Madhyamaka and Yogācāra are the two main philosophical trajectories
associated with the Mahāyāna stream of Buddhist thought. According to
Tibetan doxographical literature, Madhyamaka represents the philosophically
definitive expression of Buddhist doctrine. Stemming from the second-century writings
of Nāgārjuna, Madhyamaka developed in the form of
commentaries on his works. This style of development is characteristic
of the basically scholastic character of the Indian philosophical
tradition. The commentaries elaborated not only varying interpretations
of Nāgārjuna’s philosophy
but also different understandings of the philosophical tools that are
appropriate to its advancement. Tibetan interpreters generally claim to
take the seventh-century commentaries of Candrakīrti as authoritative,
but Indian commentators subsequent to him were in fact more influential
in the course of Indian philosophy. Madhyamaka also had considerable
influence (though by way of a rather different set of texts) in East
Asian Buddhism, where a characteristic interpretive concern has been to
harmonize Madhyamaka and Yogācāra. Although perhaps most frequently
characterized by modern interpreters as a Buddhist version of
skepticism, Madhyamaka arguably develops metaphysical concerns. The logically
elusive character of Madhyamaka arguments has fascinated and perplexed
generations of scholars. This is surely appropriate with regard to a
school whose principal term of art, “emptiness” (śūnyatā), reflects
developments in Buddhist thought from the high scholasticism of Tibet
to the enigmatic discourse of East Asian Zen.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Nāgārjuna and the Paradoxical “Perfection of Wisdom” Literature“Madhyamaka”
is a Sanskrit word that simply means “middle way.” (The derivative form “Mādhyamika” literally means “of or relating to the middle,” and conventionally designates an adherent of the school, or qualifies some aspect of its thought.) Madhyamaka refers to the Indian Buddhist
school of thought that develops in the form of commentaries on the
works of Nāgārjuna, who flourished around 150 C.E. Nāgārjuna figures in the traditional accounts developed to
authenticate the literature of the self-styled “Mahāyāna” stream of
Buddhist thought. Arguing that sūtras known to have begun circulating
only at the beginning of the first millennium could nevertheless
represent the authentic teaching of the Buddha (buddhavacana),
proponents of Mahāyāna invoked the characteristically Buddhist idea of
“skill in means” (upāyakauśalya); they thus claimed that the Mahāyāna sūtras
promulgate an advanced stage of the Buddha’s teaching such as would
not have been appropriately taught to the earliest auditors of the
Buddha, who, unprepared by the necessarily preparatory earlier
teachings, might draw nihilistic conclusions from the sūtras. It is
Nāgārjuna who is said first to have recovered and promulgated these
sūtras, having retrieved the Prajñāpāramitā (“Perfection of Wisdom”)
literature from the underwater kingdom of the “Nāgas,” or serpent
kings.
Two texts generally represent the criteria for attributing authorship
of a text to Nāgārjuna. So, this name conventionally refers to the
person who wrote the Mūlamadhyamakakārikās (MMK, “Verses on the Firmly
Fixed Middle Way”) and the Vigrahavyāvartanī (VV, “Turning Back
Objections”). Both of these texts, but particularly the former, have
occasioned a great deal of interest among Indologists and philosophers.
This is not surprising, since the MMK is indeed a rich text.
Stylistically lucid yet logically enigmatic, Nāgārjuna’s major work
shares with the Prajñāpāramitā literature a characteristic air of
paradox, which Madhyamaka’s critics see as evidence of nihilism if not
of incoherence. We read in this text, for example, that “there is, on
the part of saṃsāra, no difference at all from nirvāṇa” (MMK 25.19).
The text’s first verse says “There do not exist, anywhere at all, any
existents whatsoever, arisen either from themselves or from something
else, either from both or altogether without cause.” (MMK 1.1)
2. The Basic Philosophical Impulse
a. The “Two Truths” in Buddhist AbhidharmaIn
styling the school that develops from Nāgārjuna’s works the “middle
way” (an expression used by Nāgārjuna himself), proponents of Madhyamaka
exploited a long-invoked Buddhist trope. Traditional
accounts of the life of the Buddha typically characterize him as
striking a “middle way” between the extravagance of the courtly life
that had been available to him as a prince and the extreme asceticism
he is said initially to have tried in his pursuit of transformative
insight. Philosophically, the relevant extremes between which any
Buddhist account of the person must steer are “eternalism” and
“nihilism.” Eternalism (śāśvatavāda) is the view that there are enduring
existents of which the self is an example. Nihilism (ucchedavāda) might be termed
“eliminativism,” and denotes, for Buddhists, the view that
actions (karma) have no ethical consequences, insofar as the agents of actions cannot be said to endure as the subjects who will experience their effects.
