The Epistemology of Perception

Perception is a central issue in epistemology, the theory of knowledge. At root, all our empirical knowledge is grounded in how we see, hear, touch, smell and taste the world around us. In section 1, a distinction is drawn between perception that involves concepts and perception that doesn’t, and the various epistemic relations that there are between these two types of perception are discussed–our perceptual beliefs and our perceptual knowledge. Section 2 considers the role of causation in perception and focuses on the question of whether perceptual experience justifies our beliefs or merely causes them. Sections 3 and 4 further investigate the epistemic role of perception and introduce two distinct conceptions of the architecture of our belief system: foundationalism and coherentism. It is shown how perceptual experience and perceptual beliefs are integrated into these systems. Finally, section 5 turns to the externalist view that thinkers need not be aware of what justifies their perceptual beliefs.

Table of Contents

1. Perception and Belief
   1. Seeing That, Seeing As and Simple Seeing
   2. Perceptual Beliefs
2. Perception, Justification and Causation
   1. Armstrong’s Causal Account of Perceptual Knowledge
3. Perception and Foundationalism
   1. Traditional Foundationalism
   2. Sellars and the Myth of the Given
   3. Concepts and Experience
   4. Modest Foundationalism
4. Perception and Coherentism
   1. The Basic Idea Behind Coherentism
   2. Bonjour and the Spontaneous Nature of Perceptual Beliefs
5. Externalism
6. References and Further Reading

1. Perception and Belief

a. Seeing That, Seeing As and Simple Seeing

Perception is the process by which we acquire information about the world around us using our five senses. Consider the nature of this information. Looking out of your window, you see that it is raining. Your perception represents the world as being like that. To perceive the world in this way, therefore, it is required that you possess concepts, that is, ways of representing and thinking about the world. In this case, you require the concept RAIN. Thus, seeing that your coffee cup is yellow and that the pencil is green involves the possession of the concepts COFFEE CUP, YELLOW, PENCIL and GREEN. Such perception is termed “perceiving that,” and is factive; that is, it is presupposed that you perceive the world correctly. To perceive that it is raining, it must be true that it is raining. You can also, though, perceive the world to be a certain way and yet be mistaken. This we can call, “perceiving as,” or in the usual case, “seeing as”. A stick partly submerged in water may not be bent but, nevertheless, you see it as bent. Your perception represents the stick as being a certain way, although it turns out that you are wrong. Much of your perception, then, is representational: you take the world to be a certain way, sometimes correctly, when you see that the world is thus and so, and sometimes incorrectly, when the world is not how you perceive it to be.

It also seems that there is a form of perception that does not require the possession of concepts (although this claim has been questioned). It is plausible to claim that cognitively unsophisticated creatures, those that are not seen as engaging in conceptually structured thought, can perceive the world, and that at times we can perceptually engage with the world in a non-conceptual way. You can tell that the wasp senses or perceives your presence because of its irascible behavior. When you are walking along the High Street daydreaming, you see bus stops, waste bins, and your fellow pedestrians. You must see them because you do not bump into them, but you do not see that the bus stop is blue or that a certain pedestrian is wearing Wrangler jeans. You can, of course, come to see the street in this way if you focus on the scene in front of you, but the claim here is that there is a coherent form of perception that does not involve such conceptual structuring. Let us call such baseline perceptual engagement with the world, “simple seeing”. This perception involves the acquisition of perceptual information about the world, information that enables us to visually discriminate objects and to successfully engage with them, but also information that does not amount to one having a conceptually structured representation of the world. (Dretske, 1969, refers to simple seeing as “non-epistemic” seeing, and refers to ‘seeing that’ as “epistemic” seeing).

You can, then, simply see the bus stop, or you can see that the bus stop is blue, or you can, mistakenly, see the bus stop as made of sapphire. These are all forms of perceptual experience, ways you have of causally engaging with the world using your sensory apparatus and ways that have a distinctive conscious or “phenomenological” dimension. Seeing in its various forms strikes your consciousness in a certain way, a way that you are now experiencing as you look at your computer screen. This article investigates the causal and epistemic roles of this perceptual experience.

A little more terminology: the term “sensation” can be used to refer to the conscious aspect of perception, but note that one can have such sensations even when one would not be said to be perceiving the world. When hallucinating, for example, one is having the sensations usually characteristic of perceptual experience, even though in such cases one’s experience would not be described as perceptual.

Consider how these various kinds of perceptual experience are related to our perceptual beliefs. Perceptual beliefs are those concerning the perceptible features of our environment, and they are beliefs that are grounded in our perceptual experience of the world. The content of such beliefs can be acquired in other ways: You could be told that the bus stop is blue, or you could remember that it is blue. Right now, though, waiting for the bus, you acquire this belief by looking straight at it, and, thus, you have a perceptual belief concerning this particular fact. Just how your perceptual beliefs are grounded in your perceptual experience is a contentious issue. There is certainly a causal relation between the two, but some philosophers also claim that it is perceptual experience that provides justification for our perceptual beliefs. This foundationalist claim is denied by the coherentist (see sections 3 and 4 below).

b. Perceptual Beliefs

First, one does not necessarily come to acquire perceptual beliefs in virtue of simply seeing the world. Simple seeing is something that cognitively unsophisticated creatures can do, creatures such as wasps that do not have more sophisticated beliefs, propositional beliefs. It is plausible, though, that if one sees a certain object as a bus stop, then one would also come to believe that there is a bus stop being seen. In many cases, this is, of course, true, but it is not in all. A famous example is the Muller-Lyer illusion:

The two horizontal lines above look as though they are of different lengths, the upper line being longer than the lower. If we have seen the illusion before, then we do not believe our eyes. Instead, we believe that the lines are the same length (which they are). Here is another case: a habitual user of hallucinogenics may doubt the veracity of all his perceptions; he may not believe anything he sees. His perception, however, amounts to more than simply seeing; he sees the moon as being made of cheese and his cup of tea as grinning up at him. Yet, because of the doubt fostered by his frequent hallucinations, he does not move from seeing the world as being a certain way to believing that it is. In most cases, though, if one sees the world as being a certain way, then one also believes that it is that way. Last, let us return to the notion of “perceiving that.” Such perception has a closer relationship with the acquisition of perceptual belief. If one is described as perceiving that the world is a certain way, it is implied that one also believes that the world is so. Here, there isn’t room for perception to come apart from belief.

Thus, we have seen that we can be perceptually engaged with the world in various ways. Such engagement can amount to the mere acquisition of perceptual information, the experience of seeing the world as being a certain way, or the possession of the cognitive states of perceiving and believing that it is so. If all goes well, such perceptual beliefs may constitute perceptual knowledge of the world. According to the traditional account, this is when those beliefs are true and when they are justified. Perceptual knowledge consists in knowledge of the perceptible features of the world around us, and it is that which is grounded in our perceptual experience. Again, the nature of this grounding is controversial. Perceptual experience is certainly causally related to perceptual knowledge; foundationalists, however, make the further claim that such experience provides the justification that is constitutive of such knowledge (see section 3). Others, though, including Armstrong (section 2a) and the coherentists (section 4), do not believe perceptual experience plays this justificatory role with respect to perceptual knowledge. The next section considers this key issue of justification.

But consider the issue of skepticism. The skeptical arguments of Descartes (1641) have had an enormous influence on both the history and practice of epistemology. He suggests certain scenarios that threaten to undermine all of our empirical knowledge of the world. It could be that right now you are dreaming. If you were, everything might appear to you just as it currently does; dreams are sometimes very real. It is also possible that a powerful demon might be deliberately deceiving you; there may not be an external world at all, and all your perceptual experience and perceptual beliefs may be simply planted in your mind by this evil entity. Given such scenarios, it is not clear how our perceptual beliefs can be justified and thus, how we can have perceptual knowledge. Any reasons you have for thinking that such beliefs correctly represent the world are undermined by the fact that you could have such beliefs even if the external world did not exist. Since the seventeenth century, epistemology has been trying to find a solution to this Cartesian scepticism. This article simply assumes that we can have justification for our perceptual beliefs and that perceptual knowledge is possible. Given this assumption, the focus is on how we should conceive of such justification.

2. Perception, Justification and Causation

Perceptual experience provides both causal and justificatory grounding for our perceptual beliefs and for our knowledge of the passing show. In this section, we shall start to look at the causal and justificatory relations between perception, belief and knowledge. As was discussed above, our perceptual experience can be conceptually structured: we can see the world as being a certain way, or we can see that it is thus and so. Thus, such experience could be seen as providing justification for our perceptual knowledge in that you could be justified in taking things to have the properties you see them as having. The fact that perceptual experience is conceptual, however, is not sufficient to ensure that your perceptual beliefs are justified. Dave, a friend of yours, sees every tackle made against a player of West Ham United Football Club as a foul. He is not, however, justified in taking this to be true. Often these clashes are simply not fouls; Dave is wrong, and even when he is correct, when he really sees that a foul has been committed, it would seem that his prejudiced observation of the game entails that in these cases he only gets it right through luck, and thus, he is not justified in his belief. The fact, then, that our experience is conceptual does not entail that we have justified perceptual beliefs or knowledge. Section 3 considers what else needs to be said, and investigates an account of how perceptual experience is seen to provide epistemic justification. First, though, consider an account of perceptual knowledge that does not make use of the notion of justification.

a. Armstrong’s Causal Account of Perceptual Knowledge

Armstrong (1961 / 1973) claims that perceptual knowledge simply requires that one’s perceptual beliefs stand in lawlike relations to the world.

