between Logic, Mathematics, and Metaphysics in Leibniz”, in N. Rescher (ed.), Leibnizian Inquiries – A Group of Essays, Lanham, 149-157.
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (1990): Das System der Leibnizschen Logik, Berlin (de Gruyter).
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (2004a): Calculus Universalis – Studien zur Logik von G. W. Leibniz, Paderborn (mentis).
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (2004b): “Leibniz’s Logic”, in D. Gabbay & J. Woods (eds.) The Rise of Modern Logic – From Leibniz to Frege (Handbook of the History of Logic, vol. 3), Amsterdam (Elsevier), 1-83.
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (2004c): “Logical Criteria for Individual(concept)s”, in M. Carrara, A. M. Nunziante & G. Tomasi (eds.), Individuals, Minds, and Bodies: Themes from Leibniz, Stuttgart (Steiner), 87-107.
  • Lenzen, Wolfgang (2005): “Leibniz on Alethic and Deontic Modal Logic”. In D. Berlioz & F. Nef (eds.), Leibniz et les Puissances du Langage, Paris (Vrin), 2005, 341-362.
  • Lewis, Clarence I. & Langford, Cooper H. (1932): Symbolic Logic, New York, 21959 (Dover Publications).
  • Liske M.-Th. (1994): “Ist eine reine Inhaltslogik möglich? Zu Leibniz’ Begriffs­theorie”, in Studia Leibnitiana XXVI, 31-55.
  • Lukasiewicz, Jan (1951): Aristotle’s Syllogistic – From the Standpoint of Modern Formal Logic, Oxford (Clarendon Press).
  • Mugnai, Massimo (1992): Leibniz’s Theory of Relations, Stuttgart (Steiner).
  • Poser, Hans (1969): Zur Theorie der Modalbegriffe bei G. W. Leibniz, Wiesbaden (Steiner).
  • Rescher, Nicholas (1954): “Leibniz’s interpretation of his logical calculus”, in Journal of Symbolic Logic 19, 1-13.
  • Rescher, Nicholas (1979): Leibniz – An Introduction to his Philosophy, London (Billing & Sons).
  • Sanchez-Mazas, Miguel (1979): “Simplification de l’arithmétisation leibniti­enne de la syllogistique par l’expression arithmétique de la notion intensionelle du ‘non ens’”, in Studia Leibnitiana Sonderheft 8, 46-58.
  • Schepers, Heinrich (1972): “Leibniz‘ Disputationen ‚De Conditionibus‘: An­sätze zu einer juristischen Aussagenlogik” in Studia Leibnitiana Supplementa XV, 1-17.
  • Schupp, Franz (ed.) (1982): G. W. Leibniz, Allgemeine Untersuchungen über die Analyse der Begriffe und Wahrheiten, Hamburg (Meiner).
  • Schupp, Franz (ed.) (2000): G. W. Leibniz, Die Grundlagen des logischen Kalküls, Hamburg (Meiner).
  • Swoyer, Chris (1995): “Leibniz on Intension and Extension”, in Noûs 29, 96-114.
  • Sotirov, Vladimir (1999): “Arithmetizations of Syllogistic à la Leibniz”, in Journal of Applied Non-Classical Logics 9, 387-405.
  • Venn, John (1881): Symbolic Logic, London (MacMillan).

 

Author Information

Wolfgang Lenzen
Email: lenzen@uos.de
University of Osnabrück
Germany

Hugo Grotius (1583—1645)

GrotiusHugo Grotius was a Dutch humanist and jurist whose philosophy of natural law had a major impact on the development of seventeenth century political thought and on the moral theories of the Enlightenment. Valorized by contemporary international theorists as the father of international law, his work on sovereignty, international rights of commerce and the norms of just war continue to inform theories of the international legal order. His major work, De Jure Belli ac Pacis (The Rights of War and Peace), is particularly notable in this respect, as well as Mare Liberum, a doctrine in favor of the freedom of the seas, which is considered an antecedent, inspiration and the backbone of the modern law of the sea.

Grotius was heavily influenced by classical philosophy, most prominently Aristotle and the Stoics, as well as by the contemporary humanist tradition and the late-medieval Scholastics. Caught up in the religious strife of the Reformation, Grotius promoted an irenic vision that would unite and reconcile the Christian Church on the principles of civil religion and toleration. He was well known in his time as much for his poetry and philosophy of religion as for his work on law and politics but is best remembered for his influence on theories of the social contract, natural rights and the laws of war.

Table of Contents

  1. Life and Works
  2. Irenicism and Tolerance
    1. Religion and Civil Authority
    2. Relations with Non-Christians
    3. Christian Unity and Peace
  3. Sovereignty and Imperialism
    1. Divisible Sovereignty
    2. Resistance, War and Empire
  4. Natural Right and the Law of Nations
    1. Obligations from Nature and Custom
    2. Just War: Jus ad Bellum
    3. Just War: Jus in Bello
  5. Scholarly Interest in Grotius
  6. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Life and Works

Huig de Groot, best known by the Latinized name Hugo Grotius, began his life in the commercial town of Delft while, in 1583, the Dutch Republic persevered through a second decade of war for independence from Hapsburg rule and was already positioning itself for ascendancy as an overseas trading power. Born into a family with standing among the city elite and connections to the recently founded University of Leiden, young Hugo would find many opportunities to develop his considerable talents for scholarly pursuits even as a child. His family tutored him in Greek and Latin at an early age, introduced him to classical letters, and brought him up in the disciplines of Reformed faith. So outstanding were his gifts for intellectual work that he was welcomed to enroll at Leiden University at the mere age of eleven. At the university, the boy de Groot became a favored student of some of the most celebrated scholars of the time, discovering his talents in a whole range of subjects in the liberal arts and new sciences. His reputation as a promising young man of letters would open a number of doors for him in the political life of the time, where humanist expertise was a valued asset. The most auspicious of these opportunities came as he was preparing for life beyond the university. In 1598, no less a figure than Jan van Oldenbarnevelt, the Grand Pensionary and most influential personality in Dutch politics, invited Grotius to accompany his delegation to the French court. The embassy, which ultimately failed in its aim to renew the king’s military support against Spain, nonetheless brought Grotius into the fold of high politics and even staked him a reputation with the French court when Henry IV lauded the learned youth as “the miracle of Holland.” The connections he made in France enabled Grotius to extend his stay and earn a Doctor of Laws degree from the University of Orléans before returning to Holland the following year.

Entering into practice as a lawyer in The Hague, Grotius took advantage of chances to hone his rhetorical skills and found time to devote to his diverse scholarly interests. His earliest writings to go into print included several imitations of classical verse and translations of significant works in compass navigation and astronomy, the latter being of keen interest to his friends invested in the burgeoning overseas trade. In 1601, he published a tragedy, Adamus Exul (Adam in Exile), that earned him instant acclaim as a poet; it was a work that John Milton would later study in preparing his Paradise Lost. While Grotius prized these pursuits more highly than the mundane work of a lawyer, he always strove to please his patrons and clients. Indeed, his most lasting contributions to political thought took shape in the course of his professional duties during this period.

In 1604, Grotius was drawn into the sensational controversy over privateering in the Southeast Asian trade. The United Dutch East India Company had been rising quickly as a major player in European overseas commerce, and Grotius shared the view of many of his associates involved in the trade that the Company not only buoyed up the young republic with wealth but also weakened its adversaries by cutting into Iberian dominance of the East Indian routes. Still, acts of piracy by a private concern did not sit well in the public opinion of many citizens and allies. When asked by a friend with Company connections to write a brief justifying a recent and very lucrative seizure of Spanish cargo, Grotius went on to produce not only an ardent defense of the capture but an investigation into the deep principles of law that connected those separated by nation and culture. The resulting manuscript, provisionally titled De Indis (On the Indies), was never published in full until long after Grotius’ death (appearing in 1868 as Commentary on the Laws of Prize and Booty). It was the young jurist’s first systematic work on the problems of international affairs and was in many ways his most philosophically developed. Many of the arguments worked out in the manuscript—that there is a basic law of nature determined by the need to reconcile self-preservation with social life, that the authority to govern and even to punish derive from the rights of natural persons prior to the founding of civil societies, and that claims to jurisdiction over the open seas are invalid—would give direction to his later works.

In fact, the last of these arguments would appear in print in 1609 as the anonymous pamphlet, Mare Liberum (The Free Seas). The pamphlet, which Grotius pulled directly from the text of De Indis, once again served the interests of those in the Dutch political and commercial establishment that were insisting upon the right of access to overseas routes in the ongoing negotiations for a truce with the Spanish. The work argued not only that the Spanish claims to a trading monopoly in the Southeast Asia and elsewhere failed to square with the facts—that these were rights conferred by papal authority or acquired by just conquest—but that there was, in principle, no basis for any monopoly on access to the seas. The freedom of the seas was entailed by the very nature of private property. To privately own a thing requires that one can occupy it, taking it out of the common store, and that one can make full use of it. The sea cannot be contained and is too plentiful for its usefulness to be exhausted by a few; hence, no one can take exclusive ownership of the sea. The seas remain open to all. This question was of great importance in European relations during this period of intense competition between aspiring overseas empires, and Grotius’ work would frame the intense debate to follow. During this time in his early legal career, he penned a number of other manuscripts touching on matters of international relations that, while mostly unpublished, shaped his later work on the subject. The Parellelon Rerumpublicarum (composed 1601-2) explored the concept of ‘good faith’ in dealings with other nations through some flattering comparisons among the customs of the Greek, Roman and Dutch peoples. In his Commentary on Eleven Theses (circa 1602-08), Grotius worked out an understanding of the ruling power of a state—its sovereignty—and its relation to the principles of just war.

Having proved the usefulness of his talents to the ruling elite, Grotius’ star continued to rise. He gained recognition from Prince Maurits of Orange, the executive and military leader of the United Provinces, when in 1607, the prince appointed him as attorney general of the provinces of Holland, Zeeland and West Friesland. It was during this time that he became engaged to be married to a young woman from a distinguished family in Zeeland, Maria van Reigersberch. Her partnership and personal courage would carry the family through a tumultuous life that the young couple could not have expected at the time of their wedding in 1608. Soon thereafter, Maria gave birth to the first of seven children. As his focus shifted from legal practice to public service, Grotius began to put a number of his writings into press. His second celebrated tragedy, The Passion of Christ, came out in 1608, followed by the anonymous Mare Liberum in 1609 and a political history of the old Dutch republic, De Antiquitate Reipublicae Batavicae, in 1610. The historical account provided ideological leverage for the position that Holland had persisted in its republican form of government despite the princely claims of the Hapsburgs. The governing States of Holland commissioned Grotius to write a detailed history of the conflict with Spain, which he submitted in 1612. The States declined, likely due to the delicate truce, to publicize the work, leaving the Annales et Historiae de Rebus Belgicus to rest until his sons brought it out posthumously in 1657. Opportunity for higher office came again when, in 1612, the town council of Rotterdam offered Grotius the mayoral position of Pensionary. The title brought with it a seat in the States of Holland where he would collaborate more closely with his mentor, Oldenbarnevelt, and key players in provincial and national politics.

The political controversy that would end up defining Grotius’ tenure in office began with small rumblings when, in 1608, the professor of theology at the University of Leiden, Jacob Arminius, put forth a doctrine that challenged key features of the reigning Calvinist orthodoxy concerning predestination (see below: Irenicism and Tolerance). Calvinist church officials and divines came out strongly against the preaching of such a view. Though Arminius died the following year, the conflict escalated in a way that pitted the church establishment against the civil authorities over the question of who could rule on such doctrinal disputes. Grotius shared with many in the government of Holland some sympathies with the Arminian view but a desire above all to prevent such matters from disturbing the peace. He had been composing, during this time, a manuscript on the idea that all faiths shared a set of core doctrines, a viewpoint capable of promoting a certain equanimity towards squabbles over the finer points of theology. This was in any case the political attitude Grotius favored, and while he never published the Meletius manuscript, he developed several writings on the role of the state in managing conflicts over religion. The pamphlet, Ordinum Hollandiae et Westfrisiae pietas (1613), defended the ‘piety’ of the governments of Holland and Westfriesland in imposing a policy of toleration that allowed Arminians to preach their dissenting doctrine. Grotius himself had drafted the policy, which failed in its aim of mollifying the factions and, in fact, heightened the conflict between the civil and ecclesiastical authorities. Convinced that the practice of religion was a concern proper to civil magistrates, Grotius set about justifying his views in a longer treatise. De Imperio Summarum Potestatum circa Sacra argued that, to avoid a conflict of rights, there must be only one final authority within a state on how religion is to be practiced, that because of its mandate to keep civil peace and form responsible citizens this authority ought to come under the civil power, and that civil magistrates would do well to limit their judgments to the core doctrines Grotius had worked out in Meletius. He developed, though never published, the manuscript of De Imperio as the political conflict continued to escalate during 1614-17. His sympathies with the Arminian theology also grew during this period, and in 1617 he took it upon himself to brush back the charges of heresy with the publication of a theological work, Defensio Fidei Catholicae de Satisfactione Christi adversus Faustum Socinum.

As Grotius was being drawn further into the controversy, it came to consume national politics. The orthodox Calvinists, who were a majority at the national level and now had the backing of Prince Maurits, were demanding a national synod to settle the matter. This set up a standoff between Maurits, the national executive and commander of the armed forces, and Oldenbarnevelt, the most influential figure in the States assembly. Oldenbarnevelt led the elites of Holland, including Grotius, in blocking the synod and managing the dispute at the provincial level. That policy culminated in a decision, when riots broke out in 1617, to authorize local militias to suppress the disorder. Maurits denounced the act as an offense against his military authority, and he seized the opportunity to turn the tide against his political adversaries. At the end of an extended political and military campaign to push the Arminian supporters out of the establishment, he ordered the arrest of Oldenbarnevelt and his key supporters in August 1618. Grotius, with his mentor, was locked up and set for trial. A national synod, the famous Synod of Dort, was scheduled. Though incensed at the military coup d’etat against the sovereign institutions of Holland, Grotius calmly petitioned Maurits and the national States-General to no effect. The trials commenced the following year, and Grotius saw his mentor condemned to death for high treason. On May 18, 1619, his own sentence came down: confiscation of property and life imprisonment.

Although he would strive for the rest of his life to vindicate himself and lift the disgrace of the charges from himself and his family, Grotius entered at the age of thirty-six into his term of imprisonment in the castle Loevestein. The only solace of his confinement was that his family was allowed to reside with him and that on her regular leaves his wife Maria was able to bring back books and papers. The scholar was able to turn his isolation to some greater purpose. In Loevestein, Grotius renewed a number of neglected projects. He wrote, fully in didactic verse, a more systematic treatment of his view that there are essential elements common to all religions and that the doctrines of Christianity were recognizable through reason as the most consistent and highest expression of the common faith. The work, initially composed in Dutch, would serve as the basis for his renowned De Veritate Religionis Christiane (The Truth of the Christian Religion). Through his work in law and legal history, he had conceived the plan of writing a rigorous guidebook on jurisprudence of Holland in the vernacular of the Dutch language. The later publication, in 1631, of Inleidinge to the Hollandsche Rechts-geleerdheid (Introduction the Jurisprudence of Holland) would eventually give his book a status in Dutch law analogous to Blackstone’s Commentaries in the English system. Grotius was convinced that he could achieve the same kind of ordered treatment of the concepts, principles and precedents governing relations at the international level. Closed within the walls of his cell, he reached out for a global view of human affairs and prepared parts of what would become the massive treatise, De Jure Belli ac Pacis (The Rights of War and Peace). At the same time, Grotius was looking beyond the walls of Loevestein with a mind for a more immediate scheme: escape. He knew that he had support in the court of Louis XIII in France, and his hopes for reestablishing himself pointed towards Paris. Maria and the family’s young maid-servant, Elsje van Houwening, hatched the plan for escape. On March 22, 1621, Maria made arrangements for a chest of books to be shipped to the nearby town of Gorcum, then helped her husband into the cramped chest and watched Elsje accompany the guards as they unwittingly delivered their prisoner into the hands of friends. A month later, Grotius was in Paris, separated from his family, exiled from his beloved country, yet free.

The long period Grotius spent in exile saw the publication of his most remembered works. Having secured the support of Louis XIII and being reunited with his family, he prepared several manuscripts that he hoped would restore him to prominence. The Apologeticus, appearing in 1622, was straight to the purpose: it contained a full defense of his conduct as a public official of Holland. Despite his earnest pleas of loyalty and the best efforts of his friends, the States-General spurned his arguments and authorized a bounty on him. He turned his attention to the scholarly projects begun in Loevestein. The treatise on the universal law of nature and nations, divided into three hefty books, grew out of the reflections on the subject he had begun twenty years prior. Its first book developed an account of natural justice, so central to his earlier arguments about the Southeast Asian trade, and laid out a broad framework for judging “controversies of any and every kind, as are likely to arise” (JBP I.I.i)—those among politically sovereign entities, private parties, or rival camps within a state. The lengthy second book provided a grounding for the rights in one’s person, property, and sovereignty (subjects he was revisiting from Mare Liberum and his unpublished commentaries) and a detailed consideration of the ways such rights could be acquired, transferred, lost, and protected by recourse to war. The third book, dramatizing the gap between the prevailing customs of warfare and the demands placed on us by a more humane conscience, considers what responsibilities parties have to all those they impact in wartime and in upholding good faith in efforts to build the peace. Many of the arguments of the work were forged in Grotius’ career as an advocate and public official, though he insists in the Prolegomena to the treatise that his perspective in the work is that of a mathematician, abstracting away from particular facts and controversies of the day. When the first edition of De Jure Belli ac Pacis made its appearance in 1625, its readers would have no shortage of conflicts to which to apply its ideas about war and peace, from the campaigns of conquest and appropriation overseas to the long-raging religious conflicts on the continent that were escalating into what would be the Thirty Years War.

Grotius continued, while in France, to write and visit scholars. His Latin edition of The Truth of Christian Religion came out in 1627. It would become his most widely read and translated work. Despite the unreliability of his pension from King Louis, he turned down some tempting offers to serve as a diplomat for other nations and instead renewed his efforts to rehabilitate his standing in the Netherlands. Upon the death of Prince Maurits, Grotius returned to Holland in 1631 in hopes of finding favor with the new Prince of Orange, Frederick Henry, but an arrest warrant from the States-General forced him to flee and take up refuge in Hamburg. Grotius and his wife remained for more than two years in the city without any great prospects. He set himself to composing a third major tragedy, Sophompaneas (Joseph), which would appear in 1635. By that time, his work on the laws of war had brought opportunity to his doorstep. In 1634, he was called to meet with the Swedish High Chancellor, Oxenstierna, who informed him that the recently slain King Gustavus Adolphus had been a great admirer of De Jure Belli and expressed a desire to bring Grotius into the service of Sweden. A major power, Sweden had risen up as a champion of the Protestant cause in the bloody war that gripped Europe, and Grotius was asked to provide counsel to the young queen and serve as her ambassador to another key power, France. The position required that he renounce his Dutch citizenship in order to declare his loyalty to the Swedish crown. Though he never let go of the hope of returning to his home, he accepted. The de Groot family would once again take up residence in Paris.

As ambassador, Grotius was charged with negotiating the terms of French support for the Protestant alliance. The relations were especially fraught due to the delicate position that the French crown, under the guidance of Cardinal Richelieu, had carved out between its opposition to Hapsburg power and its defense of Catholicism. As France increasingly entered the battle fray, much of Grotius’ duty was directed to the war effort. His scholarly projects from the late 1630s-40s, however, took as their object a long-cherished goal: the reconciliation and peace of the Christian community. He began in 1638 on a scriptural commentary that would deflate Protestant rhetoric charging that the Pope was the Antichrist. That same year he slipped an anonymous treatise through an Amsterdam press defending the lay administration of the Eucharist. He then released two lengthy collections of annotations, one on the New Testament and one on the Old, which emphasized the ethical role of the scriptures over the more divisive questions of theology. Building on the idea of shared core doctrines he had explored in his earlier manuscripts, he frankly promoted his vision for a reconciled faith in an appeal printed in Paris in 1642, Via ad Pacem Ecclesiasticam (The Way to Church Peace). Grotius had great hopes that the time was ripe for this vision, but he was disappointed when his arguments were swallowed up in the same old sectarian vitriol.

Having passed the age of sixty, Grotius met with some relief his recall to Swedish court in 1645. The Queen offered to settle his family in Sweden, but he instead requested a passport so that he could rejoin Maria and pursue opportunities elsewhere. He embarked in August in the midst of a terrible storm that damaged the ship and washed it upon the German coast. The ordeal left him ill and weather-beaten. With the aid of servants, he made it to the town of Rostock where he found a hospice. His condition worsened, and death came on August 28, 1645. Arrangements were made to convey his remains to Delft, where the town of his birth bestowed him with the honor that he could not regain in life by interring his body in the Nieuwe Kerk alongside the most celebrated figures of the republic. Maria resettled in Holland, and their sons set about preparing, from Grotius’ papers, updated editions and previously unpublished manuscripts for the press. De Jure Belli ac Pacis, especially, would come to have enduring influence as the Enlightenment philosophers of the next generations embraced its framework of natural jurisprudence as a model for a modern science of law and morals. His work would become a point of departure for those natural lawyers focusing on the law among nations, from Pufendorf and Barbeyrac to Thomasius and Vattel. It would inspire radical ideas about natural rights and the social contract in the Anglo-American political discourses of Hobbes, Locke, Jefferson and Madison. For the Scottish Enlightenment, it would be required reading, informing the moral theories of Carmichael, Hutcheson, Hume and Smith. As natural jurisprudence gave way to positivism and idealism in 19th-century European thought, the place of Grotius receded in moral and political theory, but his work would be recovered in the context of emerging ideas about the international legal order as the next century approached. His work is most widely known today among those working on international relations and law, though there has been rapidly expanding scholarship on his contributions to political thought, ethics, and the philosophy of religion.

2. Irenicism and Tolerance

In the politics of the Dutch Republic and with regard to the broader religious strife in Europe, Grotius fashioned himself as an irenicist, one who seeks to bring the different denominations of Christianity together. The inflammatory conflicts among the Christian churches, which remained a persistent cause of war and upheaval in the political life of European societies, was in Grotius’ view largely attributable to excesses of dogmatism (see Heering 2004). If dogmatic claims could be reduced to an agreeable set of core tenets, he reasoned, then the various sects would have grounds for cooperating towards a reunified Christian church while allowing more esoteric matters to be contested without posing a threat to peace. This hope for Christian peace and unity characterizes Grotius’ theologically-oriented works from his early Meletius (1611) to Via ad Pacem Ecclesiasticam (1642), among his latest writings at the height of the Thirty Years War.

a. Religion and Civil Authority

In the early decades of the 17th century when Grotius’ was cutting his teeth in Dutch politics, the temperature was rising on a theological dispute concerning salvation and freedom of the will. The reformed churches, which had the backing of the civil authorities, were founded on orthodox Calvinist doctrine. The standard Calvinist view of salvation held that God’s choice of who would be saved preceded the act of creation; this grace was, consequently, not a status that could be earned through good works but rather was predestined. This view was consistent with the dominant Protestant interpretations of scripture and represented a social and ethical worldview that was compelling to the reformed faithful. Yet this view also carried the ethically troubling implication that individual choice makes no difference to how one stands with God and, as the Leiden professor of theology, Jacob Arminius, would argue, did not account for elements of scripture that seemed to acknowledge a role for human will. Arminius maintained that God’s saving grace was on offer to anyone while still accepting the basic Calvinist premise that, prior to any human act, God had already determined who He would actually elect to everlasting happiness. The paradox could be resolved by recognizing that God’s grace might be resisted. This elegant solution enabled Arminius to account for freedom of the human will while retaining the key Protestant tenet that grace alone, not works, qualifies the elect. The Arminian view of salvation, to draw on Richard Tuck’s illuminating analogy, understands God’s offer of grace to the elect to be much like a parent’s offer to buy something for a child: “the child can refuse the offer, but he cannot purchase the present himself” (Tuck 1993 p. 182). While representing a significant revision to orthodox Calvinism, this view remained consistent with the larger doctrine.

The political question, however, was whether adherents of the Arminian position should be allowed to teach it within the publically established churches. Grotius’ writings from this period confront both the theological and political aspects of the debate. On the question of theology his sympathies laid with Arminius, and his defenses of the view led up to the publication of the substantial De Satisfactione (published in 1617), which distinguished many of the Arminian tenets from the ‘Socianian’ heresies charged by the view’s opponents. Politically, the Arminian preachers were seeking a policy of toleration within the public churches. Grotius and others aligned with Oldenbarnevelt recognized the advantages of such a policy for preserving quiet in the republic. Characteristically, Grotius saw the policy as rooted in philosophical concerns. As early as the (unpublished) manuscript Meletius (1611), he was developing a philosophy of religion according to which all faiths shared core beliefs about the nature of divinity and its role in human life. While this view stressed commonality, it did not entail pluralism. A religious tradition may possess a stronger claim to truth than others in virtue of its consistency with the central doctrines and the credibility of its supporting testimony; for Grotius, Christianity held this title. (This defense of Christianity is most fully developed in Grotius’ most widely published and popular work, On the Truth of the Christian Religion.) Yet Christian tradition, too, had a further set of core doctrines which were necessary for proper worship and for the promotion of responsible citizenship. The church could accommodate friendly debate over finer matters of theology as long as it was firmly rooted in the necessary articles of faith. This philosophical framework, while not made fully public at the time, undergirded Grotius’ advocacy of the toleration policy, which the States of Holland would eventually adopt.

The policy, Grotius well understood, required not only justification but also legitimacy: in defining acceptable doctrines, the civil authority was asserting itself in sacred matters. Grotius addressed this issue in his 1613 pamphlet defending the toleration policy, Ordinum Hollandiae et Westfrisiae pietas, and went on to develop the argument for the central principles into a major essay on the authority of civil government over the public practice of religion. De Imperio Summarum Potestatum circa sacra (1614-17, unpublished) argued that the supreme civil power holds legitimate authority over all matters concerning the public interest, whether sacred or profane. In addition to finding support from scripture and tradition, Grotius grounds his case on the simple Aristotelian argument that, because the commands of multiple authorities would allow for conflicting obligations, there can be only one supreme authority in a jurisdiction (ch. 1). Holding this authority enables the supreme power, then, to preserve civil peace as well as to promote, through the effects of religion, the formation of obedient and upright citizens. The bulk of the work is thus occupied with defending the plausibility of this conclusion by clearing away misconceptions and by reconciling it both with the variety of forms of political and legal organization and with the special calling of the church. To accept the authority of the civil power in religious matters, Grotius argues, does not imply that magistrates are competent to determine the truth of all fine points of theology: a wise ruler will make use of counsel from the most reliable pastors. With even greater wisdom, a ruler would do well to abstain from pronouncing on all but the most essential articles of faith, those that are necessary for salvation (ch. 6, 9). As an instance of an inessential matter in which a “prudent silence” recommends itself, he offers those “questions about the order of predestination and the reconciliation of human free will with grace” (ibid). The policy of the States of Holland, in this framework, was a form of containment: the policy defined the boundaries of permissible doctrine at the point that would endanger the salvation of those who accept it, while allowing the disagreements inside these bounds to play themselves out. Such was Grotius’ recommendation, in both theory and practice. At bottom, however, the policy had its validity not in view of its laudable tolerance but on Erastian grounds. (The citations in the work acknowledge the influence of Thomas Erastus, who a generation earlier had argued for the supreme authority of the state in church governance.) The central position of De imperio was that any policy issued by the civil power would be valid so long as it did not contradict God’s will. That this Erastian position made room for toleration and contributed to civil peace only added to its appeal.

b. Relations with Non-Christians

The principle of toleration guided Grotius’ handling of the Arminian conflict and also served as an ideal in his view of dealings with non-Christians. Among the groups that had found haven in the Netherlands from the Inquisition were Portuguese Jews, and Grotius was asked during his time as a public official to reconsider what ought to be the policy the States towards the presence and worship practices of Jewish communities. His Remonstrantie on the question was of a piece with his developing philosophy of public religion: Jewish worship could be consistent with the state interest in religion, as Judaism accepted the fundamental doctrines regarding God’s existence and concern for human conduct. The policy recommendation was to afford civil liberties and freedom of worship to Jews, under certain restrictions that would serve to “safeguard” the salvation of Christians. This meant, for instance, that Jewish synagogues would not enjoy the same freedom to preach to Christian audiences that could be granted to Arminian and Calvinist disputants, but Grotius maintained that this encumbered status was preferable to the other options in the field. He opposed forcing Jews to practice Christianity on the grounds that such a policy was incoherent, since faith cannot be forced, as well as sinful, since it would induce people to false professions. An alternative was to forbid Jewish worship altogether, but this would promote godlessness, which would be intolerable. Finally, to those who were calling for expulsion, Grotius gave a sustained response partly grounded in principles of natural law: the social bond that nature establishes among humans should not be severed except as punishment for crime. Jewish practice did not transgress natural law, and its faith supported civic life. It was proper, therefore, that Christians and Jews share social arrangements on the basis of common principles of public order and justice.

The same balance between Christian privilege and the potential for peaceful cooperation underwrote Grotius’ approach towards the expanding relationships between Europeans and non-Christian societies around the world. The principles of natural justice in De Jure Belli ac pacis—which grounded claims to sovereignty, property, and the fulfillment of pacts—were valid and binding in any human encounter, requiring no special relation to God. The principles would oblige us, in Grotius’ famous phrase, “even if we should concede (etiamsi daremus) that which cannot be conceded without the utmost wickedness, that there is no God, or that the affairs of men are of no concern to Him” (JBP Prol. 11). Mutual recognition of natural law provided the basis for any two parties to arrive at just and peaceful terms of association, most notably those concerning trade and alliances. This did not imply that all practices regarding religion were consistent with natural law. Because a sense of justice is not sufficient to motivate humans routinely to do right, the broader human society, even more than civil societies, depends upon religion to maintain order and instill reverence for its norms (see JBP Prol. 20 and II.XX.XLIV.6). To reject God involves not only the “utmost wickedness” but a criminal disregard for human society. Indeed, the two tenets that Grotius identifies—that there is a God and that human affairs are of concern to Him—constitute what he takes to be the core of religious belief, found in all societies. Those who oppose these core beliefs may be punished, by war if necessary, but differences among the religious are not, in themselves, grounds for war (JBP II.XX.XLVI-XLVIII). Pagans, polytheists, Jews and Muslims might fail to accept the “truths” of Christianity, but their participation in the common faith supports the basic ethical structure of society. Christianity, even under non-Christian sovereigns, yet has this privilege: that in virtue of its claim to truth, its adherents must not be punished for teaching the Gospel (JBP II.XX.XLIX). The right to suppress religious doctrine, which De imperio claimed for the civil power, extends only to teachings not essential to Christian salvation.

c. Christian Unity and Peace

The privileged status of Christianity among the world’s religions is the subject of The Truth of the Christian Religion. As in De Jure Belli, composed around the same time, Grotius argues that a basic understanding of divinity and its role in the world is accessible through the use of the natural capacity of reason alone. Such truths include not only the existence and providence of God, but also God’s oneness, perfection, causal responsibility for all that happens, and judgment in the afterlife. The proofs Grotius offers are not original but are borrowed from sources both ancient and recent, owning that people of varying sophistication have long been able to reason back to a necessary and singular ‘first cause’ and to grasp that the perfect nature of such a cause would not neglect the good of all creation (ch. 1).  While some of these points require more subtle thought than others, all people can in principle arrive at the conclusions through rational reflection. Christ, however, is known through history. To learn of redemption and of what is required for salvation, one needs access to particular facts about Christ’s coming and His call to the faithful. The relevant facts, still, are supported by reasonable inferences based on reliable testimony (the evangelists), the consensus of historians, and the evidence of miracles performed. This project of deriving religious knowledge through rational investigation is what later philosophers would call “natural religion.” Significantly, Grotius argues that these facts gain further confirmation when one recognizes that the doctrines of Christianity have the greatest intrinsic appeal. The Gospel has this appeal in virtue of the reward it promises (the eternal beatitude of the soul), the quality of its ethical teachings (obeying out of love rather than fear, showing love to neighbors and enemies, and so forth), and the impeccable character of its teacher, Christ (ch. 2). Experience and rational consideration, while sufficient to establish the truth of Christianity, may not convince as readily as inferences from mere reason. Indeed, immediate acceptance is not possible without God’s help. On these grounds, Grotius would argue in De Jure Belli that one may neither punish those who fail to embrace Christianity nor impose belief by force (II.XX.XLVIII). Christians would do better to impress non-believers with their ethical example and offer persuasive arguments for conversion.

To this end, De Veritate provides a detailed debunking of other faiths. While its arguments reveal that Grotius undertook a serious study of non-Christian religions—with the aid of friends such as the Hebrew and Arabic scholar, Thomas Erpenius—some of his characterizations are far from generous, repeating old slurs about Jewish animosity towards Christians and the violent character of Islam. The arguments of the book were, after all, calculated to more than one purpose. Grotius intended the book to be of special use to seamen, whom while off to many corners of the earth to establish Dutch trading interests, would encounter a dazzling diversity of religious belief that might not only elude their attempts at persuasion but also challenge their own faith. It was the Christian reader, most of all, who may need to be assured of the Gospel’s special claim to truth.

The further effect Grotius hoped De Veritate would have on its Christian readers was to impress upon them that, in the range of religious diversity, the similarities among Christians are much more significant than the differences. The irenicist program that Grotius pursued in his later years had two main prongs. The first provided a map for Christian reunification based upon minimal agreement regarding core doctrines, beyond which some difference of belief and practice could be accommodated. The second urged Christians to recognize that the most important lessons to be taken from scripture are its ethical teachings, not its dogmas. This was the simple, practical faith that he saw reflected in the earliest Christian community and in the Christian humanists, like Erasmus, whom he so much admired. It was also a faith of which civil authorities, responsible for civic peace and virtue, could be worthy custodians.

3. Sovereignty and Imperialism

Connecting the political and international thought of Grotius is his conception of sovereignty, the supreme right of governing (summum imperium). The mark of the sovereign power is that it “cannot be made void by any other human will” (JBP, I.III.viii). Within a state, it is the highest authority; internationally it encounters other sovereign powers, among whom none holds a superior right.

a. Divisible Sovereignty

The guiding idea in Grotius’ treatment of sovereignty, as with his treatment of rights generally, is that systems of rights are radically alterable through the ways people choose to dispose of those rights. As a result, societies will vary widely in how they organize the powers of sovereignty. Philosophers might argue for the advantages of one scheme or another, “but as there are several ways of living, some better than others, and every one may choose which he pleases of all those sorts; so a people may choose what form of government they please: neither is the right which the sovereign has over his subjects to be measured by this or that form, of which divers men have divers opinions, but by the extent of the will of those who conferred it upon him” (JBP I.III.viii). What justifies a scheme of rights is that it has arisen from the historical choices of their legitimate holders, not any features of its form. This principle gave Grotius a great deal of flexibility in defending different political arrangements, provided the facts of history for the given society would play along.

On one side, Grotius was able to argue against royalists who sought to define sovereignty as an indivisible package of prerogatives that could be vested in only a singular will. Grotius takes this claim, which Jean Bodin had advanced a generation earlier, at face value but treats indivisibility as a purely conceptual point: to institute civil power in a society consists in gathering up a certain package of governmental rights and in designating who will hold that power supremely. The rights of governing come as a package, but a society may, if it chooses, designate different holders for the various rights.

