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This supplement answers a series of questions designed to reveal
more about what science requires of physical time, and to provide
background information about other topics discussed in the Time
article.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. What are instants
and durations?
A duration is an interval of time. The duration of life on earth is several billion years; the duration of a flash of lightning is
0.0002 seconds. Years and seconds are durations. The
second is the standard unit for the measurement of time in the SI system (the
International Systems of Units, that is, Le Système International d'Unités).
In informal conversation, an instant is a very short duration. In physics,
however, an instant is instantaneous; it is not a duration but rather a "point"
in time, or "a time."
The day begins at the instant called "midnight." It is an interesting question whether a duration is
a linear continuum of instants, and, if so, how we know this.
2. What is an event?
An event might be defined simply as whatever is temporally before or after
anything else. In ordinary discourse, an event is a happening lasting a certain duration during which some
object changes its properties. For example, this morning's event of buttering
the toast involved the toast's changing from unbuttered to buttered.
We could try also to define events in terms of objects and
properties and times. For example, we might treat the buttering event as
involving the toast object having changed from not having the property of containing butter at a certain
time this morning at a certain location to its having the property of containing
butter at that location a few seconds later. However, events actually are more basic
in physics than are objects and their properties.
In ordinary discourse, an event has more than an infinitesimal duration, but
in the technical discourse of physics, all events are composed of point events,
events with zero duration. Also, a point event is considered by physicists to be
a spacetime point's having some property other than those it has just by being a
location in spacetime. The point event is the point's having of some property for an
instant. Notice that no change is mentioned here, nor is a physical object that
has those properties. Point events are what all objects and events are
made of, and spacetime points are what have the properties.
These metaphysical assumptions of modern science are not part of
common sense, the shared background beliefs of most people. They also
are not acceptable metaphysical assumptions for many philosophers. In
1936, in order to avoid point events, Bertrand Russell and A. N.
Whitehead developed a theory of time based on the assumption that all
events in spacetime have a finite duration. However, they had to
assume that any finite part of an event is an event, and this
assumption is no closer to common sense than the physicist's
assumption that all events are composed of point events.
It is an open question in philosophy as to whether the passage of time is a
feature of the world to be explained by noting how
events change, such as
their changing from being present to being past.
For a more detailed discussion of what an event is, see the article Events.
3. What is a
reference frame?
A reference frame for a space is a coordinate system, namely a standard point of view or a perspective for
making observations, measurements and judgments that assigns unique values to each point of space.
Choosing a good reference frame can make a situation much easier
to describe. If you are trying to describe the motion of a car down a
straight highway, you would not want to choose a reference frame that
is fixed to a spinning carousel. Instead, choose a reference frame
fixed to the highway. The motion of a planet is very complex as seen from
earth over many months. However, the motion is very simple in a frame of
reference at rest relative to the sun. Inertial frames are very special reference frames,
as we shall see below.
A reference frame is often specified by selecting a solid object
that doesn't change its size and by saying that the reference frame is
fixed to the object. We might select a reference frame fixed to the
Rock of Gibraltar. Another object is said to be at rest in the
reference frame if it remains at a constant distance in a fixed
direction from the reference body used to define the frame. For
example, your house is at rest in a reference frame fixed to the Rock
of Gibraltar [not counting your house's vibrating when a truck drives by, nor
the house's speed due to plate tectonics]. When we say the sun rose this
morning, we are implicitly choosing a reference frame fixed to the earth's
surface. The sun is not at rest in this reference frame.
The reference frame or coordinate system must specify locations, and this is normally done by assigning numbers to points of space. In a three-dimensional space, the analyst needs to specify four distinct points on the reference
body, or four objects mutually at rest somewhere in the frame. One
point is the origin, and the other three can be used to define three
independent, perpendicular axes, the familiar x, y and z directions, assuming a
Cartesian or rectangular coordinate system were to be used. Two
point objects are at the same place if they have the same x-value,
the same y-value and the same z-value. To keep track of events, you
will also need a time axis, a "t" axis, and so you will expand your three-dimensional mathematical space to a four-dimensional mathematical space. Two point events are
simultaneous if they occur at the same place and also at the same
time. In this way, the analyst is placing a four-dimensional coordinate system on
the space and time. The coordinates could have been letters instead of
numbers, but numbers are the best choice because we want to use them for
measurement, not just for naming places.
The fact that physical spacetime has curvature implies that
no single coordinate system is capable of covering the entire spacetime. To
cover all of spacetime in that case, we must make do with covering different
regions of space time with different coordinate patches that are "knitted
together" where one patch meets another. No single coordinate system can
cover the surface of a sphere without creating a singularity, but the sphere can
be covered by patching together two coordinate systems.
In creating coordinate systems for spaces, the usual assumption is that we need n independent numbers to specify a place in an n-dimensional space, where n is an integer. This is usual but not required if we exploit the idea that there are space-filling curves which permit a single continuous line to completely fill, and thus coordinatize, a region of dimension higher than one, e.g., a plane. For this reason (namely, that each point in n-dimensional space doesn't always need n numbers to name the point), the contemporary definition of "dimension" is rather exotic.
4. What is an
inertial frame?
An inertial frame is either a non-accelerating frame, or, less generally, a reference frame in which
Newton's laws of motion hold.
How do you tell if you are in an
inertial frame? You check that objects accelerate only when acted on by forces.
That is, you check that any object's acceleration is zero if no net force acts
on the object. If no unbalanced external forces are acting on a moving object,
then the object moves in a straight line. It doesn't curve. And it travels equal
distances in equal amounts of time.
Any frame of reference moving at constant velocity relative to an inertial
frame is also an inertial frame. A reference frame spinning relative to an
inertial frame is never an inertial frame.
Einstein's theory of special relativity is intended to apply only
to inertial frames. According to the theory, the speed of
light in a vacuum is the same when observed from any inertial frame
of reference. Unlike the speed of a spaceship, the speed of light in a vacuum isn't affected by which
inertial reference frame is used for the measurement. If you have two relatively stationary, synchronized clocks
in an inertial frame, then they will read the
same time, but if one moves relative to the other, then they will get out of
synchrony. This loss of synchrony due to relative motion is called "time dilation."
The presence of gravitation normally destroys any possibility of
finding a perfect inertial frame. So, in practice,
when trying to use special relativity in a world containing gravitation, inertial frames are
distinguished not by being absolutely unaccelerated, but rather by
being unaccelerated relative to some suitably defined average of all the matter
in the universe. A reference frame in which star motion is ignored and the stars
are assumed to be at rest is approximately an inertial reference frame and is
often adequate for many purposes. This is the so-called inertial frame of the
"fixed stars."
5. What is
spacetime?
Spacetime is where events are located, or, depending on your theory of
spacetime, it's all possible events. Spacetime is a multi-dimensional space, one of whose dimensions is time. It is
often useful to suppose that there are four dimensions of spacetime. These four
include the time dimension of before-after
and the three ordinary space dimensions of, say, up-down, left-right, and forward-backward.
More technically, spacetime is the intended model of the general theory of relativity.
This requires it to be a differentiable space in which physical objects obey the equations of
motion of the theory. Minkowski space (that is, Minkowski spacetime) is the model of
special relativity. It's a certain 4-dimensional real vector space.