What makes…a belief a case of knowledge? My suggestion is that there must be a lawlike connection between the state of affairs Bap [that a believes p] and the state of affairs that makes ‘p’ true such that, given Bap, it must be the case that p. (Armstrong, 1973, p. 75)

Crudely, since causal relations are lawlike, if our perceptual and cognitive apparatus is such that it is buzzing flies that cause us to have perceptual beliefs about buzzing flies, then it will be the case that we will have perceptual knowledge of this annoying aspect of our environment when the bees cause the belief. Armstrong calls his account a “thermometer model” of knowledge. We can come to have knowledge of the world just as a thermometer can come to represent its own temperature. In both systems, there is simply a lawlike relation between a property of the world and a property of a representative device (the level of mercury in a thermometer or the state of certain internal cognitive mechanisms of a thinker).

Highlighting the role of perceptual experience, Armstrong claims that:

“perception is nothing but the acquiring of knowledge of, or, on occasions, the acquiring of an inclination to believe in, particular facts about the physical world, by means of our senses,” (Armstrong, 1961, p. 105)

He does, however, claim that there is a “contingent connection between perception and certain sorts of sensation,” and that this, “may help to explain the special ‘feel’ of perception,” (Armstrong, 1961, p. 112). Conscious sensation, then, is not essential to perception. I could be correctly said to see the road ahead as I drive late at night on the motorway, even though I have “switched off,” and appear to be driving on “autopilot.” I can see the road because I am still causally acquiring beliefs about the world in front of me by way of my senses. Similarly, cases of blindsight are also bonafide cases of perception. Blindsight patients claim to have a complete lack of visual experience on, for example, their left side, yet they can make reliable reports about shapes and objects that are presented to this side of their perceptual field (they themselves, however, claim that they are merely guessing). They do, then, seem to be acquiring correct beliefs about their environment via a causal engagement between the world and their senses, and thus, they perceive the world even though in such cases the contingent connections with sensation are lost. Thus, on Armstrong’s account, perceptual experience is not necessary for perceptual knowledge. When one does have conscious perceptual experiences, these do not play a justificatory role; they are simply causally related to perceptual belief and knowledge. Many, however, find such an account too sparse, in that one’s experience does not play any justificatory or epistemic role in the acquisition of perceptual beliefs or knowledge. It is claimed that a more satisfying theory of perception should include an account of why perceptual experience justifies our perceptual beliefs and that we should not be content with simply an account of why we are caused to acquire them. The following theory of perception attempts to include just such an account of justification.

3. Perception and Foundationalism

Foundationalists claim that the superstructure of our belief system inherits its justification from a certain subset of perceptual beliefs upon which the rest sits. These beliefs are termed “basic beliefs.” Our belief system, then, is seen as having the architecture of a building. Later, in section 4, we shall see that coherentists take our belief system to be more akin to an ecosystem, with our beliefs mutually supporting each other, rather than relying for their justification on certain crucial foundation stones. There are various versions of this foundationalist approach, two of which are discussed in the next two sections.

a. Traditional Foundationalism

Traditionally the foundations of knowledge have been seen as infallible (they cannot be wrong), incorrigible (they cannot be refuted), and indubitable (they cannot be doubted). For empiricists, these foundations consist in your beliefs about your own experience. Your beliefs are basic and non-basic. Your basic beliefs comprise such beliefs as that you are now seeing a red shape in your visual field, let us say, and that you are aware of a pungent smell. In order to justify your non-basic belief that Thierry Henry is the best striker in Europe, you must be able to infer it from other beliefs, say that he has scored the most goals. The traditional foundationalist claim, however, is that this sort of inferential justification is not required for your basic beliefs. There may not actually be a red object in the world because you may be hallucinating, but, nevertheless, you cannot be wrong about the fact that you now believe that you am seeing something red. Justification for such beliefs is provided by experiential states that are not themselves beliefs, that is, by your immediate apprehension of the content of your sensory, perceptual experience, or what is sometimes termed, “the Given”. It is, then, your experience of seeing red that justifies your belief that you are seeing red. Such experience is non-conceptual. It is, though, the raw material which you then go on to have conceptual thoughts about. This conception of the relation between knowledge and experience has had a distinguished history. It was advocated by the British empiricists–Locke, Berkeley and Hume–and by the important modern adherents C. I. Lewis (1946) and R. Chisholm (1989). However, this conception of how your perceptual beliefs are justified has been widely attacked, and the next two sections address the most influential arguments against traditional foundationalism.

b. Sellars and the Myth of the Given

Sellars (1956) provides an extended critique of the notion of the Given. There are two parts to Sellars’ argument: first, he claims that knowledge is part of the “logical space of reasons;” and second, he provides an alternative account of “looks talk,” or an alternative reading of such claims as “that looks red to me,” claims that traditionally have been seen as infallible and as foundations for our perceptual knowledge. According to Sellars, no cognitive states are non-inferentially justified. For him:

“The essential part is that in characterising an episode or a state as that of knowing, we are placing it in the logical space of reasons, of justifying and being able to justify what one says.” (Sellars, 1956, p. 76)

Whether we are talking about perceptual or non-perceptual knowledge, we must be able to offer reasons for why we take such claims to be true. To even claim appropriately that I have knowledge that I now seem to be seeing a red shape, I must be able to articulate such reasons as, “since my eyes are working fine, and the light is good, I am right in thinking that I am having a certain sensory experience.” As Rorty (1979, chapter 4) argues, justification is essentially a linguistic or “conversational” notion; it must consist in the reasoned recognition of why a particular belief is likely to be true or why one is rightly said to be having a certain experience. If such an account of justification is correct, then the notion of non-inferentially justified basic beliefs is untenable and non-conceptual perceptual experience cannot provide the justification for our perceptual beliefs.

Surely, though, “this looks red to me,” cannot be something that I can be wrong about. Such a foundationalist claim seems to be undeniable. Sellars, however, suggests that such wording does not indicate infallibility. One does not say, “This looks red to me,” to (infallibly) report the nature of one’s experience; rather, one uses such a locution in order to flag that one is unsure whether one has correctly perceived the world.

… when I say “X looks green to me”…the fact that I make this report rather than the simple report “X is green,” indicates that certain considerations have operated to raise, so to speak in a higher court, the question ‘to endorse or not to endorse.’ I may have reason to think that X may not after all be green. (Sellars, 1956, p. 41)

Thus, Sellars provides a two-pronged attack on traditional foundationalism. The way we describe our perceptual experience does indeed suggest that we have infallible access to certain private experiences, private experiences that we cannot be mistaken about. However, we should recognize the possibility that we may be being fooled by grammar here. Sellars gives an alternative interpretation of such statements as, “this looks red to me,” an interpretation that does not commit one to having such a privileged epistemological access to one’s perceptual experience. Further, a conceptual analysis of “knowledge” reveals that knowledge is essentially a rational state and, therefore, that one cannot claim to know what one has no reason for accepting as true. Such reasons must be conceived in terms of linguistic constructions that one can articulate, and thus, the bare presence of the Given cannot ground the knowledge we have of our own experience or, consequently, of the world. This, then, is a rejection of the traditional foundationalist picture, or what Sellars calls, “the Myth of the Given.”

One of the forms taken by the Myth of the Given is the idea that there is, indeed must be, a structure of particular matter of such fact that (a) each fact can not only be noninferentially known to be the case, but presupposes no other knowledge either of particular matters of fact, or of general truths; and (b) such that the noninferential knowledge of facts belonging to this structure constitutes the ultimate court of appeal for all factual claims, particular and general, about the world. (Sellars, 1956, pp. 68-9)

c. Concepts and Experience

According to traditional foundationalism, the content of perceptual experience, the Given, is not conceptual in nature. It has been argued, however, that experience should not be seen in this traditional way. The phenomenon of “seeing as,” suggests to some that experience should be interpreted as essentially conceptual in nature.

What is this a picture of?

You perhaps see a duck. I can, however, alter the character of your visual experience by changing the beliefs that you have about this picture. Think RABBIT looking upward. The picture now looks different to you even though you are seeing the same configuration of black marks on a white background. This picture is usually referred to as “the duck-rabbit.” Originally, you saw the drawing as a duck; now you see it as a rabbit (or, as Wittgenstein would say, you notice different “aspects” of the picture). You have, then, distinct perceptual experiences dependent on the particular concepts “through which” you see that picture. Some take this to prove that perceptual experience is not pre- or non-conceptual but that it is essentially a conceptual engagement with the world. Such experience does not only consist in our having certain retinal images: “There is more to seeing than meets the eyeball,” (Hanson, 1988, p. 294). It is, rather, the result of a necessary conceptual ordering of our perceptual engagement with the world. This is a theory of experience that is at odds with that of the traditional foundationalist.

