Originally, the Chinese language and its many dialects did not use any form of alphabetical writing to express the meanings and sounds of Chinese characters. As Western interest in China intensified during the eighteenth and nineteenth centuries, various systems of romanization (transliteration into the Roman alphabet used in most Western languages) were proposed and utilized. Of these, the most frequently used today are the pinyin system and the Wade-Giles system. Both are based on the pronunciation of Chinese characters according to “Mandarin,” used as the official language of government in both the People’s Republic of China (mainland China) and the Republic of China (Taiwan).

The Wade-Giles system prevailed in both China and the West until the late twentieth century, at which point the pinyin system (developed in the People’s Republic of China during the 1950s) began to gain adherence among journalists and scholars. Today, the most current scholarship tends to use pinyin renderings of Chinese terms. For this reason, the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy introduces the names of Chinese philosophical concepts and figures in pinyin romanizations, with the exception of Wade-Giles forms that appear in bibliographical entries. The difference between the two systems can be compared by examining the renderings of some common Chinese philosophical terms according to each:

PINYIN                                  WADE-GILES                                      ENGLISH TRANSLATION

de                                            te                                                             virtue, moral force, power

jing                                         ching                                                      classic, scripture

junzi                                        chün-tzu                                                gentleman, profound person

ren                                          jen                                                           benevolence, humaneness

Tian                                        T’ien                                                       Heaven, nature

ziran                                        tzu-jan                                                    spontaneity, naturalness

The following table may be used to convert pinyin and Wade-Giles romanizations:

PINYIN                                               WADE-GILES                                   PRONOUNCE AS-       

b                                                           p                                                           b as in "be", aspirated

c                                                           ts', ts'                                                   ts as in "its"

ch                                                         ch'                                                        as in "church"

d                                                           t                                                            d as in "do"

g                                                           k                                                           g as in "go"

ian                                                        ien                                                        

j                                                            ch                                                         j as in "jeep"

k                                                           k'                                                          k as in "kind", aspirated

ong                                                      ung                                                      

p                                                           p'                                                          p as in "par", aspirated

q                                                           ch'                                                        ch as in "cheek"

r                                                            j                                                            approx like the "j" in French "je"

s                                                           s, ss, sz                                               s as in "sister"

sh                                                         sh                                                         sh as in "shore"

si                                                          szu              

t                                                            t'                                                           t as in top

x                                                           hs                                                         sh as in "she" - thinly sounded      

yi                                                          I                                                            

you                                                      yu                

z                                                           ts                                                          z as in "zero"

zh                                                         ch                                                         j as in "jump"                 

zi                                                          tzu                                   

Jeffrey L. Richey
Email: Jeffrey_Richey@berea.edu
Department of Philosophy and Religion
Berea College
Berea, KY 40404