Grotius developed this position early in his career in an unpublished manuscript that he called Commentary in Eleven Theses. The practical divisibility of sovereignty is an indispensable premise for the political argument of the work, which defends the ongoing Dutch war against the rule of the king of Spain. Unlike earlier apologists, Grotius does not conceive of the war as a revolt based on right of a people to resist a tyrannical ruler but rather as a war between sovereign powers (see Borschberg 1994 pp. 169ff. and Keene 2002 pp. 45ff.). If one studies the history of rights in the Dutch case, Grotius argues, one finds that the Dutch people did not transfer all governing rights to a prince bur reserved some, in particular the right to levy taxes, to the States of Holland. While holding supreme power on many matters, the Spanish king had sought to usurp a further supreme power from the States, an act which provided them a just cause to wage war in defense of its right. Put in the language of sovereignty, the king possessed no right to render void the will of the States when it came to taxation, just as this particular right of the States could not render void the king’s rights in other matters: each was supreme within the scope of its own authority (cf. JBP I.IV.xiii). Grotius retained and systematized this conception of divisible sovereignty in De Jure Belli, where he also considered the criticism that such arrangements based on divided powers were recipes for civil strife. His answer insists on the principle with which he began: while one can point to inconveniences in any arrangements, the only relevant question in matters of right is whether those arrangements were the ones chosen (I.III.xvii).

On the other side of the political spectrum, Grotius argued against theories of popular sovereignty. The position of constitutionalist thinkers, such as those among the reforming Huguenots who would come to be called ‘monarchomachs,’ was that the right of kings to rule derives from the rights of the people; since some of these rights are inalienable, the representatives of the people retain a right to resist a regime that tyrannically usurps these rights. Grotius’ response was to grant that rights originate from the people but to argue that the people can choose to alienate whatever rights they wish, even up to the extreme of enslaving themselves to another (JBP, I.III.viii). Utter subjection to an absolute monarch is, therefore, entirely possible and consistent with the history of political arrangements in many societies. Grotius’ flexible approach enabled him to defend the republican principles alive in the Dutch provinces from one side of his mouth while shoring up the absolutist claims of his later patrons from the other. In his defense of the latter claims, we find Grotius even paying homage to the time-worn doctrine of Aristotle that some people are naturally suited to be slaves. Importantly, Grotius does not admit the doctrine as grounds for imposing slavery but rather repurposes it: the doctrine can explain why a people might choose of their own accord to hand over their full rights to the more prudent government of another. Ineptitude at self-rule, it turns out, is just one of many considerations that might factor into the selection of a form of government.

b. Resistance, War and Empire

Grotius’ understanding of sovereignty carries several implications for his theory of just war. The first concerns his position on the “right of resistance,” the hotly contested question of whether a subject people may ever justly depose a ruler for misgovernment. While Grotius rejects constitutionalist arguments that reserve inalienable rights to the people, he finds a way to preserve this rationale for resistance in a more limited form. It is unlikely that most civil societies would have been founded on utter subjection. In the absence of clear evidence that subjects have completely alienated their rights, one has to presume that rational people would have preserved their most basic rights against arbitrary treatment. This presumption attaches only in cases of “extreme necessity,” as when a government turns its sword on innocent subjects, and then only when resistance could be carried out without creating an even bloodier civil conflict (I.VI.vii). When Grotius invokes this argument from extreme necessity, he relies on what Richard Tuck has called a kind of interpretive charity (1979 pp. 79-80): since civil authority is a human institution, the bounds of which are derived from the wills of those who established it, one must credit the founders with intentions that would rationally advance, not undermine, the aims of civil association. (Compare the parallel reasoning in limiting the rights of property, II.II.vi.) Second, Grotius assigns a role in this context to third-party humanitarian intervention. Even if it should turn out that subjects must bear the most arbitrary assaults from their proper sovereign, a third-party would remain free from the special obligations that constrain subjects from resisting and could intervene on their behalf. Such interventions should only be attempted when it is evident that a government is committing gross injustices against its people—“such Tyrannies over subjects, as no good Man living can approve” (JBP II.XXV.viii). The third implication concerns Grotius’ complicated relation to imperialism. In defending the legitimacy of diverse forms of political authority, he is rejecting the principle behind those forms of imperialism that seek to impose a more enlightened form of rule for the good of the governed. Elsewhere in De Jure Belli he explicitly refutes the argument that slavery can be imposed on those who might be naturally suited to it (II.XXII.xii) and castigates those who claim rights of ‘discovery’ over lands already occupied by supposedly less enlightened folk (II.XXII.ix). On these points, he is in agreement with earlier critics of the Spanish conquests such as Francisco de Vitoria and Bartolome de las Casas.

The strategies of commercial imperialism, which characterized Dutch practice, found much more support in Grotius’ theory of just war (see generally, Tuck 1999 ch. 3, van Ittersum 2006, Wilson 2008, Thomson 2009). The whole concern of De Jure Belli is how to justly settle controversies in the dealings of those who do not live under a shared system of civil laws. In the context of global trade, such dealings will involve the claims of private parties as well as the contentions of kings and states. It ultimately falls to each party, when operating outside the jurisdiction of a common court, to judge the controversy based on the applicable standards of natural, customary, state and divine law. Significantly, Grotius maintains that such relations can be peaceful so long as those involved have a clear understanding of the law and hold themselves to norms of justice, equity, temperance, and humanity. Yet, just as magistrates duly back their rulings with force, those involved in a dispute have the right to redress injuries by means of war. Used rightly, De Jure Belli would provide all parties with a clear understanding of how the law applied to various disputes and educate them in how to render fair and responsible verdicts. However, used rightly, it would also give trading powers the flexibility to leverage their arrangements with non-Europeans and the justifications to uphold these arrangements with force. One stratagem it enabled was encroachment on local sovereignty (see Keene 2002 pp. 48ff and 79ff). Grotius’ position was firmly that non-Christian rulers could hold full title to sovereignty, but his view of sovereignty was that its marks could be divided up among various holders. A foreign trading power might enter into an alliance with a ruler that required him, for instance, to provide land for a trading ‘factory’ or deliver up his people’s labor. These arrangements do not, in themselves, transfer any mark of sovereignty, but Grotius argues that, if the foreign power (unjustly) usurps this right over time without being challenged, its “long possession” provides it with a claim to sovereignty that is now just (JBP I.III.XXI.10-11). Because marks of sovereignty can be divided off in this way, the foreign power can take over limited rights of its own without being guilty of usurping the broader authority of the king. Once the limited right was established, however, it could also be protected with force should the king try to reconsolidate his power (by the same right that the Dutch defended their limited sovereignty against the ambitions of their Spanish overlord). Had the rulers of Southeast Asia read Grotius’ work, they might have found a useful warning about the risks of getting entangled with a powerful ally; the readers among the European mercantile class would also see its usefulness.

The natural-right framework of De Jure Belli also empowers parties to a contract to arrive at their own judgments about how to interpret indeterminate clauses (JBP II.XVI) and authorizes any party, public or private, to execute punishment for culpable violations of the law (II.XX). The idea that war-making can be understood as an extension of the right to punish had been part of the Christian just-war tradition from Augustine through Vitoria and Suarez, but Grotius reconceives punishment as a natural right that obtains prior to civil authority (see Tuck 1999 pp. 102f. and Straumann 2006). In circumstances beyond civil jurisdiction, law-respecting persons can take it upon themselves to police and punish crimes affecting society. Because this exercise of power over another assumes a position of superiority, Grotius recognizes the need to explain how this difference in standing can arise among those who are equal by nature. His solution is to point out that violators demote themselves beneath the rest of humanity (JBP II.XX.iii). Anyone who remains in this position of moral superiority can properly execute punishment. The natural right to punish was an important innovation in Grotius’ early De Indis, where he argued that Dutch merchants had legitimate authority to punish the Portuguese for monopolizing the seas (fol. 40). It remains a key feature of his theory of punishment in De Jure Belli, where it provides a further source for just causes to resort to war. In contrast to the anti-imperialist arguments of Vitoria and the school of Salamanca, which had maintained that the princes of Europe had no authority to punish those beyond their jurisdiction except in response to ‘an injury received’ (On the Law of War q.1 a.3; see also On the American Indians q. 2 a.5), Grotius opens the door to punitive war against those who commit ‘crimes against nature.’ Elevated as moral superiors above regimes that enjoin or condone manifestly unjust practices—including cannibalism, piracy, the oppression of their own people or the cruel treatment of foreigners—outside powers may seek to punish these regimes in the interests of human society (II.XX.XL). Adopted while Grotius still had ties to the interests of the Dutch trading companies, this interventionist stance would have expanded the range of justifications available for colonizing lands in both Asia and the Americas (see Tuck 1999 pp. 103-4 and van Ittersum 2010).

At the same time, Grotius shows an awareness, and some discomfort, that his position could be used as a pretext for expansionist wars. He cautions that only violations of universal norms, not of the evolving customs of Europe, count as punishable offenses. Quoting Plutarch, he explicitly warns of the lurking temptations of imperialism: “To wish to impose civilization upon uncivilized peoples is a pretext which may serve to conceal greed for what is another’s” (II.XX.XLI). The structure of Grotius’ position, characteristic of the framework of De Jure Belli, both insists on strict adherence to norms of justice, equity and humanity while still affording the powerful the flexibility to interpret, judge and enforce those norms by their own lights.

4. Natural Right and the Law of Nations

The broadest principles of just war in De Jure Belli ac pacis derive from two sources: the norms of natural justice and the customary law of nations (ius gentium). (Other human and divine laws, importantly, also lay down binding principles for those who have received them, but these sources do not have the universal character of the laws of nature and nations.) On any given question regarding the resort to war or its conduct, both systems of law must be consulted, as each system is capable of influencing the rights and obligations of the other.

a. Obligations from Nature and Custom

The account of natural law in De Jure Belli, heavily influenced by the Stoic notions of Cicero, begins from two universal human concerns: self-preservation and social connection (see JBP I.II.I and Prol. 6-8). The rights of obligations of natural law are all justified in terms of the rational balancing of these two primary concerns. This approach is an outgrowth of Grotius’ earliest work on the laws of war, De Indis, where he argued that the imperative of self-preservation justified two permissions of natural law: to defend one’s life and to acquire possessions (fol. 5’-6). The need for human fellowship justifies two basic obligations towards others: to refrain from inflicting injury and from seizing their possessions (fol. 6’-7’). One apparent change that Grotius makes to his earlier theory regards the basis for these obligations. In De Indis, he aligns himself with a voluntarist account of obligation, found in medieval thinkers such as Ockham, which maintains that natural law is binding upon humans in virtue of the divine will that commands it (fol 5’). The design of nature is one way in which we receive God’s commands. By the time of De Jure Belli, Grotius seems to accept the alternative, intellectualist position that natural law binds us by teaching what both humans and God can recognize as necessary for human life: it shows us not what is obligatory because commanded but what is obligatory or permissible “in itself” (JBP I.I.x). In fact, there is much ambiguity in the later work as to which position Grotius accepts, showing itself even in his very definition of natural law as “a dictate of right reason, which points out that an act has in it a quality of moral baseness of moral necessity; and that, in consequence, such an act is either forbidden or enjoined by the author of nature, God” (JBP I.I.x). This definition is perhaps closest to the ‘mediating’ position more recently advanced by Suárez, maintaining that intellect could recognize what is, in itself, good or bad for humans but that only God’s command makes it obligatory to live accordingly (De Legibus II.VI; see Schneewind 1998 pp. 61 and 74).

What is clear is that Grotius draws a basic distinction in law, following Aristotle, between obligations derived from nature and those derived from an authoritative will (JBP I.I.ix and xiii-xvi). Sources of this second, ‘volitional’ type of law can be divine (as revealed in scripture) or human, and the latter includes not only the laws of particular states but also those laws that nations accept in their relations with each other. Kings and peoples give their assent to the law of nations through custom, not typically by positive agreement. Long observance of a norm in the relations between states gives it the force of law. In contrast to natural law, which confers its basic rights and obligations to all persons whether in a private or public capacity, the law of nations applies to relations between sovereign entities (cf. JBP Prol. 40; De Indis fol. 12ff). It deals, accordingly, largely with matters of state, such as embassies, treaties, and the special privileges of sovereigns in waging war. This system of customary law, in turns out, makes the legal position of sovereigns radically different from that of private actors in the ‘universal society’ established by natural law.

b. Just War: Jus ad Bellum

The mutual influence of the laws of nature and nations can be seen in both the resort to war (traditionally called the jus ad bellum) and in its conduct (jus in bello). The only just grounds for resorting to war are those that involve the pursuit of a right. Among such pursuits, Grotius identifies three kinds: self-defense, the recovery of property and punishment. Each of these has its basis in natural law, though the particular rights at issue might arise from other sources, such as the law of nations. The right of self-defense arises from the natural permission every person has to protect against injury (II.I.iii). If our primary concern is self-preservation, we could not take the risk of living among other people without reserving the permission to protect ourselves from them. The right of defense extends not only to one’s life, but also to one’s body and property. Grotius argues that killing in defense of one’s body is justifiable even if the assailant’s objective is not to kill but to maim or rape (II.I.vi-vii). The reason is that one can never trust that a physical assault will not result in death (though it is unclear in Grotius’ treatment of rape whether it is the victim’s life or interests of men in her ‘chastity’ that is the justifying concern). There are two constraints on justified self-defense: that the attack is imminent and certain (II.I.v). Defense is a just cause that applies only to immediate danger. Even property, however, may be defended with lethal force, with the further constraint that such force is necessary for retaining it (II.I.xvi).

Apart from defense, war may be waged in order to recover one’s rights or to punish the offender. Acting under these just causes will often entail being the one to initiate violence. Grotius argues that this breach of peace is not anti-social (and hence in violation of natural justice) because the initiator is only demanding what the other party already owes (I.II.i.5-6) – they are not violating but upholding the system of rights. Recovery of property applies not only to moveable things and territory, but also to rights over persons (such as rightful subjects or slaves), rights to actions (such as the fulfillment of contracts), and compensation for damages. All of these might be claimed by natural right, though the particular claims might be shaped by prevailing domestic systems of property or by the law of nations. This single heading yields an expansive range of cases in which war is a just option for enforcing rights. Punishment multiplies such cases. When someone willfully violates a right, they become obligated not only to make restitution but to endure punishment equivalent to their crime. Any law-respecting person (as explained above) may execute this punishment, in principle, though a number of factors will tend to limit international punishment. Due to the high risk of harming the innocent in pursuit of the guilty, punitive wars are permissible only for serious crimes (II.XX.xxxviii). In most circumstances, only sovereign governments will be permitted to execute the punishment since individual citizens would have transferred this natural right to their state (see II.XX.xxiv and II.XX.xl; cf. De Indis, fol. 40-40’). Public authorities, therefore, can lay claim to special punitive causes such as the punishment of crimes against natural society (see above) and anticipatory defense. Whereas only an actual attack can justify self-defense, a plot to attack, once set in motion, is already a crime (II.I.xvi). Under the cause of punishment, a state may resort to preemptive warfare which defense alone could not justify. Finally, every exercise of punishment must be limited to the achievement of certain goods. While the right to punish has a retributive justification rooted in the offender’s obligation to endure it, the exercise of this right ought to be governed by consequentialist considerations. The good of the offender, of the victim and of the broader society, are all relevant benefits that need to be weighed against the harms to each of these (II.XX.iv-ix). Especially when the consequences of punishment include a broader war, these considerations may urge clemency, restraint or even pardon (II.XX.xxii-iv and xxxiv-xxxvi; see II.XXIV.ii-iii).

There is a general pattern of argument—that people are permitted, in the strictness of justice, to use violence in a great many cases that will nonetheless call for moderation in the name of humanity and peace—that characterizes the whole of De Jure Belli ac Pacis. Justice is a crucial virtue, as the maintenance of society and respect of law require it, but its guidance is limited to these minimal aims. To know what the laws ought to be and to decide when and how far to exercise one’s rights, it becomes necessary to follow the promptings of equity, humanity and prudence. These “virtues which have as their object the good of others” (I.I.viii) not only serve to measure the proper severity of punishments but also to determine whether war for a punitive cause is warranted at all. Humaneness imposes a moral limit, too, in how far one ought to press rights to property, so as not to use market power to squeeze people (II.XII.xvi) or to withhold vital information when making contracts (II.XII.ix). Even in self-defense, the resort to war can have humanitarian consequences that speak strongly against making full use of one’s right (II.I.iv, viii, ix and xi). It would be a grave error, Grotius warns, to think that “where a right has been adequately established, either war should be waged forthwith, or even that war is permissible in all cases” (II.XXIV.i). The resort to war must be squared not only with justice but with humanitarian concerns, especially for its impact on the lives of innocent people. This loving regard for others that aspires to universality is what Grotius held up, in his works on religion, as the great ethical appeal of the Gospel, and De Jure Belli instructs its readers to recognize that not only humanity but also God calls them to love, forbearance and restraint.

c. Just War: Jus in Bello

The meshing of these normative standards of justice and humanity is especially pronounced in Grotius’ treatment of the conduct of war in Book III of De Jure Belli. The natural law provides but one basic rule for the conduct of war: “things which lead to an end receive their intrinsic value from the end itself” (JBP III.I.ii). That is, if one has a right to resort to war, then one has a right to conduct the war by whatever means are necessary to vindicate the just case. Grotius finds natural justice an unsatisfactory basis for the ethics of combat for two main reasons: (i) it permits inhumane and intemperate actions on the part of those who fight under a just cause, and (ii) it provides no guidance whatsoever for those who fight under an unjust cause. The answer to the first deficiency is Grotius’ account of temperamenta, discussed below. The second deficiency finds its solution in the law of nations. Grotius recognizes that while no war can be naturally just on both sides—a right on one side precludes a right on the other—wars may be either unjust on both sides or justifiably believed to be just on both sides. In either case, there are belligerents for whom natural justice provides no guidance other than, ‘your cause is unjust: stop fighting.’ Grotius resigns himself to the realism that, aside from exceptional cases, most states will not admit to the injustice of their cause and simply stop fighting. The longer such states fight, the more injustices they pile up by resisting the just party. Before long there would be no limit to the punitive war that could be prosecuted against the unjust state (see III.IV.iv). Grotius suggests that nations, recognizing the perils of this situation, established a custom of holding both parties in a war to have equal standing on the battlefield. That is, the law of nations permits to both sides (regardless of the justice of their cause) all the actions that the natural law would permit to the just.

The customs of warfare under the law of nations turn out to be extremely permissive. Tracking the prevailing practice of states, the customs permit everything from the slaughter of innocents to the taking of slaves and the looting of civilian property. License to conduct warfare in this way is the special privilege of sovereigns who have ‘solemnized’ their war under the law of nations. Indifferent to the substantive justice of a state’s cause, the law of nations insists instead on certain formalities—a public declaration by the sovereign authority—to give the belligerent its legal status in a solemn war (I.III.iv and III.III). While Grotius defends this status as a way of restoring normal relations between sovereigns at the end of war, he insists that even kings remain accountable to natural justice. The law of nations is derived from human will, and the license it gives in solemn wars cannot contradict the requirements of natural law. The license amounts to an agreement among nations not to punish each other for certain acts (III.IV.ii-iii). So, after many lengthy chapters detailing the range of actions permitted by the law of nations, Grotius takes an abrupt turn, telling the reader that he must now retrace his steps and “deprive those who wage war of nearly all the privileges which I seemed to grant, yet did not grant to them” (III.X.i). Those waging a solemn war may have the privilege of impunity under human law, but a ‘sense of shame’ ought to instill a respect not only for the ‘external’ judgments of the courts but for the ‘internal’ judgments of conscience (III.X and III.XI.i-ii). Those waging an unjust war will be accountable to God, and they have an (unenforceable) obligation to make restitution to those they have wronged. Even those waging war for a just cause should observe the limits of natural justice by sparing the innocent and pursuing only those war aims that are necessary to securing one’s rights. Conducting war merely within the bounds of the law of nations may obtain impunity, but it brings no badge of honor.

What makes kings and peoples worthy of honor is their observance of temperamenta: moderation and restraint in pursuing their just claims. Such restraint comes out of a respect for justice—by restricting the means of war to only what is necessary to achieving the ends—and also out of a sense of humanity. This humane concern for others seeks to limit the impact of war on the innocent and even those fighting on the opposing side (see, for example, III.XI.viii, XII.viii, and XIII.iv). It requires in many cases the remission of punishment, to forgiveness of burdensome war debts, and a preference for restoring local sovereignty rather than imposing imperial rule. At all events, one must uphold good faith in agreements made with the other side in order to build the basis for normal relations after the war (III.XXI-XXV). Humanity holds in view not only the aim of restoring rights but of restoring peace (see III.XXV.ii-iii). Justice might condone war against injuries that threaten the basis for living together in society, but a sense of humanity is fostered by the recognition that we must live together again.

5. Scholarly Interest in Grotius

In the century following his death, Grotius’ works came to be viewed as pivotal in the development of early modern moral and political philosophy. Jean Barbeyrac, in his 1749 essay on the emerging Science of Morality, described Grotius as “breaking the ice” of medieval dogma to make way for a rational approach to ethics. The natural law philosophy of the seventeenth and eighteenth centuries—from Pufendorf to Locke, Vattel and Thomasius—took the framework of De Jure Belli ac pacis as a point of departure. This canonical status made Grotius required reading for Enlightenment intellectuals, such that Rousseau would come to describe him in Emile, however critically, as “the master of all the savants” and Adam Smith would credit him in his lectures on jurisprudence as giving the world the most systematic treatment of the subject to date. The 21st century has seen a renewed debate among scholars over the extent of Grotius ‘originality’ in moral thought and in what it consists: the purported secularism of his approach, its rationalism, its refutation of skepticism, its account of obligation, or a variety of other candidates. Beyond these disputes, recent historians of moral and political philosophy have taken special interest in Grotius’ conception of natural rights, his theory of punishment, and his accounts of property and state sovereignty.

Grotius’ legacy, however, is most strongly connected to his contributions to international legal theory and the laws of war. Interest in Grotius saw a revival in the late nineteenth century amid efforts to articulate and institutionalize norms of international law. The peace societies of the time, closely bound up with the international women’s suffrage movement, traced back to the Grotius the evolving conscience of the ‘civilized’ world towards justice and mercy in international conflicts. Andrew Dickson White, the U.S. delegate to the 1899 Hague Peace Conference, regarded Grotius—whom he classed among the world’s Seven Great Statesmen in the Warfare of Humanity with Unreason—as providing the “real foundation of the modern science of international law.” While the claim to being ‘father’ of this law was as disputed as it was common, and despite many critical views of this work—in his 1925 history of political philosophy, Charles Vaughan had called De Jure Belli a “nest of sophistries and contradictions”—Grotius came to have a canonical status in international legal thought. By the end of the Second World War, the legal scholar Hersch Lauterpacht was able to discern a ‘Grotian tradition in international law’ rooted in commitments to the rule of law, to norms beyond positive law, and to the human capacity for moral progress in the law. Grotius continues to be most widely known within the study of just war theory and international law, most notably for the contribution of Mare Liberum to the modern law of the sea.

The preeminence of Grotius in the field of international law exerted its influence as well on the development of international relations theory. Theorists of international relations have commonly viewed Grotius as providing a distinctive conception of international society that provides a middle way between Hobbesian anarchy and Kantian cosmopolitanism. In this schema of ‘realist,’ ‘rationalist,’ and ‘revolutionist’ theories, proposed by Martin Wight and pursued in the work of Hedley Bull and others of the ‘English School’ of international relations theory, the Grotian tradition provides a rationalist account of international society. While rejecting the idea that there are common interests among states sufficient to underpin a supranational authority, the Grotian system identifies a ‘solidarity’ of interests around basic principles of order (such as mutual independence, adherence to promises, the limitation of war) that enables sovereign states to constitute their relations as a (limited) community rather than as a contest governed by the dynamics of power alone.  The association of Grotius with this strain of thought has given his work enduring interest in contemporary international theory.

While reaching the greatest prominence in international thought, the early 21st century scholarship on Grotius has a markedly interdisciplinary character. His works have received considerable attention from political theorists and historians of political thought, as well as by those studying his contributions to moral philosophy, theology and literature. Indeed, the eclecticism of Grotius’ thought pushes beyond modern disciplinary boundaries and springs up continuing dialogues across fields and borders.

6. References and Further Reading

Included in the Primary Sources are selected works of Grotius with a preference for most recently in-print English editions. (Note: references to De Jure Belli in the article provide the book, chapter and section numbers, e.g., II.XXIV.i.). The selected secondary sources include references from the article as well as suggested directions for further reading. The interested scholar will also want to consult the regularly published journal of Grotius studies, Grotiana.

a. Primary Sources

  • Grotius, H. (2006). De Jure Praedae Commentarius / Commentary on the law of prize and booty. Indianapolis, Liberty Fund.
  • Grotius, H. (1994). “Commentarius in Theses XI”: an Early Treatise on Sovereignty, the Just war, and the Legitimacy of the Dutch Revolt, P. Lang.
  • Grotius, H. (2004). The Free Sea. Indianapolis, IN, Liberty Fund.
  • Grotius, H. (1988). Meletius. Leiden, Netherlands, Brill.
  • Grotius, H. (1990). Defensio Fidei Catholicae de Satisfactione Christi, adversus Faustum Socinum Senensem. Assen/Maastricht, the Netherlands, Van Gorcum.
  • Grotius, H. (2001). De Imperio Summarum Potestatum circa Sacra. Studies in the history of Christian thought, v. 102. H.-J. v. Dam. Leiden, Brill.
  • Grotius, H. (1926). The Jurisprudence of Holland. R. W. Lee. Oxford, Clarendon Press.
  • Grotius, H. (2005). The rights of war and peace. Indianapolis, Liberty Fund.
  • Grotius, H. (1962). De Jure Belli ac pacis libri tres / The Law of War and Peace. Indianapolis, Bobbs-Merrill.
  • Grotius, H. (2012). The Truth of the Christian Religion. Indianapolis, Liberty Fund.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Borschberg, P. (1994). “Critical Introduction.” “Commentarius in Theses XI”: an Early Treatise on Sovereignty, the Just War, and the Legitimacy of the Dutch Revolt. H. Grotius, P. Lang.
  • Brett, A. (2002). “Natural Right and Civil Community: The Civil Philosophy of Hugo Grotius.” The Historical Journal 45(01): 31-51.
  • Bull, H., B. Kingsbury, et al. (1990). Hugo Grotius and International Relations. New York, Clarendon Press.
  • Dumbauld, E. (1969). The Life and Legal Writings of Hugo Grotius. Norman, University of Oklahoma Press.
  • Forde, S. (1998). “Hugo Grotius on Ethics and War.” American Political Science Review 92(3): 639-648.
  • Haakonssen, K. (1985). “Hugo Grotius and the History of Political Thought.” Political Theory 13(2): 239-265.
  • Heering, J. (2004). “Hugo Grotius’ De Veritate Religionis Christianae.” Hugo Grotius as Apologist for the Christian Religion: a Study of his Work De veritate Religionis Christianae, 1640. J. Heering. Leiden, Brill: 41-52.
  • Keene, E. (2002). Beyond the Anarchical Society: Grotius, Colonialism and Order in World Politics, Cambridge University Press.
  • Kinsella, H. M. (2006). “Gendering Grotius: Sex and Sex Difference in the Laws of War.” Political Theory 34(2): 161.
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Author Information

Andrew Blom
Email: andrew.blom@cmich.edu
Central Michigan University
U. S. A.

The Moral Permissibility of Punishment

The legal institution of punishment presents a distinctive moral challenge because it involves a state’s infliction of intentionally harsh, or burdensome, treatment on some of its members—treatment that typically would be considered morally impermissible. Most of us would agree, for instance, that it is typically impermissible to imprison people, to force them to pay monetary sanctions or engage in community service, or to execute them. The moral challenge of punishment, then, is to establish what (if anything) makes it permissible to subject those who have been convicted of crimes to such treatment.

Traditionally, justifications of punishment have been either consequentialist or retributivist. Consequentialist accounts contend that punishment is justified as a means to securing some valuable end—typically crime reduction, by deterring, incapacitating, or reforming offenders. Retributivism, by contrast, holds that punishment is an intrinsically appropriate (because deserved) response to criminal wrongdoing. Each type of account has been roundly criticized, on a variety of grounds, by theorists in the other camp. In an effort to break this impasse, scholars have attempted to find alternative strategies that incorporate certain consequentialist or retributivist elements but avoid the standard objections directed at each. Each of these accounts has, in turn, met with criticism. Finally, abolitionists argue that none of these defenses of punishment is satisfactory, and that the practice is morally impermissible; the salient question for abolitionists, then, is how else (if at all) society should respond to those forms of wrongdoing that we now punish.

This article first looks more closely at what punishment is; in particular, it examines the distinctive features of punishment in virtue of which it stands in need of justification. It then highlights various questions that a full justification of punishment would need to answer. With these questions in mind, the article considers the most prominent consequentialist, retributivist, and hybrid attempts at establishing punishment’s moral permissibility. Finally, it considers the abolitionist alternative.

Table of Contents

  1. What is Punishment?
  2. Various Questions
  3. Consequentialist Accounts
    1. Deterrence
    2. Incapacitation
    3. Offender Reform
    4. Sentencing
    5. Objections and Responses
  4. Retributivist Accounts
    1. Deserved Suffering
    2. Fair Play
    3. Censure
    4. Other Versions
    5. Sentencing
  5. Alternative Accounts
    1. Rights Forfeiture
    2. Consent
    3. Self-Defense
    4. Moral Education
    5. Hybrid Approaches
  6. Abolitionism
  7. References and Further Reading

1. What is Punishment?

When we consider whether punishment is morally permissible, it is important first to be clear about what it is that we are evaluating. Theorists disagree about a precise definition of punishment; nevertheless, we can identify a number of features that are commonly cited as elements of punishment.

First, it is generally accepted that punishment involves the infliction of a burden. The state confines people in jails and prisons, where liberties such as their freedom of movement and association, and their privacy, are heavily restricted. It imposes often heavy monetary sanctions or forces people to take part in community service work. It subjects people to periods of probation during which their movements and activities are closely supervised. In the most extreme cases, it executes people. Theorists disagree on precisely how to characterize this feature of punishment. Some describe punishment as essentially painful, or as involving the infliction of suffering, harsh treatment, or harm. Others instead write of punishment as involving the restriction of liberties. However we characterize the specific nature of the burden, it is relatively uncontroversial that punishment in its various forms is burdensome.

One might object that some prisoners could become accustomed to incarceration and so not see it as a burden, or that the masochist might even enjoy his corporal punishment. In response to supposed counterexamples such as these, a defender of the “burdensomeness” feature of punishment might argue that the comfortable prisoner and the masochist are still punished insofar as they are treated in ways that are typically regarded as burdensome by those on whom they are inflicted. Alternatively, one might argue that a particular case of incarceration, corporal punishment, and so forth, indeed does not count as punishment if the prisoner does not find it burdensome (Boonin, 2008: 8-10). Whatever one makes of these attempted counterexamples, it remains the case that punishment theorists by and large agree that burdensomeness is an essential feature of punishment.

But punishment is not merely burdensome. A second widely accepted feature of punishment is that it is intended to be burdensome. This feature distinguishes punishment from other forms of treatment that may be burdensome but are not intentionally so. Many people undoubtedly regard it as burdensome to pay their taxes, for instance, but presumably most do not regard this as a form of punishment. This is because although taxes may be foreseeably burdensome, they are not intentionally so. That is, the state does not levy taxes intending for them to be burdensome; rather, the intention is to pay for roads, an education system, and other public goods. That paying for these goods is burdensome to many taxpayers is incidental, and if there were a way to collect sufficient revenue to pay for needed public goods without this being a burden to taxpayers, then so much the better.

Punishment, however, is different. Punishment is intended to be burdensome. If it were not burdensome, then it would not be doing its job. For instance, as we will see below, some theorists contend that the aim of punishment is to reduce crime by deterring potential criminals. But for the threat of punishment to be the sort of thing likely to deter criminals, the punishment itself must be burdensome. Other theorists (retributivists) contend that wrongdoers deserve to suffer, and that punishment is justified as the infliction of this deserved suffering. Here again, the burdensomeness of punishment is not merely incidental, it is intended.

Of course, not all impositions of intended burdens count as punishment. A third commonly accepted feature of punishment is that it is imposed on someone guilty of an offense, as a response to that offense. Actually, there is some disagreement about this point. To count as punishment, must it be imposed on someone who is actually guilty of a crime? Or would it make sense to talk of punishing an innocent person (either mistakenly or intentionally)? Some scholars contend that punishment must be of a guilty person. Susan Dimock writes, “The innocent may be ‘victimized’ by the penal system, but they cannot be ‘punished’” (Dimock, 1997: 42). By contrast, H. L. A. Hart contends that we should acknowledge not only punishment of actual offenders, but also cases (which he calls “sub-standard or secondary”) of punishment “of persons…who neither are in fact nor supposed to be offenders” (see Hart, 1968: 5).

A fourth feature of punishment, widely acknowledged at least since the publication of Joel Feinberg’s seminal 1965 article “The Expressive Function of Punishment” is that it serves to express condemnation, or censure, of the offender for her offense. As Feinberg discusses, it is this condemning element that distinguishes punishment from what he calls “nonpunitive penalties” such as parking tickets, demotions, flunkings, and so forth. (Feinberg, 1965: 398-401). As we will see below, some scholars have taken this expression of censure to be central to the justification of punishment. But whether or not it plays a role in the justification of the practice, this expressive function is typically accepted as a distinctive feature of punishment.

Finally, it is worth highlighting that this article focuses on the legal institution of punishment—rather than, say, parents’ punishment of their children or other interpersonal cases of punishment (but see Zaibert, 2006). Legal theorists often assert as one of punishment’s features that it must be imposed by a properly constituted legal authority (typically, the state). They thereby aim to differentiate legal punishment from private vengeance or vigilantism. This does not mean we must accept uncritically that the state is the proper authority to impose punishment. Ideally, a full account of punishment should provide a plausible answer to why (or if) the state has an exclusive right to impose punishment.

These, then, are the most commonly cited features of punishment: punishment involves the state’s imposition of intended burdens—burdens that express social condemnation—on people (believed to be) guilty of crimes, in response to those crimes. This is not intended as a precise definition or a set of necessary and sufficient conditions for punishment. Theorists may disagree about particular elements, or especially about how exactly to flesh out the various elements. But this description is sufficient to give us a sense of why punishment stands in need of justification: It involves the state’s treating some of its members (imposing intentionally burdensome, censuring sanctions) in ways that typically would be morally impermissible.

2. Various Questions

When theorists ask whether punishment is justified, they typically assume a backdrop in which the legal system administering punishment is legitimate, and the criminal laws themselves are reasonably just. This is not to say that they assume that all legal systems are legitimate and all criminal laws are reasonably just in the actual world. Indeed, questions of political legitimacy and criminalization are important topics that have received a great deal of attention in their own right. But even in societies in which the legal system is legitimate and the laws are reasonably just, a general question arises of whether (and if so, why) it is permissible for the state to impose intended, censuring burdens on those who violate the laws.

This general question of punishment’s moral permissibility actually comprises a number of particular questions. A full normative account of punishment should provide answers to each of these questions.

First, there is the question of punishment’s function, or purpose. Put simply, what reason is there to want an institution of punishment? H. L. A. Hart referred to this as punishment’s “general justifying aim,” although this term may be misleading in two ways: on one hand, to say that the aim is justifying implies that it is sufficient, by itself, to establish punishment’s permissibility. As we will see, some scholars point out that more is needed to justify punishment than merely citing its function, no matter how valuable. On the other hand, talk of a justifying aim seems to privilege consequentialist accounts, according to which punishment is justified as a means to some socially valuable goal. But even for retributivist accounts, according to which punishment is justified not as a means to some end but rather as an intrinsically appropriate response to wrongdoing, we still need an explanation of why such a response is important enough to warrant the state’s institution of punishment. A first question, then, is what sufficiently important function punishment serves.

Even if we establish some sufficiently valuable function of punishment, this may not be enough to justify the practice. Some scholars contend that a crucial question is whether punishment violates the moral rights of those punished. If punishing offenders violates their rights, then it may be morally impermissible even if it serves some important function (Simmons, 1991; Wellman, 2009). What we need, according to this view, is an account of why, in principle, the practice of imposing intended burdens on people in the ways characteristic of punishment does not violate their moral rights.