The theory has Kantian roots. For Kant, one cannot experience the world without having a conceptual structure to provide the representational properties of such experience. In Kant’s terms, the intuitions received by the sensibility cannot be isolated from the conceptualization carried out by the understanding. As he states, “Intuitions without concepts are blind, concepts without intuitions are empty” (Kant, 1781, A51 / B75). Intuitions, or what we might call bare perceptual experience–that which does not have a conceptual structure–cannot be seen as experience of a world, and therefore, such a conception of our perceptual engagement with the world cannot be seen as experiential at all; it is “blind”. The second clause of Kant’s aphorism claims that concepts that are not based on information received through the senses can have no empirical content. The Kantian claim, then, is that thinking about the world and experiencing it are interdependent. This is an attack on the distinction drawn in section 1a between simple seeing and conceptually structured forms of perception such as seeing that and seeing as. Kant claims the notion of simple seeing is incoherent since such a non-conceptual engagement with the world isn’t experiential.

Not everyone accepts that the phenomenon of seeing as entails this picture of experience. Dretske (1969) argues that simple or non-epistemic seeing is independent of epistemic seeing; that is, it is independent of seeing that is conceptually structured. Non-epistemic seeing amounts to the ability to visually differentiate aspects of one’s environment such as the bus stop and the waste bin, and one can do this without seeing these items as anything in particular (although, of course, one usually does). Further, “seeing as” presupposes simple seeing. One has to have some bare experience to provide the raw materials for our conceptually structured experience or thought. We may be able to see the picture above as a duck or as a rabbit, but we can only do this if we have a non-conceptual experience of a certain configuration of black marks on a white background. One’s experience of the basic black and white lines in the figure is independent of any concepts one may have that may then allow one to see these lines in a certain more sophisticated way, that is, as a duck or as a rabbit. In reply, however, it could be claimed that even such a basic experience as this relies on the contingent fact that one has the concepts of, for example, BLACK and WHITE. Perhaps if one did not have these concepts, then one could not even see this basic figure.

We have, then, looked at two problems faced by the traditional foundationalist, both of which center on the alleged non-conceptual nature of perceptual experience. Two responses have been made by those who feel the force of these objections: some modify foundationalism in order to take account of some of the considerations above, and others reject it altogether. The first of these responses is the topic of the next section.

d. Modest Foundationalism

Some foundationalists agree that the Given is in some ways problematic, yet they still attempt to maintain a “modest” or “moderate” foundationalism. Audi (2003) and Plantinga (2000) promote this view. First, our perceptual beliefs concerning both the world and our own experience are not seen as infallible. You can believe that you see red or that you seem to see red, yet either belief could turn out to be unjustified. Second, non-conceptual perceptual experience does not play a justificatory role. Perceptual beliefs are simply self-justified; that is, it is reasonable to accept that they are true unless we have evidence to suggest that they may be untrustworthy. Such a view of perception remains foundationalist in nature because we still have basic beliefs, beliefs that are non-inferentially justified. Thus, the justification possessed by perceptual beliefs is defeasible. You may, for example, have good evidence that your cup of tea has been spiked with an hallucinogen, and, therefore, the justification for your perceptual belief that a pig has just flown past the window is defeated. More controversially, your belief that you seem to see red could be defeated by psychological evidence concerning your confused or inattentive state of mind. However, in the absence of any beliefs concerning such contravening evidence, your perceptual beliefs have prima facie justification.

Modest foundationalism avoids a dilemma that faces traditional foundationalism. It is certainly plausible that beliefs about your own perceptual experience are infallible and that you can’t be wrong when you claim that the cup looks red. It is not clear, however, how such beliefs can ground your perceptual knowledge since they are about your own mental states and not the world. The fact that the cup looks red to you does of course relate to the cup, but primarily it is a fact about how that cup strikes your experience. Recoiling from such a picture, you could claim that your foundational beliefs concern the color of the cup and not merely your experience of the cup. However, it is not plausible that your beliefs about the color of the cup are infallible, and therefore, such beliefs cannot play a foundational role according to the traditional account. The modest foundationalist can avoid this dilemma. For a perceptual belief to be justified, it does not have to be infallible. You can, therefore, have beliefs about the properties of objects in the world playing the requisite foundational role rather than those that are simply about your own experiences.

4. Perception and Coherentism

Modest foundationalists attempt to keep some of the features of the traditional foundationalist picture while conceding that their foundations aren’t infallible. There is, however, a distinct response to the problems associated with traditional foundationalism, and that is to reject its key feature, namely its reliance on foundational, non-inferential, basic beliefs. Coherentism presents an alternative. Coherentists such as Bonjour (1985) and Lehrer (1990) claim that beliefs can only be justified by other beliefs and that this is also true of our perceptual beliefs. Section 3.a described how Sellars argued for such a position in that, for him, perceptual beliefs must be supported by beliefs about the reliability of our experience. The next two sections explain the coherentist account of justifying perceptual claims.

a. The Basic Idea Behind Coherentism

For a coherentist, a particular belief is justified if one’s set of beliefs is more coherent with this belief as a member, and, conversely, a belief is unjustified if the coherence of one’s set of beliefs is increased by dropping that particular belief. The basic idea behind coherentism is that the better a belief system “hangs together,” the more coherent it is. How, though, should we conceive of “hanging together” or “coherence”? First, one requires consistency. Our beliefs should not clash; they must not be logically inconsistent: we should not believe p and believe that not p. However, more than mere logical consistency is required. One could imagine a set of beliefs that consisted of the belief that 2+2=4, the belief that Cher is a great actress, and the belief that yellow clashes with pink. Although these beliefs are logically consistent, they do not form a particularly coherent belief set since they do not have any bearing on each other at all. For coherence, therefore, some kind of positive connection between one’s beliefs is also required. Such a positive connection is that of inference. A maximally coherent belief set is one that is logically consistent and one within which the content of any particular belief can be inferred from the content of certain other beliefs that one holds. Conversely, the coherence of a set of beliefs is reduced if there are subgroups of beliefs that are inferentially isolated from the whole.

b. Bonjour and the Spontaneous Nature of Perceptual Beliefs

For a coherentist, perceptual beliefs are justified, as all beliefs are, if our acceptance of them leads to an increase in the overall coherence of our belief system. An account, though, is also required of how perceptual beliefs can be seen as correctly representing the external world, a world that is independent of our thinking. This is particularly pressing for the coherentist because the justification for our perceptual beliefs is provided by one’s other beliefs and not by one’s perceptual experience of one’s environment.

To account for the representational ability of perceptual beliefs, Bonjour focuses upon a class of beliefs that he calls “cognitively spontaneous.” These are beliefs we simply acquire without inference. Right now, on turning my head to the left, I spontaneously acquire the belief that the orange stapler is in front of the blue pen, and that my glass of water is half full. These perceptual beliefs are likely to be true when certain conditions obtain–that the light is good and that I am not too far away from what I am looking at (these Bonjour calls the “C-conditions”). My belief, then, that my glass is half full is only justified if I also have beliefs about the obtaining of C-conditions. However, for Bonjour’s account to be persuasive, he needs to provide some justification for this claim that beliefs acquired in the C-conditions are likely to be true representations of the world. This he does. First, we do not arrive at them via inference; they are spontaneous. Second, the beliefs that we acquire in this way exhibit a very high measure of coherence and consistency with each other and with the rest of our belief system. The question arises, then, as to why this should be so, since it is not obvious why such spontaneous beliefs should continue to cohere so well. If, for example, these beliefs were randomly produced by our perceptual mechanisms, then our set of beliefs would very soon be disrupted. Bonjour’s claim is that there is a good a priori explanation for the ongoing coherence and consistency of our set of beliefs, that is, that it is the result of our beliefs being caused by a coherent and consistent world. Thus, our perceptual beliefs correctly represent a world that is independent of our thinking. Non-conceptual perceptual experience does not play a justificatory role with respect to perception. This experience may cause us to acquire certain beliefs about our environment, but the justification for these perceptual beliefs is provided by the inferential relations that hold between these beliefs and the rest of our belief system.

There are important objections. Plantinga (1993) notes that in the Cartesian skeptical scenarios we also have a coherent set of beliefs, but in these cases they are caused not by a coherent and consistent world but by an evil demon or by a mad scientist who manipulates a brain that lies in a vat of nutrient fluid (see Descartes 1641 and Putnam 1981). Bonjour’s claim, however, is that it is a priori more probable that our beliefs are not caused by these creatures. Plantinga finds such reasoning “monumentally dubious.”

Even if such a hypothesis [that concerning the claim that our coherent belief system corresponds to a coherent world] and these skeptical explanations do have an a priori probability…it’s surely anyone’s guess what that probability might be. Assuming there is such a thing as a priori probability, what would be the a priori probability of our having been created by a good God who…would not deceive us? What would be the a priori probability of our having been created by an evil demon who delights in deception? And which, if either, would have the greater a priori probability?…how could we possibly tell? (Plantinga, 1993, p. 109)

5. Externalism

The varieties of foundationalism and coherentism examined so far share a certain approach to questions concerning epistemic justification. They ask whether the evidence available to you is sufficient to justify the beliefs that you hold. Questions of justification are approached from the first person perspective. Foundationalists claim that you have justified perceptual beliefs because of the fact that these beliefs are grounded in your perceptual experience, experience that is, of course, accessible to you; it is something of which you are aware, something that you can reflect upon. Coherentists find justification in the inferential relations that hold between your perceptual and non-perceptual beliefs, relations that are, again, something to which you have cognitive access. Epistemic practices can, however, also be assessed from the third person perspective. It can be asked whether a person’s methods do, in fact, lead him or her to have true beliefs about the world, whether or not such reliability is something of which they are aware. Externalists claim that it is this perspective with which epistemology should be concerned. A key notion for externalists is that of reliability. A belief is justified if it is acquired using a method that is reliable, with reliability being cashed out in terms of the probability that one’s thinking latches onto the truth.