General relativity theory requires that spacetime be locally like Minkowski
spacetime. Hermann
Minkowski, in 1908, was the first person to say that spacetime is fundamental and that space and time are
just aspects of spacetime. Minkowski meant it is fundamental in the sense that the spacetime interval between any two
events is intrinsic to spacetime and does not vary with the reference
frame, unlike a spatial distance or temporal duration.Spacetime is a continuum in which we can define points and
straight lines. However, these points and lines do not satisfy the
principles of Euclidean geometry when matter is present. Einstein
showed that the presence of matter affects geometry by warping space and time. Einstein's principal equation in his general theory of
relativity implies that the curvature of spacetime is directly
proportional to the density of mass in the spacetime.
That is, Einstein says the structure of spacetime changes as matter moves because the gravitational field from matter actually curves spacetime. Black holes are a sign of radical curvature.
The earth's curving of spacetime is very
slight but still significant enough that it must be accounted for
when synchronizing two Global Positioning Satellites.
There have been serious attempts over the
last few decades to construct theories of physics in which spacetime
is a product of more basic entities. The
primary aim of these new theories is to unify relativity with quantum
theory. So far these theories have not stood up to any empirical
observations or experiments that could show them to be superior to
the presently accepted theories. So, for the present the concept of
spacetime remains fundamental.
The metaphysical question of whether spacetime is a substantial
object or a relationship among events, or neither, is considered
in the discussion of the relational theory
of time.
6. What is a
Minkowski diagram?
A spacetime diagram is a representation of the point-events of spacetime. In a Minkowski spacetime diagram, a rectangular coordinate system is used, Einstein's Special Theory of Relativity holds, normally the time axis is vertical, one or two of the spatial axes are suppressed, and an object’s inertial motion (coasting) produces events in a straight line. Here is an example with space having just one
dimension.
The above diagram shows Einstein standing still midway between the two places
at which there is a flash of light. The directed arrows represent the path
of light rays from the flash. In a Minkowski diagram, a physical object,
such as an electron or a person's body, is not represented as occupying a point
but as occupying a line containing all the spacetime points at which it exists.
The line is called the "worldline" of the object. In the above
diagram, Einstein's worldline is a vertical line. If an object's
worldline intersects or meets another object's worldline, then the two objects
have collided. The units along the vertical time axis are customarily
chosen to be the product of time and the speed of light so that "worldlines" of
light rays make a forty-five degree angles with each axis. The set of all
light speed world lines going through an event defines the light cones
of that event: the past light cone and the future light cone.
Inertial motion produces a straight worldline, and
accelerated motion produces a curved worldline. If at some time
Einstein were to jump on a train moving by at constant speed, then his worldline would, from that time upward, tilt
away from the vertical and form some angle less than 45 degrees with
the time axis. Events on the same horizontal line of the Minkowski diagram
are simultaneous in that reference frame. A moving observer is added to this diagram
to produce the diagram below in the
discussion about the relativity of simultaneity.
In a coordinate system attached to the Sun, the worldline of the Earth's orbit
would be a helix.
Not all spacetimes can be given Minkowski diagrams, but any spacetime
satisfying Einstein's Special Theory of Relativity can. Minkowski diagrams are diagrams of a Minkowski space, which is a
spacetime satisfying the Special Theory, and therefore it is falsely presupposed
that physical processes such as gravitational processes have no effect on the
structure of spacetime. When attention needs to be given to the real
effect of these processes on the structure of spacetime, that is, when general
relativity is to be used, then Minkowski diagrams become inappropriate for
spacetime, and a single coordinate system no longer covers the entire
spacetime.
7. What are the
metric and the interval?
A space is simply a collection of points. How far is it from one point to some
different point? The metric is the answer to this question. A
metric on a space provides a definition of distance (or length) by
giving a function from pairs of nearby points in the space to non-negative real numbers.
In Euclidean space,
the distance
between two points is the length of the straight line connecting them.
This length is traditionally defined in terms of
coordinates. A coordinate for a point in two-dimensional space requires two numbers; a coordinate for a point in n-dimensional space requires n numbers. Time, being one-dimensional, requires a single number.
Time is considered a one-dimensional space mathematically, and the metric of time is normally chosen to be the absolute value of the numerical difference between the coordinates of
the two points. For example, the duration between 5 AM and 8 AM is three hours.
In a 2-dimensional
space, the metric is more complicated; the distance between the point (x',y'), with Cartesian coordinates x' and y', and the point (x,y), with coordinates x and y, is
defined to be the square root of (x' - x)2 + (y' - y)2.
Note the application of the Pythagorean Theorem.
Our intuitive idea of what a distance is tells us that, however we define
distance for a space, we want it to have certain distance-like properties.
For example, letting d(p,q) stand for the distance between any two points p and q in the
space, the following four conditions must be satisfied:
- d(p,p) = 0, and d(p,q) is greater than or equal to 0
- If d(p,q) = 0, then p = q
- d(p,q) = d(q,p)
-
d(p,q) + d(q,r) is greater than or equal to d(p,r)
Notice that there is no mention of the path the distance is taken across;
all the attention is on the point pairs themselves.
Do these conditions capture your idea of distance? If you were to check, you'd
find that the 2-d metric defined above, namely the square root of (x' - x)2 + (y' - y)2, does satisfy these four conditions.
In 3-d Euclidean space, the metric that is defined to be the square root of (x' - x)2 + (y' - y)2 + (z' - z)2 works
very well.
Consider the 4-d mathematical space that is used to represent the spacetime of
special relativity theory. What's an appropriate metric for this space? Well,
here is the so-called "Minkowski metric" between any pair of point events at
(x',y',z',t') and (x,y,z,t):
Δs2 = - (x' - x)2 - (y' - y)2 - (z' - z)2 +
c2(t' - t)2
The distance Δs is called "the interval" of spacetime.
The interval
corresponds to what clocks measure between a pair of timelike events [that is,
between a pair of events separated enough in time that one could have had a
causal effect on the other] and what
rulers measure between a pair of spacelike events. One other happy
feature of this Minkowski metric is that the value of the interval is unaffected by changing to a new reference frame provided the new reference frame is not accelerating relative to the first. Changing from a first frame to a new,
unaccelerated reference frame on the spacetime will change the values of all the coordinates of the points of the spacetime, but some relations between all pairs of points won't be affected, namely the intervals between pairs of points.
Take any two observers who are accelerating relative to each other. Now
consider some single event with a finite duration. The two observers won't agree on how long the
event lasts, but they will agree on the interval between the beginning and end
of the event.
The interval on spacetime is complicated because it can be negative, unlike
with the space intervals we've discussed so far. If Δs2 is
negative, the two points have a space-like separation, meaning these events have
a greater separation in space than they do in time, which makes the result be
negative. If Δs2 is positive,
then the two have a time-like separation, that is, enough time has passed that
one event could have had a causal effect on the other. The interval is zero between
points along paths of
a light ray, even if the points are millions of miles apart. Because true metrics
are always positive, the Minkowski metric isn't a true metric, nor even a
pseudometric; but
it is customary
for physicists to
refer to it loosely as a "metric" because Δs
retains enough other features of distance.
Adding space and time dependence to each term of the Minkowski
metric produces the metric for general relativity.
The metric
determines the geometry of spacetime.
8. Does the theory
of relativity imply time is partly space?
In 1908, Minkowski remarked that "Henceforth space by itself,
and time by itself, are doomed to fade away into mere shadows, and
only a kind of union of the two will preserve an independent
reality." Many people took this to mean that time is partly space,
and vice versa. C. D. Broad countered that the discovery of spacetime
did not break down the distinction between time and space but only
their independence or isolation. He argued that their lack of
independence does not imply a lack of reality. The Broad-Minkowski
disagreement is still an issue in philosophy, but if Broad is
correct, then time is time; it's not space at all.