In addition to justifying the practice of punishment in general, a complete account of punishment should also provide guidance in determining how to punish in particular cases. Even if the institution of punishment is morally permissible, a particular sentence may be impermissible if it is excessively harsh (or on some accounts, if it is too lenient). What principles and considerations should guide assessments of how severely to punish?

Relatedly, although this point has received less attention, we should ask not only about the appropriate severity of punishment but also about the proper mode of punishment. We may critique certain sentences not in virtue of their severity but because we believe the form of punishment (incarceration, capital punishment, and so forth) is in some sense inappropriate (Reiman, 1985; Moskos, 2011). What considerations, then, should guide assessments of whether imprisonment, fines, community service, probation, capital punishment, or some other form of punishment is the appropriate response to instances of criminal wrongdoing?

Finally, as mentioned, it is important to ask about the state’s role as the agent of punishment. Why is it the state’s right to impose punishment (if indeed it is)? Furthermore, what gives the state the exclusive right to punish (Wellman, 2009)? Why may victims not inflict punishment on their assailants (or hire someone to inflict the punishment)? Another question related to the proper agent of punishment—a question that has become increasingly salient in the decades following the Nuremberg trials—is when (if ever) the international community, rather than a particular state, can be the proper agent of punishment. What sorts of crime, and which criminals, are properly accountable to the institutions of international criminal law rather than (or perhaps in addition) to the domestic legal systems of particular states?

As we will see, various accounts of punishment focus on different questions. Also, some accounts seek to answer each of these questions by appealing to the same moral principles or considerations, whereas others appeal to different considerations in answering the different questions.

3. Consequentialist Accounts

Consequentialism holds that the rightness or wrongness of actions—or rules for action, or (relevant to our context) institutions—is determined solely by their consequences. Thus consequentialist accounts of punishment defend the practice as instrumentally valuable: the consequences of maintaining an institution of legal punishment, according to this view, are better than the consequences of not having such an institution. For many consequentialists, the burden of punishment itself is seen as a negative consequence—an “evil,” as Jeremy Bentham called it (Bentham, 1789: 158). Thus for punishment to be justified, it must be the case that it brings about other, sufficiently valuable consequences to outweigh its onerousness for the person on whom it is inflicted. Typically, punishment is defended as a necessary means to the socially valuable end of crime reduction, through deterrence, incapacitation, or offender reform.

a. Deterrence

Deterrence accounts contend that the threat of punishment serves as a disincentive for potential criminals. On such accounts, for the threat of punishment to be effective as a deterrent, it must be credible—it must have teeth, so to speak—and thus the legal system must follow through on the threat and impose punishment on those who violate laws. Theorists have distinguished two potential audiences for the deterrent threat: first, the threat of punishment might serve to dissuade members of the public generally from committing crimes that they might otherwise have committed. This is called general deterrence. Second, for those who do commit crimes and are subjected to punishment, the threat of future punishment (namely, the prospect of having to experience prison again, or pay further fines, and so forth) might provide a disincentive to reoffending. This is typically referred to as specific (or special) deterrence.

b. Incapacitation

Punishment might also help to reduce crime by incapacitating criminals. Unlike deterrence, incapacitation does not operate by dissuading potential offenders. Incapacitation instead aims to remove dangerous people from situations in which they could commit crimes. Imprisoning someone in a solitary confinement unit, for instance, may or may not convince her not to commit crimes in the future; but while she is locked up, she will be unable to commit (most) crimes.

c. Offender Reform

A third way in which punishment might help to reduce crime is by encouraging or facilitating offender reform. The aim of reform is like that of specific deterrence in one respect: both seek to induce a change in the offender’s behavior. That is, the aim for both is that she should choose not to reoffend. In this respect, both reform and specific deterrence differ from incapacitation, which is concerned with restricting rather than influencing offenders’ choices. But reform differs from specific deterrence in terms of the ways in which each seeks to induce different choices. Punishment aimed at specific deterrence provides prudential reasons: we impose onerous treatment on an offender in hopes that her aversion to undergoing such treatment again will convince her not to reoffend. Punishment with the aim of offender reform, by contrast, aims to reshape offenders’ moral motives and dispositions.

d. Sentencing

Each of these aims—deterrence, incapacitation, and reform—will have distinct implications with respect to sentencing. Punishment aimed at reducing crime through deterrence would in general need to be severe enough to provide members of the public with a significant incentive not to offend, or to provide offenders with an incentive not to reoffend. Also, as Bentham explained, the severity of sentences should reflect the relative seriousness of the crimes punished (Bentham, 1789: 168). More serious crimes should receive more severe punishments than do less serious crimes, so that prospective offenders, if they are going to commit one crime or the other, will have an incentive to choose the less serious crime.

For punishment aimed at reducing crime through incapacitation, sentences should be restrictive enough that dangerous offenders will be unable to victimize others (so, for instance, prison appears generally preferable to fines as a form of incapacitative punishment). In terms of duration, incapacitative sentences should last as long as the offender poses a genuine threat. Similarly, sentences aimed at reducing crime through offender reform should be tailored, in terms of the form, severity, and duration of punishment, in whatever ways are determined to be most conducive to this aim.

Finally, insofar as punishment itself is considered to be, in Bentham’s words, an “evil,” the consequentialist is committed to the view that sentences should be no more severe than is necessary to accomplish their aim. Thus whether she endorses deterrence, incapacitation, reform, or some other aim (or a combination of these), the consequentialist should also endorse a parsimony constraint on sentence severity (Tonry, 2011). After all, to impose sentences that are more severe than is necessary to accomplish punishment’s aim(s) would appear to be an infliction of gratuitous suffering—and so, from a consequentialist perspective, unjustified.

e. Objections and Responses

Typical consequentialist accounts of punishment contend that the practice is justified because it produces, on balance, positive consequences by helping to reduce crime, either through deterrence, incapacitation, or offender reform. Critics have objected to such consequentialist accounts on a number of grounds.

First, some have objected to deterrence accounts on grounds that punishment does not actually deter potential offenders. A key worry is that often (perhaps typically) those who commit crimes act impulsively or irrationally, rather than as efficient calculators of expected utility, and so they are not responsive to the threat of punishment. The question of whether punishment deters is an empirical one, and criminological studies on this question have come to different conclusions. In general, evidence seems to indicate that punishment does have some deterrent effect, but that the certainty of apprehension plays a greater deterrent role than does the severity of punishment (Nagin, 2013).

A similar line of objection has been raised against reform-based accounts of punishment. Criminological research in the 1970s led many scholars and practitioners to conclude that punishment did not, indeed could not, promote offender reform (the mantra “nothing works” was for many years ubiquitous in these discussions). More recent criminological work, however, has generated somewhat more optimism about the prospects for offender reform (Cullen, 2013).

Whereas critics have questioned whether punishment deters or facilitates offender reform, there is little doubt that punishment—especially incarceration—incapacitates (prisoners may still have opportunities to commit crimes, but their opportunities are at least significantly limited.) Critics have raised questions, however, about the link between incapacitation and crime reduction. For punishment to be justified on incapacitative grounds, after all, it would need to be the case not only that punishment in fact incapacitates, but that in so doing it helps to reduce crime. At least in some cases, there is reason to doubt whether the link between incapacitation and crime reduction holds. Most notably, locking up drug dealers or gang members does not appear to decrease drug- or gang-related crimes, because the incapacitated person is quickly and easily replaced by someone else (Tonry, 2006: 31-32).

Even if we accept, for argument’s sake, that punishment contributes to crime reduction, it still may not be justified on consequentialist grounds if it also generates costs that outweigh its benefits. The costs of punishment are not limited to the suffering or other burdens inflicted on offenders, although these burdens do matter from a consequentialist perspective. Scholars have also highlighted burdens associated with certain forms of punishment—in particular, incarceration—for offenders’ families and communities (Mauer and Chesney-Lind, 2002). These costs matter in consequentialist calculations. In addition, we must consider the financial costs of maintaining an institution of criminal punishment. In 2012, the Vera Institute of Justice released a study of 40 U.S. states that found that the total taxpayer cost of prisons in these states was $39 billion. Thus defenders of punishment on consequentialist grounds must show not only that punishment is beneficial, but also that its benefits are significant enough to outweigh its costs to offenders and to society generally.

Furthermore, even if punishment’s benefits outweigh its costs, consequentialists must make the case that these benefits cannot be achieved through some other, less burdensome response to crime. If there are alternatives to punishment that are equally effective in reducing crime but are less costly overall, then from a consequentialist perspective, these alternatives would be preferable (Boonin, 2008: 53, 264-67).

Suppose, however, that the benefits of punishment outweigh its harms and also that there are no alternatives to punishment that generate, on balance, better overall consequences. In this case, punishment would be justified from a consequentialist perspective. Many theorists, however, do not endorse consequentialism. Indeed, the most prominent philosophical objections to consequentialist accounts of punishment take aim specifically at supposed deficiencies of consequentialism itself.

Perhaps the most common objection to consequentialist accounts is that they are unable to provide principled grounds for ruling out punishment of the innocent. If there were ever a situation in which punishing an innocent person would promote the best consequences, then consequentialism appears committed to doing so. H. J. McCloskey imagines a case in which, in the wake of a heinous crime, a small-town sheriff must decide whether to frame and punish a person whom the townspeople believe to be guilty but the sheriff knows is innocent if doing so is the only way to prevent rioting by the townspeople (McCloskey, 1957: 468-69). If punishing the innocent person defuses the residents’ hostilities and prevents the riots—and thereby produces better overall consequences than continuing to search for the actual criminal—then it appears that the consequentialist is committed to punishing the innocent person. But knowingly punishing an innocent person strikes most of us as deeply unjust.

Consequentialists have responded to this objection in various ways. Some contend that what McCloskey describes is not actually punishment, because punishment, by definition, is a response to those guilty of crimes (or at least believed to be guilty, whereas in McCloskey’s example, the sheriff knows the person to be innocent). H. L. A. Hart refers to this response as the “definitional stop” and he suggests it is unhelpful because it seeks to define away the interesting normative questions. Setting terminology aside, the relevant questions are whether and why it is permissible to impose intended, condemnatory burdens on those (believed to be) guilty of crimes. The consequentialist’s response is that doing so produces the best consequences, but then it seems that the consequentialist should be committed to imposing such burdens on those not (believed to be) guilty of crimes when doing so produces the best consequences. Such a practice would strike many as morally wrong, however. Thus the objection arises for consequentialists regardless of definitions.

Others have responded to the objection that consequentialism would allow for punishing the innocent by suggesting that scenarios such as McCloskey suggests are so far-fetched that they are unlikely to occur in the real world. In actual cases, punishing the innocent will rarely, if ever, produce the best consequences. For instance, some contend that the sheriff in the example would likely be found out, and as a result the public would lose its trust in law enforcement officials; the long-term consequences, therefore, would be worse than if the sheriff had not punished the innocent person. As critics have pointed out, however, this response only shows that punishing the innocent will usually be ruled out by consequentialism. There might still be cases, albeit rare, in which punishing the innocent would generate the best consequences (maybe the sheriff is adept at covering up his act). At best, then, consequentialism seems only able to ground a contingent prohibition on punishing the innocent. Some consequentialists have accepted this implication, albeit reluctantly (see Smart, 1973: 69-73).

A similar objection to consequentialist accounts is that they cannot provide a principled basis for the widely held intuition that punishment should be no more severe than an offender deserves (where desert is the product of the seriousness of the offense and the offender’s culpability). On this view, it is morally wrong to subject those guilty of relatively minor crimes to harsh punishment; such punishment would be excessive. For consequentialist accounts, though, it appears that excessively harsh sentences would be permitted (indeed, required) if they produced the best overall consequences.

Jeremy Bentham contended that consequentialism does have the resources to ground relative proportionality in sentencing—that is, lesser offenses should receive less severe sentences than more serious offenses receive. His reasoning was that if sentences for minor offenses were as harsh as for more serious offenses, potential offenders would have no incentive to commit the lesser offense rather than the more serious one (Bentham, 1789: 168). If Bentham is right, then there is a consequentialist basis for punishing shoplifters, for instance, less harshly than armed robbers. But this does not rule out punishing shoplifters harshly (more harshly than most of us would think justified) and punishing armed robbers even more harshly; again, a consequentialist would seem committed to such a sentencing scheme if it promoted the best overall consequences.

Defenders of consequentialist sentencing have another response available, namely that excessively harsh sentences do not, in practice, produce the best consequences. For instance, criminological research suggests a) that stiffer sentences do not produce significant deterrent effects (it is primarily the certainty of punishment rather than its severity that deters); b) that extremely long prison terms are not justified on incapacitative grounds (for one reason, most offenders “age out” of criminal behavior anyway by their 30s or 40s); and c) that extremely harsh sentences may, on balance, have criminogenic effects (that is, they may make people more likely to reoffend). This sort of response, of course, makes the prohibition of disproportionate punishment a contingent matter; in other words, if extremely harsh sentences did help to reduce crime and this produced, on balance, the best overall consequences, then consequentialism would appear to endorse such sentences. Critics thus charge that consequentialist accounts are unappealing insofar as they are unable to ground more than a contingent prohibition on disproportionately harsh punishment.

Even if we prohibit punishment of the innocent or disproportionate punishment of the guilty, a third, Kantian objection holds that consequentialist punishment is not properly responsive to the person being punished. According to this objection, to punish offenders as a means to securing some valuable social end (namely, crime reduction) is to use them as mere means, rather than respecting them as ends in themselves (Kant, 1797: 473; Murphy, 1973).

In response to this objection, some scholars have contended that although consequentialists regard punishment as a means to an end, punishment does not treat offenders as mere means to this end. If we limit punishment to those who have been found guilty of crimes, then this treatment is arguably responsive to their choices and does not use them as mere means. Kant himself suggested that as long as we reserve punishment only for those found guilty of crimes, then it is permissible to punish with an eye toward potential benefits (Kant, 1797: 473).

A more recent objection to consequentialist systems of punishment, developed by R. A. Duff (1986, 2001), charges that consequentialist systems of punishment, with their focus on crime reduction, treat offenders as dangerous “outsiders”—as the “they” whom “we,” the law-abiding members of society, must threaten, incapacitate, or remold to ensure our safety. Such a conception of the criminal law is inappropriately exclusionary, Duff claims. The criminal law, and the institution of punishment, in a liberal polity should treat offenders inclusively, as (still) members of the community who despite having violated its values could, and should, nevertheless (re)commit to these values.

In response, one might object that systems of punishment aimed at crime reduction need not be exclusionary in the way Duff suggests. In particular, punishment that aims to deter crime might be said to treat all community members equally, namely as potential offenders. For those who have not committed crimes, deterrent punishment regards them as potential offenders and aims to provide an incentive not to offend (that is, general deterrence). For those who have committed crimes, deterrent punishment similarly regards them as potential (re)offenders and aims to provide an incentive not to (re)offend (that is, specific deterrence). In this way, punishment with a deterrent aim might be said to speak to all community members in the same terms, and thus not to be objectionably exclusionary.

4. Retributivist Accounts

As we have seen, consequentialist accounts of punishment are essentially forward-looking—punishment is said to be justified in virtue of the consequences it helps to produce. A different sort of account regards punishment as justified not because of what it brings about, but instead because it is an intrinsically appropriate response to crime. Accounts of the second sort have traditionally been described as retributivist. In general, we can say that retributivism views punishment as justified because it is deserved, although particular accounts differ about what exactly this means.

Theorists have distinguished two varieties of retributivism: positive retributivism and negative retributivism. Positive retributivism is typically characterized as the view that an offender’s desert provides a positive justifying reason for punishment; in other words, the state should punish those who are found guilty of criminal wrongdoing because they deserve it. Negative retributivism, by contrast, provides a constraint on punishment: punishment is justified only of those who deserve it. Because negative retributivism provides only a constraint on punishment, not a positive reason to punish, the negative retributive constraint has featured prominently in attempts at mixed accounts of punishment; such accounts allow punishment for consequentialist aims as long as the punishment is only of those who deserve it. On the other hand, because negative retributivism does not provide a positive justifying reason to punish, some scholars argue that it does not properly count as retributivism at all.

The distinction between retributivism and consequentialism is not always a neat one. Notice that one might endorse the claim that punishment is a deserved response to wrongdoing and then further assert that it is a valuable state of affairs when wrongdoers get the punishment they deserve—a state of affairs that therefore should be promoted. On this type of account, retribution itself essentially becomes the consequentialist aim of punishment (Moore, 1903; Zaibert, 2006). Nevertheless, in keeping with general practice, this article will treat retributivism as distinct from, and in competition with, consequentialist accounts.

a. Deserved Suffering

One common version of retributivism contends simply that wrongdoers deserve to suffer in proportion to their wrongdoing. Often this claim is made by way of appeal to intuitions about particular, usually heinous crimes: surely the unrepentant war criminal, for example, who has tortured and murdered many innocent people, deserves to suffer for what he has done. Proponents argue that retributivism is justified because it best accounts for our intuitions about particular cases such as these (Moore, 1987; Kleinig, 1973).

Justifying retributivism requires more, of course, than merely appealing to common intuitions about such cases. After all, even if many (even most) people do feel, in hearing reports of terrible crimes, that the perpetrators deserve to suffer, not everyone feels this way. And even those who do have such intuitions may not feel entirely comfortable with them. What we would like to know is whether the intuitions themselves are justified, or whether, for instance, they amount to an unhealthy desire for vengeance. Critics contend that those who rely on our intuitions about particular cases as evidence that retributivism is justified fail to provide the needed explanation of why the intuitions are justified.

There are other questions for such a view: does any sort of moral wrongdoing deserve to be met with suffering, or only some cases of wrongdoing? Which ones? And why is meting out deserved suffering for wrongdoing properly the concern of the state?

b. Fair Play

Another prominent type of retributivist account begins with a conception of society as a cooperative venture in which each member benefits when there is general compliance with the rules governing the venture. Because each of us benefits when everyone else plays by the rules, fairness dictates that we each have an obligation to reciprocate by playing by the rules, too. A criminal, like other members of society, benefits from general compliance with laws, but she fails to reciprocate by complying with the laws herself. She essentially becomes a free rider, because she counts on others to play by the rules that she violates. By failing to restrain herself appropriately, she gains an unfair advantage over others in society. The justification of punishment is that it corrects this unfair advantage by inflicting burdens on the offender proportionate to the benefit she gained by committing her crime (Morris, 1968).

On the fair play view, then, punishment is justified as a deserved response to an unfair advantage taken against members of society generally. Such an account offers a relatively straightforward answer to the question of why punishment is the state’s business. The state has an interest in assuring those who accept the burdens of compliance with the law that they will not be at a disadvantage to those who would free-ride on the system.

Critics of the fair play view have argued that it provides a counterintuitive conception of the crime to which punishment responds. It seems strange, for instance, to think of the wrong perpetrated by, say, a rapist as a sort of free-riding wrong against society in general, rather than an egregious wrong perpetrated against the victim in particular. In response to this charge, Dagger (1993) argues that crimes may be wrong in both senses: they may wrong particular victims in various ways, but they are also in every case wrongs in the sense of free riding on society generally.

c. Censure

Another influential version of retributivism begins with the claim, discussed earlier, that one of punishment’s distinctive features is that it communicates censure, or condemnation, of the offender for her offense. This retributivist account, developed most notably by R. A. Duff (1986, 2001), takes the censuring feature as the key to establishing punishment’s moral permissibility. Offenders deserve to be censured for what they have done, and punishment is justified because it delivers this censuring message.

Duff understands crimes as public wrongs, as violations of important public values. It follows on this account that the state is the appropriate agent of punishment; the state properly calls offenders to account for their violations of the political community’s shared values.

Censuring involves, in part, urging an offender to think about the wrong she has done, to repent and (re)commit herself to the values that she has violated. Thus it follows from censure accounts such as Duff’s that offender self-reform is an aim of punishment. But notice the crucial distinction between this sort of account and the variety of consequentialist account that aims at offender reform. Although offender reform is an aim of punishment on the censure account, it is not a justifying aim. In other words, on the censure view, punishment is not justified insofar as it tends to promote offender reform. Rather, punishment is justified because it communicates deserved censure. Part of what it means to censure, however, is to urge wrongdoers to repent and reform.

A common critique of the censure view asks why punishment—that is, the imposition of intended burdens—is the proper way to censure wrongdoers. It seems that the polity could communicate messages of censure to offenders without imposing intended burdens; for example, it could issue a public proclamation condemning the crime and blaming the offender. Why, then, is the hard treatment characteristic of punishment an appropriate vehicle for conveying such messages? One type of response, offered by Duff and others (see also Falls, 1987), holds that hard treatment is needed to convey adequately the polity’s condemnation of crimes. Nonpunitive censure—blaming without imposing intended hard treatment—would fail to communicate the seriousness of the wrongdoing.

Also, on Duff’s account, hard treatment can function to induce in offenders the sort of moral reflection that may lead to repentance, reform, and reconciliation (with their victims and the community more generally). Some have objected, however, that such an account implies too intrusive a role for the state. It is not a proper function of the state, critics charge, to seek to induce repentance and moral reform in offenders. Thus even some scholars who agree that punishment is justified as a form of censure nevertheless disagree about the role of the hard treatment element. For Andrew von Hirsch (1993), for instance, the intended burdens characteristic of punishment act as a sort of prudential supplement: punishment, as censure, serves to remind offenders (and community members) of the moral reasons to comply with the law. Punishment, as hard treatment, also provides a prudential threat as a sort of supplement for those of us for whom the moral message is not sufficient. One worry with such an account, however, is whether the prudential threat will tend to drown out the moral message.

d. Other Versions

Alternative versions of retributivism have been offered. Some scholars, for instance, argue that those who commit crimes violate the trust of their fellow community members. Trust, on this account, is an essential feature of a healthy community. Offenders undermine this trust when they victimize others. In such cases, punishment is a deserved response to such violations and an appropriate way to help maintain (or restore) the conditions of trust among community members (see Dimock, 1997). Advocates of this trust-based variety of retributivism must explain which violations of trust rise to the level that warrants criminalization, so that violators should be subject to punishment. Also, we might question whether such accounts are purely retributivist after all: if punishment is justified at least in part as a means of helping to maintain conditions of trust in a community, then this appears to be a consequentialist rationale. On the other hand, if punishment is justified not for what it helps to bring about but rather as an intrinsically appropriate (because deserved) response to violations of trust, then we need an explanation of why such violations deserve punishment, perhaps as opposed to some other form of response.

Another form of retributivism holds that offenders incur a moral debt to their victims, and so they deserve punishment as a way to repay this debt (McDermott, 2001). This moral debt is distinct from the material debt that an offender may incur. In other words, a person who robs from another person incurs a material debt equal to the value of whatever was stolen, but she also incurs a moral debt for violating the victim’s rights. The offender takes not only a material good from the victim but also a moral good. Repayment of material goods does not settle this moral debt, and so punishment is needed to fill this role. As Daniel McDermott characterizes it, punishment serves to deny the ill-gotten moral good to the perpetrator  (McDermott, 2001: 424).

Such an account raises a host of questions: what precisely is the nature of the moral good that has been taken from the victim? How can a moral good be taken away from someone? In what sense (if at all) has the perpetrator gained this good? How does punishment deny this good to the offender, and how does this thereby make things right for the victim?

e. Sentencing

Because retributivism claims that punishment is justified as a deserved response to wrongdoing, retributivist accounts should provide some guidance about what sentences are deserved in particular cases. Typically, retributivists hold that sentences should be no more severe than is deserved. This negative retributivist constraint on sentencing corresponds with the negative retributivist constraint on punishment itself (namely, that punishment is justified only of those who deserve it). By contrast, positive retributivism holds that offenders’ sentences should be no less severe than they deserve. Some scholars find this positive retributivism unappealing because it seems to preclude the state from taking into account mercy or other considerations that might count in favor of lenient sentences. In other words, some are more comfortable with retributivism’s setting a ceiling but not a floor on sentence severity. One question, though, is whether (and if so, why) retributivists are justified in endorsing the negative retributivist constraint on sentencing without also endorsing the positive retributivist constraint.

Retributivists often discuss sentencing in terms of proportionality, where a proportionate sentence is understood as one that is deserved (or at least, on some accounts, not clearly undeserved). Sentences may be proportionate in two senses: first, they may be proportionate (or disproportionate) relative to each other. This sense of proportionality, called ordinal proportionality, holds that similarly serious offenses should receive similarly severe punishments (like cases should be treated alike); that more serious offenses should be punished more harshly than less serious offenses (murder should be punished more harshly than shoplifting, for instance); and that differences in sentence severity should reflect differences in relative seriousness of offenses (because murder is much more serious than shoplifting, murder should carry a much more severe sentence).

Some scholars have challenged the notion of ordinal proportionality constraints in sentencing, both because offenders cannot neatly be distinguished into a manageable number of desert-based groups—Michael Tonry calls this the “illusion of ‘like-situated offenders’” (Tonry, 2011)—and because individual offenders’ subjective experiences of the same sentence may vary greatly. For example, someone who is young, physically imposing, or has no children may have a much different experience of a 10-year prison term from someone who is much older, physically frail, or must leave behind her children to serve the sentence. Considerations such as these do not in themselves demonstrate that the tenets of ordinal proportionality are false (that like cases should not be treated alike, for instance, or that more serious violations should not receive harsher sentences). Rather, these considerations raise challenges to our ability in practice to implement a just sentencing scheme that reflects ordinal proportionality.

Even if sentences can be devised that satisfy ordinal proportionality, however—in other words, even if a sentencing scheme itself is internally proportionate—particular sentences may fail to be proportionate if the entire sentencing scheme is too severe (or lenient). For instance, a sentencing scheme in which even the least offenses were punished with prison terms would appear disproportionate even if sentences in the scheme were proportionate relative to each other. Thus theorists note a second sense of proportionality: cardinal, or nonrelative, proportionality. Cardinal proportionality considers whether sentences are commensurate with the crimes they punish. A prison term for jaywalking would appear to violate cardinal proportionality, because such a sentence strikes us as too severe given the offense, even if this sentence were proportionate with other sentences in a sentencing scheme—that is, even if it satisfied ordinal proportionality. Thus cardinal proportionality concerns not the relation of sentences to one another, but instead the relation of a sentence to the crime to which it is a response. Put another way, even if an entire sentencing scheme is internally (ordinally) proportionate, we need guidance in how to anchor the sentencing scheme to the crimes themselves so that offenders in particular cases receive the sentences they deserve.

In addition to addressing questions of deserved sentence severity, we would like retributivism to provide some guidance about how to determine what mode, or form, of punishment is appropriate in response to a given crime. Is prison time, community service, capital punishment, probation, or something else the deserved form of response, and why?

The implications of retributivism for sentencing will depend on the specific account’s explanation of why punishment is said to be the deserved response to offending.

Those who appeal to intuitions that the guilty deserve to suffer, for instance, can similarly appeal to intuitions that those who are guilty of more serious offenses deserve to suffer more than those who are guilty of less serious offenses. As discussed, however, we would like to know how much punishment is deserved in particular cases in nonrelative terms, and also what form the suffering should take. One well-known account of sentencing is provided by lex talionis (that is, an eye for an eye, a tooth for a tooth). Immanuel Kant famously endorsed this principle: “Accordingly, whatever undeserved evil you inflict upon another within the people, that you inflict upon yourself” (Kant, 1797: 473). As critics have noted, though, not every crime appears to have an obvious like-for-like response—what would lex talionis demand for the childless kidnapper, for instance (Shafer-Landau, 2000: 193)? And even when a like-for-like response is clearly indicated, it will not always be palatable (torturing the torturer, for example).

We might assert instead that the sentence and the offense need not be alike in kind, but that the sentence should impose an amount of suffering equal to the harm done by the offender. Still, questions arise of how to make interpersonal comparisons of suffering. And again, for the most heinous crimes, a principle of inflicting equal amounts of suffering may recommend sentences that we would find troubling.

The fair play view holds that punishment functions to remove an unfair advantage gained by an offender relative to members of society generally. Critics of this view often object, however, that it provides insufficient or counterintuitive guidance about sentencing. Put simply, there does not seem to be any advantage that an offender gains, in proportion with the seriousness of her crime, relative to community members generally. On one version of the view, the offender gains freedom from the burden of self-constraint that others accept in complying with the particular law that the offender violates. If so, then the sentence severity should be proportionate to the burden others feel in complying with that law. But compliance with laws is often not a burden for most citizens. Indeed, it is often less burdensome to comply with prohibitions on serious offenses (murder, assault, and so forth) than it is to comply with prohibitions on lesser crimes (tax evasion, jaywalking, and so forth), given that we are more often tempted to commit the lesser crimes. But if the unfair advantage that punishment aims to remove is freedom from the burden of self-constraint, and if self-constraint is often more burdensome with lesser crimes, then these less serious crimes will often appear to merit relatively more severe punishments. This is a violation of ordinal proportionality.

Similar problems arise for other versions of the fair play view. Suppose, for instance, that the unfair advantage a criminal gains is not freedom from the burden of complying with the particular law she violates, but rather freedom from complying with the rule of law in general. This general compliance, Richard Dagger writes, is a genuine burden: “there are times for almost all of us when we would like to have the best of both worlds—that is, the freedom we enjoy under the rule of law plus freedom from the burden of obeying laws” (Dagger, 1993: 483). Critics have objected, however, that on this conception of the unfair advantage all offenses become, for the purposes of punishment, the same offense. Both the murderer’s and the tax cheat’s unfair advantage is freedom from compliance with the rule of law generally. If the unfair advantage is the same, however, then removing the advantage would seem to require equal sentences. Again, such sentencing appears to violate ordinal proportionality.

For the censure view, questions arise about what form of punishment and what severity will communicate the deserved message of condemnation in particular cases. On such a view, the principles of ordinal proportionality appear to follow straightforwardly: censure should reflect the seriousness of the wrongdoing, and so if punishment is the vehicle of communicating censure, then sentences should reflect the appropriate relative degree of censure for each case.

The censure view should provide guidance not only about how severely to punish crimes relative to each other, but also how severely to punish in absolute terms, and also the appropriate mode of punishment. To say that manslaughter should be censured more severely than theft, for instance, does not actually tell us how severely to censure manslaughter or theft, or with what form of punishment. Again, the challenge is in determining how to anchor the sentencing scale to actual offenses. Should the least serious offenses receive censure in the form of a small fine, a day in jail, or a year in jail? Should the most serious offenses receive capital punishment, life imprisonment, or some less severe sentence?

Similar questions arise for accounts that characterize punishment as a deserved response to violations of trust, or as a deserved response to the incurrence of a moral debt. What form and severity of punishment is appropriate to maintain conditions of community trust in response to attempted kidnapping, or the theft of a valuable piece of art? How severe must a sentence be to resolve the moral debt that is incurred when one impersonates a police officer, or cheats on her taxes?

Indeed, questions about fixing deserved sentences in response to particular offenses arise for retributivist accounts generally. Critics have charged that retributivism is unable to provide adequate, nonarbitrary guidance about either the deserved severity or deserved form of punishment in particular cases (see Shafer-Landau, 2000).

Retributivists are, of course, aware of such objections and have sought to meet them in various ways. Nonetheless, questions about proportionate sentencing continue to be a central challenge for retributivist accounts.

5. Alternative Accounts

In part as a response to objections commonly raised against consequentialist or retributivist views, a number of theorists have sought to develop alternative accounts of punishment.

a. Rights Forfeiture

At the outset, we said that the central question of punishment’s permissibility is why (if at all) it is permissible to treat those who have committed criminal offenses in ways that typically would be impermissible. For some theorists, this question is best cast in terms of rights: why are the sorts of intended burdens characteristic of punishment, which would constitute rights violations if imposed on those who have not been convicted of criminal wrongdoing, not violations of the rights of those punished?

One way in which punishment would not violate the rights of offenders is if, in committing the crime for which they are convicted, they forfeit the relevant right(s). Because offenders forfeit their right not to be punished, the state has no corresponding duty not to punish them. As W. D. Ross writes, “the offender, by violating the life or liberty or property of another, has lost his own right to have his life, liberty, or property respected, so that the state has no prima facie duty to spare him, as it has a prima facie duty to spare the innocent” (1930: 60-61).

Notice that the forfeiture view itself does not imply any particular positive justification of punishment; it merely purports to explain why punishing offenders does not violate their rights. This is consistent with maintaining that the positive justification of punishment is that it helps reduce crime, or conversely, that wrongdoers deserve to be punished. Thus the forfeiture view does not provide a complete account of the justification of punishment. Proponents, however, take this feature to be a virtue rather than a weakness of the view.

The forfeiture claim raises a number of key questions: first, why does someone who violates the law thereby forfeit the right not to be punished? For those who are gripped by the dilemma of why punishing offenders does not violate their rights, the mere answer that offenders forfeit their rights, without some deeper account of what this forfeiture amounts to, may seem inadequate. Thus some theorists attempt to ground their forfeiture claim in a more comprehensive moral or political theory (see, for instance, Morris, 1991).

Second, what is the nature of the rights forfeited? Do offenders forfeit the same rights they violate? If so, then this raises some of the same challenges as we saw with certain forms of retributivism: what right is forfeited by a childless kidnapper, for example? Alternatively, is the forfeited right simply the right not to be punished? If every offender forfeits this same, general right, then on what basis can we distinguish what sentence is permissible for different offenders? For example, if the burglar forfeits the same right as the murderer, then what prevents us from imposing the same punishment in each case (could two offenders forfeit the same right to different degrees, as some have suggested)?

Third, how should we determine the duration of the forfeiture? Fourth, if an offender forfeits her right against punishment, then why does the state maintain an exclusive right to punish? Why are other individuals not permitted to punish?

b. Consent

Rights forfeiture theorists argue that punishment does not violate offenders’ rights because offenders forfeit the relevant rights. Another way that punishment might be said not to violate offenders’ rights is if offenders waive their rights. This is the central claim of the consent view. Defended most notably by C. S. Nino (1983), the consent view holds that when a person voluntarily commits a crime while knowing the consequences of doing so, she effectively consents to these consequences. In doing so, she waives her right not to be subject to punishment. This is not to say that she explicitly consents to being punished, but rather that by her voluntary action she tacitly consents to be subject to what she knows are the consequences.

Like the forfeiture view, the consent view does not supply a positive justification for punishment. To say that a person consents to some treatment does not by itself provide us with a reason to treat her that way. So the consent view, like the forfeiture view, is compatible with consequentialist aims or with the claim that punishment is a deserved response to offending.

One challenge for the consent view is that it does not seem to justify punishment of offenders who do not know that their acts are subject to punishment. For someone to have consented to be subject to certain consequences of an act, she must know of these consequences. What’s more, even if an offender knows she is committing a punishable act, she might not know the extent of the punishment to which she is subject. If so, then it is not clear how she can be said to consent to her punishment. It is not clear, for example, that a robber who knows that robbery is a punishable offense but does not realize the severity of the punishment to which she will be subject thereby consents to her sentence.

By contrast, other critics have charged that the consent view cannot rule out sentences that most of us would find excessive. This is because a person who voluntarily commits an action with knowledge of the legal consequences, whatever these consequences happen to be, has consented to be subject to the consequences. As Larry Alexander has put it: “If the law imposes capital punishment for overparking, then one who voluntarily overparks ‘consents’ to be executed” (Alexander, 1986).

Another difficulty for the consent view is that tacit consent typically can be overridden by explicit denials of consent. Thus it would seem to follow that one who tacitly consents to be subject to punishment could override this tacit consent by explicitly denying that she consents. But of course, we do not think that an offender should be able to avoid punishment by explicitly refusing to consent to it (Boonin, 2008).

c. Self-Defense

Another proposed justification of punishment conceives of punishment as a form of societal self-defense. First consider self-defense in the interpersonal context: When an assailant attacks me, he culpably creates a situation in which harm will occur: either harm to me if I do not effectively defend myself or harm to him if I do. In such a circumstance, I am justified in acting so that the harm falls on my attacker rather than on me. Similarly, when an offender creates a situation in which either she or her victim will be harmed, the state is permitted to use force to ensure that the harm falls on the perpetrator rather than on the victim (Montague, 1995).