The justificatory status of a belief is a function of the reliability of the processes that cause it, where (as a first approximation) reliability consists in the tendency of a process to produce beliefs that are true rather than false. (Goldman, 1979, p. 10)

One need not be able to tell by reflection alone whether or not one’s thinking is reliable in the required sense; a thinker does not have to be aware of what it is that justifies his or her beliefs.

According to a reliabilist, then, a perceptual belief is justified if it is the product of reliable perceptual processes. One strategy that reliabilists have adopted is to ground their account of reliability in terms of the causal connections that thinkers have to the world. Roughly, for one to have a justified perceptual belief that p, the fact that p should cause my belief that p. I am justified in believing that Frasier is on television because its presence on the screen causes my belief. Such accounts are developed by Goldman (1979 / 1986) and Dretske (1981). It is important to note the difference between this kind of account and that of Armstrong (section 2a). Armstrong eschews all talk of justification and provides a wholly causal account of perceptual knowledge. Many externalists, however, give an account of justification in causal terms.

It was assumed throughout this article, except during the discussion of scepticism, that we do have perceptual knowledge of the world, and the article explored the multifarious epistemic and causal relations that there are between the various modes of perception and perceptual knowledge. Justification is the key issue, and there are four basic stances. One stance is to agree with Armstrong and deny that perceptual experience plays any justificatory role. Foundationalists see perceptual experience as the justificatory basis for perceptual knowledge, and it is such experience that ultimately provides justification for all our knowledge of the world. Problems with the traditional form of this position urged us to explore a more modest form of foundationalism. Others reject foundationalism altogether. Coherentists claim that the justification for our perceptual beliefs is a function of how well those beliefs “hang together” with the rest of our belief system. They too reject the justificatory role of perceptual experience. Some externalists claim that justification is a matter of reliability and that so long as our perceptual beliefs are produced by mechanisms that reliably give us true beliefs, then those beliefs are justified. Therefore, perception is of prime epistemological importance, and it remains the focus of lively philosophical debate.

6. References and Further Reading

• Armstrong, D. M. ‘The Thermometer Theory of Knowledge’ in S. Bernecker & F. Dretske, eds. Knowledge: Readings in Contemporary Epistemology, Oxford University Press, Oxford, pp. 72-85, 2000. Originally published in Armstrong, 1973, pp. 162-75, 178-83.
• Armstrong, D. M. Belief, Truth and Knowledge, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1973.
• Armstrong, D. M. Perception and the Physical World, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1961.
  • Included in the above is Armstrong’s causal account of perception.
• Audi, R. “Contemporary Modest Foundationalism,” in Pojman, L. ed. The Theory of Knowledge: Classical and Contemporary Readings, Wadsworth, Belmont, CA. 3rd edition, 2003.
  • A useful paper in which it is argued that modest foundationalism has advantages over traditional foundationalism.
• Bonjour, L. The Structure of Empirical Knowledge, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1985.
  • A well-developed coherentist theory of justification which includes an account of the role of perception within such a theory. (One should note, however, that Bonjour has recently abandoned coherentism in favour of a version of foundationalism.)
• Chisholm, R. M. Theory of Knowledge, 3rd edition, Englewood Cliffs, New Jersey, 1989.
  • A wide ranging study of various epistemological issues including his version of traditional foundationalism.
• Descartes, R. “First Meditation,” in Meditations on First Philosophy, 1641. Reprinted in The Philosophical Writings of Descartes, eds. J. Cottingham, R. Stoothoff & D. Murdoch, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1983.
  • One of the most influential passages of epistemological writing in the history of Western philosophy in which various skeptical possibilities are raised that suggest that our perceptual beliefs may not be justified.
• Dretske, F. Seeing and Knowing, Routledge and Kegan Paul, London, 1969.
  • Dretske defends the claim that seeing can be seen as non-conceptual (or non-epistemic).
• Dretske, F. Knowledge and the Flow of Information, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1981.
  • Here he presents his sophisticated version of reliabilism.
• Goldman, A. I. “What is Justified Belief?,” in G. Pappas, ed. Justification and Knowledge: New Studies in Epistemology, Reidel, pp. 1-23, 1979.
• Goldman, A.I. Epistemology and Cognition, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1986.
  • In the above, Goldman forwards his reliabilist account of justification.
• Grice, H. P. “The Causal Theory of Perception,” in Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary Volume 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
  • A precursor to the various contemporary causal theories of perception, presented in the context of a sense datum theory of perception.
• Hanson, N. R. “From Patterns of Discovery,” in Perception, R. Schwartz, ed. pp. 292- 305, 1988.
  • Hansen argues that the nature of our perceptual experience depends on the concepts we possess.
• Kant, I. The Critique of Pure Reason, trans. N. Kemp Smith, 1929 edition, The Macmillan Press, Ltd. Basingstoke, Hampshire, 1781.
  • One of the greatest and most influential works of modern philosophy. Of relevance to this article are Kant’s thoughts concerning the relation between our conceptual framework and the nature of our perceptual experience.
• Lehrer, K. Theory of Knowledge, Westview Press, Boulder, Colorado, 1990.
  • Lehrer provides a critique of foundationalism and his own developed version of coherentism.
• Lewis, C. I. An Analysis of Knowledge and Evaluation, La Salle, Illinois, 1946.
  • Amongst various other important epistemological issues, one can find Lewis’s account of traditional foundationalism.
• McDowell, J. Mind and World, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass. 1994.
  • In this transcription of his Locke lectures, McDowell argues that perceptual experience is essentially conceptual in nature.
• Plantinga, A. Warrant: The Current Debate, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1993.
  • An excellent epistemology textbook which includes an in-depth critique of Bonjour’s coherentism.
• Plantinga, A. Warranted Christian Belief, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 2000.
  • In the context of a sophisticated discussion of the philosophy of religion, Plantinga develops a version of modest foundationalism which he calls “reformed epistemology”.
• Putnam, H. Reason, Truth and History, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1981.
  • In chapter 1, Putnam presents his contemporary brain in a vat version of the Cartesian skeptical scenario.
• Rorty, R. Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature, Princetown University Press, Princetown, 1979.
  • A historically informed and extended attack on traditional foundationalism.
• Schwartz, R. Perception, Blackwell, Oxford, 1988.
  • A good collection of articles focused on the epistemology of perception.
• Sellars, W. Empiricism and the Philosophy of Mind. Originally published in H. Feigl and M. Scrivens, eds. Minnesota Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. 1, University of Minnesota Press, Minneapolis, pp. 253-329, 1956. Page numbers here refer to 1997 reprint, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass.
  • This includes Sellars’ influential attack on the Given.

Author Information

Daniel O’Brien
Email: D.Obrien@bham.ac.uk
The University of Birmingham
U. S. A.

Evidentialism

Evidentialism in epistemology is defined by the following thesis about epistemic justification:

(EVI) Person S is justified in believing proposition p at time t if and only if S’s evidence for p at t supports believing p.

As evidentialism is a thesis about epistemic justification, it is a thesis about what it takes for one to believe justifiably, or reasonably, in the sense thought to be necessary for knowledge. Particular versions of evidentialism can diverge in virtue of their providing different claims about what sorts of things count as evidence, what it is for one to have evidence, and what it is for one’s evidence to support believing a proposition. Thus, while (EVI) is often referred to as the theory of epistemic justification known as evidentialism, it is more accurately conceived as a kind of epistemic theory. In this light, (EVI) can be seen as the central, guiding thesis of evidentialism. All evidentialist theories conform to (EVI), but various divergent theories of evidentialism can be formulated.

Before turning to these issues, it is worth noting that evidentialism is also a prominent theory in the philosophy of religion. Evidentialism in the philosophy of religion has its own set of controversies, but this entry will not cover them. On evidentialism in the philosophy of religion, see Alvin Plantinga’s classic article, “Reason and Belief in God.” For a more extended discussion, see Plantinga’s Warranted Christian Belief.

Table of Contents

1. A Brief Prima Facie Case
2. Developing the Theory
   1. The Justification of Propositions v. The Justification of Beliefs
   2. Evidence
   3. Having Evidence
   4. Support
3. Objections
   1. Forgotten Evidence
   2. Against a Probabilistic-Deductive Understanding of Support
   3. Essential Appeals to Deontology
      1. Ought Implies Can
      2. An Evidence-Gathering Requirement
      3. Duties Not to Follow One’s Evidence
   4. A Pragmatic Reply
   5. Rationally Believing Skepticism is False
4. Conclusion
5. References and Further Reading
   1. More Advanced Studies

1. A Brief Prima Facie Case

When we think about what it takes for one to believe reasonably or justifiably, we think that one has to have good reasons (or, more accurately, adequate reason for thinking the proposition in question is true). We think that one is not believing as one should when one believes something for no reason whatsoever or for very weak reasons. This dependence on reasons seems to be central to the very concept of justified belief. It should be no surprise, then, that the traditional view holds that one is justified only if one has adequate reasons for belief. Thus, evidentialism can be thought of as the default, or commonsense, conception of epistemic justification. Indeed, we can see the centrality of this conception of justification throughout the history of philosophy, especially in its grappling with the problem of skepticism. In order to justify denying skeptical claims, we want to know what reason we have for believing that skepticism is false. Traditional accounts have looked to one’s available evidence or reasons for an answer.