Nevertheless,
there is a deep sense in which time and space are "mixed up" or
linked. This is evident from the Lorentz transformations of special
relativity that connect the time t in one inertial frame with the
time t' in another frame that is moving in the x direction at a
constant speed v. In this equation, t' is dependent upon the space
coordinate x and the speed. In this way, time is not independent of
either space or speed. It follows that the time between two events
could be zero in one frame but not zero in another. Each frame has
its own way of splitting up spacetime into its space part and its
time part.
The reason why time is not partly space is
that, within a single frame, time is distinct from space. Time is not
simply an arbitrary one-dimensional sub-space of spacetime; it is a
distinguished sub-space. That is, time is a distinguished
dimension of spacetime, not an arbitrary dimension. What being
distinguished amounts to is that when you set up a rectangular
coordinate system on spacetime with an origin at, say, the event of Mohammed's
birth, you may point the
x-axis east or toward Mecca or away from the center of Earth, but you may not point it forward in time--you
may do that only with the
t-axis, the time axis.
9. Is time the
fourth dimension?
Yes and no; it depends on what you are talking about. Time is the
fourth dimension of 4-d spacetime, but time is not the fourth dimension
of space, the space of places.
Mathematicians have a broader notion of the term "space" than the
average person; and in their sense a space need not consist of
places, that is, geographical locations. Not paying attention to the
two meanings of the term "space" is the source of all the confusion
about whether time is the fourth dimension. The mathematical space
used by mathematical physicists to represent physical spacetime is
four dimensional and in that space, the space of places is a 3-d
sub-space and time is another 1-d sub-space. Minkowski was the first
person to construct such a mathematical space, although in 1895 H. G. Wells
treated time as a fourth dimension in his novel The time Machine. Spacetime is
represented mathematically by Minkowski as a space of events, not as a space of
ordinary geographical places.
In any coordinate system on spacetime, it takes at least four
independent numbers to determine a spacetime location. In any
coordinate system on the space of places, it takes at least three.
That's why spacetime is four dimensional but the space of places is
three dimensional. Actually this 19th century definition of
dimensionality, which is due to Bernhard Riemann, is not quite
adequate because mathematicians have subsequently discovered how to
assign each point on the plane to a point on the line without any two
points on the plane being assigned to the same point on the line. The
idea comes from Georg Cantor. Because of this one-to-one
correspondence, the points on a plane could be specified with just one number. If so, then the line and plane must have the same dimensions
according to the Riemann definition. To avoid this problem and to keep the plane
being a 2-d object, the
notion of dimensionality of a space has been given a new, but rather
complex, definition.
10. Is there more than one kind of physical time?
Every reference frame has its own physical time, but the question
is intended in another sense. At present, physicists measure time electromagnetically. They define a standard
atomic clock using periodic electromagnetic processes in atoms,
then use electromagnetic signals (light) to synchronize clocks that
are far from the standard clock. In doing this, are physicists
measuring '"electromagnetic time" but not other kinds of physical
time?
In the 1930s, the physicists Arthur Milne and Paul Dirac
worried about this question. Independently, they suggested there may
be very many time scales. For example, there could be the time of
atomic processes and light, which is measured best by atomic clocks.
There also could be the time of gravitation and large-scale physical
processes, which is measured best by the rotation of a pulsar
(pulsating star). The two physicists worried that the atomic clock
and the astronomical clock might drift out of synchrony after being
initially synchronized, yet there would be no reasonable explanation
for why they don't stay in synchrony. Ditto for clocks based on the
pendulum, on superconducting resonators, on the spread of
electromagnetic radiation through space, and on other physical
principles. Just imagine the difficulty for physicists if they had to
work with electromagnetic time, gravitational time, nuclear time,
neutrino time, and so forth. Current physics, however, has found no
reason to assume there is more than one kind of time for physical
processes.
In 1967, physicists did reject the astronomical standard
for the atomic standard because the deviation between known atomic
and gravitation periodic processes could be explained better assuming
that the atomic processes were the more regular of the two.
Physicists had no reason to believe that a gravitational periodic
process, that is just as regular initially as the atomic process and
that is not affected by friction or impacts or other forces, would
ever drift out of synchrony with the atomic process, yet this is the
possibility that worried Milne and Dirac.
11. How is time relative to the observer?
Physical time is not relative to any observer's state of mind.
Wishing time will pass does not affect the rate at which the observed
clock ticks. On the other hand, physical time is relative to
the observer's reference system--in
trivial ways and in a deep way discovered by Albert Einstein.
In a trivial way, time is relative to the
chosen coordinate system on the reference frame, though not to the
reference frame itself. For example, it depends on the units chosen
as when the duration of some event is 34 seconds if seconds are
defined to be a certain number of ticks of the standard
clock, but is 24 seconds if seconds are defined to be a different
number of ticks of that standard clock. Similarly, the difference
between the Christian calendar and the Jewish calendar for the date
of some event is due to a different unit and origin. Also trivially,
time depends on the coordinate system when a change is made from
Eastern Standard Time to Pacific Standard Time. These dependencies
are taken into account by scientists but usually never mentioned. For
example, if a pendulum's approximately one-second swing is measured
in a physics laboratory during the autumn night when the society
changes from Daylight Savings Time back to Standard Time, the
scientists do not note that one unusual swing of the pendulum that
evening took a negative fifty-nine minutes and fifty-nine seconds
instead of the usual one second.
Isn't time relative to the observer's coordinate system in the sense that in some reference frames there could be fifty-nine seconds in a minute? No, due to scientific convention, it is absolutely certain that there are sixty seconds in any minute in any reference frame. How long an event lasts is relative to the reference frame used to measure the time elapsed, but in any reference frame there are exactly sixty seconds in a minute because this is true by definition. Similarly, you do not need to worry that in some reference frame there might be two gallons in a quart.
In a deeper sense, time is relative, not just to the coordinate
system, but to the reference frame itself. That is Einstein's principal
original idea about time.
Einstein's idea is that without reference to the frame, there is
no fixed time interval between two events, no 'actual' duration
between them.
Einstein illustrated his idea for two observers, one on a moving train in the middle of the train, and a second observer standing on the embankment next to the train tracks.
If the observer sitting in the middle of the rapidly moving train receives signals simultaneously from lightning flashes at the front and back of the train, then in his reference frame the two lightning strikes were simultaneous. But the strikes were not simultaneous in a frame fixed to an observer on the ground. This outside observer will say that the flash from the back had farther to travel because the observer on the train was moving away from the flash. If
one flash had farther to travel, then it must have left before the other one, assuming that both flashes moved at the same speed. Therefore, the lightning struck the back of the train before the lightning struck the front of the train in the reference frame fixed to the tracks.
Let's assume that a number of observers are moving with various constant speeds in various directions.
Consider the
inertial frame of reference in which each observer is at rest in his or her own frame. Which of these
observers will agree on their time measurements? Only observers with zero
relative speed will agree. Observers with different relative speeds
will not, even if they agree on how to define the second and agree on
some event occurring at time zero (the origin of the time axis). If
two observers are moving relative to each other, but each makes
judgments from a reference frame fixed to themselves, then the
assigned times to the event will disagree more, the faster their
relative speed. All observers will be observing the same objective
reality, the same event in the same spacetime, but their different
frames of reference will require disagreement about how spacetime
divides up into its space part and its time part.