Given their characteristically Buddhist concern to refuse the existence of an ultimately
existent “self,” it is the nihilism pole that
Mādhyamikas must work hardest to avoid. Indeed, the concern to avoid
charges of nihilism represents one of the most significant
preoccupations of Mādhyamika philosophers. This concern has to be
understood in terms of the traditionally Buddhist idea of “two truths,”
or two levels of explanation or description: the familiar level
of discourse that includes reference to the “conventionally existent”
(saṃvṛtisat), and the level which makes reference only to what is
“ultimately existent” (parmārthasat). Most schools of Buddhist
philosophy can be understood in terms of the sense in which they deny
the “ultimate” existence of the self, while affirming its
“conventional” existence.
In its basically Ābhidharmika iterations (that is, in the ways
elaborated in the earliest scholastic literature of Indian Buddhism,
the so-called “Abhidharma”) this denial of the ultimate existence of
the self is an idea that can be understood as comparable to a great
deal of contemporary philosophical discussion. Philosophical projects
in cognitive science can be said, for example, to turn on questions of
how (or perhaps whether) to relate two levels of description: (1) the
broadly intentional level of description that generally reflects the
first-person, phenomenological perspective (and that is also reflected
in ordinary language and interactions), and (2) the scientific level of
description at which the real explanatory work is done. Similarly, the
broadly Ābhidharmika trajectory of Buddhist philosophy has it that the
two truths basically consist in two sets of existing things: the set of
conventionally existent (saṃvṛtisat) things and the set of ultimately
existent (parmārthasat) things. The “conventionally existent” comprises all reducible or supervenient phenomena (basically, all temporally
enduring macro-objects); the “ultimately existent” represents the set of
ontological primitives, which the Abhidharma literature calls “dharmas.” It is ultimately the case, then, that causal interactions among the dharmas exhaustively explain
all conventional events.
The works of Nāgārjuna and his philosophical heirs are best understood
as constitutively opposed to this understanding of the two truths. The
foundational idea of Madhyamaka is that the set of ultimately existent
things is an empty set – a point that Mādhyamikas characteristically
promote by insisting on the emptiness (śūnyatā) not only of wholes such
as persons, but also of the analytic categories (dharmas) to which
these are reduced in Abhidharma literature. The works of Nāgārjuna and
his commentators, then, typically comprise arguments to the effect that
none of the analytic categories (dharmas) and concepts used to explain
anything can be coherently formulated. More precisely, the argument is that no such categories can intrinsically provide any explanatory purchase on the phenomena they purportedly explain.
b. The Interminability of Dependent OriginationIn
proceeding this way, Mādhyamikas can be understood to think that the
ontologizing impulse of Abhidharma compromises the most important
insight of the Buddhist tradition – which is, on the Mādhyamika
reading, that all existents are “dependently originated”
(pratītyasamutpanna). (The cardinal doctrine of the “dependent origination”
of all existents represents the flip-side of the Buddhist denial of a
“self”; that is, the reason we do not have unitary and enduring selves
just is that any moment of experience can be explained as having
originated from innumerable causes, none of which can be specified as
what we “really” are.) More precisely, Mādhyamikas can be said to have
recognized that the ontological primitives posited by Abhidharma could
have explanatory purchase only if they are posited as an exception to
the rule that everything is dependently originated; that is,
dependently originated existents could only be ultimately explained by
something that does not itself require the same kind of explanation.
But it is precisely the Mādhyamika point to emphasize that there is no
exception to this rule; phenomena are dependently originated all the
way down, and it is therefore impossible to specify precisely what it
is upon which anything finally depends. Hence, there can be no set of
“ultimately existent” things.
Mādhyamika arguments to this effect typically work by showing that all
explanatory categories turn out to be constitutively dependent upon the
phenomena they purportedly explain – as, for example, notions such as
“fire” and “fuel,” “action” and “agent,” or “cause” and “effect” are
intelligible only relative to one another. To show the constitutively
relative (i.e., dependent) character of all such explanatory categories
and phenomena is effectively to make the one point that Mādhyamikas are
most concerned to make: that insofar as there is nothing that is not
dependently originated, there is therefore nothing that is not “empty”
(śūnya). (This paraphrases MMK 24.19, which says: “Since there is no
dharma whatsoever that is not dependently originated, therefore there
is no dharma whatsoever that is not empty.”)