Naturally, then, we see this traditional conception reflected in the writings of many influential philosophers. David Hume, for example, writes that the “wise man. . . proportions his belief to the evidence,” and he proceeds with this as his epistemic ideal (73). Bertrand Russell endorses the view that “[p]erfect rationality consists . . . in attaching to every proposition a degree of belief corresponding to its degree of credibility,” credibility functionally depending on evidence (397-398). W.K. Clifford writes that “it is wrong always, everywhere, and for anyone to believe anything upon insufficient evidence” (518). Such quotations help to illustrate the dominance of the view that justified belief depends upon one’s having good reasons or evidence. Though this by no means settles the issue, it does provide reason to try to work out a theory of justification that appeals solely to evidence. The remainder of this entry turns toward a detailed consideration of the theory itself.

2. Developing the Theory

Richard Feldman and Earl Conee, two leading defenders of evidentialism, have explicitly defined evidentialism as a thesis about the justificatory status of all of the doxastic attitudes: belief, disbelief, and suspension of judgment. They write that doxastic attitude, d, toward p is justified for one at t if and only if one’s evidence at t supports one’s taking d towards p (15). So understood, evidentialism is not just a thesis about justified belief, it is also a thesis about justified disbelief and the justified withholding of belief. Only one doxastic attitude towards a proposition is justified for a person at a time, and this is a function of one’s evidence. Here, I focus on the core of evidentialism—the thesis about justified belief given in (EVI)—both for simplicity and because most treatments and criticisms of evidentialism focus on it. What is said about (EVI) can be extended naturally to the rest of the doxastic attitudes and thereby applied to Feldman and Conee’s explicit thesis.

a. The Justification of Propositions v. The Justification of Beliefs

Before proceeding, it is crucial to nail down more exactly what evidentialism is a theory of. As I have defined it in (EVI), evidentialism is the thesis that one is justified in believing a proposition at a time if and only if one’s evidence at that time supports believing that proposition. (EVI) does not entail that whenever one has adequate evidence for p one believes p justifiably. This is for two reasons. First, one can be justified in believing p even if one fails to believe it. For example, one might not believe p simply because one fails to consider whether or not p is true, yet one may nevertheless have good enough reason to think p is true and so be justified in believing p.

Second, one can have good enough reason to believe p and still believe it as a result of something other than this good reason. One might believe it as a result of wishful thinking, for example. In such a case, the evidentialist holds that the person is justified in believing the proposition in question but, nevertheless, believes it unjustifiably. One believes it for or because of the wrong reasons. One way of putting the difference here is by saying that evidentialism is a thesis regarding propositional justification, not a thesis about doxastic justification. That is, evidentialism is a thesis about when one is justified in believing a proposition, not a thesis about when one’s believing is justified. The latter requires not just that one have good reason to believe but also that one believe for those good reasons.

b. Evidence

As introduced above, evidentialism is a kind of theory of epistemic justification; one can formulate various divergent evidentialist theories by providing different analyses of its constituent concepts. The present section focuses on the central notion of evidence and explicates the various ways that one can restrict the sorts of things that count as evidence. Sections 2c. and 2d. turn to complexities in other parts of (EVI). Together, these three sections illustrate the diversity of possible evidentialist theories.

Evidence for or against p is, roughly, any information relevant to the truth or falsity of p. This is why we think that fingerprints and DNA left at the scene of the crime, eye-witness testimony, and someone’s whereabouts at the time the crime was committed all count as evidence for or against the hypothesis that the suspect committed the crime. The sort of evidence that interests the evidentialist, however, is not just anything whatsoever that is relevant to the truth of the proposition in question. The evidentialist denies that such facts about mind-independent reality are evidence in the sense relevant to determining justification. According to (EVI) only facts that one has are relevant to determining what one is justified in believing, and in order for one to have something in the relevant sense, one has to be aware of, to know about, or to, in some sense, “mentally possess” it. The sort of evidence the evidentialist is interested in, therefore, is restricted to mental entities (or, roughly, to mental “information”). In addition, it is only one’s own mental information that is relevant to determining whether one is justified in believing that p. For example, my belief that Jones was in Buffalo at the time the crime was committed is not relevant to determining whether you are justified in believing that Jones committed the crime.

Evidentialist theories can agree on this much while still providing differing accounts of evidence. For example, one might think that only one’s own beliefs can provide one with reason to believe something, as many coherentists do. An evidentialist might then hold that only belief states are evidential states. One’s experiences (that is, experiential states) then would not be evidentially or justificatorily relevant. The standard view of evidentialism, however, is that at least beliefs and perceptual states are evidential states. Not only what you believe but also what you experience can provide you with reason to believe that something is the case. Yet one does not have to stop there. One, for example, might also count memories, apparent memories, or seemings-to-be-true as kinds of evidence. In the end, what sorts of states one takes to be evidential will depend both on one’s intuitions about what sorts of things can provide one with genuine reason to believe and also on one’s strategy for responding to objections.

It is worth noting that while evidentialists have available many options about what to count as kinds of evidence, not just anything mental can properly be classified as evidence. In general, only those states or properties that are themselves informational (or at least can directly and on their own “communicate” information to the subject) can properly be classified as evidential states or properties. Regardless of whether one’s feeling of pain is an informational state, it does, so to speak, directly or on its own “communicate” information to one; so it is open to the evidentialist to classify it as an evidential state. By contrast, one’s ability to, e.g., identify complex geometrical shapes in one’s visual field is not itself a kind of evidence. (Even though this ability will undoubtedly provide one with evidence one would otherwise not possess.) The ability to identify complex geometrical shapes in one’s visual field is not a kind of evidence because it is neither an informational state, nor is it a state that directly and on its own “communicates” information to one. Instead, it is always something else that gets “communicated” to one via that ability. In general, therefore, cognitive abilities are not properly considered as part of one’s evidence. As we will see below, though, this is not to say that one’s cognitive abilities are completely irrelevant to justification on every evidentialist view.

c. Having Evidence

As alluded to above, not just any evidence whatsoever is relevant to determining whether one’s belief is justified; it is only the evidence that one has that is so relevant. The obvious restriction this imposes is that one’s evidence includes only one’s own mental states. One option, then, is to hold that one’s evidence at a time (or, alternatively, the evidence one has at a time) consists in all of the evidential mental states that obtain in the person at that time, including both occurrent and nonoccurrent mental states. On this view, one’s evidence includes not only one’s present experiences and those beliefs presently “before one’s mind” but also stored or standing beliefs, even if one is not presently able to recall or consciously consider them.

To see how this account of having evidence affects the consequences of the theory, consider the following example. Suppose that I believe that most television newscasters reliably report the day’s news. I find that television newscasters almost always report the day’s stories in ways consistent with that reported by other news outlets. For example, if the newscaster were to report that a fire occurred on Elm Street, I would also be able to find a report in the newspaper confirming that a fire did, indeed, occur on Elm Street. When I discuss this topic with people, they tend to agree that this is the case, and I have no strong evidence against this belief. It seems, then, that I justifiably believe that most television newscasters reliably report the news. Also suppose that fifteen years ago I heard reliable testimony that one newscaster, Mick Stuppagin, almost always provides incorrect reports. At the time, I believed that Mick was a very unreliable newscaster. Suppose, however, that although my belief that Mick’s reports are unreliable and the testimony that such is the case are still stored in my long-term memory, I am presently unable to recall them. If someone mentions Mick Stuppagin and asks whether I think he is a reliable newscaster, I may form the belief that he is a reliable newscaster on the basis of my justified belief that most newscasters are reliable.

On the view developed above, I would be believing unjustifiably, since I have outweighing evidence against p. I would not be justified in believing that Mick is a reliable newscaster even though I may be utterly unable to recall my evidence against this belief, even though my so believing may be completely blameless, and even though it may seem to me on deep reflection that I am believing as I should. Some may find this counterintuitive and, as a result, may want to formulate a more restricted account of having evidence.

One such option is to hold that the evidence one has at a time is restricted to one’s occurrent evidential states—i.e., those states involving one’s current assent, those presently “before one’s mind,” so to speak. On this account of having evidence, my stored memory belief that Mick Stuppagin is an unreliable newscaster is not evidence that I have at the present time. Furthermore, it is also not clearly true that I have as evidence my belief that most television newscasters reliably report the day’s news, and it is doubtful that my testimonial and inductive evidence for this belief is properly considered evidence that I presently have. The justificatory status of my present belief about Mick Stuppagin will depend solely on my occurrent evidential states. (The details of the case would need to be filled in order to determine whether or not the theory implies that belief is justified.)

The difficulty for this view is to show how such a restricted view of one’s having evidence can account for the justification of all of the beliefs we think are justified. For instance, we think we have some non-occurrent beliefs that are justified. We need an explanation of this. Similarly, it seems that as soon as I occurrently entertain the proposition that George Washington was the first president of the United States, I am justified in believing it, and its being so justified does not depend upon my consciously recalling anything. Those who restrict the evidence one has to one’s occurrent states need either to provide an explanation of this or to in some way explain away these common intuitions.