So far, this view appears to justify state intervention only to stop ongoing crimes or ward off impending crimes. How does this view justify punishment as a response to past crimes? Advocates of the view claim that the state is not only justified in intervening to stop actual offenses; it is also permitted to threaten the use of force to deter such crimes. For the threat to be credible and thus effective as a deterrent, however, the state will need to follow through on the threat in cases in which offenders are not deterred. Thus punishment of offenders is permissible.

Notice that although the self-defense account views punishment as a deterrent threat, it is not a pure consequentialist account. Crucial to punishment’s permissibility on the self-defense view is the claim that an offender has culpably created the circumstance in which harm will fall either on the perpetrator or the victim. This backward-looking element is missing from pure consequentialist accounts that cite punishment’s deterrent effects in defending the practice.

Critics object that the analogy between self-defense and punishment breaks down in a number of respects. First, many self-defense theorists argue that the logic of defensive force permits the use of such force even against “innocent” threats. But we do not typically believe that, by analogy, punishment of innocent people is permitted, even if such punishment helped to maintain the credibility of a deterrent threat. Second, the degree of force that is permitted to stop an actual attack may far exceed what we intuitively believe would be permitted as punishment of an offense that has already been committed.

Third, it is one thing to follow through on a threat in order to deter the person who has just offended from offending again. It is another thing—and one might argue, more difficult to justify—to punish one person in order to maintain a credible deterrent threat against the public generally. If we believe the primary deterrent effect of punishment is as a general deterrent (rather than as a specific deterrent), then the analogy with typical accounts of self-defense seems strained. It would be as if, to deter the oncoming assailant from following through with his attack, I grab someone nearby (who has previously attacked me) and inflict the same degree of harm that I would aim to inflict on the assailant to defend myself. This might, of course, be permissible if my previous attacker had thereby acquired a duty to protect me from future harm by allowing himself to be punished as a means of maintaining a credible deterrent threat (Tadros, 2011).

d. Moral Education

The moral education view shares certain features of consequentialist accounts as well as retributivist accounts. On this view, punishment is justified as a means of teaching a moral lesson to those who commit crimes (and perhaps to community members more generally, as well).

Like standard consequentialist accounts, the education view acknowledges that part of the story of punishment’s justification involves its importance in reducing crime. But the education theorist also takes seriously the worry expressed by many retributivists that aiming to shape people’s behavior merely by issuing threats is, in G. W. F. Hegel’s words, “much the same as when one raises a cane against a dog; a man is not treated in accordance with his dignity and honour, but as a dog” (Hegel, 1821: 36). By contrast, a central feature of the moral education view is that those who commit crimes are moral agents, capable of reflecting on and responding to moral reasons. Thus moral education theorists view punishment not as a means of conditioning people to behave in certain ways, but rather of “teaching the wrongdoer that the action she did (or wants to do) is forbidden because it is morally wrong and should not be done for that reason” (Hampton, 1984).

Another way to express this difference between the education view and standard consequentialist views is that consequentialist views focus entirely on whether punishment promotes some goal. The education view, however, holds that only certain means are appropriate for pursuing this goal: namely, punishment aims to engage with the offender as a moral agent, to teach her that (and why) her behavior was morally wrong, so that she will reform herself. Thus we can even distinguish the education view from consequentialist accounts that aim at crime reduction through offender reform. For such consequentialist accounts, punishment’s justification is solely a matter of whether, on balance, it promotes these ends. The education view sets offender reform as an end, but it also grounds certain constraints on how we may appropriately pursue this end.

The education view, like the retributive censure view discussed earlier, views punishment as a communicative enterprise. Punishment communicates to offenders (indeed, to the community more generally) that what they have done is wrong. Thus on both accounts, punishment aims to encourage offenders to reform themselves. But whereas the retributive censure theorists view the message conveyed by punishment as justified insofar as it is deserved, education theorists contend that punishment is justified in virtue of what it aims to accomplish. In this respect, the education view sits more comfortably with standard consequentialist accounts than with retributivist views.

The education view conceives of punishment as aiming to confer a benefit on the offender, the benefit of moral education. This is not to say that punishment is not burdensome; as we have seen, its burdensomeness is an essential feature of punishment. But the burdens of punishment are intended to be ultimately beneficial. Thus education theorists roundly reject accounts according to which it is permissible (or even required) to inflict harm on those guilty of wrongdoing. Instead, education theorists hold, following Plato, that we should never do harm to anyone, even those who have wronged us.

Critics have raised various objections to the moral education view. Some are skeptical about whether punishment is the most effective means of moral education. Others point out that many (perhaps most) offenders are not apparently in need of moral education: many offenders realize they are doing something wrong but do so anyway. Even those who do not realize this as they are acting may recognize it soon afterward. Thus they do not seem to need moral education. Finally, some object that the education view is inappropriately paternalistic. According to the education view, after all, the state is justified in coercively restricting offenders’ liberties as a means to conferring a benefit (moral education) on them. Many liberal theorists are uncomfortable, however, with the idea that the state may coerce a person for her own benefit.

e. Hybrid Approaches

Finally, some theorists have responded to seemingly intractable disputes between consequentialists and retributivists by contending that the question of punishment’s permissibility is not actually a single question at all. Instead, establishing punishment’s permissibility involves answering a number of questions: questions about the aim of the practice, about its limits, and so on. Once we distinguish different questions that bear on punishment’s permissibility, we can then recognize that these questions may be answered by appeal to different moral considerations. What emerges is a hybrid account of punishment’s permissibility.

The most famous articulation of a hybrid view comes from H. L. A. Hart (1968), although there have been numerous attempts to develop such accounts both before and after Hart. The specifics of these accounts vary somewhat, but in general the point has been to distinguish the question of punishment’s aim (Hart called this the “general justifying aim”) from the question of how we must constrain our pursuit of that aim. The first question, about punishment’s aim, is usually answered according to consequentialist considerations, whereas the second question, about appropriate constraints, is typically answered by appeal to retributivist principles. In other words, if we are asking what reason could justify society in maintaining a system of punishment, the answer will appeal to punishment’s role in reducing crime, and thereby protecting the safety and security of community members. But if we ask how we may punish in particular cases, the answer will appeal to retributivist principles about proportionality and desert. Some have distinguished these questions in terms of the proper (consequentialist) rationale of legislators in criminalizing certain types of behaviors and the proper (retributivist) rationale of judges in imposing sentences on those who violate the criminal laws.

Although such views are sometimes described as “two-question” or “two-level” views, with the focus on consequentialist aims and retributivist constraints, there is no reason in principle why we should distinguish only two questions. As we saw earlier, punishment actually raises a host of specific normative questions, and so if we accept the general strategy of distinguishing questions and answering them by appeal to different considerations, then there is no reason in principle to stop with only a two-level hybrid theory. A hybrid view might offer distinct considerations in answer to a variety of questions: what is the positive aim of punishment? Does punishment violate offenders’ rights? How severely may we punish in particular cases? What mode of punishment is permissible in particular cases? And so on.

Also, although hybrid theories typically follow the pattern of aims and constraints, so that consequentialism provides the reason to have an institution of punishment and retributivism provides constraints on how we punish, there is no reason in principle why this could not be reversed. A hybrid theory might hold that suffering is an intrinsically appropriate (deserved) response to wrongdoing, but then endorse as a constraint, for example, that such retributive punishment should never tend to undermine offender reform.

Critics have charged hybrid accounts with being ad hoc and unstable. Although we can distinguish different questions related to punishment’s permissibility, it is a mistake to think that the answers to these questions are entirely independent of each other, so that we can answer each by appeal to entirely distinct considerations. For example, if we accept the consequentialist view that punishment’s general justifying aim is that it helps to deter crime, then why would considerations of deterrence not also play a role (even a decisive role) in how severely we punish in particular cases? Why should retributivist proportionality considerations govern in sentencing if these conflict with the pursuit of crime reduction through deterrence?

Retributivists, for their part, often argue that hybrid theories such as Hart’s, on which consequentialism supplies the justifying aim of punishment, relegate retributivism to a peripheral role. Retributivists, after all, tend to regard consequentialism as providing inappropriate reasons to punish. Characterizing retributivism’s role as providing constraints on the pursuit of consequentialist aims is thus unsatisfying to many retributivists.

6. Abolitionism

Some scholars are unpersuaded by any of the standardly articulated justifications of punishment. In fact, they conclude that punishment is morally unjustified, and thus that the practice should be abolished. An obvious question for abolitionists, of course, is what (if anything) should take the place of punishment. That is, how should society respond to those who behave in ways (committing tax fraud, burglary, assault, and so on) that currently are subject to punishment?

One option would be to endorse a model of treatment rather than punishment. On this model, an offender is viewed as manifesting some form of disease or pathology, and the appropriate response is thus to try to treat and cure the person rather than to punish her. Treatment differs from punishment, first, because it need not be burdensome. At least in principle, treatment could be pleasant. In practice, of course, treatment may often be burdensome—indeed, it may involve many of the same sorts of restrictions and burdens as we find with punishment. But even though courses of treatment may be burdensome, treatment does not typically convey the condemnation that is characteristic of punishment. After all, we generally think of those who are sick as warranting sympathy or concern, not condemnation.

Other options for abolitionists would be to endorse some model of restitutive or restorative, rather than criminal, justice. We might require that offenders make restitution to their victims, as defendants in civil lawsuits are often required to make restitution to plaintiffs (Boonin, 2008: 213-75). Or offenders might engage with victims in a process of restorative justice, one in which both offenders and victims play an active role, with aims of repairing the harms done and restoring the relationships that have been damaged (Braithwaite, 1999). Neither the restitutive nor the restorative models are centrally concerned with imposing intended, censuring burdens on offenders.

Not surprisingly, these alternative accounts are themselves subject to various objections. Critics of the treatment model, for instance, charge that it provides insufficient limits on what sort of treatment of offenders is permissible. The aim of “curing” diseased individuals might warrant quite severe treatment, both in scope and duration. Similarly, scholars have argued that the treatment model fails properly to respect offenders, as it treats them merely as patients rather than as moral agents who are responsible, and should be held responsible, for their actions (Morris, 1968).

Critics of the restitutive and restorative models may point out that some crimes do not clearly lend themselves to restitution or restoration: some crimes may seem so heinous that no victim restitution or restoration of relationships is possible. Other crimes do not have clearly specifiable victims. In addition, consequentialists may worry that practices of restitution or restoration may be inadequate as means of crime reduction if, for example, they are less effective than punishment at deterring potential offenders. Retributivists also may argue that something important is lost when we respond to wrongdoing solely with restitutive or restorative practices. Particularly for those who hold that an important function of punishment is to convey societal censure, restitution or restoration may seem inadequate as responses to crime insofar as they are not essentially concerned with censuring offenders. Alternatively, some retributivists argue that the restorative ideals can best be served by a system of retributive punishment (Duff, 2001; Bennett, 2008).

7. References and Further Reading

  • Alexander, Larry (1986). “Consent, Punishment, and Proportionality.” Philosophy & Public Affairs 15:2, 178-82.
  • Bennett, Christopher (2008). The Apology Ritual: A Philosophical Theory of Punishment. Cambridge, Cambridge University Press.
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Author Information

Zachary Hoskins
Email: zachary.hoskins@nottingham.ac.uk
University of Nottingham
United Kingdom

Intentionality

If I think about a piano, something in my thought picks out a piano. If I talk about cigars, something in my speech refers to cigars. This feature of thoughts and words, whereby they pick out, refer to, or are about things, is intentionality. In a word, intentionality is aboutness.

Many mental states exhibit intentionality. If I believe that the weather is rainy today, this belief of mine is about today’s weather—that it is rainy. Desires are similarly directed at, or about things: if I desire a mosquito to buzz off, my desire is directed at the mosquito, and the possibility that it depart. Imaginings seem to be directed at particular imaginary scenarios, while regrets are directed at events or objects in the past, as are memories. And perceptions seem to be, similarly, directed at or about the objects we perceptually encounter in our environment. We call mental states that are directed at things in this way ‘intentional states’.

The major role played by intentionality in affairs of the mind led Brentano (1884) to regard intentionality as “the mark of the mental”; a necessary and sufficient condition for mentality. But some non-mental phenomena seem to display intentionality too—pictures, signposts, and words, for example. Nevertheless, the intentionality of these phenomena seems to be derived from the intentionality of the mind that produces them. A sound is only a word if it has been conferred with meaning by the intentions of a speaker or perhaps a community of speakers; while a painting, however abstract, seems only to have a subject matter insofar as its painter intends it to. Whether or not all mental phenomena are intentional, then, it certainly seems to be the case that all intentional phenomena are mental in origin.

The root of the word ‘intentionality’ reflects the notion that it expresses, deriving from the Latin intentio, meaning ‘directed at’. Intentionality has been studied since antiquity and has generated numerous debates that can be broadly categorized into three areas that are discussed in the following sections:

Section 1 concerns the intentional relation: the relation between intentional states and their objects. Here we aim to answer the question “What determines why any given intentional state is about one thing and not another?” For example, what makes a thought about a sheep about that sheep? Does the thought look like the sheep? Or does it perhaps have a causal origin in an encounter with the sheep?

Section 2 explores the nature of the objects of intentional states. Are these objects independent of us, or somehow constituted by the nature of our minds? Do they have to exist, or can we have thoughts about non-existent objects like The Grinch?

Section 3 explores the nature of intentional states themselves. For example, are intentional states essentially rational states, such that only rational creatures can have them? Or might intentional states be necessarily conscious states? And is it possible to give a naturalized theory of intentionality that appeals only to facts describable in the natural sciences?

This article explores these questions, and the dominant theories that have been designed to answer them.

Table of Contents

  1. The Intentional Relation
    1. Formal Theories of Intentionality
    2. Problems for Forms, and the Causal Alternative
  2. Intentional Objects
    1. Intentional Inexistence
    2. Thinking About Things that Do Not Exist
    3. Direct versus Indirect Intentionality
  3. Intentional States
    1. Intentionality and Reason
    2. Intentionality and Intensionality
    3. Intentionality and Consciousness
    4. Naturalizing Intentionality
  4. References and Further Reading

1. The Intentional Relation

If I am thinking about horses, what is it about my thought that makes it about horses and not, say, sheep? That is, in what relation do intentional states stand to their objects? This is the question “What is the intentional relation?” There have been many answers proposed to this question, and a broad division can be discerned in the history of philosophy between what can be called ‘formal’ and ‘causal’ theories.

a. Formal Theories of Intentionality

One answer to the question is that mental states refer to the things they do because of the intrinsic features of those mental states. The earliest version of this theory is based on Plato’s theory of forms. Plato held that apart from the matter (hyle) they are composed of, all things have another aspect, which he called their ‘form’ (morphê). All horses, for example, although individually made of different material, have something in common – and this is their form. The exact meaning of Plato’s ‘form’ is a controversial issue. On one reading, two things have the same form or are ‘conformal’ if they share the same shape; on a broader interpretation, two things are conformal if there is a one-to-one mapping between the essential features of the two—as there is between a building and an architect’s blueprint for the building. Plato held that when we think about an object, we have the form of the object in our mind, so that our thought literally shares the form of the object. Aristotle further developed this theory, arguing that in perception (sensu) the form of an object perceived is transmitted from the object to the mind of the perceiver. In the Middle Ages Thomas Aquinas defended and elaborated Aristotle’s theory, and in the Early Modern period the theory finds an heir in the work of the ‘British Empiricists’ Locke and Hume. Locke and Hume argued that ‘ideas’, which they considered to be the fundamental components of thought, refer to their objects because they are images of those objects, impressed on the mind through the action of the perceptual faculties.

Although images or shapes may play a role in thought, it is generally accepted that they cannot provide a complete account of intentionality. The relation between an image and its object is a relation of resemblance. But this presents a difficulty that was first raised against the formal theory by Ockham in the Middle Ages (King, 2007). The problem is that the relation of resemblance is ambiguous in a way that the intentional relation cannot be. An image of a man walking up a hill also resembles a man walking backwards down a hill (Wittgenstein, 1953), whereas a thought about a man walking up a hill is not also a thought about a man walking backwards down a hill. Similarly, while an image of Mahatma Gandhi resembles Mahatma Gandhi, it also resembles everyone who resembles Mahatma Gandhi (Goodman, 1976). Thoughts about Mahatma Gandhi on the other hand, are not thoughts about anyone who looks like Mahatma Gandhi.

An alternative formal model that seems to avoid this problem appeals to descriptions (Frege 1892, Russell 1912). This view holds that if I am thinking about something, then I must have in mind a description that uniquely identifies that thing. Descriptions seem to avoid the problem of ambiguity faced by images. There may be many people who resemble Mahatma Gandhi, but probably only one person that satisfies the description ‘the Indian Nationalist leader assassinated on the 30th of January 1948’. Since the ‘descriptivist’ account takes concepts to refer to their objects by describing them, so that the features of a concept somehow correspond to the features of its object, the descriptivist theory is arguably also a formal theory of intentionality.

In addition to answering the question why an intentional state refers to one object and not another, the formal approach is also helpful in explaining how thinkers understand what it is they are thinking about. One thing that we seem to be able to do when we have mental states that are directed at particular things objects is to reflect upon different aspects of those objects, reason about them, describe them, and even make reliable predictions about them. For example, if I understand what horses are, and what sheep are, I ought to be in a position to tell you about their differences, and perhaps make good predictions about their behavior. If intentional states are conformal with their objects, we have some explanation for how such understanding is possible, since the form of the object the intentional state is directed at should be available to me if I reflect upon my own thoughts.

And we have another reason still for expecting that thoughts have a formal component. Frege (1892) observed that we can have multiple thoughts about the same thing, without realizing that we are thinking of the same thing in each case. The Ancient Greeks believed that Hesperus and Phosphorus (two Greek names for Venus) were two different stars in the sky, one of which appeared in the morning, while the other appeared in the evening. As a result they believed that Hesperus rises in the evening while simultaneously believing that Phosphorus does not. Of course Hesperus and Phosphorus, as it turns out, are the same object – the planet Venus, which rises both in the morning and in the evening. And so the Ancient Greeks had two contradictory beliefs about Venus, without realizing that both beliefs were about the same thing. The upshot is that it is possible for us to have distinct concepts that pick out the same thing without our knowing.

Frege proposed as an explanation that our concepts must vary in more ways than in what they refer to. They also vary, he proposed, in what he called their ‘sense’, so that two concepts could refer to the same object while differing in sense. He described the sense as the ‘mode of presentation’ of the object that a concept picks out. It would appear that by ‘mode of presentation’ he meant something like a description of the object. So, while the reference of someone’s hesperus and phosphorus concepts might be the same, the sense of hesperus might be ‘the star that appears in the evening’, while the sense of phosphorus could be ‘the star that appears in the morning’. Since it is perfectly rational to suppose that the object that satisfies the description ‘the star that appears in the morning’ might not be the same as the object that satisfies the description ‘the star that appears in the evening’, we now have an explanation for how one could have two concepts that pick out the same thing without knowing.

Supposing that the intentional relation is one of conformality, then, allows us to explain i) why a thought refers to what it does, (ii) how we can have introspective knowledge of the things we think about, and (iii) how two or more of our concepts could pick out the same thing without our knowing. But there are problems facing the formal approach, which have lead many to look for alternatives.

b. Problems for Forms, and the Causal Alternative

The formal theory of intentionality faces two major objections.

The first objection, sometimes called ‘the problem of ignorance and error’, is that the descriptions we have at our disposal of the objects we think about might be insufficient to uniquely identify those objects. Putnam (1975) articulated this objection using a now famous thought-experiment. Suppose that you are thinking of water. If the descriptive theory is right, for example, you must have at your disposal a description that uniquely distinguishes water from all other things. For most of us – chemists aside – such a description will amount to something like ‘the clear drinkable liquid in the rivers, lakes, and taps around here’. But suppose, suggests Putnam, that there is another planet far away from here, which looks to its inhabitants just like Earth looks to us. On that planet, let’s call it Twin-Earth, there is a clear drinkable liquid that the inhabitants of the planet refer to (coincidentally) as ‘water’, but that is in fact a different chemical substance; rather than H2O, it has a different chemical composition—let’s call it XYZ. If this were true, we should expect that the description most people here on Earth are in a position to give of what we call ‘water’ will be just the same as the description the inhabitants of the other planet give of what they call ‘water’. But, by hypothesis, when we think about water we are thinking of the substance on our planet, H2O, and when they think of what they call ‘water’, they are thinking of a different thing—XYZ. As a result, it would seem that descriptions are not sufficient to explain what we are thinking of, since a member of either of these groups will give the same description for what they call ‘water’, even though their thoughts pick out different substances. This is the ‘ignorance’ part of the problem—we often don’t have enough descriptive knowledge of the things we think about to uniquely identify those things. The ‘error’ part is that it often turns out to be the case that our beliefs about the things we think about are false. For example, many people believe tomatoes are vegetables not fruit; and as a result, the description they will give of ‘tomato’ will include the claim that tomatoes are vegetables. If these people are indeed thinking of tomatoes, so the argument goes, it cannot be as a result of their being in possession of a description that picks out tomatoes, since no tomato truly falls under the description ‘fruit’.

The second difficulty for the formal accounts, specifically directed at the descriptive account, is that descriptions do not identify the essential nature of the things they pick out, whereas many words and concepts do (Searle 1958, Kripke 1980). The description someone might offer of Hesperus could be ‘the brightest celestial object in the evening sky’. But it is perfectly coherent to suppose that Hesperus could have existed without having been visible in the evening. It could have drifted into a different orbital pattern, or have been occluded by a belt of asteroids, and therefore never have been visible in the evening. This description does not, therefore, capture an essential feature of Hesperus. The term ‘Hesperus’ in our thoughts, on the other hand, does pick out an essential feature of Hesperus—being Hesperus. That this is an important difference can be seen when we realize that concepts and descriptions seem to behave differently in thoughts about counterfactual possibilities—or, alternative ways the world could have turned out. For example, the thought ‘Hesperus could have failed to have been the brightest celestial object in the evening sky’, is clearly true—this could have been the case had it drifted into a different orbital pattern. But the thought ‘Hesperus could have failed to have been Hesperus’, is not true: there is no way the world could have turned out such that Hesperus could have failed to have been itself. The name ‘Hesperus’ therefore identifies the essence of Hesperus—what it couldn’t fail to be; but the description does not. So now we have a further reason for thinking that concepts are not cognitively equivalent to descriptions—since they behave differently in thoughts about counterfactual possibility.

As an alternative to descriptions, images, or forms of any sort, Putnam (1975) and Kripke (1980) propose a ‘causal’ model of intentionality. On this alternative model, our concepts do not have intrinsic formal features that determine what they refer to. Rather, a concept picks out the thing that originally caused it to occur in the mind of a thinker, or the thing it is causally related to in the mind-independent world. On this view, if I have a concept that picks out horses, this concept must have initially been caused to occur in me by a physical encounter with horses. If I have a concept that picks out water, the concept must have been caused to occur in me by a causal interaction with water. And if I have a concept that picks out Hesperus, this concept must have a causal origin in my apprehension of Hesperus, perhaps by seeing it in the sky.

We can see how the causal theory can be used to address the two major objections to the formal theory. Firstly, on the causal account, the ‘water’ thoughts of those on Earth can be distinguished from the ‘water’ thoughts of those on Twin-Earth: the substance Earthlings are causally interacting with when they have ‘water’ thoughts is H2O, while the substance that Twin-Earthlings are causally interacting with is XYZ—explaining why the thoughts of each thinker refer to different things, even though the descriptions they might offer of those things are identical. Similarly, I can causally interact with water, or tomatoes, even if I have false beliefs about these things, so the causal model allows that the descriptions I might offer of the things I think about can be false. The causal model therefore seems to handle the problem of ignorance and error. Secondly, if we reject that my hesperus concept is cognitively equivalent to a description, the worry that the description fails to identify the essence of the object simply doesn’t arise. The causal model therefore also seems to handle the problem concerning reference to essential properties (sometimes called the ‘modal problem’).

However, the causal model has trouble explaining some of the things the formal model was designed to explain (see last paragraph of Section 1a above). Firstly, the causal model has trouble explaining (ii), how we can reflect on the objects of our thoughts, and say something about them. If concepts have no formal component that somehow describes their objects this becomes mysterious. The causal model also fails to explain (iii), how we can have multiple thoughts about the same thing without realizing. While formal models can explain this by holding that different concepts can be cognitively equivalent to different descriptions of the same thing, the causal model has trouble explaining this. Since the thoughts of an Ancient Greek about hesperus, and the thoughts of an Ancient Greek about phosphorus have a causal origin in the same object, namely Venus, the causal relation that stands between these concepts and their object is identical in each case; as a result, there ought to be no difference between the concepts on the causal model.

The formal and causal models therefore each provide good explanations for one set of phenomena, but run into trouble in explaining another.

Perhaps the best account of the intentional relation will be one that draws on aspects of both theories—something that so-called ‘two-dimensional’ accounts of intentionality aim to do (Chalmers 1996, 2006, Lewis 1997, Jackson 1998). On this approach, although it is necessary to know what environment a thinker is causally connected to in order to know what her thoughts refer to, this need not rule out that her concepts also have a formal component. The trick is to find a formal component that does not run into the problems raised by the causal theorist. To deal with the problem of error, for example, it has been proposed that the formal component of a concept might be a description of the appearance of the object the concept refers to (Searle 1983). Although I can be wrong that the things my tomato concept picks out are vegetables, it would seem that I cannot be mistaken that they are apparently red shiny edible objects—since I cannot be wrong about how the world appears to me. Such content would therefore avoid the problem of error—these descriptions couldn’t turn out to be false. To deal with the problem of ignorance, where my descriptive knowledge fails to uniquely determine which thing I am thinking of, it has been proposed to write the causal origin of my experience into the formal component. So, my concept water might be cognitively equivalent not just to ‘the apparently clear drinkable liquid in the lakes and rivers’, which fails to distinguish the water on Earth from the water on Twin-Earth, but to ‘the stuff causing my current experiences of an apparently drinkable liquid in the lakes and rivers’ (Searle 1983). This description, it would seem, does indeed distinguish water from Twin-Earth water, since only water is the causal source of my experiences (because I am on Earth, not Twin-Earth). And to get descriptions to behave the same way as concepts in thoughts about counterfactual possibility, it has been proposed to include the specification ‘actual’ in the descriptive content of a concept (Davies and Humberstone 1980). Although it is true that ‘the brightest celestial object in the evening sky could have failed to have been Hesperus’, it seems not to be true that ‘the actual thing that is the brightest celestial object in the evening sky could have failed to have been Hesperus’. By including ‘actual’ in the description, we can therefore get the description to behave in the same way as the concept in counterfactual thoughts. In sum, the descriptive content of a concept like water would be something like ‘the actual stuff causing my experience of an apparently clearly drinkable liquid in the lakes and rivers’. Such content, it is hoped, can account for the phenomena formal models explain without running into the difficulties faced by earlier formal accounts. Whether these modifications really succeed in handling the problems raised by the causal theorist is, however, a topic of ongoing controversy (see Soames 2001, 2005 and Recanati 2013 for recent defenses of the causal approach; see Chalmers 2006 for a defense of the two-dimensional approach, and an advanced overview of the debate).

2. Intentional Objects

Having seen some of the layout of the debate about what determines the object of any intentional state, we can now consider issues that arise when we consider the objects themselves. Do they all have something in common that makes them appropriate as objects of intentional states? Might there be non-existent intentional objects? Do our thoughts connect directly with these objects or only indirectly, via our senses?

a. Intentional Inexistence

Franz Brentano has been mentioned already in this article, in part because his work set the tone for much of the debate over intentionality in the 20th century. One of his claims was that the objects of intentional states have a special type of existence, which he called ‘intentional inexistence’. Whether he meant by that a special sort of existence ‘in’ the intentional, or that intentional objects do not exist, is debated. Supposing that intentionality is always directed at objects that do not exist, however, is particularly problematic, and we’ll look at the difficulties it raises in the next section. So first I’ll explore the possibility that Brentano supposed that intentional objects have a special sort of existence as objects of intentional states.

This idea had a particularly strong influence on the work of Edmund Husserl, who founded a branch of philosophy of mind known as phenomenology, which he conceived of as the study of experience. Husserl emphasizes that the objects of thought have a particular character insofar as they are objects of thought. First, they have to be related to other concepts and ideas in the mind of the thinker in a coherent way, a feature he refers to as their ‘noematic’ character. If our ideas of the objects we encounter in experience conflict too severely with the constraints that our understanding of how the world works, those ideas will disintegrate (something he calls ‘noematic explosion’). Visual illusions present a good example of this. If we are presented with an object that appears to be a cube sitting on a flat surface, we will approach the object with certain expectations, for example that if we turn our heads to one side we will see the side of the cube now out of view, if we grab a hold of it our grasp will be resisted, and so on. If the object turns out to be an image painted in such a way that it only appears as a cube from a certain angle, when we discover this by trying to pick it up, for example, the idea we are working with of the object will disintegrate. It is in this sense that Husserl at least took the objects of thought to have a special sort of existence as objects of thought (Føllesdal 1992, Mooney 2010).

Husserl (1900) proposed that we can study the nature of the constraints that the character of our mind places on the possible objects of thought through a method he calls ‘phenomenological reduction’, which involves uncovering the conditions of our awareness of objects through reflection on the nature of experience. The approach inherits a great deal from Kant’s transcendental idealism, since in both cases we are required to recognize that the nature of our minds may impose a very specific character on objects as we encounter them in experience – a character that we should not be tempted to assume is imposed on our experience by facts about the external world. The idea that the nature of our minds imposes constraints on the way we experience the world is in fact a claim that is increasingly widely accepted, and phenomenology has become an area of particular interest for the emerging field of cognitive science (see for example Varela, Thompson and Rosch 1991).

b. Thinking About Things that Do Not Exist

The second possible interpretation of Brentano’s claim – that intentional objects do not exist – is particularly problematic. Whether or not all objects of thought are non-existent, it certainly seems that many are, including those that are obviously fictitious (The Grinch, Sherlock Holmes) or likely non-existent even if many people believe in them (Faeries, Hell). But deep puzzles arise when we consider what it means to say something about a non-existent object. Can we, for example, coherently state that Santa Claus has flying reindeer? If he does not exist, how can it be true that he has flying reindeer?  Can we indeed even coherently state that Santa Claus does not exist? If he does, our statement is false. But if he does not exist, then it seems that our claim is not about anything – and hence apparently meaningless. Another way of putting the puzzle involves definite descriptions. It seems reasonable to say the following:

(1)     The fairy king does not exist

But upon further consideration 1) is quite puzzling, because the appearance of the definite article ‘the’ in that statement seems to presuppose that there is such a thing as the fairy king to which we refer.

Russell proposed a famous solution to this puzzle. It involves first analyzing definite descriptions to show how we can use these to express claims about things that do not exist, and second to show that most terms that we use to make negative existential claims are actually definite descriptions in disguise. The first move is accomplished by Russell’s analysis of the logical structure of definite descriptions. He takes definite descriptions to have the logical form ‘a unique thing that has the properties F and G’. So, the definite description ‘the fairy king’ in 1) on Russell’s reading is logically equivalent to the description ‘a unique thing that is both a king and a fairy’. Notably, this eliminates the term ‘the’ from the description, and with it the presupposition that there is a fairy king. And rather than being meaningless, the claim that such a thing does not exist is true, if no unique thing exists that is both a king and a fairy:

(2)     There is no unique thing that is a king and a fairy

And, of course, false if there is a unique thing that is a king and a fairy. The second step of Russell’s solution is to hold that most referring terms in ordinary language are actually disguised definite descriptions. The term ‘Santa Claus’ on this view is actually a sort of shorthand for a description, perhaps ‘the man with the flying reindeer’. And this description is in turn to be analyzed as Russell proposes, so that the claim ‘Santa Claus does not exist’ in fact amounts to the denial that a unique individual that has the properties of being a man and having flying reindeer exists. And that seems to be perfectly coherent.

Are there any terms, in language or thought, on this account, that are not descriptions? Russell’s view is that the simplest terms in thought, out of which definite descriptions are composed, are not descriptions but singular terms, whose meaning is simply the object they refer to. These are demonstrative terms like ‘that’ and ‘this’, and our concepts of sensible properties like colors, sounds and smells. The meaning of these terms are fixed by what Russell called ‘acquaintance’ – they are conferred with meaning as a result of a direct interaction between the thinker and thing referred to, for example when we point at a color and simply think to ourselves ‘that’. These terms are only meaningful if in fact there are objects in the world to which they refer. Notice that on this view the second interpretation of Brentano’s claim – that in general the objects of thought do not exist – will become impossible to maintain. Since the descriptions that can pick out non-existent objects are composed of terms that are only meaningful if they refer to existing things, the objects of at least singular terms must exist for the view to make any sense.

c. Direct versus Indirect Intentionality

Even supposing that many objects of thought do exist, a further question arises as to whether the objects that we encounter in experience are products of our minds, or mind-independent objects. The view that the objects of experience are mind-dependent can be motivated by two complementary considerations. First, it seems reasonable to suppose that two different persons’ experiences in the same environment can be different. A color-blind person and a person with perfect color vision might have visually very different experiences in the same environment. Conversely, it seems that one person’s experiences in two very different environments could be the same. When I look at an oasis in the desert, I have a visual experience that might seem to be identical to the experience I have when faced with a mirage, even though these two environments are very different.

These considerations have lead many to argue that our experiences – even those of ordinary objects – are mediated by what have been called ‘sense data’. According to the sense-data theorist, what we immediately experience are not mind-independent objects, but sense-data that are produced at least partly by our minds. This allows us to explain the two puzzles considered above. If what we encounter in experience are sense data and not mind-independent objects, then two people could have very different experiences in the same mind-independent environment, and correlatively, one person could have two indistinguishable experiences in two very different mind-independent environments. Note that these sense-data may correspond very closely to the way things stand in the mind-independent world around us, so the view need not imply that our interactions with the world should be dysfunctional.

This ‘indirect’ theory of perception, however, raises worries about our knowledge of the world. When we say of the ketchup before us that it is red, are we saying this about the ketchup, or about the sense-data that we experience as a result of looking at the ketchup? If we really only experience the sense-data, this would suggest that most of the beliefs we have about the world around us are false. We believe our intentional states are directed at mind-independent objects, but the indirect theory suggests that they are not. We believe we’ve seen red ketchup, but this theory suggests that in fact we’ve only seen sense-data of red ketchup. And if we only have experience of sense-data produced by our minds, this seems to imply that we have never really had any direct experience with the world. It suggests that we’ve never seen waterfalls, smelled flowers, or heard the voices of our friends, but have only experienced sense-data of these things.

An early reply to these concerns involves jettisoning the indirect-theory of perception, and adopting the view that there are no sense-data or any other kind of representations mediating our experiences of the objects around us – a view sometimes called ‘naive realism’, and associated with Moore (1903). But on this approach, explanations of hallucinations or variations between different individuals’ experiences of the same objects are strained. An interesting middle ground is known as disjunctivism (Hinton 1967, Snowdon 1981, McDowell 1994, Martin 2002). The disjunctivist holds that the argument for the indirect theory of perception based on hallucinations is fallacious. Although the experiences of the oasis and the mirage might well be indistinguishable for the subject of the experience, this need not imply that the experiences are really the same. Rather, since one experience is the product of an encounter with an oasis, and the other is not, there is a difference between the experiences—it is just one that the subject is unable to identify. As a result, the disjunctivist holds that when we have veridical experiences, we have direct encounters with objects in the world, and when we have hallucinations, what we experience are sense-data produced by our mind. The disjunctivist view, then, at least allows us to see that we might not be forced into the indirect theory of perception by the existence of hallucinations.