This relativity of time to reference frame implies that there be
no such thing as The Past in the sense of a past independent of
reference frame. This is because a past event in one reference frame
might not be past in another reference frame.
In some reference frame, was Adolf Hitler born before George
Washington? No, because the two events are causally connectible. That
is, one event could in principle have affected the other since light
would have had time to travel from one to the other. We can select a
reference frame to reverse the usual earth-based order of two events
only if they are not causally connectible, that is, only if one event is in the absolute elsewhere of the other. Despite the relativity of
time to a reference frame, any two observers in any two reference frames should agree about
which of two causally connectible
events happened first.
12. What are the relativity and conventionality of simultaneity?
If the universe obeys relativistic physics, then events that occur
simultaneously with respect to one reference frame will not occur simultaneously
in another reference frame that is moving with respect to the first frame. This
is called the "relativity of simultaneity." It applies only to
pairs of events in each other's absolute elsewhere.
This Minkowski diagram represents Einstein sitting still in the reference frame
while Lorentz is traveling rapidly away from him and toward the source of
flash 2. Because Lorentz's timeline is a straight line we can tell that he
is moving at a constant speed. The two flashes of light arrive at Einstein's location simultaneously,
creating
spacetime event B. However, Lorentz sees flash 2 before flash 1.
That is, the event A of Lorentz seeing flash 2 occurs before event C of Lorentz
seeing flash 1. So, Einstein will readily say the flashes are simultaneous,
but Lorentz will have to do some computing to figure out that the flashes are
simultaneous in the frame because they won't "look" simultaneous. However, if
we'd chosen a different reference frame from the one above, one in which Lorentz is not moving but
Einstein is, then Lorentz would be correct to say
flash 2 occurs before flash 1 in that new frame. So, whether the flashes are or
are not simultaneous depends on which reference frame is used in making the
judgment. It's all relative.
This relativity of simultaneity is philosophically less controversial than the conventionality of simultaneity. To appreciate the
difference, consider what is involved in making a determination
regarding simultaneity. Given two events that happen essentially at
the same place, physicists assume they can tell by direct observation
whether the events happened simultaneously. If we don't see one of
them happening first, then we say they happened simultaneously, and
we assign them the same time coordinate. The determination of
simultaneity is more difficult if the two happen at separate places.
One proper way to measure (operationally define) simultaneity at a
distance is to say that two events are simultaneous in a reference
frame if unobstructed light signals from the two events would reach
us simultaneously when we are midway between the two places where
they occur, as judged in that frame. This is the operational
definition of simultaneity used by Einstein in his theory of
relativity.
The "midway" method described above of
operationally defining simultaneity in one reference frame for two
distant signals causally connected to us has a significant
presumption: that the light beams travel at the same speed regardless
of direction. Einstein, Reichenbach and Grünbaum have called this a
reasonable "convention" because any attempt to experimentally confirm
it presupposes that we already know how to determine simultaneity at
a distance. This is the conventionality, rather than relativity, of
simultaneity. To pursue the point, suppose the two original events
are in each other's absolute elsewhere; they couldn't have affected
each other. Einstein noticed that there is no physical basis for
judging the simultaneity or lack of simultaneity between these two
events, and for that reason said we rely on a convention when we
define distant simultaneity as we do. Hillary Putnam, Michael Friedman, and
Graham Nerlich object to
calling it a convention--on the grounds that to make any other
assumption about light's speed would unnecessarily complicate our
description of nature, and we often make choices about how nature
is on the basis of simplification of our description. They
would say there is less conventionality in the choice than Einstein
supposed.
The "midway" method isn't the only way to define simultaneity.
Consider a second method, the "mirror reflection" method. Select an
earth-based frame of reference, and send a flash of light from earth
to Mars where it hits a mirror and is reflected back to its source.
The flash occurred at 12:00, let's say, and its reflection arrived
back on earth 20 minutes later. The light traveled the same empty,
undisturbed path coming and going. At what time did the light flash
hit the mirror? The answer involves the so-called conventionality of
simultaneity. All physicists agree one should say the reflection
event occurred at 12:10. The controversial philosophical question is
whether this is really a convention. Einstein pointed out that there
would be no inconsistency in our saying that it hit the mirror at
12:17, provided we live with the awkward consequence that light was
relatively slow getting to the mirror, but then traveled back to
earth at a faster speed. If we picked the impact time to be 12:05,
we'd have to live with the fact that light traveled slower coming
back. There is a physical basis for not picking the impact time to be
less than noon nor later than 12:20, because doing so would violate
the physical principle that causes precede their effects. One
requirement we place on the concept of simultaneity is that distant
events which are simultaneous could not be in causal contact with
each other. We can satisfy that requirement for any choice of impact
time from 12:00 to 12:20.
13. What is the difference between the past and the absolute past?
The events in your absolute past are those that could have
directly or indirectly affected you, the observer, now. These absolutely past
events are the
events in or on the backward light cone of your present event, your
here-and-now. The backward light cone of event Q is the
imaginary cone-shaped surface of spacetime points formed by the paths of all
light rays reaching Q from the past. An event's being in another event's absolute past is a feature of spacetime
itself because the event is in the point's past in all possible
reference frames. The feature is frame-independent. For any event in
your absolute past, every observer in the universe (who isn't making
an error) will agree the event happened in your past. Not so for
events that are in your past but not in your absolute past. Past
events not in your absolute past will be in what Eddington called
your "absolute elsewhere" and these past
events will be in your present as judged by some other reference frames.
The absolute elsewhere is
the region of spacetime containing events that are not causally
connectible to your here-and-now. Your absolute elsewhere is the region of spacetime that is neither in nor on either
your forward or backward light cones. No event here now, can affect any
event in your absolute elsewhere; and no event in your absolute elsewhere can
affect you here and now. A spacetime point's absolute future is all the
future events outside the point's absolute elsewhere.
A single point's absolute
elsewhere, absolute future, and absolute past partition all of
spacetime beyond the point into three disjoint regions.
If point A is in point B's absolute elsewhere, the two events are
said to be "spacelike related." If the two are in each other's forward or
backward light cones they are said to be "timelike related" or
"causally connectible."
14. What is time dilation?
According to special relativity, two properly functioning clocks next to each
will stay synchronized. Even if they were to be far away from each other,
they'd stay synchronized. But if one clock moves away from the other, the
moving clock will tick slower than the stationary clock, as measured in the
inertial reference frame of the stationary clock. This slowing due to
motion is called "time dilation." If you move at 99% of the speed of light, then your time slows by a factor of 7 relative to stationary clocks. In addition, you are 7 times thinner than when you are stationary, and you are 7 times heavier. If you move at 99.9%, then you slow by a factor of 22.
Time dilation is about clocks in different frames disagreeing with each
other. Suppose your twin's
spaceship travels to and from a star one light year away. It takes light from your
Earth-based flashlight two years to go there and back. But if the spaceship is
fast, your twin can make the trip in less than two years, according to his own
clock. Does he travel the distance in less time than it takes light to
travel that distance?
No, according to your clock he takes more than two years, and so is
slower than light.
We sometimes speak of time dilation by saying time itself is "slower," but
time isn't going slower in any absolute sense, only relative to some other frame
of reference. Does time have a rate? Well, time in a reference frame has
no rate in that frame, but time in a reference frame can have a rate as measured
in a different frame, such as in a frame is moving relative to the first frame.