Other accounts of having evidence lie between these two extremes. A more typical “internalist” account might hold, for example, that the evidence one has at a time is that which is easily available to one upon reflection, so not all of one’s beliefs count as evidence that one has at a time. On this account, I am presently justified in believing that Mick is a reliable newscaster if and only if my stored memory belief that Mick is an unreliable newscaster (and its supporting evidence) is not easily available to me upon reflection. Various other accounts of having evidence can be developed that allow for varying degrees of availability or varying amounts of reflection. Guiding each account of having evidence are intuitions regarding cases similar to that above and intuitions regarding the extent to which justification is deontological.

We can conclude from the above that evidentialist theories can be formulated so as to account for widely divergent intuitions regarding cases. Furthermore, without a specific account of what it is for one to have evidence, it is not clear which proposed cases are to count as counterexamples to the theory.

d. Support

Recall that on the evidentialist view, S is justified in believing p at t if and only if S’s evidence for p at t supports believing p. We have already seen how evidentialists can provide different accounts of evidence and having evidence. The present section focuses on complexities with the notion of support.

Perhaps the most obvious issue that needs to be addressed in order to understand what it is for one’s evidence to support believing a proposition is the degree to which one’s evidence must support that proposition in order for one to be justified in believing it. Again, this will vary from account to account. One standard account understands it as follows: one is justified in believing a proposition only if the evidence that one has makes it more likely to be true than not. The likelihood of truth given one’s evidence has to be greater than 0.5 in order for one to be justified in believing the proposition, but the threshold required for knowledge might be much higher. In order to know that p, one might not merely have to justifiably believe that p; one might have to justifiably believe it to a certain degree.

This way of understanding the degree of support required in order for one to be justified in believing p is absolute, or we might say non-contextual. The degree required is the same across all possible cases. By contrast, Stewart Cohen presents a contextualist version of evidentialism. On his account, the degree to which one’s evidence must support a proposition in order for one to be justified in believing it will fluctuate with the conversationally determined standards that govern attributions of justification and knowledge. An immediate result is that one’s evidence for p may be enough to make believing p justified in one context (where the conversationally-determined standards for justification are relatively low) while failing to make believing p justified in another context (where the standards for justification are much higher). Evidentialism is, therefore, consistent with both contextualist theories of justification and non-contextualist theories of justification.

A further, more central epistemological issue regarding support has to do with the structure of justification. Evidentialism may be combined with foundationalism, coherentism, a “mixed” view such as Susan Haack’s foundherentism, or any other theory of the structure of justification. Each theory may be incorporated into evidentialism by understanding them as providing an account of the proper nature of epistemic support. Since foundationalism is far more dominant than the other theories, in what follows I will present one way of developing evidentialism with regard to it.

According to foundationalism, a belief is justified if and only if: either it is a foundational belief or it is supported by beliefs which either are themselves foundational beliefs or are ultimately supported by foundational beliefs. From the previous section, we have seen that it is only the evidence one has that is relevant to determining whether a belief is justified. Of all of this, foundationalism implies that only that evidence which is non-doxastic, foundational, or ultimately supported by a foundational belief is capable of supporting (or conferring positive justificatory status on) a belief. (Non-doxastic evidential states may include appearance states, direct apprehensions, rational intuitions, and seemings-to-be-true. For the foundationalist, some such evidential states are crucial as only they can justify the foundational beliefs.)

Assuming this framework, we can proceed as follows. In order to determine whether one is justified in believing that p, first isolate the portion of the evidence that is non-doxastic, foundational, or ultimately supported by a foundational belief. Only this is capable of justifying a proposition. Next, if the proposition under consideration is believed, subtract that belief and anything else whose support essentially depends on (or traces back to) that belief. (This last modification is intended to accommodate the foundationalist thesis that only the more basic can justify the less basic. See, for example, the discussion in section 3e. below.) Finally, determine whether this portion of one’s evidence makes the proposition more likely true than not. If so, then it is prima facie supported by one’s evidence (and thus prima facie justified). If not, it is unjustified, for it is not supported by the evidence one has that is able to justify one’s believing the proposition.

Note that I have had to add a prima facie qualification here. This is due to the, at least, apparent possibility of one’s support for a belief being defeated by other evidence one has that is neither non-doxastic, nor foundational, nor ultimately supported by foundational beliefs. An unjustified belief may be able to defeat the positive justification one has for believing p, but such unjustified beliefs have so far been excluded from consideration. In such a case, we may want to say that one would not be justified in believing p.

3. Objections

The aim in this section is to provide a sampling of objections that have been raised against evidentialist theories of justification. The aim is not to respond to these objections on behalf of the evidentialist nor to evaluate their strength. While the following are not objections to all possible versions of evidentialism, together they illustrate the difficulty in formulating a complete and adequate evidentialist theory. The chief difficulty for the evidentialist is to develop the theory in a way that avoids all such objections and does so in an independently motivated and principled way.

a. Forgotten Evidence

One kind of objection stems from the widespread occurrence of one’s forgetting the evidence that one once had for some proposition. We can distinguish between two sorts of cases here. According to the first sort, though one once had good evidence for believing, one has since forgotten it. Nevertheless, one may continue to believe justifiably, even without coming to possess any additional evidence. Evidentialism appears unable to account for this. According to the second sort of case, when one originally came to believe p, one had no evidence to support believing p. Perhaps one originally came to believe p for very bad reasons. Consequently, just after one formed the belief, one was not believing justifiably as one’s total evidence did not support believing that p. Suppose, though, that one has since forgotten why it is that one originally formed the belief and also has forgotten all of the evidence one had against it. Since it doesn’t seem as though in the interim one has to have gained some additional evidence for p, one might think that the subject of the second case remains unjustified in believing p. The relevant beliefs in both cases appear to be on an evidential par: neither belief seems to be supported by adequate evidence. The objection is that there, nevertheless, is a justificatory difference between the two cases, and evidentialism is unable to account for this.

The details of the cases proposed along these lines are crucial, for evidentialists may be able to motivate a denial of the critic’s justificatory assessment of one of the cases. This, however, is only of help when combined with an explanation for the justification of memory beliefs in general and memory beliefs involving forgotten evidence in particular.

Here evidentialists can appeal to the notion of evidence and to what sorts of states or properties are properly classified as evidential. For example, one may argue that the “felt impulse” to believe the proposition recalled from memory or its “seeming to be true” is itself a kind of evidence. On this account, in the first case one is justified in believing p because one does have evidence that supports believing p. The supporting evidence is the proposition’s “seeming to be true” or the “felt impulse” that accompanies the belief, but this very same evidence is present in the second case as well. Furthermore, this “felt impulse” or “seeming to be true” will necessarily accompany any memory belief, so there will be no cases along the lines of the second sort in which one has no evidence to support believing p. As a result, the critic’s appraisal of the second case is mistaken. In the absence of overriding counter-evidence, one’s memory belief is justified, so the correct appraisal of the second case holds that one is justified in believing p. In short, the critic’s justificatory assessment of the second case is mistaken.

b. Against a Probabilistic-Deductive Understanding of Support

A second objection targets the notion of one’s evidence supporting a proposition. As I have developed the notion of support above, part of it is given by some theory of probability. A body of evidence, e, supports believing some proposition p only if e makes p probable. If we suppose for simplicity that all of the beliefs that constitute e are themselves justified, we can say that e supports believing p if and only if e makes p probable. However, one might argue that, even with this assumption, one’s evidence e can make p probable without one being justified in believing that p. If this is so, the resulting evidentialist thesis is false.

Alvin Goldman, for example, has argued that the possession of reasons that make p probable, all things considered, is not sufficient for p to be justified (Epistemology and Cognition, 89-93). The crux of the case he considers is as follows. Suppose that while investigating a crime a detective has come to know a set of facts. These facts do establish that it is overwhelmingly likely that Jones has committed the crime, but it is only an extremely complex statistical argument that shows this. Perhaps the detective is utterly unable to understand how the evidence he has gathered supports this proposition. In such a case, it seems wrong to say that the detective is justified in believing the proposition, since he does not even have available to him a way of reasoning from the evidence to the conclusion that Jones did it. He has no idea how the evidence makes the proposition that Jones did it likely. Thus, the evidentialist thesis, so understood, is false.

The appeal to probability and statistics here is not essential to this sort of objection, so it would be a mistake to focus solely on this feature of the case in attempting to respond. Richard Feldman has presented an example which is supposed to demonstrate exactly this point. His example of the beginning logic student is supposed to show that being necessitated by one’s evidence is not sufficient for one’s evidence to support believing a proposition (“Authoritarian Epistemology,” 150). Feldman asks us to consider a logic student who is just learning to identify valid arguments. She has learned a set of rules by which one can distinguish between valid arguments and invalid arguments, but she has not yet become proficient at applying them to particular argument forms. She looks at an exercise in her text that asks her to determine whether some argument forms are valid. She looks at one problem and comes to believe that it is, indeed, a valid argument. As the argument is valid, she believes exactly as her evidence entails she should believe, but she is presently unable to see how it is that the rules show the argument is, indeed, valid. Despite her evidence necessitating the proposition that the argument is valid, it seems she is not justified in believing it.