In thus characterizing all categories and all existents as finally “empty,”
what Mādhyamikas mean is that they are empty of what we may translate
as “essence” (svabhāva). This is true just insofar as they exist not
“essentially” (svabhāvena), but only relatively – that is, only in
relation to other existents and categories. In arguing thus, Mādhyamikas – typifying
characteristically Sanskritic styles of argumentation, in which the
terms and analyses of the Sanskrit grammarians figure prominently –
exploit the etymology of the word svabhāva. Although the semantic range
of this Sanskrit word typically comprises ideas like “defining
characteristic” or “identity,” the word can etymologically be read as
referring to something “existent” (bhāva) “by itself” (sva-). Among the
recently debated exegetical questions concerning Madhyamaka has been
whether important Mādhyamika arguments centrally involve an
equivocation on this term, unwarrantedly equating “identity” with
“causally independent existence.”
c. Ethics and the Charge of NihilismIt
is not only in their characteristically Buddhist denial of a really
existent “self,” but also in their more radical (and rhetorically
charged) emphasis on the universally obtaining character of emptiness
that Mādhyamikas recurrently elicited charges of nihilism – a charge as
often issuing from proponents of other Buddhist schools as from the
various Brahmanical schools of Indian philosophy. One of the most
prominently recurrent sorts of exchange in Nāgārjuna’s MMK involves an
interlocutor’s presupposing that by ‘emptiness’ Mādhyamikas must mean
non-existence. For example, the twenty-fourth chapter of the MMK begins
with the challenge of an imagined interlocutor (this one clearly
another Buddhist): “If all this is empty, then there’s neither
production nor destruction; it follows, for you, that the Four Noble
Truths don’t exist.” (MMK 24.1) The rejoinder (at MMK 24.20): it is in
fact only because everything is empty – which just is to say,
dependently originated – that the Four Noble Truths can obtain. That
is, the fact that existents only come into being in mutual dependence
upon one another (and are therefore “empty” of an essence) is all that
makes it possible for (what is the first Noble Truth) suffering to
arise – and thus having arisen as a contingent and dependent phenomenon, to
be caused to cease (the third Noble Truth). If, in contrast, suffering
were the “natural” or “essential” state of affairs (svabhāva), this
would (as Nāgārjuna sees it) mean that it could not be interrupted, and
the cultivation of the entire Buddhist path would be impossible.
It is particularly important for the proponent of Madhyamaka to
foreclose the possibility of a nihilist reading of claims regarding
emptiness insofar as it is finally the ethical and soteriological
project of Buddhist practice that is thought to be at stake. In this
regard, the characteristically Mādhyamika conviction is that it is in
fact the Ābhidharmika iteration of the Buddhist project (and not
Mādhyamika claims regarding emptiness) that is “nihilist.” This is
because on the characteristically Ābhidharmika understanding of the
“two truths,” the world as “conventionally” described – as consisting,
for example, in suffering persons whose plight should elicit
compassionate dedication to the Buddhist path – is finally altogether
superseded by the privileged level of description constitutively
developed in the Abhidharma literature. The characteristically
Ābhidharmika enumeration of the dharmas that putatively constitute the
set of “ultimately existent” things amounts to the specification of
what “really” exists instead of the self. If, in contrast, it is
recognized that no such privileged level of description can coherently
be elaborated – that, in other words, there is no set of ontological
primitives in terms of which the only real explanatory work can be
done, and that in that sense there is nothing “more real” than the
world as conventionally described – then the world is finally to be
accepted as irreducibly “conventional,” and the persons therein can
hence be regarded as ethical agents who are not finally eliminable in
terms of the analytic categories of Abhidharma.
3. The Question of Self-contradiction and the Possible Truth of Mādhyamika ClaimsBut
this understanding also raises what are surely the most philosophically
complex and interesting problems in understanding Madhyamaka: if the
constitutive claim of Madhyamaka is to be taken as one to the effect
that the ultimate truth is that there is (in the sense described) no
“ultimate truth,” it is easy to ask: What is the status of this claim itself?