Time dilation is not an illusion of perception; and it's not a
matter of the second having different definitions in different
reference frames. Also, it's not a Doppler effect. Time dilation isn't affected
by direction of motion. The Doppler effect is affected by direction of
motion, which we detect in the difference between a blue shift and a red shift.
Time dilation due to difference in constant speeds is described by
Einstein's special theory of relativity. The general theory of
relativity describes a second kind of time dilation, one due to
different accelerations and different gravitational influences. For
more on general relativistic dilation, see the discussion of
gravity and black
holes.
Newton's physics describes duration as an absolute property,
implying it is not relative to the reference frame. However, in Newton's physics the speed of light
is relative to the frame.
Einstein's special theory of relativity reverses both of these
aspects of time. For inertial frames, it implies the speed of light
is not relative to the frame, but duration is relative to the
frame. In general relativity, however, the speed of light can vary
within one reference frame if matter and energy are present.
Time dilation due to motion is relative in the sense that if your
spaceship moves past mine so fast that I measure your clock to be
running at half speed, then you will measure my clock to be running
at half speed also, provided both of us are in inertial frames. If
one of us is affected by a gravitational field or undergoes
acceleration, then that person isn't in an inertial frame and the
results are different.
Both types of time dilation play a significant role in
time-sensitive satellite navigation systems such as the Global
Positioning System. The atomic clocks on the satellites must be
programmed to compensate for the relativistic dilation effects of
both gravity and motion.
15. How does gravity affect time?
Einstein's general theory of relativity (1915) is a generalization
of his special theory of special relativity (1905). It is not
restricted to inertial frames, and it encompasses a broader range of
phenomena, namely gravity and accelerated motions. According to
general relativity, gravitational differences affect time by dilating
it. Observers in a less intense gravitational potential find that
clocks in a more intense gravitational potential run slow relative to
their own clocks. People live longer in basements than in attics, all
other things being equal. Basement flashlights will be shifted toward
the red end of the visible spectrum compared to the flashlights in
attics. This effect is known as the gravitational red shift. Even the
speed of light is slower in the presence of higher gravity.
Informally one speaks of gravity bending light rays
around massive objects, but more accurately it is the space that bends, and as
a consequence the light is bent, too. The light simply follows the
shortest path through spacetime, and when space curves the shortest paths are
no longer Euclidean straight lines.
16. What happens to time near a black hole?
A black hole is a volume of very high gravitational field or
severe warp in the spacetime continuum. Astrophysicists believe black
holes are commonly formed by the inward collapse of stars that have
burned out. The center of a spherical black hole is infinitely dense according
to relativity theory, but some theories of quantum gravity imply that the
density cannot reach infinity.
It is surrounded by an event horizon, a concentric sphere marking the
point of no return. Anything getting that close could never escape
the inward pull, even if it had an unlimited fuel supply and could
travel at near the speed of light. Anything crossing the event
horizon from the outside would quickly crash into the center of the
black hole and be crushed to a point, according to relativity theory.
The singularity is the point of infinite density in the black hole. The first black hole solution to
Einstein's equations of general relativity were discovered by Schwarzschild in
1916. Because even light itself could not escape from inside a black hole,
John Wheeler chose the name "black hole."
In relativity theory, the proper time between two
events
along a worldline is the time that would be shown on a clock whose
path in spacetime is that worldline between the events. The proper time is not the same
as the coordinate time. Coordinate time is time along the worldline
of an ideal clock at the origin
of the coordinate system. The coordinate time between the two events is the time
separation of the events given by an observer at rest in the frame. Proper time is independent of
coordinate time, although the usual convention is to measure both
times in the same units, namely seconds. As judged by a clock on
earth in an earth-based frame of reference, an astronaut flying into a distant black hole will take an
infinite coordinate time to reach the event horizon of the black
hole. That is, if we could see the astronaut's clock, the clock would appear to
us to slow to a halt. But as judged by the astronaut, it
will take only a few microseconds of the astronaut's proper time to pass through the event
horizon and crash into the center of the black hole.
If you, the person
falling toward the event horizon, were to escape the pull towards the black hole
and return home, you'd discover that you were younger than your earth-bound twin
and that your initially synchronized clocks showed that yours had fallen behind.
It is in this sense that you've experienced a time warp, a warp in the time
component of spacetime. According to Stanford physicist Leonard Susskind, there is "a very common
misconception, namely, that because an outside observer sees an infalling
observer slow down, that the infalling observer sees the outsider speed up.
This is simply not so. The infalling observer looks back and sees nothing
unusual."
17. What is the solution to the twins paradox?
This paradox, also called the clock paradox and the twin paradox,
is an argument about time dilation that uses the theory of
relativity to produce a contradiction. The argument considers two twins at rest
with their clocks synchronized. One twin climbs into a spaceship and flies far
away at a constant speed, then reverses course and flies back at the same speed.
When they reunite, will the twins still be the same age? No. Relativity theory
implies that the twin on the spaceship will return and be younger than the
Earth-based twin. The elapsed proper time of the twin who returns is less
than the elapsed proper time of the Earth-based twin. However, it's all
relative, isn't it? That is, we could have considered the spaceship to be
stationary. Wouldn't relativity theory then imply that the Earth-based twin
would race off (along with the Earth), then return and be the younger of the
two? If so, we have a contradiction: when the twins reunite, each will be
younger than the other.
Einstein worried about the paradox [Einstein, Naturwissenschaften, 6,
697 (1918)], and Herbert Dingle famously argued in the 1960's that
the paradox reveals an inconsistency in special relativity. Almost all
philosophers and scientists now agree that it is not a true paradox, in the
sense of revealing a logical inconsistency within relativity theory, but is
merely a complex puzzle that can be adequately solved within relativity
theory. The twin who feels the acceleration is the twin who becomes the
younger twin, but the acceleration upon starting and reversing course is not
what causes this difference in aging, and it is not essential to the paradox.
The way out of the paradox is to
notice that the argument has two halves. The first half describes the
twin in the spaceship flying away, then turning around and flying
back to the Earth-based twin who remains fixed in an inertial
frame during the flight. The second half describes the Earth-based twin as flying
away from the spaceship and then returning to the spaceship, while
the spaceship remains stationary in an inertial frame during the flight.
The assumption is that the stars are not moving in tandem with the spaceship but
are generally stationary relative to the Earth. Without this crucial, but
usually implicit, assumption, one couldn't decide which twin was in an inertial
frame.
The production of the paradox depends on using a heuristic principle that the
description of the world is equally valid from the point of view of any
observer. That heuristic principle is embedded in the above remark, "...it's all
relative, isn't it?" The application of the principle makes the assumption
that the two halves of the analysis are working with two equivalent descriptions
of the same process. However, the two descriptions are not equivalent because,
if there is an inertial frame in the first half of the argument, then there is
no available inertial frame for the second half.
The analyst is always free to make the choice of a non-inertial frame in
which the spaceship is considered to be stationary. This would complicate the
analysis, but the result would be the same, namely no
contradiction. So, it
can’t be shown that the Earth-based twin is the younger.
To dig more deeply into the cause of error in the reasoning, notice that the production of the paradox depends upon a careless use of the
heuristic principle that the description of the world is equally
valid from the point of view of any observer. This principle is
misinterpreted in the twins paradox. What is always correct in
relativity theory and what underlies the heuristic principle is the
symmetry principle: the invariance of the laws under Lorentz
transformations. These transformation equations give the relations
between the coordinates of a single event [such as our
spaceship’s flight away from the Earth-based twin] as
measured by observers in two different inertial reference frames in
motion relative to one another. But there aren’t two inertial
frames to use in the case of the twins paradox, so the symmetry
principle is correct, but the heuristic principle is not applicable.