3. Intentional States

So far we have looked at the question what determines the object of any given intentional state, and the question what is the nature of the objects of intentional states. What we have not examined is whether there are broad conditions for a state to count as intentional in the first place. Are only rational creatures capable of intentional states? Are intentional states essentially conscious states? Can we provide an account of intentional states in natural terms?

a. Intentionality and Reason

The centrality of reason to the intentional is an important strand in Kant’s famous Critique of Pure Reason (1787), and has informed an influential line of thinking taken up in the work of Sellars (1956), Strawson (1959) and Brandom (1996). Kant argues that in the apprehension of any object, an individual must have a range of concepts at her disposal that she can use to rationally assess the nature of the object apprehended. In order to apprehend a material object, for example, a thinker must understand what causation is. If she does not understand what causation is, she will not understand that if the material object were to be pushed, it would move. Or if it were picked up and thrown against a wall, it would not go straight through the wall or disappear, but would be caused by the solidity of the wall to bounce backward.  Without having the capacity to understand any of these issues, Kant argued, it would not be true to say that an individual apprehends the material object.

The appeal to the necessity of reason for concept-possession often goes hand in hand with the claim that our intentional states are all interdependent. Since I cannot have the concept material object, without the concept cause, then the two concepts depend on one another—and this may be the case for all our concepts, leading to a view known as ‘concept holism’. This raises a puzzle, however, that many think undermines the view. The concern is that if our concepts are interdependent in this way, then if any of my concepts change, all the others change with it. If for example I can only grasp the concept horse if I have the concept animal, then if my animal concept changes in some way, my horse concept will change along with it. If we couple this with the observation that our beliefs about the world are almost constantly being updated, as our day to day experience progresses, then the worry arises that we could literally never have the same thought twice. Any time my beliefs about the world change they will change at least one of my concepts, and if all of my concepts are interdependent, then whenever any of my beliefs change, they will all change. As a result, although it might seem to me that I had thoughts about horses both yesterday and today, this would not be true since the concept that occurred in my thoughts yesterday would not be the same concept as occurred in my thoughts today. Some who think this is an intolerable result adopt the view known as ‘concept atomism’, which holds that our concepts do not stand in essential relations to one another, but only to the external objects they refer to (Fodor and Lepore 1992). Atomism, however, seems to be committed to the claim that I could possess the concept horse without knowing what an animal is, and to the holist that seems as intolerable as concept holism seems to the atomist.

b. Intentionality and Intensionality

Another feature of intentional states that is sometimes thought to be essential is what is called ‘intensionality’ (with an ‘s’). This is the phenomenon whereby the objects of thought are presented to a thinker from a certain point of view—what Frege called a ‘mode of presentation’. We already encountered one of the puzzles that motivate this idea above discussing Frege’s puzzle, where the answer to the question why two concepts can be co-referential without a thinker knowing is proposed to be the fact that a thinker’s concepts pick out an object under a particular mode of presentation.

The potentially essential connection between intentionality and intensionality can be seen when we try to describe someone’s intentional states without bearing in mind their point of view. Recall the beliefs that Lois Lane has about Superman. Lois Lane believes she loves Superman, but does not believe she loves her colleague Clark Kent, not knowing that Superman is Clark Kent. 1) seems like a true description of Lois Lane’s belief about Superman:

(1)     Lois Lane believes that she loves Superman

If (1) is true, however, and Superman is Clark Kent, then we might expect that we would state exactly the same thing if we substitute the name ‘Clark Kent’ for the name ‘Superman’ in (1). That would give us (2):

(2)     Lois Lane believes that she loves Clark Kent

To many, however, it seems that there is something wrong with (2). If Superman walks into the room in his Clark Kent disguise, Lois will not light up as she does when he walks in without the disguise. If Lois is told that Clark Kent is in trouble, she will not infer that the man she loves in is in trouble. A natural explanation for these facts is that the belief reported in (1) is not the same as the belief reported in (2). Since our reports about the beliefs of others may be false if we do not take into consideration the mode of presentation under which the objects of those beliefs are thought of by the holder of the belief, it seems like intensionality may be an essential feature of intentional states.

Another phenomenon that seems to tie intentionality to intensionality is shown in the fact that we cannot infer from the fact that someone has a belief about x, that x exists. This is unusual, since for most cases of predication (ascription of a property to an object), we can infer from the fact that we have ascribed a property to an object that the object exists. For example, if the claim that the sun is bright is true, it would seem to follow that there must be such a thing as the sun. That is, predication ordinarily permits existential generalization: if a property is truly predicated of an object, then some object with that property exists (Fa → ∃xFx). However, from the fact that I believe the sun is bright, it does not follow that there is such a thing as the sun. After all, I might just as easily believe, as Kant did, that phlogiston is the cause of combustion, but as we know, there is no such thing as phlogiston. If we combine these two claims we get a third claim: that neither the assertion nor the denial of a report of an intentional state entails that the proposition the intentional state is about is true or false. For example, we could truly assert that Kant believed that phlogiston causes combustion, but this does not entail that it is true that phlogiston causes combustion.

Chisholm (1956) thought that an intentional state is any state whose description has these three features: failure to preserve truth given the inter-substitution of co-referring terms (such as ‘Superman’ for ‘Clark Kent’), failure to allow existential generalization entailment (the existence of the intentional object), and failure to entail the truth of the object proposition (such as the belief ascribed to the thinker).

However, these criteria do not seem to hold up for all intentional states. While it does not follow from the fact that Kant believes phlogiston causes combustion that there is such a thing as phlogiston, or that it is true that phlogiston causes combustion, these things would seem to follow if it we held that Kant knew that phlogiston causes combustion. That is, it does not seem possible to have knowledge of things that do not exist, or of propositions that are not true, so if someone knows Fa, then an object with the property F must exist, and if someone knows that p, then p must be true. Knowledge ascriptions therefore do not satisfy the second and third conditions proposed by Chisholm, and yet they are surely intentional states. And perceptual states, which also seem to be intentional states, do not obviously satisfy any of the conditions. You cannot perceive something that does not exist, and you cannot perceive that p is the case if p is not the case, and additionally it is possible to intersubstitute co-referring terms in descriptions of perceptions. If it is true that Jimi Hendrix saw Bob Dylan at Woodstock, then it is true that Jimi Hendrix saw Robert Zimmerman at Woodstock, because Bob Dylan is Robert Zimmerman. Hendrix might not have believed that he saw Robert Zimmerman, or have known that he saw Robert Zimmerman, but nevertheless, if he saw Bob Dylan, he saw Robert Zimmerman. And perceptual states also seem quite clearly to be intentional states.

There is surely an important connection between intentionality and intensionality, then, but how it works in detail is clearly more complex than Chisholm thought.

c. Intentionality and Consciousness

A state of a creature is a conscious state if there is something it is like for the creature to be in that state. There is something it feels like for a person to have their hand pressed onto a hot grill, but there is not anything it feels like for a cheese sandwich to be pressed onto a hot grill. Do these conscious states have an essential connection to intentionality? Might intentionality depend on consciousness, or vice versa?

Some views take conscious states to be a kind of intentional state—thus holding that consciousness depends on intentionality. There are good prima facie grounds for holding this view. It is not obvious how I could be conscious of a horse being before me without my conscious state being directed at, or about, the horse. The idea that conscious states are a species of intentional state can be teased out in various ways. We might say that conscious content is simply intentional content that is available for rational evaluation, so that if I am conscious that it is raining, I have a mental state about the rain that I can reflect upon (Dennett 1991). Or we could say that conscious states always represent the world as being in such-and-such a way, so that if I am conscious that it is raining, I have a mental state that represents the world as being rainy right now (Tye 1995). Or, that conscious states are states that are naturally selected to indicate to a subject that her environment is in such and such a way, and again therefore intentional (Dretske 1995).

However the view that there are ‘raw feels’ in our conscious experience that do not say anything at all about the world also has considerable pull. For example, you might think that when you’re conscious of the warmth of the sun on your face you can indeed reflect upon the fact and judge that it is sunny where you are, but that the warm feeling itself does not tell you that it is sunny. On this view there are two things here, the warm feeling, and the subsequent judgment ‘it is sunny’, which although formed on the basis of the feeling is nevertheless distinct from it (Ryle 1949, Sellars 1956, Peacocke 1983). On this view, conscious states are not intentional in themselves, since they do not in themselves represent the world as being in any particular way, even if they can be used to make judgments about the world.

On the other hand, we might think the dependence runs the other way: that intentional states depend on consciousness. We might suppose that it is hard to make sense of the claim that we could have mental states about the world without the world feeling any way at all to us. Searle (1983), for example, thinks that our notion of the mind essentially involves the notion of consciousness, so he denies that there could be essentially unconscious mental states. To deal with the case of beliefs or desires that I am not currently consciously entertaining, he argues that these must at least have the potential to become conscious in order to be properly understood as mental states.

This dependence claim has its skeptics too, however. The position known as ‘epiphenomenalism’ holds that there is no essential role for consciousness to play in our lives: that consciousness is caused by, but itself plays no causal role in, other mental events. We may happen to have conscious experiences concurrent with some of the events in our lives (such as intentional events), and they may even stand in constant conjunction with those events, but this in itself is not evidence that a creature could not exist that carries out the same activities with no conscious experiences at all. A real life example can get this intuition going. In a phenomenon sometimes called ‘blindsight’, subjects display above chance capacity to discriminate features of their environment while at least reporting that they have no corresponding conscious experience of these features. In one experiment, a subject is shown two drawings of a house, each identical in every respect except that one house is represented as being on fire. When asked, the subjects insist that they can see no difference between the two houses (the house on fire is in the visual region that the subject is having problems with). When pressed on which house they would prefer to live in, however, the subjects show an above chance preference for the house that is not represented as being on fire. Since the subjects seem to have distinct attitudes to the two pictures, hence distinct intentional states directed at each picture, and since there is no apparent variation in conscious experience, some take such cases to motivate the claim that it is possible to have intentional states without any conscious component.

d. Naturalizing Intentionality

Whatever the essence of intentionality might be, a further question that arises is whether we can ‘naturalize’ our account of it. That is to say, whether we can give an account of intentionality that can be exhaustively described in the terms in which the laws of nature are expressed. There is a long tradition of holding that the mind is outside of space and time – that it is an immaterial substance – and on that view, since intentional states are mental states, intentionality could not be naturalized. But particularly in the 20th century, there has been a push to reject the view that the mind is immaterial and to try to account for the mind in terms of natural processes, such as causal relations, natural selection, and any other process that can be explained in terms of the laws of the natural sciences.

The attempt faces various challenges. We have already looked at one, which is that if we take intentional states to depend on consciousness, and we hold that it is not possible to give a naturalized account of consciousness, then it follows that we cannot naturalize intentionality. But there is another particularly tricky puzzle facing the naturalization of intentionality in terms of causal relations. As we saw above (3b) at least some intentional states have the property of intensionality: it does not follow from the fact that I believe p that p is the case, and it does not follow from the fact that I do not believe p that p is not the case. Another way to put this is that our concepts do not always co-vary with the objects they represent. On the one hand we can encounter the objects our concepts refer to without our concepts triggering, for example, when Lois Lane meets Clark Kent and the thought ‘that’s Superman’ fails to occur to her. And conversely our concepts can be triggered when the object they refer to is not about, such as when I see a cow in the night and mistakenly think ‘there’s a horse’. Our concepts, in other words, can trigger when they should not, and can fail to trigger when they should. This is a problem for naturalizing intentionality, because the causal theory of intentionality (1b) is at the heart of attempts to naturalize intentionality, and the causal theory has trouble explaining intensionality. For example, the causal theory holds that a concept refers to whatever causes it to trigger. But if Lois Lane bumps into Clark Kent and her superman concept fails to trigger, this would suggest that Lois Lane’s superman concept does not refer to Clark Kent. And that’s not a good outcome, since Superman is Clark Kent. Similarly, if I see a cow in the night and my horse concept goes off, the causal account implies that my horse concept refers to cows in the night. And that’s no good either.

Dretske (1981) argues that causal relations can in fact exhibit intensionality, so that we can naturalize intentionality. A compass, he argues, indicates the location of the North Pole because the North Pole causes the compass needle to point at it. He takes a compass to be a ‘natural indicator’ of the North Pole, and so to exhibit natural intentionality. But he thinks the compass also exhibits intensionality. In addition to indicating the North Pole, the compass also indicates the location of polar bears, because there are polar bears at the North Pole. However, if the polar bears move south, the compass will not continue to indicate their location. As a result, suggests Dretske, the compass exhibits intensionality: the compass can fail to indicate the location of polar bears, even though the location of polar bears is the North Pole, just as Lois Lane’s superman concept can fail to indicate Clark Kent, even though Clark Kent is Superman. There is a problem with this account, however, because the relationship between the location of polar bears and the North Pole is very different to the relationship between Superman and Clark Kent. The location of the polar bears can fail to be where the North Pole is, but Clark Kent cannot fail to be where Superman is. That is, the kind of failure to trigger that we are concerned to explain is where a concept fails to trigger in response to what is necessarily identical to its reference – not in response to something that merely happens to be co-instantiated with its reference on some occasions.

Another attempt to allow for these cases within a causal theory appeals to the notion of a natural function or telos (Mathen and Levy 1984, Millikan 1984, Dretske 1995, Papineau 1993). If the heart has been selected by evolution to pump blood, then we can say that the natural function of the heart is to pump blood. But functions can malfunction, as we see when the heart stops, thus failing to continue to pump blood. What distinguishes the correct from the incorrect activities of the heart is whether the heart is doing what it was selected for by evolution. The teleological theory of intentionality proposes that this same mechanism distinguishes the correct and incorrect triggers of a concept. When my horse concept tokens in response to my encounter with a cow in the night, it is malfunctioning, because it was selected to alert me to the presence of horses. This account faces several objections, but the clearest is that it rules out the possibility of a creature having thoughts whose mental states did not come into being through natural selection. Although highly unlikely, it is does not seem impossible that a being formally identical to a thinking person could come into existence by chance, through the right freak coincidence of physical events (in one story it involves lightning hitting a swamp and the right chemicals instantaneously bonding to form a molecule-for-molecule match of an adult human (Davidson 1987)). If the teleological theory of intentionality were right, such a being would have no intentional states since its brain states would have no natural history, even though it would be physically and behaviorally indistinguishable from a thinking person. Many see this is as a reductio ad absurdum of the teleological account, since it seems that by hypothesis such a being would be able to perceive, form desires and beliefs about its environment, and so forth.

Another proposal still is that we can distinguish correct from incorrect triggers of a concept in terms of the relationship they stand in to one another: the incorrect triggers of a concept only cause the concept to trigger because the correct triggers do, but the correct triggers don’t trigger the concept because the incorrect ones do (Fodor 1987). To return to the cow in the night example, the proposal is that if horses didn’t cause my horse concept to trigger, cows in the night wouldn’t either: the reason cows in the night cause it to trigger is because horses cause it to trigger, and cows in the night look like horses. But the reverse is not the case: if cows in the night didn’t cause my horse concept to trigger, this needn’t mean that horses wouldn’t. Correct and incorrect triggers can therefore by identified by this ‘asymmetric dependence’ relation they have to one another. When we try to explain why the correct triggers would continue to cause a concept to token even if the incorrect triggers didn’t, however, the proposal becomes less convincing. Returning to the Twin-Earth example, if we travel to Twin-Earth our water concept will be triggered by the watery looking stuff there, presumably falsely. But since Twin-Earth water is by hypothesis ordinarily indistinguishable from Earth water, it seems wrong to say that if Twin-Earth water did not cause our water concept to trigger, Earth water still would. The reason Earth water causes our water concept to trigger, after all, is presumably because it looks, tastes and smells a certain way. But Twin-Earth water looks, tastes and smells exactly the same way, so it is far from clear why we should expect that if Twin-Earth water did not trigger our water concept Earth water still would. Fodor (1998) replies that we should discount Twin-Earth worries because Twin-Earth does not exist. But it is not clear that this helps, since we could surely discover a substance on Earth that we might not be able to distinguish from water, in which case the same worry can be raised without discussing Twin-Earth.

Needless to say there are further arguments made on behalf of these proposals, but as things stand, there is no widely accepted solution to the problem presented by intensionality for naturalizing intentionality.

4. References and Further Reading

  • Brandom, R. (1996). Making it Explicit. Harvard University Press.
  • Brentano, F. (1874/1911/1973). Psychology from an Empirical Standpoint, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • Chalmers, D. (1996). The Conscious Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Chalmers, D. (2006). “Foundations of Two-Dimensional Semantics.” In M. Garcia-Carpintero and J. Macia (eds). Two-Dimensional Semantics: Foundations and Applications. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Chisholm, R. M. (1956). “Perceiving: a Philosophical Study,” chapter 11, selection in D. Rosenthal (ed.), The Nature of Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1990.
  • Davidson, D. (1980). Essays on Events and Actions, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Davidson, D. (1987). “Knowing One’s Own Mind.” In Proceedings and Addresses of the American Philosophical Association, 60: 441–58.
  • Dennett, D.C (1991). Consciousness Explained. Boston: Little Brown.
  • Dretske, F. (1981). Knowledge and the Flow of Information, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Dretske, F. (1995). Naturalizing the Mind. Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Dreyfus, H.L. (ed.) (1982). Husserl, Intentionality and Cognitive Science, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Evans, G. (1979). “Reference and Contingency.” The Monist, 62, 2 (April, 1979), 161-189.
  • Fodor, J.A. (1975). The Language of Thought, New York: Crowell.
  • Fodor, J.A. (1987). Psychosemantics, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Fodor, J.A. (1998). Concepts: Where Cognitive Science Went Wrong, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Fodor, J. A. and Lepore, E. (1992). Holism: A Shopper’s Guide. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Føllesdal, D. (1982). “Husserl’s notion of Noema,” in H.L. Dreyfus (ed.), The Nature of Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Frege, G. (1892/1952). “On Sense and Reference.” In P. Geach and M. Black (eds.), Philosophical Writings of Gottlob Frege, Oxford: Blackwell, 1952.
  • Goodman, N. (1968). Languages of Art: An Approach to a Theory of Symbols. Indianapolis: The Bobbs-Merrill Company.
  • Haugeland, J. (1981). “Semantic Engines: an Introduction to Mind Design.” In J. Haugeland (ed.), Mind Design, Philosophy, Psychology, Artificial Intelligence, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press, 1981.
  • Hinton, J.M., (1967). “Visual Experiences.” Mind, 76: 217–227.
  • Husserl, E. (1900/1970). Logical Investigations, (Engl. Transl. by Findlay, J.N.), London: Routledge and Kegan Paul.
  • Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Kaplan, D. (1979). “Dthat.” In P. French, T. Uehling, and H. Wettstein (eds.), Contemporary Perspectives in the Philosophy of Language, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
  • King, P. (2007). “Rethinking Representation in the Middle Ages.” In Representation and Objects of Thought in Medieval Philosophy, edited by Henrik Lagerlund, Ashgate Press: 81-100.
  • Kim, J. (1993). Mind and Supervenience, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Kripke, S. (1972/1980). Naming and Necessity, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Martin, M.G.F. (2002). “The Transparency of Experience.” Mind and Language, 17: 376–425.
  • Mohan, M. & Levy, E. (1984). “Teleology, Error, and the Human Immune System.” Journal of Philosophy 81 (7):351-372.
  • McDowell, J. (1994). Mind and World. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • McGinn, C. (1989). Mental Content, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • McGinn, C. (1990). Problems of Consciousness, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Mill, J.S. (1884). A System of Logic, Ratiocinative and Inductive: Being a Connected View of the Principles of Evidence and the Methods of Scientific Investigation, New York: Harper.
  • Millikan, R.G. (1984). Language, Thought and Other Biological Objects, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Mooney, T. (2010). “Understanding and Simple Seeing in Husserl.” Husserl Studies, 26: 19-48.
  • Moore, G.E. (1903). “The Refutation of Idealism.” Mind 12 (1903) 433-53.
  • Papineau, D. (1993). Philosophical Naturalism. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Peacocke, C. (1983). Sense and Content: Experience, Thought and their Relations, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Putnam, H. (1974). “The Meaning of ‘Meaning’,” in H. Putnam, Philosophical Papers, vol. II, Language, Mind and Reality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1975.
  • Recanati, F. (2013). Mental Files. Oxford University Press.
  • Russell, B. (1905/1956). “On Denoting,” in R. Marsh (ed.), Bertrand Russell, Logic and Knowledge, Essays 1901-1950, New York: Capricorn Books, 1956.
  • Russell, B. (1911). The Problems of Philosophy, (New York: Holt).
  • Ryle, G. (1949). The Concept of Mind. Oxford University Press.
  • Searle, J. (1958). “Do Proper Names have Sense?” Mind 67: 166-173.
  • Searle, J. (1983). Intentionality, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Searle, J, (1994). “Intentionality (1),” in Guttenplan, S. (ed.) (1994) A Companion Volume to the Philosophy of Mind, Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Sellars, W. (1956/1997). “Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind.” In Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind: with an Introduction by Richard Rorty and a Study Guide by Robert Brandom, R. Brandom (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Snowdon, P.F., (1981). “Perception, Vision and Causation.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, New Series, 81: 175–92.
  • Soames, S. (2005). Reference and Description: The Case against Two-Dimensionalism. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Strawson, P. (1959). The Bounds of Sense. Oxford University Press.
  • Tye, M. (1995). Ten Problems of Consciousness, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Varela, F., Thompson, E., and Rosch E., (1991). The Embodied Mind: Cognitive Science and Human Experience, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
  • Wittgenstein, L. (1953). Philosophical Investigations. Oxford: Blackwell.

 

Author Information

Cathal O’Madagain
Email: cathalcom@gmail.com
Ecole Normale Superieure, Paris
France

Ethical Expressivism

Broadly speaking, the term “expressivism” refers to a family of views in the philosophy of language according to which the meanings of claims in a particular area of discourse are to be understood in terms of whatever non-cognitive mental states those claims are supposed to express. More specifically, an expressivist theory of claims in some area of discourse, D, will typically affirm both of the following theses. The first thesis—psychological non-cognitivism—states that claims in D express mental states that are characteristically non-cognitive. Non-cognitive states are often distinguished by their world-to-mind direction of fit, which contrasts with the mind-to-world direction of fit exhibited by cognitive states like beliefs. Some common examples of non-cognitive states are desires, emotions, pro- and con-attitudes, commitments, and so forth. According to the second thesis—semantic ideationalism—the meanings or semantic contents of claims in D are in some sense given by the mental states that those claims express. This is in contrast with more traditional propositional or truth-conditional approaches to meaning, according to which the meanings of claims are to be understood in terms of either their truth-conditions or the propositions that they express.

An expressivist theory of truth claims—that is, claims of the form “p is true”—might hold that (i) “p is true” expresses a certain measure of confidence in, or agreement with, p, and that (ii) whatever the relevant mental state, for example, agreement with p, that state just is the meaning of “p is true”. In other words, when we claim that p is true, we neither describe p as true nor report the fact that p is true; rather, we express some non-cognitive attitude toward p (see Strawson 1949). Similar expressivist treatments have been given to knowledge claims (Austin 1970; Chrisman 2012), probability claims (Barker 2006; Price 2011; Yalcin 2012), claims about causation (Coventry 2006; Price 2011), and even claims about what is funny (Gert 2002; Dreier 2009).

“Ethical expressivism”, then, is the name for any view according to which (i) ethical claims—that is, claims like “x is wrong”, “y is a good person”, and “z is a virtue”—express non-cognitive mental states, and (ii) these states make up the meanings of ethical claims. (I shall henceforth use the term “expressivism” to refer only to ethical expressivism, unless otherwise noted.) This article begins with a brief account of the history of expressivism, and an explanation of its main motivations. This is followed by a description of the famous Frege-Geach Problem, and of the role that it played in shaping contemporary versions of the view. While these contemporary expressivisms may avoid the problem as it was originally posed, recent work in metaethics suggests that Geach’s worries were really just symptoms of a much deeper problem, which can actually take many forms. After characterizing this deeper problem—the Continuity Problem—and some of its more noteworthy manifestations, the article explores a few recent trends in the literature on expressivism, including the advent of so-called “hybrid” expressivist views. See also “Non-Cognitivism in Ethics.”

Table of Contents

  1. Expressivism and Non-Cognitivism: History and Motivations
  2. The Frege-Geach Problem and Hare’s Way Out
  3. The Expressivist Turn
  4. The Continuity Problem
    1. A Puzzle about Negation
    2. Making Sense of Attitude Ascriptions
    3. Saving the Differences
  5. Recent Trends
    1. Expressivists’ Attitude Problem
    2. Hybrid Theories
    3. Recent Work in Empirical Moral Psychology
  6. References and Further Reading

1. Expressivism and Non-Cognitivism: History and Motivations

The first and primary purpose of this section is to lay out a brief history of ethical expressivism, paying particular attention to its main motivations. In addition to this, the section will also answer a question that many have had about expressivism, namely: what is the difference between expressivism and “non-cognitivism”?

The difference is partly an historical one, such that a history of expressivism must begin with its non-cognitivist ancestry. Discussions of early non-cognitivism typically involve three figures in particular—A. J. Ayer, C. L. Stevenson, and R. M. Hare—and in that respect, this one will be no different. But rather than focusing upon the substance of their views, in this section, we will be more interested in the main considerations that motivated them to take up non-cognitivism in the first place. As we shall see, early non-cognitivist views were motivated mostly by two concerns: first, a desire to avoid unwanted ontological commitments, especially to a realm of “spooky,” irreducibly normative properties; and second, a desire to capture an apparently very close connection between sincere ethical claims and motivation.

In the case of Ayer, his motivation for defending a version of non-cognitivism was relatively clear, since he explains in the Introduction of the second edition of Language, Truth, and Logic (1946), “[I]n putting forward the theory I was concerned with maintaining the general consistency of my position [logical positivism].” As is well known, logical positivists were rather austere in their ontological accommodations, and happy to let the natural sciences decide (for the most part) what gets accommodated. In fact, a common way to interpret their verificationism is as a kind of method for avoiding unwanted ontological commitments—“unwanted” because they do not conform to what Ayer himself described as his and other positivists’ “radical empiricism.” Claims in some area of discourse are meaningful, in the ordinary sense of that term—which, for Ayer, is just to say that they express propositions—only if they are either analytic or empirically verifiable. Claims that are neither analytic nor empirically verifiable—like most religious claims, for instance—are meaningless; they might express something, but not propositions.

Ayer’s positivism could perhaps make room for moral properties as long as those properties were understood as literally nothing but the natural properties into which philosophers sometimes analyze them—for example, maximizing pleasure, since this is in principle verifiable—but it left no room at all for the irreducibly normative properties that some at the time took to be the very subject-matter of ethics (see Moore 1903). So in order to “maintain the general consistency of his position,” and to avoid any commitment to empirically unverifiable, irreducibly normative properties, Ayer’s positivism meant that he had to construe ordinary ethical claims as expressing something other than propositions. Moreover, for reasons unimportant to my purposes here, he argued that these claims express non-cognitive, motivational states of mind—in particular, emotions. It is for this reason that Ayer’s brand of non-cognitivism is often referred to as “emotivism”.

Stevenson likely shared some of Ayer’s ontological suspicions, but this pretty clearly is not what led him to non-cognitivism. Rather than being concerned to maintain the consistency of any pre-conceived philosophical principles, Stevenson begins by simply observing our ordinary practices of making ethical claims, and then he asks what kind of analysis of “good” is able to make the best sense out of these practices. For instance, in practice, he thinks ethical claims are made more to influence others than to inform them. In fact, in general, Stevenson seems especially impressed with what he called the “magnetism” of ethical claims—that is, their apparently close connection to people’s motivational states. But he thinks that other attempts to analyze “good” in terms of these motivational states have failed on two counts: (a) they make genuine ethical disagreement impossible, and (b) they compromise the autonomy of ethics, assigning ethical facts to the province of psychology, or sociology, or one of the natural sciences.

According to Stevenson, these other theories err in conceiving the connection between ethical claims and motivational states in terms of the former describing, or reporting, the latter—so that, for instance, the meaning of “Torture is wrong” consists in something like the proposition that I (the speaker) disapprove of torture. This is what led to problems (a) and (b) from above: two people who are merely describing or reporting their own attitudes toward torture cannot be genuinely disagreeing about its wrongness; and if the wrongness of torture were really just a matter of people’s attitudes toward it, then ethical inquiries could apparently be settled entirely by such means as introspection, psychoanalysis, or even just popular vote. Stevenson’s non-cognitivism, then, can be understood as an attempt to capture the relation between ethical claims and motivational states in a way that avoids these problems.

The solution, he thinks, is to allow that ethical claims have a different sort of meaning from ordinary descriptive claims. If ordinary descriptive claims have propositional meaning—that is, meaning that is a matter of the propositions they express—then ethical claims have what Stevenson called emotive meaning. “The emotive meaning of a word is a tendency of a word, arising through the history of its usage, to produce (result from) affective responses in people.  It is the immediate aura of feeling which hovers about a word” (Stevenson 1937, p.23; see also Ogden and Richards 1923, 125ff). A claim like “Torture is the subject of today’s debate” may get its meaning from a proposition, but the claim “Torture is wrong” has emotive meaning, in that its meaning is somehow to be understood in terms of the motivational states that it is typically used either to express or to arouse.

If Ayer and Stevenson apparently disagreed over the meaningfulness of ethical claims, with Ayer at times insisting that such claims are meaningless, and Stevenson allowing that they have a special kind of non-propositional meaning, they were nonetheless united in affirming a negative semantic thesis, sometimes called semantic non-factualism, according to which claims in some area of discourse—in this case, ethical claims—do not express propositions, and, consequently, do not have truth-conditions. Regardless of whether or not ethical claims are meaningful in some special sense, they are not meaningful in the same way that ordinary descriptive claims are meaningful, that is, in the sense of expressing propositions. Ayer and Stevenson were also apparently united in affirming what we earlier called psychological non-cognitivism. So as the term shall be used here, ‘ethical non-cognitivism’ names any view that combines semantic non-factualism and psychological non-cognitivism, with respect to ethical claims.

According to Hare, ethical claims actually have two kinds of meaning: descriptive and prescriptive. To call a thing “good” is both (a) to say or imply that it has some context-specific set of non-moral properties; this is the claim’s descriptive meaning, and (b) to commend the thing in virtue of these properties (this is the claim’s prescriptive meaning). But importantly, the prescriptive meaning of ethical claims is primary: the set of properties that I ascribe to a thing when calling it “good” varies from context to context, but in all contexts, I use “good” for the purpose of commendation. For Hare, then, ethical claims are used not to express emotions, or to excite the emotions of others, but rather to guide actions. They do this by taking the imperative mood. That is, they are first-and-foremost prescriptions. For this reason, Hare’s view is often called “prescriptivism”.

It may be less clear than it was in the case of Ayer and Stevenson whether Hare’s prescriptivism ought to count as a version of non-cognitivism. After all, it is not uncommon to suppose that sentences in the imperative mood still have propositional content. Since he rarely goes in for talk of “expression”, it is unclear whether Hare is a psychological non-cognitivist. However, it would nonetheless be fair to say that, since prescriptions do not have truth-conditions, Hare is committed to saying that the relationship between prescriptive ethical claims and propositions is fundamentally different from that between ordinary descriptive claims and propositions; and in this sense, it does seem as if he is committed to a form of semantic non-factualism. It also seems right to think that if we do not express any sort of non-cognitive, approving attitude toward a thing when we call it “good,” then we do not really commend it. So even if he is not explicit in his adherence to it, Hare does seem to accept some form of psychological non-cognitivism as well.

Also unclear are Hare’s motivations for being an ethical non-cognitivist. By the time Hare published The Language of Morals (1952), non-cognitivism was already the dominant view in moral philosophy. So there was much less of a need for Hare to motivate the view than there was for Ayer and Stevenson a couple decades earlier. Instead, Hare’s concern was mostly to give a more thorough articulation of the view than the other non-cognitivists had, and one sophisticated enough to avoid some of the problems that had already arisen for earlier versions of the view.

One thing that does appear to have motivated Hare’s non-cognitivism, however, is its ability to explain intuitions about moral supervenience. Most philosophers agree that there is some kind of relationship between a thing’s moral status and its non-moral features, such that two things cannot have different moral statuses without also having different non-moral features. This is roughly what it means to say that a thing’s moral features supervene upon its non-moral features. For example, if it is morally wrong for Stan to lie to his teacher, but not morally wrong for Stan to lie to his mother, then there must be some non-moral difference between the two actions that underlies and explains their moral difference, for example, something to do with Stan’s reasons for lying in each case. While non-philosophers may not be familiar with the term “supervenience”, the fact that we so often hold people accountable for judging like cases suggests that we do intuitively take the moral to supervene upon the non-moral.

Those philosophers, like Moore, who believe in irreducibly normative properties must explain how it is that, despite apparently not being reducible to non-moral properties, these properties are nonetheless able to supervene upon non-moral properties, which has proven to be an especially difficult task (see Blackburn 1988b). But non-cognitivists like Hare do not shoulder this difficult metaphysical burden. Instead, they explain intuitions about moral supervenience in terms of rational consistency. If Joan commends something in virtue of its non-moral properties, but then fails to commend something else with an identical set of properties, then she is inconsistent in her commendations, and thereby betrays a certain sort of irrationality. It is this simple expectation of rational consistency, and not some complicated thesis about the ontological relations that obtain between moral and non-moral properties, that explains our intuitions about moral supervenience.

Not long after Hare’s prescriptivism hit the scene, ethical non-cognitivism would be the target of an attack from Peter Geach. Given that the attack was premised upon a point made earlier by German philosopher Gottlob Frege, it has come to be known as the Frege-Geach Problem for non-cognitivism. In the next section, we will see what the Frege-Geach Problem is. Before doing so, however, let us briefly return to the question raised at the beginning of this section: what is the difference between expressivism and non-cognitivism?

In the introduction, we saw that ethical expressivism is essentially the combination of two theses concerning ethical claims: psychological non-cognitivism and semantic ideationalism. As we will see in Sections 2 and 3, the Frege-Geach Problem pressures the non-cognitivist to say more about the meanings of ethical claims than just the non-factualist thesis that they are not comprised of truth-evaluable propositions. It is partly in response to this pressure that contemporary non-cognitivists have been moved to accept semantic ideationalism. So the difference between expressivism and non-cognitivism is historical, but it is not merely historical.  Rather, the difference is substantive as well: both expressivists and non-cognitivists accept some form of psychological non-cognitivism; but whereas the earlier non-cognitivists accepted a negative thesis about the contents of ethical claims—essentially, a thesis about how ethical claims do not get their meanings—contemporary expressivists accept a positive thesis about how ethical claims do get their meanings: ethical claims mean what they do in virtue of the non-cognitive mental states they express. It should be noted, however, that there are still many philosophers who use the terms “non-cognitivism” and “expressivism” interchangeably.

2. The Frege-Geach Problem and Hare’s Way Out

Non-cognitivist theories have met with a number of objections throughout the years, but none as famous as the so-called Frege-Geach Problem. As a point of entry into the problem, observe that there are ordinary linguistic contexts in which it seems correct to say that a proposition is being asserted, and contexts in which it seems incorrect to say that a proposition is being asserted.  Consider the following two sentences:

(1)        It is snowing.

(2)        If it is snowing, then the kids will want to play outside.

In ordinary contexts, to make claim (1) is to assert that it is snowing. That is, when a speaker utters (1), she puts forward a certain proposition—in this case, the proposition that it is snowing—as true. Accordingly, if we happen to know that it is not snowing, it could be appropriate to say that the speaker is wrong.  But when a speaker utters (2), she does not thereby assert that it is snowing. Someone can coherently utter (2) without having any idea whether it is snowing, or even knowing that it is not snowing. In the event that it is not snowing, we should not then say that the speaker of (2) is wrong. However, whether “It is snowing” is being asserted or not, it surely means the same thing in the antecedent of (2) as it does in (1). Equally, while we should not say that the speaker of (2) is wrong if it happens not to be snowing, it would nonetheless be correct, in that event, to say that both (1) and the antecedent of (2) are false.