Various responses are available to the evidentialist. One may here appeal to the distinction between propositional justification and doxastic justification in an effort to motivate the claim that the detective is justified in believing that Jones did it and the student is justified in believing that the argument is valid. When combined with a fully developed and well-motivated theory of evidential support, this may provide a response to these examples. Note, however, that this reply depends crucially on being able to hold that the logic student is justified in believing p but not justifiably believing p. This is a tenuous position, at least for standard accounts of the basing relation—i.e., for standard accounts of that which, when added to an instance of propositional justification, yields an instance of doxastic justification. The dominant view is that the basing relation is causal, and the student’s evidence for believing that the argument is valid is causing her belief, and it is not doing so in some non-standard, deviant way. The reply to the objection that appeals to the distinction between propositional and doxastic justification demands, therefore, that one also provide a satisfactory account of the basing relation, and none have so far been formulated.

An alternative response to these examples is simply to accept their lesson. One might just accept that such examples show that we need to develop a notion of evidential support that does not appeal solely to logical relations between one’s evidence and those propositions under consideration. For example, one might hold that one must, in some sense, grasp or appreciate the logical or probabilistic connection between one’s evidence and the proposition in question in order for that evidence to support it. Evidentialism allows for such possibilities.

c. Essential Appeals to Deontology

The view that justification is, in some substantive way, a deontological concept motivates the following three objections. According to a deontological conception of epistemic justification, one has an intellectual duty, requirement, or obligation to believe justifiably. Deontologists commonly hold that people are rightly praised for believing or blamed for failing to believe in accordance with this duty or obligation.

i. Ought Implies Can

Many believe that this deontological conception of epistemic justification entails that one ought to believe a proposition only if one can believe it. Put differently, one might think that one has to be able to believe p in order for one to be justified in believing p. (This second statement of the issue is more perspicuous, as I here set aside issues regarding doxastic voluntarism.) Some propositions are too complicated and complex for a given person to entertain given his or her actual abilities, and other propositions are too complex for humans to even possibly entertain. It seems wrong to say that one is justified in believing that these extremely complex propositions are true. (EVI), however, appears to imply that one can be justified in believing such extremely complex propositions, especially given the theories of evidence and evidential support sketched in section 2d. above. If, however, (EVI) does have this consequence, then one might conclude that evidentialism is false.

The argument here has two main premises. The first premise is that (EVI) entails that one can be justified in believing a proposition that it is impossible for one to entertain. The second premise is that if this first premise is true, then (EVI) is false. Because evidentialism neither rules out nor entails the motivating deontological conception of epistemic justification, evidentialists can plausibly deny either premise.

Standard accounts of evidentialism deny the first premise. According to these accounts, the proper nature of evidential support rules out the possibility that one’s evidence can support a proposition that one cannot entertain. Evidential support is, in this sense, restricted. Whether or not such evidentialist theories are acceptable depends crucially on whether evidentialism is able to accommodate this restriction in a principled way. Here evidentialists can appeal to meta-epistemological considerations regarding the nature of epistemic justification, as well as to intuitions about a sufficiently varied set of cases. For instance, the deontological conception of justification itself can motivate and help explain a companion deontological conception of evidential support. In addition, one can appeal to cases like Feldman’s logic student example (in section 3b. above) in order to illustrate how the notion of evidential support should be restricted. Together, these considerations can help to motivate one’s evidentialist theory. In this way, one can formulate a version of evidentialism that clearly does not have the consequence that one can be justified in believing a proposition that one cannot entertain.

By contrast, an evidentialist who rejects a deontological conception of justification may accept that one can be justified in believing propositions too complex even to consider and as a result may reject the second premise of the argument. Again, the theory of evidentialism itself allows this. This second response to the argument would need to be strengthened by considerations against the motivating deontological conception of epistemic justification, but considering these in this entry would take us too far astray. The crucial point to emphasize here is that evidentialism neither rules out nor entails this conception of epistemic justification, so both responses are consistent with the theory.

ii. An Evidence-Gathering Requirement

Some argue that the justification of a belief depends, at least in part, on the inquiry that led to the belief. Two ways this can get fleshed out are as follows. One might argue that only beliefs that result from “epistemically responsible behavior” can be justified. In order to be justified on such a view, one must not only follow one’s evidence but also gather evidence in an epistemically responsible way. Alternatively, one might argue that one is not justified in believing a proposition if one could have easily discovered (or should have discovered) evidence that defeated one’s present justification for it. Here, we focus primarily on the latter.

When developing evidentialism in his introductory textbook, Epistemology, Richard Feldman presents the following example.

A professor and his wife are going to the movies to see Star Wars, Episode 68. The professor has in his hand today’s newspaper which contains the listings of movies at the theater and their times. He remembers that yesterday’s paper said that Star Wars, Episode 68 was showing at 8:00. Knowing that movies usually show at the same time each day, he believes that it is showing today at 8:00 as well. He does not look in today’s paper. When they get to the theater, they discover that the movie started at 7:30. When they complain at the box office about the change, they are told that the correct time was listed in the newspaper today. The professor’s wife says that he should have looked in today’s paper and he was not justified in thinking it started at 8:00. (47)

The professor has good evidence to believe that the movie starts at 8:00, but the claim is that he is not justified in believing this because he should have (and could have very easily) gathered defeating evidence. Evidentialism does not take into account one’s evidence-gathering and, thus, cannot account for this intuition.

Evidentialism is a theory about the present justificatory status of propositions and beliefs for subjects. It provides an account of what one should now believe, given one’s actual situation. Feldman claims that this is the central epistemological question; it alone determines the justificatory status of one’s beliefs. There are other questions about when one ought to gather more evidence, but these, Feldman claims, should be carefully distinguished from questions regarding epistemic justification (Epistemology, 48). As it is, the professor is believing exactly as he ought to believe as he is driving to the theater. As a result, Feldman concludes, evidentialism provides the correct answer about this case.

iii. Duties Not to Follow One’s Evidence

The previous objection to evidentialism attempted to demonstrate that having evidence that supports believing p is not sufficient for being justified in believing p. One might also attempt to demonstrate this by providing examples that do not appeal to evidence gathering requirements. The following is one such example.

Suppose that Bill comes to possess overwhelming evidence that his recently deceased wife was having multiple affairs throughout their marriage. If he were to come to believe what his evidence supports, he would blame his children and himself. We can further suppose that he is presently so unstable as a result of his loss that believing that his wife was having affairs would cause him to seriously harm his children before committing suicide. In such a case, it is very clear that Bill ought not to believe that his wife was having affairs. Indeed, we might say that he has a duty not to believe exactly what his evidence supports. Since evidentialism implies that he really ought to believe that his wife was having affairs, evidentialism is false.

The standard response to these types of examples is to distinguish between different kinds of demands, oughts, and duties and to hold that sometimes these conflict. For example, we have an epistemic duty to follow our evidence, we have a practical duty to not always seek out more evidence for each of the propositions we consider, and we may also have moral duties to believe or disbelieve certain propositions. While these duties can conflict, nevertheless, the epistemic, moral, and practical demands on us remain. Thus, the response is that Bill does have an epistemic duty to believe what his evidence supports, even though he has overriding moral and prudential duties to believe that his wife was not having affairs. While this response is fairly uncontroversial, the crucial point to emphasize here is that such a move is itself a substantial thesis that is in need of support. We need to be shown in an independently motivated way why we should believe that matters should be understood in this way rather than in some other.

d. A Pragmatic Reply

William James has famously argued that having adequate evidence is not necessary for one to believe justifiably. James notes that our fears, hopes, and desires (in short, our “passions”) do influence what we believe. We do not proceed in conformance with Clifford’s evidentialist thesis, nor should we. Furthermore, when we are confronted with an option to do or not to do something, we cannot help but choose one or the other; the choice is forced. By failing to decide, we embrace one of the options. In such situations, it can be permissible for one to believe a proposition in the absence of sufficient evidence. More specifically, James argues that whenever we are confronted with a live, forced, momentous option to believe or not to believe a proposition that cannot be decided on “intellectual grounds” alone, it is permissible for us to decide on the basis of our “passional nature” (522).

Consider, for example, the proposition that God exists. Believing or failing to believe that God exists is a forced and momentous option. It is forced because we cannot help but choose one or the other; a failure to decide is, in effect, to choose to not believe that God exists. It is momentous since it is a unique opportunity to gain something supremely significant and only one of the options, belief, will deliver this supreme good. Contrary to the evidentialist, James argues that one can justifiably believe that God exists in the absence of supporting evidence if both believing that God exists and failing to believe that God exists are live options for one.