The argument of the twins paradox applies the heuristic principle
anyway, and draws an incorrect conclusion that there is a
contradiction.
What causes one twin to age differently? The best answer to this
question is to re-examine the question itself. It was remarked above that the easiest way to see the
dissimilarity in the two halves of the argument. Failure to notice the asymmetry in the two halves is
the cause of the error in the paradox, but it's not the cause of the age
difference in the twins. Their age difference isn't caused by anything,
just as light's going at the speed of light instead of at some other speed isn't
caused by something but is just the way nature behaves, at least insofar as the
theory of relativity is concerned.
18. What is the solution to Zeno's paradoxes?
See the article "Zeno's Paradoxes" elsewhere in this encyclopedia.
19. How do time coordinates get assigned to points of spacetime?
A reference system is a reference
frame plus either a coordinate system or an
atlas of coordinate systems placed by the analyst
upon the space to uniquely name the points. These names or
coordinates are frame dependent in that a point can get new
coordinates when the reference frame is changed. For 4-d spacetime obeying
special relativity, a
coordinate system is a grid of smooth timelike
and spacelike curves on the spacetime that assigns to each point three
space coordinate numbers and one time coordinate number. Inertial
frames can have global coordinate systems, but if we are working with
general relativity where we cannot assume inertial frames, then the
best we can do is to assign a coordinate system to a small region of
spacetime where the laws of special relativity hold to a good
approximation. General relativity requires special relativity to hold
locally, and thus for spacetime to be Euclidean locally. So spacetime
allows coordinate systems locally. Consider two coordinate systems on
adjacent regions. For adjacent regions we make sure that the 'edges'
of the two coordinate systems match up in the sense that each point
near the intersection of the two coordinate systems gets a unique set
of four coordinates and that nearby points get nearby coordinate
numbers. The result is an "atlas" on spacetime.
For small regions of spacetime, we create a coordinate system by
choosing a style of grid, say rectangular coordinates, fixing a point
as being the origin, selecting one timelike and three spacelike lines
to be the axes, and defining a unit of distance for each dimension.
We cannot use letters for coordinates. The alphabet's structure is
too simple. Integers won't do either; but real numbers are adequate to the task.
The definition of "coordinate system" requires us to assign our real numbers in
such a way that numerical betweenness among the coordinate numbers reflects the
betweenness relation among points. For example, if we assign numbers 17, pi, and
101.3 to instants, then every interval of time that contains the pi instant and
the 101.3 instant had better contain the 17 instant. There is no way to select
one point of spacetime and call it the origin of the coordinate system except by
reference to actual events. In practice, we make the origin be the location of a
special event, such as the birth of Jesus, or Mohammed, or a selected tick of our atomic
clock.
The choice of the unit presupposes we have defined what "distance"
means. The metric for a space specifies what is meant by distance in
that space. The natural metric between any two points in a
one-dimensional space, such as the time sub-space of our spacetime,
is the numerical difference between the coordinates of the two
points. Using this metric, the duration between the 11:00 instant and
the 11:05 instant is five minutes. The metric for spacetime defines
the spacetime interval between two spacetime
locations, and it is more complicated than the metric for time alone.
The spacetime interval between any two events is invariant or
unchanged by a change to any other reference frame, although the
spatial distances and durations do vary. More accurately, in the
general theory, the infinitesimal spacetime interval between two
neighboring points is invariant. The units of the spacetime interval
are seconds squared.
In this discussion, there is no need to worry about the
distinction between change in metric and change in coordinates. For a
space that is topologically equivalent to the real line and for
metrics that are consistent with that topology, each coordinate
system determines a metric and each metric determines a coordinate
system. More precisely, once you decide on a positive direction in
the one-dimensional space and a zero-point for the coordinates, then
the possible coordinate systems and the possible metrics are in
one-to-one correspondence.
There are still other restrictions on the assignments of
coordinate numbers. The restriction that we called the "conventionality
of simultaneity" fixes what time-slices of spacetime can be
counted as collections of simultaneous events. An even more
complicated restriction is that coordinate assignments satisfy the
demands of general relativity. The metric of spacetime is not global
but varies from place to place due to the presence of matter and
gravitation. Spacetime cannot be given its coordinate numbers without
our knowing the distribution of matter and energy. However, for very
small regions of spacetime, the general relativistic metric tensor
reduces to the metric for special relativistic spacetime.
20. How do dates get assigned to actual events?
Our purpose in choosing a coordinate system or atlas
to assign real numbers to all spacetime points is to express
relationships among actual and possible events. The relationships we
are interested in are order relationships (Did this event occur
between those two?) and magnitude relationships (How long after A did
B occur?). The date of a (point) event is the time coordinate number
of the spacetime location where the event occurs. We expect all these
assignments of dates to events to satisfy the requirement that event
A happens before event B iff t(A) < t(B), where t(A) is the time
coordinate of A. The assignments of dates to events also must satisfy
the demands of our physical theories, and in this case we face
serious problems involving inconsistency as when a geologist gives
one date for the birth of earth and an astronomer gives a different
date.
It is a big step from assigning numbers to points to assigning
them to real events. Here are some of the questions that need
answers. How do we determine whether a nearby event and a distant
event occurred simultaneously? Assuming we want the second to be the standard
unit for measuring the time interval between two events, how do we operationally define the
second so we can measure whether one event occurred exactly one
second later than another event? How do we know whether the clock we
have is accurate? Less fundamentally, attention must also be paid to the dependency
of dates due to shifting from Standard Time to Daylight Savings
Time, to crossing the International Date Line, and to switching from
the Julian to the Gregorian Calendar.
Let's design a coordinate system. Suppose we have already assigned
a date of zero to the event that we choose to be at the origin of our
coordinate system. To assign dates to other events, we first must
define a standard clock and declare that the time intervals between
any two consecutive ticks of that clock are the same. The second, our
conventional unit of time measurement, will
be defined to be so many ticks of the standard
clock. We then synchronize other clocks with the standard clock
so the clocks show equal readings at the same time. The time at which
a point event occurs is the number reading on the clock at rest
there. If there is no clock there, the assignment process is more
complicated.
We want to use clocks to assign a time even to distant events, not
just to events in the immediate vicinity of the clock. To do this
correctly requires some appreciation of Einstein's theory of
relativity. A major difficulty is that two nearby synchronized
clocks, namely clocks that have been calibrated and set to show the
same time when they are next to each other, will not in general stay
synchronized if one is transported somewhere else. If they undergo
the same motions and gravitational influences, they will stay
synchronized; otherwise, they won't. For more on how to assign dates
to distant events, see the discussion of the relativity
and conventionality of simultaneity.
As a practical matter, dates are assigned to events in a wide
variety of ways. The date of the birth of the Sun is measured very
differently from dates assigned to two successive crests of a light
wave. For example, there are lasers whose successive crests of
visible light waves pass by a given location every 10 to the minus 15
seconds. This short time isn't measured with a stopwatch. It is
computed from measurements of the light's wavelength. We rely on
electromagnetic theory for the equation connecting the periodic time
of the wave to its wavelength and speed. Dates for other kinds of
events also are often computed rather than directly measured with a
clock.