It would seem open to the Mādhyamika only to allow that it is itself
conventionally true – but is that not just to say that one may as well
choose not to adopt this particular “convention”? The problem, then, is
whether characteristically Mādhyamika claims are, to the extent they
are true, performatively self-contradictory or self-referentially
incoherent. This problem was well understood (if not always clearly
addressed) by proponents of Madhyamaka, and is very much in play in
characteristically Mādhyamika claims to the effect that “emptiness”
itself is empty – that, in other words, the Mādhyamika analysis is to
be applied not only to all existents, but also to this analysis
thereof.
To say as much is the only way consistently to affirm the universal
scope of claims regarding emptiness; for there would clearly be a
performative self-contradiction in claiming that “all existents are
empty-cum-dependently-originated,” while yet allowing that claim itself
to stand as an exception – as itself having, that is, the kind of
“ultimately” privileged explanatory purchase that is denied with
respect to all other analyses. But it is a complex matter whether the
Mādhyamika can, in avoiding this route to self-contradiction, affirm
the “emptiness of emptiness” without thereby depriving his own claim of
any purchase. It is particularly at this point, then, that there is an
air of paradox going to the heart of Mādhyamika discourse, finding
expression in, for example, apparent claims to the effect that no claim
is being made; hence, such quintessentially Mādhyamika tropes as the
claim that Madhyamaka advances no philosophical “thesis” (pratijñā),
and that “emptiness” does not reflect any specific “view” (dṛṣṭi).
Such rhetoric characteristically expresses what is surely the central
interpretive and philosophical issue at stake in understanding
Madhyamaka, and it is not surprising, in this regard, that Madhyamaka
should often have been interpreted by modern scholars as having
affinities with Hellenistic skepticism. Another line of interpretation
(often inflected in recent years by appeal to Wittgenstein, or to
various poststructuralist thinkers) has it that Mādhyamika claims not
to be making any claim should be taken seriously as expressing a
basically “therapeutic” sort of stance – one meant performatively to
undermine (in something like the same way, perhaps, as in the Zen
discourse of koans) soteriologically counter-productive profusions of
discursive thought. This line of interpretation can be warranted by
characteristically Mādhyamika talk about the elimination of prapañca
(often translated as conceptual “proliferation”), and by paeans to the
“ultimate truth” as something finally ineffable.
Such readings are, however, difficult to reconcile with what many
Tibetan interpreters (perhaps notwithstanding such rhetoric) took to be
the constitutively Mādhyamika claim: namely, that “emptiness” just
means (and is the only way consistently to describe) “dependent
origination.” If it is said, for example, that there is nothing
“non-empty” just insofar as there is nothing that is not dependently
originated (here again, paraphrasing MMK 24.19), that would seem to
preclude, at least, the truth of statements (made, e.g., by certain
theists) to the effect that there is something (e.g., God) that is
necessarily (or otherwise not dependently) existent. If the Mādhyamika
statement does not rule out the truth of such statements, then it would
be difficult to understand it as meaning anything (although perhaps the
radically “therapeutic” interpreter of Madhyamaka will here bite the
bullet and, well, argue that it is the very idea of “meaning” anything
that is to be jettisoned); but to say that the Mādhyamika claim
contradicts a truth-claim proffered by some theists just is to say that
the former claim, too, is proposed as true. Recognizing that, one might
urge that the universal scope of the Mādhyamika claim entails that
there is an important sense in which Madhyamaka is constitutively
anti-skeptical – that, indeed, Mādhyamika arguments advance a finally
metaphysical point. For example, one could argue that what is at stake
here is the properly transcendental fact that emptiness (understood as
the fact that things exist only interdependently) is a condition of the
possibility of any existents and of any analysis thereof.
The question for the proponent of such a line of interpretation then
becomes: If “the ultimate truth is that there is no ultimate truth,” is
it possible to think of this claim as itself ultimately true? It is
important to note, in this regard, that while Mādhyamikas
characteristically (indeed, constitutively) eschew the Ābhidharmika
idea that “ultimate truth” involves a domain of enumerable existents
regarding which claims are to be judged for their adequacy, Madhyamaka
nevertheless makes abundant reference to the “ultimate truth.” One way
to make sense of this is to attribute to Madhyamaka a basically
deflationist account of truth – that is, one according to which calling
a claim “true” is to be explained not as predicating a metaphysical
property (such as “correspondence” with “ultimately existent” things)
of it, but simply as committing oneself to it. On such a view, to the
extent that the (Ābhidharmika) idea of “ultimate truth” has been shown
incoherent, all that remains is the level of “truth” that is
characterized by common-sense realism.