This is what Geach calls “the Frege point,” a reference to German philosopher Gottlob Frege: “A thought may have just the same content whether you assent to its truth or not; a proposition may occur in discourse now asserted, now unasserted, and yet be recognizably the same proposition” (Geach 1965, p.449). The best way to account for the facts that (a) claim (1) and the antecedent of (2) have the same semantic contents, and that (b) they are both apparently capable of truth and falsity, is to suppose that claim (1) and the antecedent of (2) both express the proposition that it is snowing. So apparently, a claim’s expressing a proposition is something wholly independent of what a speaker happens to be doing with the claim, e.g., whether asserting it or not.

Now, we should note two things about the theories of early non-cognitivists like Ayer, Stevenson, and Hare. First, they are meant only to apply to claims in the relevant area of discourse—in this case, ethical claims—and are not supposed to generalize to other sorts of claims. In other words, theirs are apparently specialized, or “local,” semantic theories. So, for instance, most ethical non-cognitivists would agree that claim (1) expresses the proposition that it is snowing, and that this accounts for the meaning of (1). Second, perhaps understandably, ethical non-cognitivists focus their theories almost entirely upon ethical claims when they are asserted. The basic question is always something like this: what really is going on when a speaker makes an assertion of the form ‘x is wrong’? Does the speaker thereby describe x as wrong? Or might it be a kind of fallacy to assume that the speaker is engaged in an act of description, based only upon the surface grammar of the sentence? Might she instead be doing something expressive or evocative? Geach observes, “Theory after theory has been put forward to the effect that predicating some term ‘P’—which is always taken to mean: predicating ‘P’ assertorically—is not describing an object as being P but some other ‘performance’; and the contrary view is labeled ‘the Descriptive Fallacy’” (Geach 1965, p.461). Little attention is paid to ethical claims in contexts where they are not being asserted.

The Frege-Geach Problem can be understood as a consequence of these two features of non-cognitivist theories. As we saw earlier with claims (1) and (2), when we embed a claim into an unasserted context, like the antecedent of a conditional, we effectively strip the claim of its assertoric force. Claim (1) is assertoric, but the antecedent of (2) is not, despite having the same semantic content. But as Geach points out, exactly the same phenomenon occurs when we take a claim at the heart of some non-cognitivist theory and embed it into an unasserted context. This is why the Frege-Geach Problem is sometimes called the Embedding Problem. For example, consider the following two claims, similar in form to claims (1) and (2):

(3)        Lying is wrong.

(4)        If lying is wrong, then getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

As with claims (1) and (2) above, the relationship between a speaker and claim (3) is importantly different from the relationship between a speaker and the antecedent of claim (4). At least in ordinary contexts, a speaker of (3) asserts that lying is wrong, whereas a speaker of (4) does no such thing. But, assuming “the Frege point” applies here as well, the semantic contents of (3) and the antecedent of (4) do not depend upon whether they are being asserted or not. In both cases, their contents ought to be the same; and therein lies the rub for ethical non-cognitivists.

Given that their theories are meant to apply only to ethical claims, and not to claims in other areas of discourse, non-cognitivists are apparently committed to telling a radically different story about the semantic content of (3), as compared to the propositional story they would presumably join everyone else in telling about the contents of claims like (1) and (2). But whatever story they tell about the content of (3), it is unclear how it could apply coherently to the antecedent of (4) as well. Take Ayer, for instance. According to Ayer, claim (3) is semantically no different from

(3’)      Lying!!

“where the shape and thickness of the exclamation marks show, by a suitable convention, that a special sort of moral disapproval is the feeling which is being expressed” (Ayer (1946)1952, p.107). Ayer believed that speakers of claims like (3) are not engaged in acts of description, but rather acts of expressing their non-cognitive attitudes toward various things. This is how Ayer’s theory treats the contents of ethical claims when they are asserted. Now, absent some independently compelling reason for thinking that “the Frege point” should not apply here, the same analysis ought to be given to the antecedent of (4). But the same analysis cannot be given to the antecedent of (4). For, just as a speaker can sincerely and coherently utter (2) without believing that it is snowing, a speaker can sincerely and coherently utter (4) without disapproving of lying. So whatever Ayer has to say about the content of the antecedent of (4), it cannot be that it consists in the expression of “a special sort of moral disapproval,” since a speaker of (4) does not express disapproval of lying. Apparently, then, he is committed to saying, counter-intuitively, that the contents of (3) and the antecedent of (4) are different.

As Geach poses it, the problem for the ethical non-cognitivist at this point is actually two-fold (see especially Geach 1965: 462-465). First, the non-cognitivist must explain how ethical claims are able to function as premises in logical inferences in the first place, if they do not express propositions. Traditionally, inference in logic is thought to be a matter of the truth-conditional relations that hold between propositions, and logical connectives like “and”, “or”, and “if-then” are thought to be truth-preserving functions from propositions to propositions. But as we have already seen, ethical non-cognitivists deny that ethical claims are even in the business of expressing propositions. So how, Geach wonders, are we apparently able to infer

(5)        Therefore, getting your little brother to lie is wrong

from (3) and (4), if the content of (3) is nothing more than an attitude of disapproval toward lying?  Or consider:

(6)        Lying is wrong or it isn’t.

Claim (6) can be inferred from (3) by a familiar logical principle, and in non-ethical contexts, we account for this by explaining how disjunction relates two or more propositions. But how can someone who denies that (3) expresses a proposition explain the relationship between (3) and (6)? The second part of the problem, related to the first, is that the non-cognitivist must explain why the inference from (3) and (4) to (5), for instance, is a valid one. As any introductory logic student knows well, the validity of modus ponens depends upon the minor premise and the antecedent of the major premise having the same content. Otherwise, the argument equivocates, and the inference is invalid. But as we just saw, on the theories of non-cognitivists like Ayer, claim (3) and the antecedent of (4) apparently do not have the same content. So Ayer seems committed to saying that what appears to be a straightforward instance of modus ponens is in fact an invalid argument. This is the so-called Frege-Geach Problem for non-cognitivism as Geach originally put it.

In response to an argument very much like Geach’s (see Searle 1962), Hare appears to give non-cognitivists a “way out” of the Frege-Geach Problem (Hare 1970). As Hare sees it, the matter ultimately comes down to whether or not the non-cognitivist can adequately account for the compositionality of language, that is, the way the meanings of complex sentences are composed of the meanings of their simpler parts. As has already been noted, linguists and philosophers of language have traditionally done this by telling a story about propositions and the various relations that may hold between them—the meaning of (2), for instance, is composed of (a) the proposition that it is snowing, (b) the proposition that the kids will want to play outside, and (c) the conditional function “if-then”. The challenge for the non-cognitivist is simply to find another way to account for compositionality—though, it turns out, this is no simple matter.

Hare’s own proposal was to think of the meanings of ethical claims in terms of the sorts of acts for which they are suited and not in terms of propositions or mental states. The claim “Lying is wrong,” for instance, is especially suited for a particular sort of act, namely, the act of condemning lying. Thinking of the meanings of ethical claims in this way allows Hare and other non-cognitivists to effectively concede “the Frege point,” since suitability for an act is something wholly independent of whether a claim is being asserted or not. It allows them, for instance, to say that the content of (3) is the same as the content of the antecedent of (4), which, we saw, was a problem for theories like Ayer’s. From here, accounting for the meanings of complex ethical claims, like (4) and (6), is a matter of conceiving logical connectives not as functions from propositions to propositions, but rather as functions from speech acts to speech acts. If non-cognitivists could do something like this, that is, draw up a kind of “logic of speech acts”, then they would apparently have the resources for meeting both of Geach’s challenges. They could explain how ethical claims can function as premises in logical inferences, and they could explain why some of those inferences, and not others, are valid. Unfortunately, Hare himself stopped short of working out such a logic, but his 1970 paper would nonetheless pave the way for future expressivist theories and their own responses to the Frege-Geach Problem.

3. The Expressivist Turn

Earlier, it was noted that the difference between non-cognitivism and expressivism is both historical and substantive. To repeat, ethical non-cognitivists were united in affirming the negative semantic thesis that ethical claims do not get their meanings from truth-evaluable propositions, as in semantic non-factualism. But as we have already seen with Hare, the Frege-Geach Problem pressures non-cognitivists to say something more than this, in order to account for the meanings of both simple and complex ethical claims, and to explain how some ethical claims can be inferred from others.

Contemporary ethical expressivists respond to this pressure by doing just that: while still affirming the semantic non-factualism of their non-cognitivist ancestors, expressivists nowadays add to this the thesis that was earlier called semantic ideationalism. That is, they think that the meanings of ethical claims are constituted not by propositions, but by the very non-cognitive mental states that they have long been thought to express. In other words, if non-cognitivists “removed” propositions from the contents of ethical claims, then expressivists “replace” those propositions with mental states, or “ideas”—hence, ideationalism. It is this move, made primarily in response to the Frege-Geach Problem, and by following Hare’s lead, that constitutes the historical turn from ethical non-cognitivism to ethical expressivism. Both non-cognitivists and expressivists believe that ethical claims express non-cognitive attitudes, but expressivists are distinguished in thinking of the expression relation itself as a semantic one.

Ethical expressivism is often contrasted with another theory of the meanings of ethical claims according to which those meanings are closely related with speaker’s non-cognitive states of mind, namely, ethical subjectivism. Ethical subjectivism can be understood as the view that the meanings of ethical claims are propositions, but propositions about speakers’ attitudes. So whatever the relationship between claim (1) above and the proposition that it is snowing, the same relationship holds between claim (3) and the proposition that I (the speaker) disapprove of lying. So ethical subjectivists can also, with expressivists, say that ethical claims mean what they do in virtue of the non-cognitive states that they express. But whereas the expressivist accounts for this in terms of the way the claim itself directly expresses the relevant state, the subjectivist accounts for it in terms of the speaker indirectly expressing the relevant state by expressing a proposition that refers to it.

The contrast between expressivism and subjectivism is important not only for the purpose of understanding what expressivism is, but also for seeing a significant advantage that it is supposed to have over subjectivism. Suppose Jones and Smith are engaged in a debate about the wrongness of lying, with Jones claiming that it is wrong, and Smith claiming that it is not wrong.  Presumably, for this to count as a genuine disagreement, it must be the case that their claims have incompatible contents. But according to subjectivism, the contents of their claims, respectively, are the propositions that I (Jones) disapprove of lying and that I (Smith) do not disapprove of lying. Clearly, though, these two propositions are perfectly compatible with each other. Where, then, where is the disagreement? This is often thought to be a particularly devastating problem for ethical subjectivism, that is, it cannot adequately account for genuine moral disagreement, but it is apparently not a problem for expressivists. According to expressivism, the disagreement is simply a matter of Jones and Smith directly expressing incompatible states of mind.  This is one of the advantages of supposing that the semantic contents of ethical claims just are mental states, and not propositions about mental states.

Now, recall the two motivations that first led people to accept ethical non-cognitivism. The first was a desire to avoid any ontological commitment to “spooky,” irreducibly normative properties. Moral realists, roughly speaking, are those who believe that properties like goodness and wrongness have every bit the ontological status as other, less controversial properties, like roundness and solidity, that is, moral properties are no less “real” than non-moral properties. But especially for those philosophers committed to a thoroughgoing metaphysical naturalism, it is hard to see how things like goodness and wrongness could have such a status. Especially when it is noted, as Mackie famously does, that moral properties as realists typically conceive them are somehow supposed to have a kind of built-in capacity to motivate those who apprehend them, to say nothing of how they are supposed to be apprehended, a capacity apparently not had by any other property (see Mackie 1977, p.38-42). Ethical expressivists avoid this problem by denying that people who make ethical claims are even engaged in the task of ascribing moral properties to things in the first place. Ontologically speaking, expressivism demands little more of the world than people’s attitudes and the speakers who express them, and so, it nicely satisfies the first of the two non-cognitivist desiderata.

The second desideratum was a desire to accommodate an apparently very close connection between ethical claims and motivation. In simple terms, motivational internalism is the view that a necessary condition for moral judgment is that the speaker be motivated to act accordingly. In other words, if Jones judges that lying is wrong, but has no motivation whatsoever to refrain from lying, or to condemn those who lie, or whatever, then internalists will typically say that Jones must not really judge lying to be wrong. Even if motivational internalism is false, though, it is surely right that we expect people’s ethical claims to be accompanied by motivations to act in certain ways; and when people who make ethical claims seem not to be motivated to act in these ways, we often assume either that they are being insincere or that something else has gone wrong. Sincere ethical claims just seem to “come with” corresponding motivations. Here, too, expressivism seems well suited to account for this feature of ethical claims, since they take ethical claims to directly express non-cognitive states of mind, for example, desires, emotions, attitudes, commitments, and these states are either capable of motivating by themselves, or at least closely tied to motivation. So while ethical expressivists distinguish themselves from earlier non-cognitivists by accepting the thesis of semantic ideationalism, they are no less capable of accommodating the very same considerations that motivated non-cognitivism in the first place.

Finally, return to the Frege-Geach Problem. As we saw in the previous section, Geach originally posed it as a kind of logical problem for non-cognitivists: by denying that claims in the relevant area of discourse express propositions, non-cognitivists take on the burden of explaining how such claims can be involved in logical inference, and why some such inferences are valid and others invalid. Hare took a first step toward meeting this challenge by proposing that we understand the contents of ethical claims in terms of speech acts, and then work out a kind of “logic” of speech acts. Contemporary expressivists, since they understand the contents of ethical claims not in terms of speech acts but in terms of mental states, are committed to doing something similar with whatever non-cognitive states they think are expressed by these claims. In other words, as it is sometimes put, expressivists owe us a kind of “logic of attitudes.”

Here, again, is our test case:

(3)        Lying is wrong.

(4)        If lying is wrong, then getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

(5)        Therefore, getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

If the meanings of (3), (4), and (5) are to be understood solely in terms of mental states, and not in terms of propositions, how is it that we can infer (5) from (3) and (4)? And why is the inference valid?

In some of his earlier work on this, Blackburn (1984) answers these questions by suggesting that complex ethical claims like (4) express higher-order non-cognitive states, in this case, something like a commitment to disapproving of getting one’s little brother to lie upon disapproving of lying. If someone sincerely disapproves of lying, and is also committed to disapproving of getting her little brother to lie as long as she disapproves of lying—the two states expressed by (3) and (4), respectively—then she thereby commits herself to disapproving of getting her little brother to lie. This is one sense in which (5) might “follow from” (3) and (4), even if it is not exactly the entailment relation with which we are all familiar from introductory logic.

Furthermore, a familiar way to account for the validity of inferences like (3)-(5) is by saying that it is impossible for the premises to be true and for the conclusion to be false. But if the expressivist takes something like the approach under consideration here, he will presumably have to say something different, since it is certainly possible for someone to hold both of the attitudes expressed by (3) and (4) without also holding the attitude expressed by (5). So for instance, the expressivist might say something like this: while a person certainly can hold the attitudes expressed by (3) and (4) without also holding the attitude expressed by (5), such a person would nonetheless exhibit a kind of inconsistency in her attitudes—she would have what Blackburn calls a “fractured sensibility” (1984: 195). It is this inconsistency that might explain why the move from (3) and (4) to (5) is “valid,” provided that we allow for this alternative sense of validity. Recall, that this is essentially the same sort of inconsistency of attitudes that Hare thought underlies our intuitions about moral supervenience.

This is just one way in which expressivists might attempt to solve the Frege-Geach Problem.  Others have attempted different sorts of “logics of attitudes,” with mixed results. In early twenty-first century discourse, the debate about whether such a thing as a “logic of attitudes” is even possible—and if so, what it should look like—is ongoing.

4. The Continuity Problem

Even if expressivists can solve, or at least avoid, the Frege-Geach Problem as Geach originally posed it, there is a deeper problem that they face, a kind of “problem behind the problem”, and that will be the subject of this section. To get a sense of the problem, consider that expressivists have taken a position that effectively pulls them in two opposing directions. On the one hand, since the earliest days of non-cognitivism, philosophers in the expressivist tradition have wanted to draw some sort of sharp contrast between claims in the relevant area of discourse and claims outside of that area of discourse, that is, between ethical and non-ethical claims. But on the other hand, and this is the deeper issue that one might think lies behind the Frege-Geach Problem, ethical claims seem to behave in all sorts of logical and semantic contexts just like their non-ethical counterparts. Ethical claims are apparently no different from non-ethical claims in being (a) embeddable into unasserted contexts, like disjunctions and the antecedents of conditionals, (b) involved in logical inferences, (c) posed as questions, (d) translated across different languages, (e) negated, (f) supported with reasons, and (g) used to articulate the objects of various states of mind, for example, we can say that Jones believes that lying is wrong, Anderson regrets that lying is wrong, and Black wonders whether lying is wrong, to name just a few. It is in accounting for the many apparent continuities between ethical and non-ethical claims that expressivists run into serious problems. So call the general problem here the Continuity Problem for expressivism.

One very significant step that expressivists have taken in order to solve the Continuity Problem is to expand their semantic ideationalism to apply to claims of all sorts, and not just to claims in the relevant area of discourse. So, in the same way that ethical claims get their meanings from non-cognitive mental states, non-ethical claims get their meanings from whatever states of mind they express. In other words, expressivists attempt to solve the Continuity Problem by swapping their “local” semantic ideationalism, that is, ideationalism specifically with respect to claims in the discourse of concern, for a more “global” ideationalist semantics intended to apply to claims in all areas of discourse. This is remarkable, as it represents a wholesale departure from the more traditional propositionalist semantics according to which sentences mean what they do in virtue of the propositions they express. Recall the earlier claims:

(1)        It is snowing.

(3)        Lying is wrong.

According to most contemporary expressivists, the meanings of both (1) and (3) are to be understood in terms of the mental states they express.  Claim (3) expresses something like disapproval of lying, and claim (1) expresses the belief that it is snowing, as opposed to the proposition that it is snowing. So even if ethical and non-ethical claims express different kinds of states, their meanings are nonetheless accounted for in the same way, that is, in terms of whatever mental states the relevant claims are supposed to express.

If nothing else, this promises to be an important first step toward solving the Continuity Problem. But taking this step, from local to global semantic ideationalism, may prove to be more trouble than it is worth, as it appears to raise all sorts of other problems a few of which we shall consider here under the general banner of the Continuity Problem.

a. A Puzzle about Negation

Keeping in mind that expressivism now appears to hinge upon it being the case that an ideationalist approach to semantics can account for all of the same logical and linguistic phenomena that the more traditional propositional or truth-conditional approaches to semantics can account for, consider a simple case of negation:

(1)        It is snowing.

(7)        It is not snowing.

On an ideationalist approach to meaning, (1) gets its meaning from the belief that it is snowing, and (7) gets its meaning from either the belief that it is not snowing, or perhaps a state of disbelief that it is snowing, assuming, for now, that a state of disbelief is something different from a mere lack of belief. A claim and its negation ought to have incompatible contents, and this is apparently how an ideationalist would account for the incompatibility of (1) and (7). But now consider a case of an ethical claim and its negation:

(3)        Lying is wrong.

(8)        Lying is not wrong.

We saw these claims earlier, in Section 3, when discussing how expressivists are supposed to be able to account for genuine moral disagreement in a way better than ethical subjectivists.  Basically, expressivists account for such disagreement by supposing that a speaker of (3) and a speaker of (8) express incompatible mental states, as is the case with (1) and (7).  But if the incompatible states in the case of (1) and (7) are states of belief that p and belief that not-p (or belief and disbelief), what are the incompatible states in this case?

The non-cognitive mental state expressed by (3) is presumably something like disapproval of lying. So what is the non-cognitive state that is expressed by (8)? On the face of it, this seems like it should be an easy question to answer, but upon reflection, it turns out to be really quite puzzling. Whatever is expressed by (8), it should be something that is independently plausible as the content of such a claim, and it should be something that is somehow incompatible with the state expressed by (3). But what is it?

To see why this is puzzling, consider the following three sentences (adapted from Unwin 1999 and 2001):

(9)        Jones does not think that lying is wrong.

(10)      Jones thinks that not lying is wrong.

(11)      Jones thinks that lying is not wrong.

These three sentences say three importantly different things about Jones. Furthermore, it seems as if the state attributed to Jones in (11) should be the very same state as the one expressed by (8) above. But again, what is that state?  Let us proceed by process of elimination. It cannot be that (11) attributes to Jones a state of approval, that is, approving of lying. Presumably, for Jones to approve of lying would be for Jones to think that lying is right, or good. But that is not what (11) says; it says only that he thinks lying is not wrong. Nor can (11) attribute to Jones a lack of disapproval of lying, since that is what is attributed in (9), and as we’ve already agreed, (9) and (11) tell us different things about Jones. Moreover, (11) also cannot attribute to Jones the state of disapproval of not lying, since that is the state being attributed in (10). But at this point, it is hard to see what mental state is left to be attributed to Jones in (11), and to be the content of (8).

The expressivist does not want to say that (3) and (8) express incompatible beliefs, or states of belief and disbelief, as with (1) and (7), since beliefs are cognitive states, and we know that expressivists are psychological non-cognitivists. If (3) and (8) express beliefs, and we share with Hume the idea that beliefs by themselves are incapable of motivating, then we will apparently not have the resources for explaining the close connection between people sincerely making one of these claims and their being motivated to act accordingly. Nor does the expressivist want to say that (3) and (8) express inconsistent propositions, since that would be to abandon her semantic non-factualism. Propositions are often thought to determine truth conditions, and truth conditions are often thought to be ways the world might be. So to allow that (3) and (8) express propositions would presumably be to allow that there is a way the world might be that would make it true that lying is wrong. Furthermore, accounting for this would involve the expressivist in precisely the sort of moral metaphysical inquiries she seeks to avoid. For these reasons, it is crucial for the expressivist to find a non-cognitive mental state to be the content of (8). It must be something incompatible with the state expressed by (3), and it must be a plausible candidate for the state attributed to Jones in (11). But as we have seen, it is very difficult to articulate just what state it is.

Expressivists must show us that, even after accepting global semantic ideationalism, we are still able to account for all of the same phenomena as those accounted for by traditional propositional approaches to meaning. But here it seems they struggle even with something as simple as negation. Further, until they provide a satisfactory explanation of the contents of negated ethical claims, it will remain unclear whether they really do have a better account of moral disagreement than ethical subjectivists, as has long been claimed.

b. Making Sense of Attitude Ascriptions

Earlier, it was noted that ethical claims are no different from non-ethical claims in being able to articulate the objects of various states of mind. Let us now look closer at why expressivists may have a problem accounting for this particular point of continuity between ethical and non-ethical discourse.

(12)      Frank fears that it is snowing.

(13)      Wanda wonders whether it is snowing.

(14)      Haddie hates that it is snowing.

Claims (12)-(14) ascribe three different attitudes to Frank, Wanda, and Haddie. Clearly, however, these three attitudes have something in common, something that can be represented by the claim from earlier

(1)        It is snowing.

Traditionally, the way that philosophers of mind and language have accounted for this is by saying that (1) expresses the proposition that it is snowing, and that what all three of the attitudes ascribed to Frank, Wanda, and Haddie have in common is that they are all directed at one and the same proposition, that is, they all have the same proposition as their object.

By abandoning traditional propositional semantics, though, expressivists take on the burden of finding some other way of explaining how the contents of expressions like “fears that”, “wonders whether”, and “hates that” are supposed to relate to the content of whatever follows them. If the content of (1) is supposed to be something like the belief that it is snowing, as ideationalists suppose, and (1) is also supposed to be able to articulate the object of Frank’s fear, then the expressivist is apparently committed to thinking that Frank’s fear is actually directed at the belief that it is snowing. But, of course, Frank is not afraid of the belief that it is snowing—he is not afraid to believe that it is snowing—rather, he is afraid that it is snowing.

Things are no less problematic in the ethical case. For consider:

(15)      Frank fears that lying is wrong.

(16)      Wanda wonders whether lying is wrong.

(17)      Haddie hates that lying is wrong.

Here again, it seems right to say that the attitudes ascribed in (15)-(17) all share something in common, something that can be represented by the claim from earlier

(3)        Lying is wrong.

But if it is denied that (3) expresses a proposition, as ethical expressivists and non-cognitivists always have, it becomes unclear how (3) could be used to articulate the object of those attitudes.  Focus upon (15) for a moment. Now, what are the contents of ‘fears that’ and ‘lying is wrong’, such that the latter is the object of the former? We presumably have one answer already, from the expressivist: the content of ‘lying is wrong’ in (15), like the content of (3), is an attitude of disapproval toward lying. However, on the plausible assumption that the content of “fears that” is an attitude of fear toward the content of whatever follows, we apparently get the expressivist saying that (15) ascribes to Frank a fear of disapproval of lying, or a fear of disapproving of lying. But surely that is not what (15) ascribes to Frank. He may fear these other things as well, but (15) says only that he fears that lying is wrong.

The expressivist may try to avoid this puzzle by insisting that “lying is wrong” as it appears in (15) has a content that is different from the content of (3), but this still leaves us wondering what the meanings of claims like (15)-(17) are supposed to be, according to the expressivist’s ideationalist semantics. As Schroeder explains, expressivists “owe an account of the meaning of each and every attitude verb, for example, fears that, wonders whether, and so on; just as much as they owe an account of “not”, “and”, and “if … then”. Very little progress has yet been made on how non-cognitivists [or expressivists] can treat attitude verbs, and the prospects for further progress look dim” (Schroeder 2008d, p.716).

c. Saving the Differences

One might think that a simple way to defeat any non-factualist account of ethical claims is simply to point out that we can coherently embed ethical claims into truth claims. It makes perfect sense, for instance, for someone to say, “It is true that lying is wrong.” Presumably, however, this could only make sense if whatever follows “It is true that” is the sort of thing that can be true. Of course, propositions are among the sorts of things that can be true, in fact, this is often thought to be their distinguishing characteristic. But non-factualists deny that ethical claims express propositions. So how do they account for the fact that the truth-predicate seems to apply just as well to ethical claims as it does to non-ethical claims?

If this were a devastating problem for non-cognitivists, then the non-cognitivist tradition in ethics would not have lasted for very long, since philosophers were well aware of the matter soon after Ayer first published Language, Truth, and Logic in 1936. The thought then—essentially just an application of Ramsey’s (1927) famous redundancy theory of truth—was that, in at least some cases, the truth-predicate does not actually ascribe some metaphysically robust property being true to whatever it is being predicated of. Rather, to add the truth-predicate to a claim is to do nothing more than to simply assert the claim by itself. In claiming that “It is true that lying is wrong,” on this view, a speaker expresses the very same state that is expressed by claiming only that “Lying is wrong,” and nothing more; hence, the “redundancy” of the truth predicate.

In early twenty-first century discourse, theories like Ramsey’s are referred to as deflationary or minimalist theories of truth, since they effectively “deflate” or “minimize” the ontological significance of the truth-predicate. Some ethical expressivists, in part as a way of solving the Continuity Problem, have taken to supplementing their expressivism with deflationism. The basic idea goes something like this: if we accept a deflationary theory of truth across the board, we can apparently say that ethical claims are truth-apt, in fact, every bit as truth-apt as any other sort of claim. This allows the expressivist to avoid simple versions of the objection noted at the beginning of this section.  Interestingly, the deflationism need not stop with the truth-predicate. We might also deflate the notion of a proposition by insisting that a proposition is just whatever is expressed by a truth-apt claim. As long as we allow that ethical claims are truth-apt, in some deflationary sense, we may now be able to say, for instance, that

(3)        Lying is wrong

expresses the proposition that lying is wrong, after all. If this is allowed, then the expressivist may now have the resources for accounting for the compositionality of ethical discourse in basically the same way in which traditional propositional semanticists would do so. The meanings of complex ethical claims are to be understood in terms of the propositions expressed by their parts. Once the notion of a proposition is deflated, we might just as well deflate the notion of belief by saying something to the effect that all it is for one to believe that p is for one to accept a claim that expresses the proposition that p. In these ways, perhaps an expressivist can “earn the right” to talk of truth, propositions, and beliefs, and perhaps also knowledge, in the ethical domain, just as they do in non-ethical domains.

This is the essence of Blackburn’s brand of expressivism, known commonly nowadays as ‘quasi-realism’. As we saw earlier, moral realists are those who believe that moral properties have every bit the ontological status as other, less controversial properties, like roundness and solidity. This allows realists to account for things like truth, propositions, beliefs, and knowledge in the ethical domain in precisely the same way that we ordinarily do in other domains, such as those that include facts about roundness and solidity. By deflating the relevant notions, however, Blackburn and other moral non-realists are nonetheless supposed to be able to say all the things that realists say about moral truth, and the like; hence, “quasi”-realism.

There are at least two problems for ethical expressivists who take this approach to solving the Continuity Problem. The first is simply that deflationism is independently a very controversial view. In his own defense of a deflationary theory of truth, Paul Horwich addresses no fewer than thirty-nine “alleged difficulties” faced by such a theory (Horwich 1998). Granted, he apparently believes that all of these difficulties can be addressed with some degree of satisfaction, but few will deny that deflationary theories of truth represent a departure from the common assumption that truth is a real property of things, and that this property consists in something like a thing’s corresponding with reality. Deflationism may help expressivists avoid the Continuity Problem, but at the cost of then burdening them to defend deflationism against its many problems.

A second and more interesting problem, though, is that taking this deflationary route may, in the end, ruin what was supposed to be so unique about expressivism all along. In other words, there is a sense in which deflationism may too good a response to the Continuity Problem. After all, at the core of ethical expressivism is the belief that there is some significant difference between ethical and non-ethical discourse. Recall again our two basic instances of each:

(1)        It is snowing.

(3)        Lying is wrong.

As we just saw, once deflationism is allowed to run its course, we end up saying remarkably similar things about (1) and (3). Both are truth-apt; both express propositions; both can be the objects of belief; both can be known; and so forth. But now you may be wondering: what, then, is supposed to be the significant difference that sets (3) apart from (1)? Or, another way of putting it: what would be the point of contention between an expressivist and her opponents if both parties agreed to deflate such notions as truth, proposition, and belief? This has sometimes been called the problem of “saving the differences” between ethical and non-ethical discourse.

One response to this problem might be to say that the relevant differences between ethical and non-ethical discourse actually occur at a level below the surface of the two linguistic domains. Recall that we deflated the notion of belief by saying that to believe that p is just to accept a claim that expresses the proposition that p. Using these terms, the expressivist might say that the main difference between (1) and (3) is a matter of what is involved in “accepting” the two claims. Accepting an ethical claim like (3) is something importantly different from accepting a non-ethical claim like (1), and presumably the difference has something to do with the types of mental states involved in doing so.  Whether or not this sort of response will work is the subject of an ongoing debate in early twenty-first century philosophical literature.

5. Recent Trends

While the Continuity Problem remains a lively point, or collection of points, of debate between expressivists and their critics, it is certainly not the only topic with which those involved in the literature are currently occupied. Here we review a few other recent trends in expressivist thought, perhaps the most notable among them being the advent of so-called “hybrid” expressivist theories.

a. Expressivists’ Attitude Problem

There are some who would say that the Continuity Problem just is the Frege-Geach Problem, that is, that the Frege-Geach Problem ought to be understood very broadly, so as to include all of the many issues associated with the apparent logical and semantic continuities between ethical and non-ethical discourse. Even so, ethical expressivism faces other problems as well. Let us now look briefly at an issue that is receiving more and more attention these days—the so-called Moral Attitude Problem for ethical expressivism.

Recall again that expressivists often claim to have a better way of accounting for the nature of moral disagreement than the account on offer from ethical subjectivists. The idea, according to the expressivist, is supposed to be that a moral disagreement is ultimately just a disagreement in non-cognitive attitudes. Rather than expressing propositions about their opposing attitudes—which, we saw earlier, would be perfectly compatible with each other—the two disagreeing parties directly express those opposing non-cognitive attitudes. But then, in our discussion of the puzzle about negation, we saw that the expressivist may actually owe us more than this. Specifically, she owes us an explanation of what, exactly, those opposing attitudes are supposed to be. If Jones claims that lying is wrong, and Smith claims that it is not wrong, then Jones and Smith are engaged in a moral disagreement about lying. The expressivist, presumably, will say that Jones expresses something like disapproval of lying. But then what is the state that is directly expressed by Smith’s claim, such that it is disagrees, or is incompatible, with Jones’ disapproval?

According to the Moral Attitude Problem, the issue actually runs deeper than this, for there are more constraints on the expressivist’s answer than just that the state expressed by Smith be something incompatible with Jones’ disapproval of lying. In fact, Jones’ disapproval of lying may turn out to be no less mysterious than whatever sort of state is supposed to be expressed by Smith. After all, we disapprove of all sorts of things. Suppose that Jones also disapproves of Quentin Tarantino movies, but Smith does not. Presumably, this would not count as a moral disagreement, despite the fact that Jones and Smith are expressing mental states similar to those expressed in their disagreement about lying. So what is it, according to ethical expressivism, that makes the one disagreement, and not the other, a moral disagreement? This is especially puzzling given that expressivists often clarify their view by saying that moral disagreements are more like aesthetic disagreements, like a disagreement over Tarantino films; than they are like disagreements over facts, such as whether or not it is snowing.

So the Moral Attitude Problem, basically, is the problem of specifying the exact type, or types, of attitude expressed by ethical claims, such that someone expressing the relevant state counts as making an ethical claim—as opposed to an aesthetic claim, or something else entirely. Judith Thomson raises something like the Moral Attitude Problem when she writes,

The [ethical expressivist] needs to avail himself of a special kind of approval and disapproval: these have to be moral approval and moral disapproval.  For presumably he does not wish to say that believing Alice ought to do a thing is having toward her doing it the same attitude of approval that I have toward the sound of her splendid new violin. (Thomson 1996, p.110)

And several years later, in a paper entitled “Some Not-Much-Discussed Problems for Non-Cognitivism in Ethics,” Michael Smith raises the same problem:

[Ethical expressivists] insist that it is analytic that when people sincerely make normative claims they thereby express desires or aversions.  But which desires and aversions … , and what special feature do they possess that makes them especially suitable for expression in a normative claim? (Smith 2001, p.107)

But it is only very recently that expressivists and their opponents have begun to give the Moral Attitude Problem the attention that it deserves (see Merli 2008; Kauppinen 2010; Köhler 2013; Miller 2013, pp.39-47, pp.81-87; and Björnsson and McPherson 2014)

What can the expressivist say in response? For starters, expressivists can, and should, point out that the Moral Attitude Problem is not unique to their view. Indeed, those who think that ethical claims express cognitive states, like beliefs—namely, ethical cognitivists—face a very similar challenge: Jones believes both that lying is wrong and that Quentin Tarantino movies are bad, but only one of these counts as a moral belief; what is it, exactly, that distinguishes the moral from the non-moral belief? Cognitivists will say that the one belief has a moral proposition as its content, whereas the other belief does not. But that just pushes the question back a step: what, now, is it that distinguishes the moral from the non-moral proposition? Whether it be a matter of spelling out the difference between moral and non-moral beliefs, or that between moral and non-moral propositions, cognitivists are no less burdened to give an account of the nature of moral thinking than are ethical expressivists.

In fact, Köhler argues that expressivists can actually take what are essentially the same routes in response to the Moral Attitude Problem as those taken by cognitivists. Cognitivists, he thinks, have just two options: they can either (a) characterize the nature of moral thinking by reference to some realm of sui generis moral facts which, when they are the objects of beliefs, make those beliefs moral beliefs, or else (b) do the same, but without positing a realm of sui generis moral facts, and instead identifying moral facts with some set of non-moral facts. Similarly, it seems expressivists have two options: they can either (a) say that “the moral attitude” is some sui generis state of mind, or else (b) insist that “the moral attitude” can be analyzed in terms of non-cognitive mental states with which we are already familiar, like desires and aversions, approval and disapproval, and so forth.