21. What is essential to being a clock?
Clocks record numerical information about time. They measure the
quantity of time, the duration. Every clock has two functions. One function is to generate a sequence of events of hopefully the same durations. Periodic processes provide these events. In a wall clock, the events are pairs of successive ticks. In a pendulum clock, the events are swings (that is, oscillations) of the pendulum.
The second function is to count these events, thereby providing a
measurement of their durations in seconds and minutes and hours and years.
This counting can be especially difficult if the ticks are occurring a trillion times a second.
One principal
goal in clock-building is to make these basic durations be congruent.
That is, the duration between any two adjacent ticks should be the same.
When this goal is achieved, the clock is said to be uniform or regular.
A second goal is for the time measurements of the clock to agree with those of the standard clock. When this happens, the clock is said to be properly calibrated or accurate or synchronized with the standard clock.
To calibrate a clock, that is, to synchronize it with the
standard clock, we want our clock to
show that it is time t just when the standard clock shows that it is
time t, for all t.
A clock isn't really
measuring the time in any reference frame other
than one fixed to the clock. In other words, a clock primarily measures the
elapsed proper time between events that occur
along its own worldline. Because clocks are intended to be used to measure
events external to themselves, a third goal in clock building is to ensure there
is no difficulty in telling which clock tick is simultaneous with
which event that occurs outside the clock. For example, we might want to determine when the sun comes up in the morning at some particular place where we and our clock are located. For some clocks, the sound made by the ticking helps
us make this determination. For other clocks, the determination is made by our seeing the sun rise just when we see the digital clock face show a specific time of day. More accuracy in the determination requires less reliance on human judgment.
In our discussion so far, we have assumed that the
clock is very small, that it can count any part of a second and that
it can count high enough to be a calendar. This isn't always a good assumption with a real clock. Despite the practical problems, there is the
problem of there being a physical limit to the shortest duration
measurable by a given clock because no clock can measure time more
accurately than the time it takes light to travel between the
components of that clock, the components in the part that generates the
sequence of regular ticks.
22. What is our standard clock?
By current convention [in 1964 by ratification
by the General Conference of Weights and Measures for the International System
of Units, which replaced what was called the "metric system"], the standard clock is the clock we agree to
use for defining the standard second. The current standard second is
defined to be the duration of 9,192,631,770 periods (cycles,
oscillations, vibrations) of a certain kind of microwave radiation in
the standard clock. More specifically, the second is defined to be
the duration of 9,192,631,770 periods of the microwave radiation
required to produce the maximum fluorescence of cesium 133 atoms
(that is, their radiating a specific color of light) as the atoms
make a transition between two specific hyperfine energy levels of the
ground state of the atoms. This is the internationally agreed upon unit
for atomic time [the T.A.I. system]. The old astronomical system
[Universal Time 1] defined a second to be 1/86,400 of an Earth day.
For atomic time, the atoms of cesium with a uniform energy are sent through a chamber
that is being irradiated with these microwaves. The frequency of
these microwaves is tuned until the maximum number of cesium atoms
flip from one energy to the other, showing that the microwave
radiation frequency is now precisely tuned to be 9,192,631,770
vibrations per second. Because this frequency for maximum
fluorescence is so stable from one experiment to the next, the
vibration number is accurate to so many significant digits. The
National Institute of Standards and Technology's F-1 atomic fountain
clock, which was adopted in late 1999 as the primary time standard of
the United States, is so accurate that it drifts by less than one
second every 20 million years. We know there is this drift because it is
implied by the laws of physics, not because we have a better clock from which to
make the judgment.
The standard clock is used to fix the units of all lengths. The
unit of length depends on the unit of time. The meter depends on the
second. It does not follow from this, though, that time is more basic
than space. All that follows is that time measurement is more basic
than space measurement. And this has to do with convention and with
the fact that current science is capable of measuring time more
precisely than space.
Thanks to the regularity of light propagation in a vacuum, the meter is
defined in terms of the second. The meter is defined in terms of the pre-defined second as being
the distance light travels in exactly 0.000000003335640952 seconds or
1/299,792,458 seconds. That number is picked so that the new meter
will be nearly the same distance as the old meter, which was the
distance between two marks on a platinum bar that was kept in the
Paris Observatory. Why is the meter defined in terms of the second,
instead of having the second defined in terms of the meter as, say, how long it
takes light to travel a certain distance? The answer is that distance
can't be measured as accurately as time. Time can be more accurately
measured than distance, voltage, temperature, mass, or anything else.
These standard definitions of the second and the meter amount to
defining or fixing the speed of light in a vacuum in all inertial
frames. The speed is exactly one meter per 0.000000003335640952
seconds or 299,792,458 meters per second, or approximately 186,282
miles per second or about a foot per nanosecond. There can no longer
be any direct measurement to see if that is how fast light REALLY
moves in an inertial frame; it is simply defined to be moving that
fast. Any measurement that produced a different value for the speed
of light would be presumed initially to have an error in, say, its
measurements of lengths and durations, or in its assumptions about
the influence of gravitation and acceleration, or in its assumption
that the light was moving in a vacuum. This initial presumption comes
from a deep reliance by scientists on Einstein's theory of
relativity. However, if it were eventually decided by the community
of scientists that the theory of relativity is incorrect and that the
speed of light shouldn't have been fixed as it was, then the
scientists would call for a new world convention to re-define the
second. Some physicists believe that a better system of units would
first define the speed of light, then define the second, and then
make the meter be a computed consequence of these.
Although a microwave atomic clock is currently used for our standard unit of
time, it is expected that in the first quarter of the 21st century, physicists
will agree to use an optical atomic clock, and then the definition of the second
will be changed to refer to an optical frequency, rather than to a microwave
frequency.
23. Why are some standard clocks better than others?
We choose as our standard clock our best clock, the one with the
least drift, the one with the most regularity in its period. Other
clocks ideally are calibrated by being synchronized to this standard clock.
In about 1700, scientists discovered that their best watches and clocks
showed that the time from one day to the next, as determined by sunrises, varied
throughout the year. Therefore, they preferred to define durations in
terms of the mean or average day throughout the year. Before the 1950s, the standard clock was defined astronomically in terms of the
mean rotation of the earth upon its axis [solar time]. For a short period
in the 1950s and 1960s, it was defined in terms of the revolution of the earth about the Sun
[ephemeris time]. The second was defined to be 1/86,400 of the
mean solar day, the average throughout the year of the rotational period of the earth with
respect to the Sun. Now we've found a better standard clock, a certain kind of
atomic clock [atomic time]. All atomic clocks measure time in terms of the natural
resonant frequencies of various atoms and molecules. The periodic
behavior of a super-cooled cesium atomic clock is the best practical
standard clock we have so far discovered. [The dates of adoption of the
standards was left vague in the previous sentences because different
international organizations adopted different standards in different years.]
The principal theoretical
goal in selecting a standard clock is to find a periodic (cyclic) process that, if adopted as our
standard, makes the resulting system of physical laws simpler
and more useful. Choosing the atomic clock as standard is much
better for this purpose than choosing the periodic dripping of water from our goat
skin bag or the period of a special pendulum or even the periodic revolution of the earth about the Sun.