Here, again, evidentialists can respond by appealing to a distinction between different kinds of justification. One may be pragmatically or morally justified in believing against one’s evidence, but this is not to say that one is epistemically justified in so believing. For example, evidentialists can begin by noting that it is in some sense very reasonable to let our “passions” influence our actions and beliefs. It may be in one’s own interest to believe that one’s wife is not having an affair, for instance. We might put this point by saying that one is pragmatically justified in believing that one’s wife is not having an affair. Furthermore, the stakes might be so high that such pragmatic considerations outweigh any epistemic considerations we might have. Hence, even though one’s evidence does not support believing p (and one is therefore not epistemically justified in believing p), it may be, all things considered, more rational for one to believe p than to not believe p. Of course, nothing here turns on the content of the belief in question. Similar cases can be constructed for religious beliefs as well, and some evidentialists might want to focus on the particular nature of religious beliefs in order to directly respond to the religious case James considers. In summary, while it is true that non-epistemic considerations can outweigh epistemic considerations, the epistemic considerations remain. While it is not epistemically permissible to flout our evidentialist duties, we do think that in certain cases it is in some sense permissible to violate them. In this way, evidentialists can try to utilize a distinction between different kinds of justification in order to try to explain away the intuitions that appear to support James’ general thesis, as well as his claims about religious belief in particular.

e. Rationally Believing Skepticism is False

Keith DeRose has presented a more recent objection that has its roots in the philosophical challenge posed by skepticism. Two separate arguments are distinguishable here. First, DeRose argues that evidentialism appears unable to account for the degree to which he is justified in believing that particular skeptical scenarios are false (703-706). The specific argument DeRose presents makes reference to his contextualist intuitions. In the context of discussing theories of evidentialism in general, it is important to note this contextualist dimension of his argument, and I’ll make reference to it below.

DeRose thinks people are justified in believing, to a fairly substantial degree, that they are not brains in vats, and he thinks that any correct theory of epistemic justification must account for the substantial degree to which people are so justified in believing. In order to be an adequate theory of justification, therefore, evidentialism must show how the evidence people normally possess substantially supports believing that they are not brains in vats. DeRose claims that this has not yet been done, and he doubts that evidentialism can accomplish it adequately.

Second, DeRose claims that this difficulty highlights a fundamental complexity in the notion of evidence. In short, he thinks that at any given time we don’t have “one simple body of evidence that constitutes” the evidence that we have (704). For instance, it seems as though my belief that I have hands is evidence that I have and can use to support various other propositions—the proposition that I did not lose them in recent combat, for example. If, though, it is good evidence that I in fact have and can use, then it seems I should be able to appeal to it in order to argue that I am not a (handless) brain in a vat. It seems it should be uncontroversial that one’s evidence justifies one in believing that this skeptical scenario is false, yet justifying the denial of such skeptical scenarios is much more difficult than this implies. My belief that I have hands appears not to be able to justify the proposition that I am not a (handless) brain in a vat. In summary, when some issues are being discussed, my belief that I have hands is evidence I can appeal to, but when other issues are being discussed it appears not to be evidence that I can use. Evidentialism owes us an explanation of this.

As with most of the objections here considered, the force of DeRose’s points will vary with each proposed version of evidentialism. The central notions of evidence and evidential support do have to be explained, and they have to be explained in a way that allows reasonable conclusions about people’s typical appraisals of skeptical scenarios. As I have developed evidentialism in section 2 above, one can develop both contextualist and non-contextualist versions. This is especially important to note because exactly the sorts of considerations regarding skepticism DeRose invokes motivate contextualism in general and contextualist versions of evidentialism in particular. A contextualist version of evidentialism will hold that when skeptical scenarios are not being discussed, people are justified in believing to a very high degree that skeptical scenarios do not obtain. As a result, DeRose’s first argument is much more interesting and intuitively plausible when applied to non-contextualist versions of evidentialism.

The traditional responses to skepticism are exactly the responses that non-contextualist evidentialists have available. For example, non-contextualist evidentialists can utilize some closure principle or inference to the best explanation to try to account for the degree to which we think we are justified in believing that skeptical hypotheses are false. Whether these strategies succeed is controversial, but the problem of skepticism is a difficult and serious one, and no proposed solution is uncontroversial. It should be no surprise, then, that one may object to the consequences any version of evidentialism has for the skeptical challenge. The fundamental lesson here is that the evidentialist needs to develop these consequences and defend them.

The second of DeRose’s arguments is best understood as a demand for a fully developed and adequate theory of evidential support. We want to know how it is that evidence works so as to justify beliefs. This demand is wholly appropriate, of course, since evidence and evidential support are concepts central to evidentialism. On one standard account, I can appeal to the proposition that I have hands in order to come to believe justifiably that I did not lose them in combat precisely because I am justified in believing propositions about the external world (including, of course, the proposition that I have hands). Although, when one is trying to show how it is that one is justified in believing that one has hands, one obviously cannot appeal to the fact that one is justified in believing the proposition that one has hands. One needs to appeal to other propositions, propositions whose justification is prior to (or does not depend on) the justification of the proposition in question. All of this seems to be uncontroversial, but this is just to explain how evidence works so as to justify one in believing that certain propositions are true. The structure of justification is part of evidential support, and it is because some propositions are more basic than other propositions that we cannot appeal to those less basic propositions in order to justify the more basic ones. There is no unclarity here, but the explanation does help to illustrate why a response to DeRose’s first argument is so crucial. The story depends on one’s already being justified in believing some fundamental external world propositions. It is here that the evidentialist has to confront the skeptic and somehow explain how it is that we are justified in believing that skeptical hypotheses are false.

4. Conclusion

This brief treatment of evidentialism explains it as a type of theory of epistemic justification. All evidentialist theories are united in understanding justification as being a function of one’s present evidence as formalized in (EVI), yet many widely divergent options are available to one who seeks to develop the theory. There are competing ideas about which mental states count as evidence, different understandings of the notion of having evidence, various ways of understanding the crucial notion of support, and also various ways of relating these three central concepts. Many of the objections developed above apply only to some of these ways of developing the theory. This highlights the role they can play in one’s attempting to develop a complete evidentialist thesis. As is the case with theories in all areas of philosophy, objections such as those developed above help to guide philosophers towards more promising formulations of the theory. It remains to be seen whether evidentialism can be formulated in a way that not only overcomes each of these objections but also helps us to provide reasonable answers to other central epistemological questions.

5. References and Further Reading

• W. K. Clifford. “The Ethics of Belief.” The Theory of Knowledge. 3rd. ed. Ed. Louis P. Pojman. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 2003. 515-518.
• Cohen, Stewart. “How to be a Fallibilist.” Philosophical Perspectives, 2. Ed. James E. Tomberlin. Atascadero, CA: Ridgeview Publishing Co., 1988. 91-123.
• DeRose, Keith. “Ought We to Follow Our Evidence?” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 60 (2000): 697-706.
• Feldman, Richard. “Authoritarian Epistemology.” Philosophical Topics 23.1 (1995): 147-169.
• Feldman, Richard. Epistemology. Upper Saddle River, NJ: Prentice Hall, 2003.
• Feldman, Richard and Earl Conee. “Evidentialism.” Philosophical Studies 48 (1985): 15-34.
• Goldman, Alvin. Epistemology and Cognition. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1986.
• Hume, David. An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. 2nd ed. Ed. Eric Steinberg. Indianapolis, IN: Hackett Publishing Co., 1993.
• James, William. “The Will To Believe.” The Theory of Knowledge. 3rd. ed. Ed. Louis P. Pojman. Belmont, CA: Wadsworth, 2003. 519-526.
• Plantinga, Alvin. “Reason and Belief in God.” Faith and Rationality. Eds. Alvin Plantinga and Nicholas Wolterstorff. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press: 1983. 16-93.
• Plantinga, Alvin. Warranted Christian Belief. New York: Oxford University Press, 2000.
• Russell, Bertrand. Human Knowledge: Its Scope and Limits. New York: Simon and Schuster, 1948.

a. More Advanced Studies

While this list in no way approximates comprehensiveness, the following are some additional helpful works on evidentialism in epistemology.

• Conee, Earl and Richard Feldman. Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2004.
  • This is, perhaps, the best single work available for exploring these issues in more detail, and it is by all accounts an excellent place to start. It includes their article, “Evidentialism,” which has come to be viewed as the definitive article on the theory. It also contains other previously published articles that not only examine particular aspects of the theory but also defend favored versions as well as new, previously unpublished articles on the topic.
• Feldman, Richard and Earl Conee. “Internalism Defended.” Epistemology: Internalism and Externalism. Ed. Hilary Kornblith. Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 2001. 231-260.
  • Much that has been written on the internalism and externalism debate in epistemology is very relevant to evidentialism. I choose to include only one such article here. “Internalism Defended,” argues that evidentialism is one internalist theory of justification that is able to overcome all of the common objections raised to internalist theories of justification. Both a version of this paper and an “afterward” is included in Conee and Feldman’s book Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology.
• Feldman, Richard. “Having Evidence.” Philosophical Analysis. Ed. David Austin. Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers: 1988. 83-104.
  • This is a sustained examination of the crucial notion of having evidence. Feldman demonstrates just how vital it is, clearly lays out the complications and difficulties involved, and defends one particular interpretation. Reprinted with an “afterward” in Evidentialism: Essays in Epistemology.
• Haack, Susan. Evidence and Inquiry: Towards Reconstruction in Epistemology. Cambridge, MA: Blackwell Publishers, 1993.
  • This is a sustained explication and defense of a novel evidentialist theory of the structure of epistemic justification. Haack terms this theory, “foundherentism,” as it blends elements of coherentism and foundationalism. This book is helpful reading for those who want to gain a more complete understanding of competing theories of the nature of evidential support.

Author Information

Daniel M. Mittag
Email: dlmt@mail.rochester.edu
University of Rochester
U. S. A.