The second of these options for expressivists is certainly the more popular of the two. But according to Köhler, if expressivists are to be successful in taking this approach, they ought to conceive of the identity between “the moral attitude” and other, more familiar non-cognitive states in much the same way that naturalistic moral realists conceive of the identity between moral and non-moral facts—that is, either by insisting that the identity is synthetic a posteriori, as the so-called “Cornell realists” do with moral and non-moral facts, or by insisting that the identity is conceptual, but non-obvious, an approach to conceptual analysis proposed by David Lewis, and recently taken up by a few philosophers from Canberra. Otherwise, if an expressivist is comfortable allowing for a sui generis non-cognitive mental state to hold the place of “the moral attitude,” she should get to work explaining what this state is like. Indeed, Köhler argues that this can be done without violating expressivism’s long-standing commitment to metaphysical naturalism (see Köhler 2013, pp.495-507).

b. Hybrid Theories

Perhaps the most exciting of recent trends in the expressivism literature is the advent of so-called “hybrid” expressivist theories. The idea behind hybrid theories, very basically, is that we might be able to secure all of the advantages of both expressivism and cognitivism by allowing that ethical claims express both non-cognitive and cognitive mental states. Why call them hybrid expressivist views, then, and not hybrid cognitivist views? Recall that the two central theses of ethical expressivism are psychological non-cognitivism—the thesis that ethical claims express mental states that are characteristically non-cognitive—and semantic ideationalism—the thesis that the meanings of ethical claims are to be understood in terms of the mental states that they express. Since neither of these theses state that ethical claims express only non-cognitive states, the hybrid theorist can affirm both of them whole-heartedly. For that reason, hybrid theories are generally considered to be forms of expressivism.

The idea that a single claim might express two distinct mental states is not a new one. Philosophers of language have long thought, for instance, that slurs and pejoratives are capable of doing this. Consider the term “yankee” as used by people living in the American South. In most cases, among Southerners, to call someone a “yankee” is to express a certain sort of negative attitude toward the person. But importantly, the term “yankee” cannot apply to just anyone, rather, it applies only to people who are from the North. Acordingly, when native Southerner Roy says, “Did you hear?  Molly’s dating a yankee!” he expresses both (a) a belief that Molly’s partner is from the North, and (b) a negative attitude toward Molly’s partner. It seems we need to suppose that Roy has and expresses both of these states—one cognitive, the other non-cognitive—in order to make adequate sense of the meaning of his claim. In much the same way, hybrid theorists in metaethics suggest that ethical claims can express both beliefs and attitudes. Indeed, these philosophers often model their theories on an analogy to the nature of slurs and pejoratives (see Hay 2013).

Even within the expressivist tradition, the language of hybridity may be new, but the basic idea is not. Recall from earlier that Hare believed ethical claims have two sorts of meaning: descriptive meaning and prescriptive meaning. To claim that something is “good,” he thinks, is to both (a) say or imply that it has some context-specific set of non-moral properties; this is the claim’s descriptive meaning, and (b) commend the thing in virtue of these properties; this is the claim’s prescriptive meaning. This is not far off from a hybrid view according to which “good”-claims express both (a) a belief that something has some property or properties, and (b) a positive non-cognitive attitude toward the thing. Hare was apparently ahead of his time in this respect. The hybrid movement as it is now known is less than a decade old.

One of the earliest notable hybrid views is Ridge’s “ecumenical expressivism” (see Ridge 2006 and 2007). In its initial form, ecumenical expressivism is the view that ethical claims express two closely related mental states—one a belief, and the other a non-cognitive state like approval or disapproval. Furthermore, as an instance of semantic ideationalism, ecumenical expressivism adds that the literal meanings, or semantic contents, of ethical claims are to be understood solely in terms of these mental states. So, for example, the claim

(3)        Lying is wrong

expresses something like these two states: (a) disapproval of things that have a certain property F, and (b) a belief that lying has property F. Notably, the view allows for a kind of subjectivity to moral judgment, since the nature of property F will differ from person to person. A utilitarian, for instance, might disapprove of behavior that fails to maximize utility; a Kantian might instead disapprove of behavior that disrespects people’s autonomy; and so on and so forth. Furthermore, Ridge’s view is supposed to be able to solve the Frege-Geach Problem by conceiving of logical inference and validity in terms of the relationships that obtain among beliefs.

(4)        If lying is wrong, then getting your little brother to lie is wrong.

According to ecumenical expressivism, complex ethical claims like (4) also express two states: (a) disapproval of things that have a certain property F, and (b) the complex belief that if lying has property F, then getting one’s little brother to lie has property F as well. Coupled with an account of logical validity understood in terms of consistency of beliefs, this looks like a promising way to satisfy Geach’s two challenges. (Ridge has since updated his view so that it is no longer a semantic theory, but rather a meta-semantic theory. Thus, rather than attempting to assign literal meanings to ethical claims, Ridge means only to explain that in virtue of which ethical claims have the meanings that they do. See Ridge 2014.)

The implicature-style views defended by Copp and Finlay also fall within the hybrid camp (Copp 2001, 2009; Finlay 2004, 2005). Coined by philosopher H. Paul Grice, the term “implicature” refers to a semantic phenomenon in which a speaker means or implies one thing, while saying something else. A popular example is that of the professor who writes, “Alex has good handwriting,” in a letter of recommendation. What the professor says is that Alex has good handwriting, but what the professor means or implies is that Alex is not an especially good student. So the claim “Alex has good handwriting” has both a literal content, that Alex has good handwriting, and an implicated content, that Alex is not an especially good student.

In the same way, Copp and Finlay suggest that ethical claims have both literal and implicated contents. Once again:

(3)        Lying is wrong

According to these implicature-style views, someone who sincerely utters (3) thereby communicates two things. First, she either expresses a belief, or asserts a proposition, to the effect that lying is wrong—this is the claim’s literal content. Second, she implies that she has some sort of non-cognitive attitude toward lying—this is the claim’s implicated content. It is in this way that implicature-style views are supposed to capture the virtues of both cognitivism and expressivism. Where Copp and Finlay disagree is over the matter of what it is in virtue of which the non-cognitive attitude is implicated. According to Copp, it is a matter of linguistic conventions that govern ethical discourse; whereas Finlay thinks it is a matter of the dynamics of ethical conversation. So Copp’s view is an instance of conventional implicature, while Finlay’s is an instance of conversational implicature.

There may be yet another way to “go hybrid” with one’s expressivism. Rather than hybridizing the mental state(s) expressed by ethical claims, one might instead hybridize the very notion of expression itself. This is the route taken by defenders of a view known as ‘ethical neo-expressivism’ (Bar-On and Chrisman 2009; Bar-On, Chrisman, and Sias 2014). Ethical neo-expressivism rests upon two very important distinctions. The first is a distinction between two different kinds of expression. When we say that agents express their mental states and that sentences express propositions, we refer not just to two different instances of expression, but more importantly, to two different kinds expression, which are often conflated by expressivists.  To see how the two kinds of expression come apart, consider:

(18)      It is so great to see you!

(19)      I am so glad to see you!

Intuitively, these two sentences have different semantic contents. Setting aside complicated issues related to indexicality, sentence (18) expresses the proposition that it is so great to see you (the addressee), and sentence (19) expresses the proposition that I (the speaker) am so glad to see you (the addressee). However, these two different sentences might nonetheless function as vehicles for expressing the same mental state, that is, I might express my gladness or joy at seeing a friend by uttering either of them. Indeed, I might also do so by hugging my friend, or even just by smiling. Importantly, the neo-expressivist urges, it is not the speaker who expresses this or that proposition, but the sentences. People cannot express propositions, but sentences can, in virtue of being conventional representations of them. However, it is not the sentences that express gladness or joy, but the speaker. Sentences cannot express mental states; they are just strings of words. But people can certainly express their mental states by performing various acts, some of which involve the utterance of sentences. Call the relation between sentences and propositions semantic-expression, or s-expression; and call the relation between agents and their mental states action-expression, or a-expression.

According to neo-expressivists, most ethical expressivists, including most hybrid theorists, conflate these two senses of expression because they fail to adequately recognize a second distinction. Notice that terms like “claim”, “judgment”, and “statement” are ambiguous: they might refer either to an act or to the product of that act. So the term “ethical claim” might refer either to the act of making an ethical claim, or to the product of this act—which, presumably, is a sentence tokened either in thought or in speech. This distinction between ethical claims understood as acts and ethical claims understood as products maps nicely onto the earlier distinction between a- and s-expression. Understood as acts, ethical claims are different from non-ethical claims in that, when making an ethical claim, a speaker a-expresses some non-cognitive attitude. In this way, neo-expressivists can apparently affirm psychological non-cognitivism, and may also have the resources for “saving the differences” between ethical and non-ethical discourse. On the other hand, understood as products—that is, sentences containing ethical terms—ethical claims are just like non-ethical claims in s-expressing propositions, and not necessarily in the deflationary sense of proposition noted above. By allowing that ethical claims express propositions, the neo-expressivist may have all she needs in order to avoid the Continuity Problem.

Now, according to some, semantic ideationalism is essential to expressivism. Gibbard, for instance, writes, “The term ‘expressivism’ I mean to cover any account of meanings that follow this indirect path: to explain the meaning of a term, explain what states of mind the term can be used to express” (2003, p.7). However, ethical neo-expressivism, as we have just seen, rejects semantic ideationalism in favor of the more traditional propositional approach to meaning. In light of this, one might legitimately wonder whether neo-expressivism ought to count as an expressivist view. But as Bar-On, Chrisman, and Sias (2014) argue, neo-expressivism is perfectly capable of accommodating both of the main motivations of non-cognitivism and expressivism described in Sections 1 and 3—that is, avoiding a commitment to “spooky,” irreducibly normative properties, and accounting for the close connection between sincere ethical claims and motivation.  Besides, as we saw earlier, it looks like the expressivist’s commitment to semantic ideationalism is what got her into trouble with the Continuity Problem in the first place. So even if neo-expressivism represents something of a departure from mainstream expressivist thought, it may nonetheless be a departure worth considering.

c. Recent Work in Empirical Moral Psychology

Expressivists have long recognized that it is possible to make an ethical claim without being in whatever is supposed to be the corresponding non-cognitive mental state. It is possible, for instance, to utter

(3)        Lying is wrong

without, at the same time, disapproving of lying. Maybe the speaker is just reciting a line from a play; or maybe the speaker suffers from a psychological disorder that renders him incapable of ever being in the relevant non-cognitive state, and he is just repeating something that he has heard others say. These are surely possibilities, and expressivists have at times had different things to say about them, and other cases like them. Either way, though, expressivists generally assume that ethical claims are nonetheless tied to non-cognitive states in a way that justifies us in thinking that a speaker of an ethical claim, if she is being sincere, ought to be motivated to act accordingly. This is one of the two main motivations that attract people to theories in the expressivist tradition.

The assumption that sincere ethical claims in ordinary cases are accompanied by non-cognitive states is presumably one that has empirical implications.  If true, for instance, one might expect to find activity in regions of the brain associated with such states as people make ethical claims sincerely. Indeed, this is precisely what researchers in empirical moral psychology have found throughout various studies conducted over the past few decades. From brain scans to behavioral experiments, tests of skin conductance to moral judgment surveys given in disgusting environments, study after study seems to confirm a view that is sometimes called “psychological sentimentalism”—that is, the view that people are prompted to make the ethical claims that they make primarily by their emotional responses to things.

Now, to be sure, the link posited by psychological sentimentalism is a causal one—our emotions cause us to make certain ethical claims—and that is importantly different from the conceptual link that expressivists generally assume exists between non-cognitive states and ethical claims. But expressivists may nonetheless benefit from exploring how recent work in empirical moral psychology can be used to support parts of their view—for example, how it is that the conceptual link is supposed to have come about. If nothing else, expressivists may find significant empirical support for the view, shared by everyone in the tradition since Ayer, that ethical claims are expressions of characteristically non-cognitive states of mind.

6. References and Further Reading

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  • Barker, S. (2006). “Truth and the Expressing in Expressivism.” In Horgan, T. and Timmons, M. (eds.). Metaethics after Moore. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Bar-On, D. and M. Chrisman (2009). “Ethical Neo-Expressivism.” In R. Shafer-Landau (ed.). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 4. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Bar-On, D., M. Chrisman, and J. Sias (2014). “(How) Is Ethical Neo-Expressivism a Hybrid View.” In M. Ridge and G. Fletcher (eds.), Having It Both Ways: Hybrid Theories and Modern Metaethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Björnsson, G. and T. McPherson (2014). “Moral Attitudes for Non-Cognitivists: Solving the Specification Problem,” Mind,
  • Blackburn, S. (1984). Spreading the Word. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Blackburn, S. (1988a). “Attitudes and Contents.” Ethics 98: 501-17.
  • Blackburn, S. (1988b). “Supervenience Revisited.” In G. Sayre-McCord (ed.), Essays on Moral Realism. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Blackburn, S. (1998). Ruling Passions. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Boisvert, D. (2008). “Expressive-Assertivism.” Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 89(2): 169-203.
  • Boyd, R. (1988). “How to Be a Moral Realist.” In G. Sayre-McCord (ed.), Essays on Moral Realism. Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Brink, D. (1989). Moral Realism and the Foundations of Ethics. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Chrisman, M. (2008). “Expressivism, Inferentialism, and Saving the Debate.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 77: 334-358.
  • Chrisman, M. (2012). “Epistemic Expressivism.” Philosophy Compass 7(2): 118-126.
  • Copp, D. (2001). “Realist-Expressivism: A Neglected Option for Moral Realism.” Social Philosophy and Policy 18(2): 1-43.
  • Copp, D. (2009). “Realist-Expressivism and Conventional Implicature.” In Shafer-Landau, R. (ed.). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 4. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Coventry, A. (2006). Hume’s Theory of Causation: A Quasi-Realist Interpretation. London: Continuum.
  • Divers, J. and A. Miller (1994). “Why Expressivists About Value Should Not Love Minimalism About Truth.” Analysis 54: 12-19.
  • Dreier, J. (2004). “Meta-Ethics and the Problem of Creeping Minimalism.” Philosophical Perspectives 18: 23-44.
  • Dreier, J. (2009). “Relativism (and Expressivism) and the Problem of Disagreement.” Philosophical Perspectives 23: 79-110.
  • Finlay, S. (2004). “The Conversational Practicality of Value Judgment.” The Journal of Ethics 8: 205-223.
  • Finlay, S. (2005). “Value and Implicature.” Philosophers’ Imprint 5: 1-20.
  • Geach, P. (1965). “Assertion.” Philosophical Review 74: 449-465.
  • Gert, J. (2002). “Expressivism and Language Learning.” Ethics 112: 292-314.
  • Gibbard, A. (1990). Wise Choices, Apt Feelings. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Gibbard, A. (2003). Thinking How to Live. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Greene, J. D. (2008). “The Secret Joke of Kant’s Soul.” In Walter Sinnott-Armstrong (ed.), Moral Psychology, Vol. 3: The Neuroscience of Morality: Emotion, Brain Disorders, and Development. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, pp. 35-79.
  • Greene, J. D. and J. Haidt (2002). “How (and Where) Does Moral Judgment Work?” Trends in Cognitive Sciences 6: 517-523.
  • Haidt, J. (2001). “The Emotional Dog and Its Rational Tail: A Social Intuitionist Approach to Moral Judgment.” Psychological Review 108(4): 814-834.
  • Hare, R. M. (1952). The Language of Morals. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Hare, R. M. (1970). “Meaning and Speech Acts.” The Philosophical Review 79: 3-24.
  • Hay, Ryan. (2013). “Hybrid Expressivism and the Analogy between Pejoratives and Moral Language.” European Journal of Philosophy 21(3): 450-474.
  • Horwich, P. (1998). Truth. Second Edition. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Jackson, F. (1998). From Metaphysics to Ethics. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Jackson, F. and P. Pettit (1995). “Moral Functionalism and Moral Motivation.” Philosophical Quarterly 45: 20-40.
  • Kauppinen, A. (2010). “What Makes a Sentiment Moral?” In R. Shafer-Landau (ed.), Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 5. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Köhler, S. (2013). “Do Expressivists Have an Attitude Problem?” Ethics 123(3): 479-507.
  • Lewis, D. (1970). “How to Define Theoretical Terms.” Journal of Philosophy 67: 427-446.
  • Lewis, D. (1972). “Psychophysical and Theoretical Identifications.” Australasian Journal of Philosophy 50: 249-258.
  • Mackie, J. L. (1977). Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong. London: Penguin.
  • Merli, D. (2008). “Expressivism and the Limits of Moral Disagreement.” Journal of Ethics 12: 25-55.
  • Miller, A. (2013). Contemporary Metaethics: An Introduction. Second Edition. Cambridge: Polity.
  • Moore, G. E. (1903). Principia Ethica. New York: Cambridge University Press.
  • Nichols, S. (2004). Sentimental Rules: On the Natural Foundations of Moral Judgment. New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Ogden, C. K. and I. A. Richards (1923). The Meaning of Meaning. New York: Harcourt Brace & Jovanovich.
  • Price, H. (2011). “Expressivism for Two Voices.” In J. Knowles and H. Rydenfelt (eds.). Pragmatism, Science, and Naturalism. Peter Lang.
  • Prinz, J. (2006). “The Emotional Basis of Moral Judgments.” Philosophical Explorations 9(1): 29-43.
  • Ramsey, F. P. (1927). “Facts and Propositions.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society 7 (Supplementary): 153-170.
  • Ridge, M. (2006). “Ecumenical Expressivism: Finessing Frege.” Ethics 116: 302-336.
  • Ridge, M. (2007). “Ecumenical Expressivism: The Best of Both Worlds?” In Shafer-Landau, R. (ed.). Oxford Studies in Metaethics, Vol. 2. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Ridge, M. (2014). Impassioned Belief. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Ridge, M. and G. Fletcher, eds. (2014). Having It Both Ways: Hybrid Theories and Modern Metaethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Schroeder, M. (2008a). Being For: Evaluating the Semantic Program of Expressivism. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Schroeder, M. (2008b). “Expression for Expressivists.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 76(1): 86-116.
  • Schroeder, M. (2008c). “How Expressivists Can and Should Solve Their Problem with Negation.” Noûs 42(4): 573-599.
  • Schroeder, M. (2008d). “What is the Frege-Geach Problem?” Philosophy Compass 3(4): 703-720.
  • Schroeder, M. (2009). “Hybrid Expressivism: Virtues and Vices.” Ethics 119(2): 257-309.
  • Searle, J. (1962). “Meaning and Speech Acts.” Philosophical Review 71 (1962): 423-32.
  • Searle, J. (1969). Speech Acts: An Essay in the Philosophy of Language. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Smith, M. (1994a). The Moral Problem. Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Smith, M. (1994b). “Why Expressivists About Value Should Love Minimalism About Truth.” Analysis 54: 1-12.
  • Smith, M. (2001). “Some Not-Much-Discussed Problems for Non-Cognitivism in Ethics.” Ratio 14: 93-115.
  • Stevenson, C. L. (1937). “The Emotive Meaning of Ethical Terms.” Mind 46: 14-31.
  • Stevenson, C. L. (1944). Ethics and Language. New Haven: Yale University Press.
  • Strawson, P. F. (1949). “Truth.” Analysis 9: 83-97.
  • Thomson, J. (1996). “Moral Objectivity.” In G. Harman and J. Thomson, Moral Relativism and Moral Objectivity (Great Debates in Philosophy). Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Unwin, N. (1999). “Quasi-Realism, Negation and the Frege-Geach Problem.” Philosophical Quarterly 49: 337-352.
  • Unwin, N. (2001). “Norms and Negation: A Problem for Gibbard’s Logic.” Philosophical Quarterly 51: 60-75.
  • Yalcin, S. (2012). “Bayesian Expressivism.” Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society CXII(2): 123-160.

Author Information

James Sias
Email: siasj@dickinson.edu
Dickinson College
U. S. A.

Gottfried Leibniz: Philosophy of Mind

LeibnizGottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716) was a true polymath: he made substantial contributions to a host of different fields such as mathematics, law, physics, theology, and most subfields of philosophy.  Within the philosophy of mind, his chief innovations include his rejection of the Cartesian doctrines that all mental states are conscious and that non-human animals lack souls as well as sensation.  Leibniz’s belief that non-rational animals have souls and feelings prompted him to reflect much more thoroughly than many of his predecessors on the mental capacities that distinguish human beings from lower animals.  Relatedly, the acknowledgment of unconscious mental representations and motivations enabled Leibniz to provide a far more sophisticated account of human psychology.  It also led Leibniz to hold that perception—rather than consciousness, as Cartesians assume—is the distinguishing mark of mentality.

The capacities that make human minds superior to animal souls, according to Leibniz, include not only their capacity for more elevated types of perceptions or mental representations, but also their capacity for more elevated types of appetitions or mental tendencies.  Self-consciousness and abstract thought are examples of perceptions that are exclusive to rational souls, while reasoning and the tendency to do what one judges to be best overall are examples of appetitions of which only rational souls are capable.  The mental capacity for acting freely is another feature that sets human beings apart from animals and it in fact presupposes the capacity for elevated kinds of perceptions as well as appetitions.

Another crucial contribution to the philosophy of mind is Leibniz’s frequently cited mill argument.  This argument is supposed to show, through a thought experiment that involves walking into a mill, that material things such as machines or brains cannot possibly have mental states.  Only immaterial things, that is, soul-like entities, are able to think or perceive.  If this argument succeeds, it shows not only that our minds must be immaterial or that we must have souls, but also that we will never be able to construct a computer that can truly think or perceive.

Finally, Leibniz’s doctrine of pre-established harmony also marks an important innovation in the history of the philosophy of mind.  Like occasionalists, Leibniz denies any genuine interaction between body and soul.  He agrees with them that the fact that my foot moves when I decide to move it, as well as the fact that I feel pain when my body gets injured, cannot be explained by a genuine causal influence of my soul on my body, or of my body on my soul.  Yet, unlike occasionalists, Leibniz also rejects the idea that God continually intervenes in order to produce the correspondence between my soul and my body.  That, Leibniz thinks, would be unworthy of God.  Instead, God has created my soul and my body in such a way that they naturally correspond to each other, without any interaction or divine intervention.  My foot moves when I decide to move it because this motion has been programmed into it from the very beginning.  Likewise, I feel pain when my body is injured because this pain was programmed into my soul.  The harmony or correspondence between mental states and states of the body is therefore pre-established.

Table of Contents

  1. Leibnizian Minds and Mental States
    1. Perceptions
      1. Consciousness, Apperception, and Reflection
      2. Abstract Thought, Concepts, and Universal Truths
    2. Appetitions
  2. Freedom
  3. The Mill Argument
  4. The Relation between Mind and Body
  5. References and Further Reading
    1. Primary Sources in English Translation
    2. Secondary Sources

1. Leibnizian Minds and Mental States

Leibniz is a panpsychist: he believes that everything, including plants and inanimate objects, has a mind or something analogous to a mind.  More specifically, he holds that in all things there are simple, immaterial, mind-like substances that perceive the world around them.  Leibniz calls these mind-like substances ‘monads.’  While all monads have perceptions, however, only some of them are aware of what they perceive, that is, only some of them possess sensation or consciousness.  Even fewer monads are capable of self-consciousness and rational perceptions.  Leibniz typically refers to monads that are capable of sensation or consciousness as ‘souls,’ and to those that are also capable of self-consciousness and rational perceptions as ‘minds.’  The monads in plants, for instance, lack all sensation and consciousness and are hence neither souls nor minds; Leibniz sometimes calls this least perfect type of monad a ‘bare monad’ and compares the mental states of such monads to our states when we are in a stupor or a dreamless sleep.  Animals, on the other hand, can sense and be conscious, and thus possess souls (see Animal Minds).  God and the souls of human beings and angels, finally, are examples of minds because they are self-conscious and rational.  As a result, even though there are mind-like things everywhere for Leibniz, minds in the stricter sense are not ubiquitous.

All monads, even those that lack consciousness altogether, have two basic types of mental states: perceptions, that is, representations of the world around them, and appetitions, or tendencies to transition from one representation to another.  Hence, even though monads are similar to the minds or souls described by Descartes in some ways—after all, they are immaterial substances—consciousness is not an essential property of monads, while it is an essential property of Cartesian souls.  For Leibniz, then, the distinguishing mark of mentality is perception, rather than consciousness (see Simmons 2001).  In fact, even Leibnizian minds in the stricter sense, that is, monads capable of self-consciousness and reasoning, are quite different from the minds in Descartes’s system.  While Cartesian minds are conscious of all their mental states, Leibnizian minds are conscious only of a small portion of their states.  To us it may seem obvious that there is a host of unconscious states in our minds, but in the seventeenth century this was a radical and novel notion.  This profound departure from Cartesian psychology allows Leibniz to paint a much more nuanced picture of the human mind.

One crucial aspect of Leibniz’s panpsychism is that in addition to the rational monad that is the soul of a human being, there are non-rational, bare monads everywhere in the human being’s body.  Leibniz sometimes refers to the soul of a human being or animal as the central or dominant monad of the organism.  The bare monads that are in an animal’s body, accordingly, are subordinate to its dominant monad or soul.  Even plants, for Leibniz, have central or dominant monads, but because they lack sensation, these dominant monads cannot strictly speaking be called souls.  They are merely bare monads, like the monads that are subordinate to them.

The claim that there are mind-like things everywhere in nature—in our bodies, in plants, and even in inanimate objects—strikes many readers of Leibniz as ludicrous.  Yet, Leibniz thinks he has conclusive metaphysical arguments for this claim.  Very roughly, he holds that a complex, divisible thing such as a body can only be real if it is made up of parts that are real.  If the parts in turn have parts, those have to be real as well.  The problem is, Leibniz claims, that matter is infinitely divisible: we can never reach parts that do not themselves have parts.  Even if there were material atoms that we cannot actually divide, they must still be spatially extended, like all matter, and therefore have spatial parts.  If something is spatially extended, after all, we can at least in thought distinguish its left half from its right half, no matter how small it is.  As a result, Leibniz thinks, purely material things are not real.  The reality of complex wholes depends on the reality of their parts, but with purely material things, we never get to parts that are real since we never reach an end in this quest for reality.  Leibniz concludes that there must be something in nature that is not material and not divisible, and from which all things derive their reality.  These immaterial, indivisible things just are monads.  Because of the role they play, Leibniz sometimes describes them as “atoms of substance, that is, real unities absolutely destitute of parts, […] the first absolute principles of the composition of things, and, as it were, the final elements in the analysis of substantial things”  (p. 142.  For a more thorough description of monads, see Leibniz: Metaphysics, as well as the Monadology and the New System of Nature, both included in Ariew and Garber.)

a. Perceptions

As already seen, all monads have perceptions, that is, they represent the world around them.  Yet, not all perceptions—not even all the perceptions of minds—are conscious.  In fact, Leibniz holds that at any given time a mind has infinitely many perceptions, but is conscious only of a very small number of them.  Even souls and bare monads have an infinity of perceptions.  This is because Leibniz believes, for reasons that need not concern us here (but see Leibniz: Metaphysics), that each monad constantly perceives the entire universe.  For instance, even though I am not aware of it at all, my mind is currently representing every single grain of sand on Mars.  Even the monads in my little toe, as well as the monads in the apple I am about to eat, represent those grains of sand.

Leibniz often describes perceptions of things of which the subject is unaware and which are far removed from the subject’s body as ‘confused.’  He is fond of using the sound of the ocean as a metaphor for this kind of confusion: when I go to the beach, I do not hear the sound of each individual wave distinctly; instead, I hear a roaring sound from which I am unable to discern the sounds of the individual waves (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 13, in Ariew and Garber, 1989).  None of these individual sounds stands out.  Leibniz claims that confused perceptions in monads are analogous to this confusion of sounds, except of course for the fact that monads do not have to be aware even of the confused whole.  To the extent that a perception does stand out from the rest, however, Leibniz calls it ‘distinct.’  This distinctness comes in degrees, and Leibniz claims that the central monads of organisms always perceive their own bodies more distinctly than they perceive other bodies.

Bare monads are not capable of very distinct perceptions; their perceptual states are always muddled and confused to a high degree.  Animal souls, on the other hand, can have much more distinct perceptions than bare monads.  This is in part because they possess sense organs, such as eyes, which allow them to bundle and condense information about their surroundings (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 4).  The resulting perceptions are so distinct that the animals can remember them later, and Leibniz calls this kind of perception ‘sensation.’  The ability to remember prior perceptions is extremely useful, as a matter of fact, because it enables animals to learn from experience.  For instance, a dog that remembers being beaten with a stick can learn to avoid sticks in the future (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 5, in Ariew and Garber, 1989).  Sensations are also tied to pleasure and pain: when an animal distinctly perceives some imperfection in its body, such as a bruise, this perception just is a feeling of pain.  Similarly, when an animal perceives some perfection of its body, such as nourishment, this perception is pleasure.  Unlike Descartes, then, Leibniz believed that animals are capable of feeling pleasure and pain.

Consequently, souls differ from bare monads in part through the distinctness of their perceptions: unlike bare monads, souls can have perceptions that are distinct enough to give rise to memory and sensation, and they can feel pleasure and pain.  Rational souls, or minds, share these capacities.  Yet they are additionally capable of perceptions of an even higher level.  Unlike the souls of lower animals, they can reflect on their own mental states, think abstractly, and acquire knowledge of necessary truths.  For instance, they are capable of understanding mathematical concepts and proofs.  Moreover, they can think of themselves as substances and subjects: they have the ability to use and understand the word ‘I’ (see Monadology, section 30).  These kinds of perceptions, for Leibniz, are distinctively rational perceptions, and they are exclusive to minds or rational souls.

It is clear, then, that there are different types of perceptions: some are unconscious, some are conscious, and some constitute reflection or abstract thought.  What exactly distinguishes these types of perceptions, however, is a complicated question that warrants a more detailed investigation.

i. Consciousness, Apperception, and Reflection

Why are some perceptions conscious, while others are not?  In one text, Leibniz explains the difference as follows: “it is good to distinguish between perception, which is the internal state of the monad representing external things, and apperception, which is consciousness, or the reflective knowledge of this internal state, something not given to all souls, nor at all times to a given soul” (Principles of Nature and Grace, section 4).  This passage is interesting for several reasons: Leibniz not only equates consciousness with what he calls ‘apperception,’ and states that only some monads possess it.  He also seems to claim that conscious perceptions differ from other perceptions in virtue of having different types of things as their objects: while unconscious perceptions represent external things, apperception or consciousness has perceptions, that is, internal things, as its object.  Consciousness is therefore closely connected to reflection, as the term ‘reflective knowledge’ also makes clear.

The passage furthermore suggests that Leibniz understands consciousness in terms of higher-order mental states because it says that in order to be conscious of a perception, I must possess “reflective knowledge” of that perception.  One way of interpreting this statement is to understand these higher-order mental states as higher-order perceptions: in order to be conscious of a first-order perception, I must additionally possess a second-order perception of that first-order perception.  For example, in order to be conscious of the glass of water in front of me, I must not only perceive the glass of water, but I must also perceive my perception of the glass of water.  After all, in the passage under discussion, Leibniz defines ‘consciousness’ or ‘apperception’ as the reflective knowledge of a perception.  Such higher-order theories of consciousness are still endorsed by some philosophers of mind today (see Consciousness).  For an alternative interpretation of Leibniz’s theory of consciousness, however, see Jorgensen 2009, 2011a, and 2011b).

There is excellent textual evidence that according to Leibniz, consciousness or apperception is not limited to minds, but is instead shared by animal souls.  One passage in which Leibniz explicitly ascribes apperception to animals is from the New Essays: “beasts have no understanding … although they have the faculty for apperceiving the more conspicuous and outstanding impressions—as when a wild boar apperceives someone who is shouting at it” (p. 173).  Moreover, Leibniz sometimes claims that sensation involves apperception (e.g. New Essays p. 161; p. 188), and since animals are clearly capable of sensation, they must thus possess some form of apperception.  Hence, it seems that Leibniz ascribes apperception to animals, which in turn he elsewhere identifies with consciousness.

Yet, the textual evidence for animal consciousness is unfortunately anything but neat because in the New Essays—that is, in the very same text—Leibniz also suggests that there is an important difference between animals and human beings somewhere in this neighborhood.  In several passages, he says that any creature with consciousness has a moral or personal identity, which in turn is something he grants only to minds.  He states, for instance, that “consciousness or the sense of I proves moral or personal identity” (New Essays, p. 236).  Hence, it seems clear that for Leibniz there is something in the vicinity of consciousness that animals lack and that minds possess, and which is crucial for morality.

A promising solution to this interpretive puzzle is the following: what animals lack is not consciousness generally, but only a particular type of consciousness.  More specifically, while they are capable of consciously perceiving external things, they lack awareness, or at least a particular type of awareness, of the self.  In the Monadology, for instance, Leibniz argues that knowledge of necessary truths distinguishes us from animals and that through this knowledge “we rise to reflexive acts, which enable us to think of that which is called ‘I’ and enable us to consider that this or that is in us” (sections 29-30).  Similarly, he writes in the Principles of Nature and Grace that “minds … are capable of performing reflective acts, and capable of considering what is called ‘I’, substance, soul, mind—in brief, immaterial things and immaterial truths” (section 5).  Self-knowledge, or self-consciousness, then, appears to be exclusive to rational souls.  Leibniz moreover connects this consciousness of the self to personhood and moral responsibility in several texts, such as for instance in the Theodicy: “In saying that the soul of man is immortal one implies the subsistence of what makes the identity of the person, something which retains its moral qualities, conserving the consciousness, or the reflective inward feeling, of what it is: thus it is rendered susceptible to chastisement or reward” (section 89).

Based on these passages, it seems that one crucial cognitive difference between human beings and animals is that even though animals possess the kind of apperception that is involved in sensation and in an acute awareness of external objects, they lack a certain type of apperception or consciousness, namely reflective self-knowledge or self-consciousness.  Especially because of the moral implications of this kind of consciousness that Leibniz posits, this difference is clearly an extremely important one.  According to these texts, then, it is not consciousness or apperception tout court that distinguishes minds from animal souls, but rather a particular kind of apperception.  What animals are incapable of, according to Leibniz, is self-knowledge or self-awareness, that is, an awareness not only of their perceptions, but also of the self that is having those perceptions.

Because Leibniz associates consciousness so closely with reflection, one might wonder whether the fact that animals are capable of conscious perceptions implies that they are also capable of reflection.  This is another difficult interpretive question because there appears to be evidence both for a positive and for a negative answer.  Reflection, according to Leibniz, is “nothing but attention to what is within us” (New Essays, p. 51).  Moreover, as already seen, he argues that reflective acts enable us “to think of that which is called ‘I’ and … to consider that this or that is in us” (Monadology, section 30).  Leibniz does not appear to ascribe reflection to animals explicitly, and in fact, there are several texts in which he says in no uncertain terms that they lack reflection altogether.  He states for instance that “the soul of a beast has no more reflection than an atom” (Loemker, p. 588).  Likewise, he defines ‘intellection’ as “a distinct perception combined with a faculty of reflection, which the beasts do not have” (New Essays, p. 173) and explains that “just as there are two sorts of perception, one simple, the other accompanied by reflections that give rise to knowledge and reasoning, so there are two kinds of souls, namely ordinary souls, whose perception is without reflection, and rational souls, which think about what they do” (Strickland, p. 84).

On the other hand, as seen, Leibniz does ascribe apperception or consciousness to animals, and consciousness in turn appears to involve higher-order mental states.  This suggests that Leibnizian animals must perceive or know their own perceptions when they are conscious of something, and that in turn seems to imply that they can reflect after all.  A closely related reason for ascribing reflection to animals is that Leibniz sometimes explicitly associates reflection with apperception or consciousness.  In a passage already quoted above, for instance, Leibniz defines ‘consciousness’ as the reflective knowledge of a first-order perception.  Hence, if animals possess consciousness it seems that they must also have some type of reflection.