When we choose a standard clock we are making a choice about how to compare
two durations in order to decide whether they are of equal duration. Is this
choice somehow forced upon us? To what extent is this choice conventional? Philosophers dispute the extent to which the choice of metric is
conventional rather than forced by nature. Taking the conventional
side, Adolf Grünbaum argues that time is metrically amorphous. It has
no intrinsic metric in the sense of its structure determining the
measure of durations. Instead, we analysts establish durations
between instants by the way we assign coordinates to instants. If we
were to say the instant at which Jesus was born and the instant at
which Abraham Lincoln was assassinated occurred only 24 seconds
apart, whereas the duration between Lincoln's assassination and his
burial is 24 billion seconds, then we can't be mistaken. It's up to
us to say what is correct when we first create our conventions about
measuring duration. We can consistently assign any numerical time
coordinates we wish, subject only to the condition that the
assignment properly reflect the betweenness relations of the events
that occur at those instants. That is, if event J (birth of Jesus)
occurs before event L (Lincoln's assassination) and this in turn
occurs before event B (burial of Lincoln), then the time assigned to
J must be numerically less than the time assigned to L, and both must
be less than the time assigned to B. t(J) < t(L) < t(B). A
simple requirement. It is other requirements that lead us to reject
the above convention about 24 seconds and 24 billion seconds as
unhelpful. What requirements? We've found that, for doing science,
certain processes are more "regular" than others. Pendulum swings are
more regular than repeated barks of a dog. Periodic appearances of
the sun overhead are more regular than rainstorms. Why are they? It's because
there are many periodic processes in nature that have a special relationship to
each other; their periods are very nearly constant multiples of each other, and
this constant stays the same over a long time. For example, the period of the
rotation of the Earth is a fairly constant multiple of the period of the
revolution of the Earth around the Sun, and both these periods are a constant
multiple of the periods of swinging pendulums. The class of these periodic
processes is very large, so the world will be easier to describe if we choose
our standard clock from one of these periodic processes. If we were to choose
the standard to be the period of our own pulse, then we'd find that all those
other processes would speed up when we are excited and slow down when we are
not, and we'd find that it would be more difficult to find simple laws of
nature. A good convention
for what is regular will make it easier for scientists to find simple laws of
nature and to explain
what causes other events to be irregular. It is the search for
regularity and simplicity that leads us to adopt the conventions for numerical time
coordinate assignments that we do. No, says the objectivist, the success of the atomic clock over these other clocks we might have chosen as our standard clock shows that we picked the correct clock. An objectivist believes that whether two intervals of time are really equivalent is an intrinsic feature of nature, and choosing an atomic clock instead of the earth's revolutions about the sun as the standard clock isn't any more conventional than is choosing to say the Earth is round rather than flat.
A
practical goal in selecting a standard clock is to find a clock that
is relatively insulated from environmental impact such as comet impacts, stray
electric fields or the presence of dust. If not insulation, then
compensation. That is, if there is some theoretically predictable effect
upon the standard clock, then the clock can be regularly adjusted to take
account of the effect. Sensors, such as a thermometer or whatever, will sense the
local conditions that affect the clock, and their readings can be used to apply a suitable correction in
order to compensate for the effect of those conditions.
Why is choosing the cesium atomic clock as our standard better than choosing an astronomical process
such as the mean yearly motion of the earth around the Sun? The brief
answer is that the earth's rate of spin varies. The ocean's tides, the sloshing of earth's molten core,
and other things, are
affecting the rotation of the earth, but not affecting the atomic clock. If
we said that by definition the earth doesn't slow down, then scientists would
have to say that the frequency of light
emitted from cesium atoms is gradually increasing for seemingly no apparent
reason. That is, by sticking to the earth-sun
clock, we have trouble accounting for accelerations and
retardations of the orbital motions of the other planets compared with earth's
rotational period, and we have trouble accounting for the
simultaneous accelerations and retardations of atomic motions such as
those in cesium-133 atoms compared again with earth's rotational period. Our atomic theory says that these atomic
processes should behave uniformly as time goes on, so sticking with the
earth-sun clock forces us accept awkward changes in our atomic theory
and in the rotations of the other planets. On the other
hand, by switching to the cesium atomic standard, these alterations
are unnecessary, the mysteries vanish, and we can readily explain the non-uniform wobbling
of the earth's yearly revolutions by reference to the tides on the
earth, the movement of the liquid metal at the center of earth, the gravitational pull of other planets, dust between planets,
and collisions with comets. These influences affecting a solar clock
do not affect the cycles of the cesium atom.
There are two principal advantages of
the cesium clock: (1) it provides a standard that is reproducible
anywhere in the universe where there is cesium, and, more importantly, (2) the behavior of
the cesium atom is relatively insulated or isolated from other processes,
especially from a
comet's bombarding the earth.
In order to keep our atomic-based calendar in synchrony
with the rotations and revolutions of the earth, say, to keep
atomic-noons occurring on astronomical-noons and ultimately to prevent
Northern hemisphere winters from occurring in some future July, we
systematically add leap years and leap seconds and leap microseconds in the counting
process. These changes don't affect the duration of a second, but
they do affect the duration of a year because, with leap years, not
all years last the same number of seconds.
Our universe has a large number of
different processes that bear consistent time relations, or frequency
of occurrence relations, to each other. For example, the frequency of
a fixed-length pendulum is a constant multiple of the half life of a
specific radioactive uranium isotope; the relationship doesn't change
as time goes by (at least not much and not for a long time). The
existence of these sorts of relationships makes our system of
physical laws much simpler than it otherwise would be, and it makes
us more confident that there is something objective we are referring to with
the time-variable in those laws.
24. What does it mean for a clock to be accurate?
It's important to distinguish accuracy from precision. If
you use a bow to shoot arrows at a target, then the shooting is precise if all
the arrows cluster near a point, even if that point is far from the bull’s-eye.
For your shooting to be accurate you need to hit the bull’s-eye. The
standard clock's ticking is our bulls-eye. An ordinary wristwatch is considered to be accurate
if it ticks in synchrony (that is, in step) with our standard clock.
What it means for the standard clock to be accurate depends somewhat on your philosophy of time. If you are a conventionalist,
then once you pick the convention, the standard clock can’t fail to be accurate.
There may be more or less useful standards (you would do better choosing the ticks of an atomic clock rather
than the barks of your neighbor’s dog as the standard periodic process), but usefulness isn’t a sign of truth.
The absolute theory of time, on the other hand, implies time is marching on
independent of all events, and an accurate standard clock will be in sync with this “march.” If it is out
of sync, then our standard clock won’t be telling the true time. But since our civilization doesn’t know how to
establish this synchrony, we take a very different route to accuracy by saying the best
choice for a standard clock is one that is the most regular,
and we find out which is the most regular by finding the clock that is best
at meeting the following three goals:
a. The most accurate clock will use a process that is not affected very much by environmental conditions such as temperature, time of day, where it's located, human choices, the presence of dust and comets. [The standard atomic clock meets goal (a) better than the astronomical standard clock does.]
b. Exact reproductions of the clock should stay in synchrony with each other when environmental conditions are the same. To use the technical expression, the reproductions should remain sufficiently congruent, i.e., more congruent than competing clocks using a different standard.
c. The standard clock's readings should be consistent with the Newton's first and second laws of motion (assuming we are in a situation where these laws should hold so that we don't need to deal with Einstein's revisions of Newton's laws). If we run a test of those laws, and
if we find that Newton's laws are violated, then the problem isn’t with the laws but with the clock
used in our test, and we say the clock is inaccurate, provided there are no
other mistakes in the experiment. The first person to notice requirement (c) on accuracy of clocks was Leonhard Euler [1707-1783], a Swiss mathematician and physicist.
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