We are consequently faced with an interpretive puzzle: even though there is strong indirect evidence that Leibniz attributes reflection to animals, there is also direct evidence against it.  There are at least two ways of solving this puzzle.  In order to make sense of passages in which Leibniz restricts reflection to rational souls, one can either deny that perceiving one’s internal states is sufficient for reflection, or one can distinguish between different types of reflection, in such a way that the most demanding type of reflection is limited to minds.  One good way to deny that perception of one’s internal states is sufficient for reflection is to point out that Leibniz defines reflection as “attention to what is within us” (New Essays, p. 51), rather than as ‘perception of what is within us.’  Attention to internal states, arguably, is more demanding than mere perception of these states, and animals may well be incapable of the former.  Attention might be a particularly distinct perception, for instance.  Alternatively, one can argue that reflection requires a self-concept, or self-knowledge, which also goes beyond the mere perception of internal states and may be inaccessible to animals.  Perceiving my internal states, on that interpretation, amounts to reflection only if I also possess knowledge of the self that is having those states.  Instead of denying that perceiving one’s own states is sufficient for reflection, one can also distinguish different types of reflection and claim that while the mere perception of one’s internal states is a type of reflection, there is a more demanding type of reflection that requires attention, a self-concept, or something similar.  Yet, the difference between those two responses appears to be merely terminological.  Based on the textual evidence discussed above, it is clear that either reflection generally, or at least a particular type of reflection, must be exclusive to minds.

ii. Abstract Thought, Concepts, and Universal Truths

So far, we have seen that one cognitive capacity that elevates minds above animal souls is self-consciousness, which is a particular type of reflection.  Before turning to appetitions, we should briefly investigate three additional, mutually related, cognitive abilities that only minds possess, namely the abilities to abstract, to form or possess concepts, and to know general truths.  In what may well be Leibniz’s most intriguing discussion of abstraction, he says that some non-human animals “apparently recognize whiteness, and observe it in chalk as in snow; but it does not amount to abstraction, which requires attention to the general apart from the particular, and consequently involves knowledge of universal truths which beasts do not possess” (New Essays, p. 142).  In this passage, we learn not only that beasts are incapable of abstraction, but also that abstraction involves “attention to the general apart from the particular” as well as “knowledge of universal truths.”  Hence, abstraction for Leibniz seems to consist in separating out one part of a complex idea and focusing on it exclusively.  Instead of thinking of different white things, one must think of whiteness in general, abstracting away from the particular instances of whiteness.  In order to think about whiteness in the abstract, then, it is not enough to perceive different white things as similar to one another.

Yet, it might still seem mysterious how precisely animals should be able to observe whiteness in different objects if they are unable to abstract.  One fact that makes this less mysterious, however, is that, on Leibniz’s view, while animals are unable to pay attention to whiteness in general, the idea of whiteness may nevertheless play a role in their recognition of whiteness.  As Leibniz explains in the New Essays, even though human minds are aware of complex ideas and particular truths first as well as rather easily, and have to expend a lot of effort to subsequently achieve awareness of simple ideas and general principles, the order of nature is the other way around:

The truths that we start by being aware of are indeed particular ones, just as we start with the coarsest and most composite ideas.  But that doesn’t alter the fact that in the order of nature the simplest comes first, and that the reasons for particular truths rest wholly on the more general ones of which they are mere instances. … The mind relies on these principles constantly; but it does not find it so easy to sort them out and to command a distinct view of each of them separately, for that requires great attention to what it is doing. (p. 83f.)

Here, Leibniz says that minds can rely on general principles, or abstract ideas, without being aware of them, and without having distinct perceptions of them separately.  This might help us to explain how animals can observe whiteness in different white objects without being able to abstract: the simple idea of whiteness might play a role in their cognition, even though they are not aware of it, and are unable to pay attention to this idea.

The passage just quoted is interesting for another reason: It shows that abstracting and achieving knowledge of general truths have a lot in common and presuppose the capacity to reflect.  It takes a special effort of mind to become aware of abstract ideas and general truths, that is, to separate these out from complex ideas and particular truths.  It is this special effort, it seems, of which animals are incapable; while they can at times achieve relatively distinct perceptions of complex or particular things, they lack the ability to pay attention, or at least sufficient attention, to their internal states.  At least part of the reason for their inability to abstract and to know general truths, then, appears to be their inability, or at least very limited ability, to reflect.

Abstraction also seems closely related to the possession or formation of concepts: arguably, what a mind gains when abstracting the idea of whiteness from the complex ideas of particular white things is what we would call a concept of whiteness.  Hence, since animals cannot abstract, they do not possess such concepts.  They may nevertheless, as suggested above, have confused ideas such as a confused idea of whiteness that allows them to recognize whiteness in different white things, without enabling them to pay attention to whiteness in the abstract.

An interesting question that arises in this context is the question whether having an idea of the future or thinking about a future state requires abstraction.  One reason to think so is that, plausibly, in order to think about the future, for instance about future pleasures or pains, one needs to abstract from the present pleasures or pains that one can directly experience, or from past pleasures and pains that one remembers.  After all, just as one can only attain the concept of whiteness by abstracting from other properties of the particular white things one has experienced, so, arguably, one can only acquire the idea of future pleasures through abstraction from particular present pleasures.  It may be for this reason that Leibniz sometimes notes that animals have “neither foresight nor anxiety for the future” (Huggard, p. 414).  Apparently, he does not consider animals capable of having an idea of the future or of future states.

Leibniz thinks that in addition to sensible concepts such as whiteness, we also have concepts that are not derived from the senses, that is, we possess intellectual concepts.  The latter, it seems, set us apart even farther from animals because we attain them through reflective self-awareness, of which animals, as seen above, are not capable.  Leibniz says, for instance, that “being is innate in us—the knowledge of being is comprised in the knowledge that we have of ourselves.  Something like this holds of other general notions” (New Essays, p. 102).  Similarly, he states a few pages later that “reflection enables us to find the idea of substance within ourselves, who are substances” (New Essays, p. 105).  Many similar statements can be found elsewhere.  The intellectual concepts that we can discover in our souls, according to Leibniz, include not only being and substance, but also unity, similarity, sameness, pleasure, cause, perception, action, duration, doubting, willing, and reasoning, to name only a few.  In order to derive these concepts from our reflective self-awareness, we must apparently engage in abstraction: I am distinctly aware of myself as an agent, a substance, and a perceiver, for instance, and from this awareness I can abstract the ideas of action, substance, and perception in general.  This means that animals are inferior to us among other things in the following two ways: they cannot have distinct self-awareness, and they cannot abstract.  They would need both of these capacities in order to form intellectual concepts, and they would need the latter—that is, abstraction—in order to form sensible concepts.

Intellectual concepts are not the only things that minds can find in themselves: in addition, they are also able to discover eternal or general truths there, such as the axioms or principles of logic, metaphysics, ethics, and natural theology.  Like the intellectual concepts just mentioned, these general truths or principles cannot be derived from the senses and can thus be classified as innate ideas.  Leibniz says, for instance,

Above all, we find [in this I and in the understanding] the force of the conclusions of reasoning, which are part of what is called the natural light. … It is also by this natural light that the axioms of mathematics are recognized. … [I]t is generally true that we know [necessary truths] only by this natural light, and not at all by the experiences of the senses. (Ariew and Garber, p. 189)

Axioms and general principles, according to this passage, must come from the mind itself and cannot be acquired through sense experience.  Yet, also as in the case of intellectual concepts, it is not easy for us to discover such general truths or principles in ourselves; instead, it takes effort or special attention.  It again appears to require the kind of attention to what is within us of which animals are not capable.  Because they lack this type of reflection, animals are “governed purely by examples from the senses” and “consequently can never arrive at necessary and general truths” (Strickland p. 84).

b. Appetitions

Monads possess not only perceptions, or representations of the world they inhabit, but also appetitions.  These appetitions are the tendencies or inclinations of these monads to act, that is, to transition from one mental state to another.  The most familiar examples of appetitions are conscious desires, such as my desire to have a drink of water.  Having this desire means that I have some tendency to drink from the glass of water in front of me.  If the desire is strong enough, and if there are no contrary tendencies or desires in my mind that are stronger—for instance, the desire to win the bet that I can refrain from drinking water for one hour—I will attempt to drink the water.  This desire for water is one example of a Leibnizian appetition.  Yet, just as in the case of perceptions, only a very small portion of appetitions is conscious.  We are unaware of most of the tendencies that lead to changes in our perceptions.  For instance, I am aware neither of perceiving my hair growing, nor of my tendencies to have those perceptions.  Moreover, as in the case of perceptions, there are an infinite number of appetitions in any monad at any given time.  This is because, as seen, each monad represents the entire universe.  As a result, each monad constantly transitions from one infinitely complex perceptual state to another, reflecting all changes that take place in the universe.  The tendency that leads to a monad’s transition from one of these infinitely complex perceptual states to another is therefore also infinitely complex, or composed of infinitely many smaller appetitions.

The three types of monads—bare monads, souls, and minds—differ not only with respect to their perceptual or cognitive capacities, but also with respect to their appetitive capacities.  In fact, there are good reasons to think that three different types of appetitions correspond to the three types of perceptions mentioned above, that is, to perception, sensation, and rational perception.  After all, Leibniz distinguishes between appetitions of which we can be aware and those of which we cannot be aware, which he sometimes also calls ‘insensible appetitions’ or ‘insensible inclinations.’  He appears to further divide the type of which we can be aware into rational and non-rational appetitions.  This threefold division is made explicit in a passage from the New Essays:

There are insensible inclinations of which we are not aware.  There are sensible ones: we are acquainted with their existence and their objects, but have no sense of how they are constituted. … Finally there are distinct inclinations which reason gives us: we have a sense both of their strength and of their constitution. (p. 194)

According to this passage, then, Leibniz acknowledges the following three types of appetitions: (a) insensible or unconscious appetitions, (b) sensible or conscious appetitions, and (c) distinct or rational appetitions.

Even though Leibniz does not say so explicitly, he furthermore believes that bare monads have only unconscious appetitions, that animal souls additionally have conscious appetitions, and that only minds have distinct or rational appetitions.  Unconscious appetitions are tendencies such as the one that leads to my perception of my hair growing, or the one that prompts me unexpectedly to perceive the sound of my alarm in the morning.  All appetitions in bare monads are of this type; they are not aware of any of their tendencies.  An example of a sensible appetition, on the other hand, is an appetition for pleasure.  My desire for a piece of chocolate, for instance, is such an appetition: I am aware that I have this desire and I know what the object of the desire is, but I do not fully understand why I have it.  Animals are capable of this kind of appetition; in fact, many of their actions are motivated by their appetitions for pleasure.  Finally, an example of a rational appetition is the appetition for something that my intellect has judged to be the best course of action.  Leibniz appears to identify the capacity for this kind of appetition with the will, which, as we will see below, plays a crucial role in Leibniz’s theory of freedom.  What is distinctive of this kind of appetition is that whenever we possess it, we are not only aware of it and of its object, but also understand why we have it.  For instance, if I judge that I ought to call my mother and consequently desire to call her, Leibniz thinks, I am aware of the thought process that led me to make this judgment, and hence of the origins of my desire.

Another type of rational appetition is the type of appetition involved in reasoning.  As seen, Leibniz thinks that animals, because they can remember prior perceptions, are able to learn from experience, like the dog that learns to run away from sticks.  This sort of behavior, which involves a kind of inductive inference (see Deductive and Inductive Arguments), can be called a “shadow of reasoning,” Leibniz tells us (New Essays, p. 50).  Yet, animals are incapable of true—that is, presumably, deductive—reasoning, which, Leibniz tells us, “depends on necessary or eternal truths, such as those of logic, numbers, and geometry, which bring about an indubitable connection of ideas and infallible consequences” (Principles of Nature and Grace, section 5, in Ariew and Garber, 1989).  Only minds can reason in this stricter sense.

Some interpreters think that reasoning consists simply in very distinct perception.  Yet that cannot be the whole story.  First of all, reasoning must involve a special type of perception that differs from the perceptions of lower animals in kind, rather than merely in degree, namely abstract thought and the perception of eternal truths.  This kind of perception is not just more distinct; it has entirely different objects than the perceptions of non-rational souls, as we saw above.  Moreover, it seems more accurate to describe reasoning as a special kind of appetition or tendency than as a special kind of perception.  This is because reasoning is not just one perception, but rather a series of perceptions.  Leibniz for instance calls it “a chain of truths” (New Essays, p. 199) and defines it as “the linking together of truths” (Huggard, p. 73).  Thus, reasoning is not the same as perceiving a certain type of object, nor as perceiving an object in a particular fashion.  Rather, it consists mainly in special types of transitions between perceptions and therefore, according to Leibniz’s account of how monads transition from perception to perception, in appetitions for these transitions.  What a mind needs in order to be rational, therefore, are appetitions that one could call the principles of reasoning.  These appetitions or principles allow minds to transition, for instance, from the premises of an argument to its conclusion.  In order to conclude ‘Socrates is mortal’ from ‘All men are mortal’ and ‘Socrates is a man,’ for example, I not only need to perceive the premises distinctly, but I also need an appetition for transitioning from premises of a particular form to conclusions of a particular form.

Leibniz states in several texts that our reasonings are based on two fundamental principles: the Principle of Contradiction and the Principle of Sufficient Reason.  Human beings also have access to several additional innate truths and principles, for instance those of logic, mathematics, ethics, and theology.  In virtue of these principles we have a priori knowledge of necessary connections between things, while animals can only have empirical knowledge of contingent, or merely apparent, connections.  The perceptions of animals, then, are not governed by the principles on which our reasonings are based; the closest an animal can come to reasoning is, as mentioned, engaging in empirical inference or induction, which is based not on principles of reasoning, but merely on the recognition and memory of regularities in previous experience.  This confirms that reasoning is a type of appetition: using, or being able to use, principles of reasoning cannot just be a matter of perceiving the world more distinctly.  In fact, these principles are not something that we acquire or derive from perceptions.  Instead, at least the most basic ones are innate dispositions for making certain kinds of transitions.

In connection with reasoning, it is important to note that even though Leibniz sometimes uses the term ‘thought’ for perceptions generally, he makes it clear in some texts that it strictly speaking belongs exclusively to minds because it is “perception joined with reason” (Strickland p. 66; see also New Essays, p. 210).  This means that the ability to think in this sense, just like reasoning, is also something that is exclusive to minds, that is, something that distinguishes minds from animal souls.  Non-rational souls neither reason nor think, strictly speaking; they do however have perceptions.

The distinctive cognitive and appetitive capacities of the three types of monads are summarized in the following table:

Leibniz-Mind table

2. Freedom

One final capacity that sets human beings apart from non-rational animals is the capacity for acting freely.  This is mainly because Leibniz closely connects free agency with rationality: acting freely requires acting in accordance with one’s rational assessment of which course of action is best.  Hence, acting freely involves rational perceptions as well as rational appetitions.  It requires both knowledge of, or rational judgments about, the good, as well as the tendency to act in accordance with these judgments.  For Leibniz, the capacity for rational judgments is called ‘intellect,’ and the tendency to pursue what the intellect judges to be best is called ‘will.’  Non-human animals, because they do not possess intellects and wills, or the requisite type of perceptions and appetitions, lack freedom.  This also means, however, that most human actions are not free, because we only sometimes reason about the best course of action and act voluntarily, on the basis of our rational judgments.  Leibniz in fact stresses that in three quarters of their actions, human beings act just like animals, that is, without making use of their rationality (see Principles of Nature and Grace, section 5, in Ariew and Garber, 1989).

In addition to rationality, Leibniz claims, free actions must be self-determined and contingent (see e.g. Theodicy, section 288).  An action is self-determined—or spontaneous, as Leibniz often calls it—when its source is in the agent, rather than in another agent or some other external entity.  While all actions of monads are spontaneous in a general sense since, as we will see in section four, Leibniz denies all interaction among created substances, he may have a more demanding notion of spontaneity in mind when he calls it a requirement for freedom.  After all, when an agent acts on the basis of her rational judgment, she is not even subject to the kind of apparent influence of her body or of other creatures that is present, for instance, when someone pinches her and she feels pain.

In order to be contingent, on the other hand, the action cannot be the result of compulsion or necessitation.  This, again, is generally true for all actions of monads because Leibniz holds that all changes in the states of a creature are contingent.  Yet, there may again be an especially demanding sense in which free actions are contingent for Leibniz.  He often says that when a rational agent does something because she believes it to be best, the goodness she perceives, or her motives for acting, merely incline her towards action without necessitating action (see e.g. Huggard, p. 419; Fifth Letter to Clarke, sections 8-9; Ariew and Garber, p. 195; New Essays, p. 175).  Hence, Leibniz may be attributing a particular kind of contingency to free actions.

Even though Leibniz holds that free actions must be contingent, that is, that they cannot be necessary, he grants that they can be determined.  In fact, Leibniz vehemently rejects the notion that a world with free agents must contain genuine indeterminacy.  Hence, Leibniz is what we today call a compatibilist about freedom and determinism (see Free Will).  He believes that all actions, whether they are free or not, are determined by the nature and the prior states of the agent.  What is special about free actions, then, is not that they are undetermined, but rather that they are determined, among other things, by rational perceptions of the good.  We always do what we are most strongly inclined to do, for Leibniz, and if we are most strongly inclined by our judgment about the best course of action, we pursue that course of action freely.  The ability to act contrary even to one’s best reasons or motives, Leibniz contends, is not required for freedom, nor would it be worth having.   As Leibniz puts it in the New Essays, “the freedom to will contrary to all the impressions which may come from the understanding … would destroy true liberty, and reason with it, and would bring us down below the beasts” (p. 180).  In fact, being determined by our rational understanding of the good, as we are in our free actions, makes us godlike, because according to Leibniz, God is similarly determined by what he judges to be best.  Nothing could be more perfect and more desirable than acting in this way.

3. The Mill Argument

In several of his writings, Leibniz argues that purely material things such as brains or machines cannot possibly think or perceive.  Hence, Leibniz contends that materialists like Thomas Hobbes are wrong to think that they can explain mentality in terms of the brain.  This argument is without question among Leibniz’s most influential contributions to the philosophy of mind.  It is relevant not only to the question whether human minds might be purely material, but also to the question whether artificial intelligence is possible.  Because Leibniz’s argument against perception in material objects often employs a thought experiment involving a mill, interpreters refer to it as ‘the mill argument.’  There is considerable disagreement among recent scholars about the correct interpretation of this argument (see References and Further Reading).  The present section sketches one plausible way of interpreting Leibniz’s mill argument.

The most famous version of Leibniz’s mill argument occurs in section 17 of the Monadology:

Moreover, we must confess that perception, and what depends on it, is inexplicable in terms of mechanical reasons, that is, through shapes and motions.  If we imagine that there is a machine whose structure makes it think, sense, and have perceptions, we could conceive it enlarged, keeping the same proportions, so that we could enter into it, as one enters into a mill.  Assuming that, when inspecting its interior, we will only find parts that push one another, and we will never find anything to explain a perception.  And so, we should seek perception in the simple substance and not in the composite or in the machine.

To understand this argument, it is important to recall that Leibniz, like many of his contemporaries, views all material things as infinitely divisible.  As already seen, he holds that there are no smallest or most fundamental material elements, and every material thing, no matter how small, has parts and is hence complex.  Even if there were physical atoms—against which Leibniz thinks he has conclusive metaphysical arguments—they would still have to be extended, like all matter, and we would hence be able to distinguish between an atom’s left half and its right half.  The only truly simple things that exist are monads, that is, unextended, immaterial, mind-like things.  Based on this understanding of material objects, Leibniz argues in the mill passage that only immaterial entities are capable of perception because it is impossible to explain perception mechanically, or in terms of material parts pushing one another.

Unfortunately Leibniz does not say explicitly why exactly he thinks there cannot be a mechanical explanation of perception.  Yet it becomes clear in other passages that for Leibniz perceiving has to take place in a simple thing.  This assumption, in turn, straightforwardly implies that matter—which as seen is complex—is incapable of perception.  This, most likely, is behind Leibniz’s mill argument.  Why does Leibniz claim that perception can only take place in simple things?  If he did not have good reasons for this claim, after all, it would not constitute a convincing starting point for his mill argument.

Leibniz’s reasoning appears to be the following.  Material things, such as mirrors or paintings, can represent complexity.  When I stand in front of a mirror, for instance, the mirror represents my body.  This is an example of the representation of one complex material thing in another complex material thing.  Yet, Leibniz argues, we do not call such a representation ‘perception’: the mirror does not “perceive” my body.  The reason this representation falls short of perception, Leibniz contends, is that it lacks the unity that is characteristic of perceptions: the top part of the mirror represents the top part of my body, and so on.  The representation of my body in the mirror is merely a collection of smaller representations, without any genuine unity.  When another person perceives my body, on the other hand, her representation of my body is a unified whole.  No physical thing can do better than the mirror in this respect: the only way material things can represent anything is through the arrangement or properties of their parts.  As a result, any such representation will be spread out over multiple parts of the representing material object and hence lack genuine unity.  It is arguably for this reason that Leibniz defines ‘perception’ as “the passing state which involves and represents a multitude in the unity or in the simple substance” (Monadology, section 14).

Leibniz’s mill argument, then, relies on a particular understanding of perception and of material objects.  Because all material objects are complex and because perceptions require unity, material objects cannot possibly perceive.  Any representation a machine, or a material object, could produce would lack the unity required for perception.  The mill example is supposed to illustrate this: even an extremely small machine, if it is purely material, works only in virtue of the arrangement of its parts.  Hence, it is always possible, at least in principle, to enlarge the machine.  When we imagine the machine thus enlarged, that is, when we imagine being able to distinguish the machine’s parts as we can distinguish the parts of a mill, we will realize that the machine cannot possibly have genuine perceptions.

Yet the basic idea behind Leibniz’s mill argument can be appealing even to those of us who do not share Leibniz’s assumptions about perception and material objects.  In fact, it appears to be a more general version of what is today called “the hard problem of consciousness,” that is, the problem of explaining how something physical could explain, or give rise to, consciousness.  While Leibniz’s mill argument is about perception generally, rather than conscious perception in particular, the underlying structure of the argument appears to be similar: mental states have characteristics—such as their unity or their phenomenal properties—that, it seems, cannot even in principle be explained physically.  There is an explanatory gap between the physical and the mental.

4. The Relation between Mind and Body

The mind-body problem is a central issue in the philosophy of mind.  It is, roughly, the problem of explaining how mind and body can causally interact.  That they interact seems exceedingly obvious: my mental states, such as for instance my desire for a cold drink, do seem capable of producing changes in my body, such as the bodily motions required for walking to the fridge and retrieving a bottle of water.  Likewise, certain physical states seem capable of producing changes in my mind: when I stub my toe on my way to the fridge, for instance, this event in my body appears to cause me pain, which is a mental state.  For Descartes and his followers, it is notoriously difficult to explain how mind and body causally interact.  After all, Cartesians are substance dualists: they believe that mind and body are substances of a radically different type (see Descartes: Mind-Body Distinction).  How could a mental state such as a desire cause a physical state such as a bodily motion, or vice versa, if mind and body have absolutely nothing in common?  This is the version of the mind-body problem that Cartesians face.

For Leibniz, the mind-body problem does not arise in exactly the way it arises for Descartes and his followers, because Leibniz is not a substance dualist.  We have already seen that, according to Leibniz, an animal or human being has a central monad, which constitutes its soul, as well as subordinate monads that are everywhere in its body.  In fact, Leibniz appears to hold that the body just is the collection of these subordinate monads and their perceptions (see e.g. Principles of Nature and Grace section 3), or that bodies result from monads (Ariew and Garber, p. 179).  After all, as already seen, he holds that purely material, extended things would not only be incapable of perception, but would also not be real because of their infinite divisibility.  The only truly real things, for Leibniz, are monads, that is, immaterial and indivisible substances.  This means that Leibniz, unlike Descartes, does not believe that there are two fundamentally different kinds of substances, namely physical and mental substances.  Instead, for Leibniz, all substances are of the same general type.  As a result, the mind-body problem may seem more tractable for Leibniz: if bodies have a semi-mental nature, there are fewer obvious obstacles to claiming that bodies and minds can interact with one another.

Yet, for complicated reasons that are beyond the scope of this article (but see Leibniz: Causation), Leibniz held that human minds and their bodies—as well as any created substances, in fact—cannot causally interact.  In this, he agrees with occasionalists such as Nicolas Malebranche.  Leibniz departs from occasionalists, however, in his positive account of the relation between mental and corresponding bodily events.  Occasionalists hold that God needs to intervene in nature constantly to establish this correspondence.  When I decide to move my foot, for instance, God intervenes and moves my foot accordingly, occasioned by my decision.  Leibniz, however, thinks that such interventions would constitute perpetual miracles and be unworthy of a God who always acts in the most perfect manner.  God arranged things so perfectly, Leibniz contends, that there is no need for these divine interventions.  Even though he endorses the traditional theological doctrine that God continually conserves all creatures in existence and concurs with their actions (see Leibniz: Causation), Leibniz stresses that all natural events in the created world are caused and made intelligible by the natures of created things.  In other words, Leibniz rejects the occasionalist doctrine that God is the only active, efficient cause, and that the laws of nature that govern natural events are merely God’s intentions to move his creatures around in a particular way.  Instead for Leibniz these laws, or God’s decrees about the ways in which created things should behave, are written into the natures of these creatures.  God not only decided how creatures should act, but also gave them natures and natural powers from which these actions follow.  To understand the regularities and events in nature, we do not need to look beyond the natures of creatures.  This, Leibniz claims, is much more worthy of a perfect God than the occasionalist world, in which natural events are not internally intelligible.

How, then, does Leibniz explain the correspondence between mental and bodily states if he denies that there is genuine causal interaction among finite things and also denies that God brings about the correspondence by constantly intervening?  Consider again the example in which I decide to get a drink from the fridge and my body executes that decision.  It may seem that unless there is a fairly direct link between my decision and the action—either a link supplied by God’s intervention, or by the power of my mind to cause bodily motion—it would be an enormous coincidence that my body carries out my decision.  Yet, Leibniz thinks there is a third option, which he calls ‘pre-established harmony.’  On this view, God created my body and my mind in such a way that they naturally, but without any direct causal links, correspond to one another.  God knew, before he created my body, that I would decide to get a cold drink, and hence made my body in such a way that it will, in virtue of its own nature, walk to the fridge and get a bottle of water right after my mind makes that decision.

In one text, Leibniz provides a helpful analogy for his doctrine of pre-established harmony.  Imagine two pendulum clocks that are in perfect agreement for a long period of time.  There are three ways to ensure this kind of correspondence between them: (a) establishing a causal link, such as a connection between the pendulums of these clocks, (b) asking a person constantly to synchronize the two clocks, and (c) designing and constructing these clocks so perfectly that they will remain perfectly synchronized without any causal links or adjustments (see Ariew and Garber, pp. 147-148).  Option (c), Leibniz contends, is superior to the other two options, and it is in this way that God ensures that the states of my mind correspond to the states of my body, or in fact, that the perceptions of any created substance harmonize with the perceptions of any other.  The world is arranged and designed so perfectly that events in one substance correspond to events in another substance even though they do not causally interact, and even though God does not intervene to adjust one to the other.  Because of his infinite wisdom and foreknowledge, God was able to pre-establish this mutual correspondence or harmony when he created the world, analogously to the way a skilled clockmaker can construct two clocks that perfectly correspond to one another for a period of time.

5. References and Further Reading

a. Primary Sources in English Translation

  • Ariew, Roger and Daniel Garber, eds. Philosophical Essays. Indianapolis: Hackett, 1989.
    • Contains translations of many of Leibniz’s most important shorter writings such as the Monadology, the Principles of Nature and Grace, the Discourse on Metaphysics, and excerpts from Leibniz’s correspondence, to name just a few.
  • Ariew, Roger, ed.  Correspondence [between Leibniz and Clarke]. Indianapolis: Hackett, 2000.
    • A translation of Leibniz’s correspondence with Samuel Clarke, which touches on many important topics in metaphysics and philosophy of mind.
  • Francks, Richard and Roger S. Woolhouse, eds. Leibniz’s ‘New System’ and Associated Contemporary Texts. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1997.
    • Contains English translations of additional short texts.
  • Francks, Richard and Roger S. Woolhouse, eds. Philosophical Texts. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998.
    • Contains English translations of additional short texts.
  • Huggard, E. M., ed. Theodicy: Essays on the Goodness of God, the Freedom of Man and the Origin of Evil. La Salle: Open Court, 1985.
    • Translation of the only philosophical monograph Leibniz published in his lifetime, which contains many important discussions of free will.
  • Lodge, Paul, ed. The Leibniz–De Volder Correspondence: With Selections from the Correspondence between Leibniz and Johann Bernoulli. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2013.
    • An edition, with English translations, of Leibniz’s correspondence with De Volder, which is a very important source of information about Leibniz’s mature metaphysics.
  • Loemker, Leroy E., ed. Philosophical Papers and Letters. Dordrecht: D. Reidel, 1970.
    • Contains English translations of additional short texts.
  • Look, Brandon and Donald Rutherford, eds. The Leibniz–Des Bosses Correspondence. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2007.
    • An edition, with English translations, of Leibniz’s correspondence with Des Bosses, which is another important source of information about Leibniz’s mature metaphysics.
  • Parkinson, George Henry Radcliffe and Mary Morris, eds. Philosophical Writings. London: Everyman, 1973.
    • Contains English translations of additional short texts.
  • Remnant, Peter and Jonathan Francis Bennett, eds. New Essays on Human Understanding. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
    • Translation of Leibniz’s section-by-section response to Locke’s Essay Concerning Human Understanding, written in the form of a dialogue between the two fictional characters Philalethes and Theophilus, who represent Locke’s and Leibniz’s views, respectively.
  • Rescher, Nicholas, ed. G.W. Leibniz’s Monadology: An Edition for Students. Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press, 1991.
    • An edition, with English translation, of the Monadology, with commentary and a useful collection of parallel passages from other Leibniz texts.
  • Strickland, Lloyd H., ed. The Shorter Leibniz Texts: A Collection of New Translations. London: Continuum, 2006.
    • Contains English translations of additional short texts.

b. Secondary Sources

  • Adams, Robert Merrihew. Leibniz: Determinist, Theist, Idealist. New York: Oxford University Press, 1994.
    • One of the most influential and rigorous works on Leibniz’s metaphysics.
  • Borst, Clive. “Leibniz and the Compatibilist Account of Free Will.” Studia Leibnitiana 24.1 (1992): 49-58.
    • About Leibniz’s views on free will.
  • Brandom, Robert. “Leibniz and Degrees of Perception.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 19 (1981): 447-79.
    • About Leibniz’s views on perception and perceptual distinctness.
  • Davidson, Jack. “Imitators of God: Leibniz on Human Freedom.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 36.3 (1998): 387-412.
    • Another helpful article about Leibniz’s views on free will and on the ways in which human freedom resembles divine freedom.
  • Davidson, Jack. “Leibniz on Free Will.” The Continuum Companion to Leibniz. Ed. Brandon Look. London: Continuum, 2011. 208-222.
    • Accessible general introduction to Leibniz’s views on freedom of the will.
  • Duncan, Stewart. “Leibniz’s Mill Argument Against Materialism.” Philosophical Quarterly 62.247 (2011): 250-72.
    • Helpful discussion of Leibniz’s mill argument.
  • Garber, Daniel. Leibniz: Body, Substance, Monad. New York: Oxford University Press, 2009.
    • A thorough study of the development of Leibniz’s metaphysical views.
  • Gennaro, Rocco J. “Leibniz on Consciousness and Self-Consciousness.” New Essays on the Rationalists. Eds. Rocco J. Gennaro and C. Huenemann. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999. 353-371.
    • Discusses Leibniz’s views on consciousness and highlights the advantages of reading Leibniz as endorsing a higher-order thought theory of consciousness.
  • Jolley, Nicholas. Leibniz. London; New York: Routledge, 2005.
    • Good general introduction to Leibniz’s philosophy; includes chapters on the mind and freedom.
  • Jorgensen, Larry M. “Leibniz on Memory and Consciousness.” British Journal for the History of Philosophy 19.5 (2011a): 887-916.
    • Elaborates on Jorgensen (2009) and discusses the role of memory in Leibniz’s theory of consciousness.
  • Jorgensen, Larry M. “Mind the Gap: Reflection and Consciousness in Leibniz.” Studia Leibnitiana 43.2 (2011b): 179-95.
    • About Leibniz’s account of reflection and reasoning.
  • Jorgensen, Larry M. “The Principle of Continuity and Leibniz’s Theory of Consciousness.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 47.2 (2009): 223-48.
    • Argues against ascribing a higher-order theory of consciousness to Leibniz.
  • Kulstad, Mark. Leibniz on Apperception, Consciousness, and Reflection. Munich: Philosophia, 1991.
    • Influential, meticulous study of Leibniz’s views on consciousness.
  • Kulstad, Mark. “Leibniz, Animals, and Apperception.” Studia Leibnitiana 13 (1981): 25-60.
    • A shorter discussion of some of the issues in Kulstad (1991).
  • Lodge, Paul, and Marc E. Bobro. “Stepping Back Inside Leibniz’s Mill.” The Monist 81.4 (1998): 553-72.
    • Discusses Leibniz’s mill argument.
  • Lodge, Paul. “Leibniz’s Mill Argument Against Mechanical Materialism Revisited.” Ergo (2014).
    • Further discussion of Leibniz’s mill argument.
  • McRae, Robert. Leibniz: Perception, Apperception, and Thought. Toronto: University of Toronto Press, 1976.
    • An important and still helpful, even if somewhat dated, study of Leibniz’s philosophy of mind.
  • Murray, Michael J. “Spontaneity and Freedom in Leibniz.” Leibniz: Nature and Freedom. Eds. Donald Rutherford and Jan A. Cover. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2005. 194-216.
    • Discusses Leibniz’s views on free will and self-determination, or spontaneity.
  • Phemister, Pauline. “Leibniz, Freedom of Will and Rationality.” Studia Leibnitiana 26.1 (1991): 25-39.
    • Explores the connections between rationality and freedom in Leibniz.
  • Rozemond, Marleen. “Leibniz on the Union of Body and Soul.” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie 79.2 (1997): 150-78.
    • About the mind-body problem and pre-established harmony in Leibniz.
  • Rozemond, Marleen. “Mills Can’t Think: Leibniz’s Approach to the Mind-Body Problem.” Res Philosophica 91.1 (2014): 1-28.
    • Another helpful discussion of the mill argument.
  • Savile, Anthony. Routledge Philosophy Guidebook to Leibniz and the Monadology. New York: Routledge, 2000.
    • Very accessible introduction to Leibniz’s Monadology.
  • Simmons, Alison. “Changing the Cartesian Mind: Leibniz on Sensation, Representation and Consciousness.” The Philosophical Review 110.1 (2001): 31-75.
    • Insightful discussion of the ways in which Leibniz’s philosophy of mind differs from the Cartesian view; also argues that Leibnizian consciousness consists in higher-order perceptions.
  • Sotnak, Eric. “The Range of Leibnizian Compatibilism.” New Essays on the Rationalists. Eds. Rocco J. Gennaro and C. Huenemann. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1999. 200-223.
    • About Leibniz’s theory of freedom.
  • Swoyer, Chris. “Leibnizian Expression.” Journal of the History of Philosophy 33 (1995): 65-99.
    • About Leibnizian perception.
  • Wilson, Margaret Dauler. “Confused Vs. Distinct Perception in Leibniz: Consciousness, Representation, and God’s Mind.” Ideas and Mechanism: Essays on Early Modern Philosophy. Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1999. 336-352.
    • About Leibnizian perception as well as perceptual distinctness.

 

Author Information

Julia Jorati
Email: jorati.1@osu.edu
The Ohio State University
U. S. A.