This interpretation has the advantage of fitting quite well with the
kind of traditional doxographical accounts (influentially developed,
early on, by the Indian Mādhyamika Bhāvaviveka) that figure prominently in the
Tibetan monastic curriculum. These represent the schools of Indian
Buddhist philosophy in an ascending hierarchy of progressively more
refined views, the understanding of each of which requires having
rightly understood its predecessors. On such an account, Madhyamaka,
though framed as an uncompromising critique of Ābhidharmika Buddhism,
nevertheless depends on the latter: if the naive realism of non-Buddhas
consists in thinking there is something more real (paradigmatically,
selves) underlying our experience of the world, the realization of the
“deflated” realism of Madhyamaka differs from that (and is therefore
transformative) only insofar as one has first pursued to its limits the
kind of reductionist exercise that shows how unstable is our naive
self-grasping. If one has not first entertained the Ābhidharmika’s
reductionist approach, then there would be no difference between the
common-sense realism of the Mādhyamika, and that of ordinary ignorant
persons. But if one realizes the necessary failure of the
reductionist’s privileged level of description only after having
entertained it, the resultant “realism” will be inflected by the
transformative understanding that our selves are “real” in the only
sense in which anything (even the purportedly “ultimate” existents that
are dharmas) can be real – that is, relatively, dependently.
Another strategy (perhaps not mutually exclusive of the foregoing) is
to emphasize that what Mādhyamikas refute, under the heading of
“ultimate truth,” is simply the idea of a privileged level of
description (in the form of a set of enumerable ontological primitives)
– but that the abstract fact of there being no such set is itself
really (indeed metaphysically) true. In that case, the salient point is
just that the truth of the Mādhyamika claim does not consist in its
reference to – its correspondence with – a specifiable domain of
objects. This reconstruction can be coupled with an understanding of
Mādhyamika arguments as basically transcendental arguments. Such an
interpretation makes good sense, at least, of what is surely one of the
most prominently recurrent rhetorical strategies of Nāgārjuna; so,
Nāgārjuna can be understood to argue that his various interlocutors’
objections are incoherent just insofar as these very objections
presuppose the truth of Nāgārjuna’s claims. Emptiness is not only not
mutually exclusive of the Four Noble Truths – it is a condition of the
possibility thereof. Emptiness is, moreover, a condition of the
possibility even of an opponent’s denying this; for any analysis or
denial at all (indeed, any cognitive act) consists, in the first
instance, in some relation.
Perhaps more suggestively, such an interpretation can also help map the
finally ethical concerns of Madhyamaka onto some contemporary arguments
concerning reductionist accounts of the person. In this regard, it was
noted that the Ābhidharmika trajectory of Buddhist philosophy can be
understood as analogous to various projects in cognitive science. In
the idiom of the latter, then, it could be said that the Ābhidharmika
idea is that there is, “conventionally,” an intentional level of
description (variously characterized as the “common-sense” view, “folk
psychology,” etc.); and, “ultimately,” a scientific level of
description, comprising the ontological primitives that alone are said
“really” to exist, and exhaustively to explain the former level. One
line of critique developed against such approaches is to argue that
anyone offering an exhaustively “impersonal,” non-intentional
description of (what we think of as) persons can be shown necessarily
to presuppose precisely the personal, intentional level of description
that is purportedly explained. Similarly, the upshot of the Mādhyamika
argument that the world is (as expressed above) “irreducibly
conventional” is that the level of description at which “persons” are
in play cannot coherently be thought to be eliminable. Many of the
commentator Candrakīrti’s arguments can be said, without too great a
stretch, to make something like this point, recurrently urging against
various interlocutors that any purported attempt to explain the
conventional world (in terms that, if the proposed account is to have
any explanatory purchase, must not themselves be conventional)
inevitably founders on the unavoidability of presupposing the
conventional senses of words.
Suffice it to say that the philosophical and exegetical issues in play
here are highly complex, and that almost any attempt at understanding
the texts of Nāgārjuna and his commentators is likely to require a
considerable effort of rational reconstruction – which perhaps explains
the enduring appeal of this trajectory of thought.
4. Historical Development of Indian Schools of InterpretationThe
Indian Buddhist tradition attests two broad streams in the
interpretation of Nāgārjuna’s thought, corresponding roughly to what
later Tibetan interpreters would refer to as the “Prāsaṅgika” and
“Svātantrika” accounts of Madhyamaka. Interpreters of the former sort
are so-called because of their view that Madhyamaka should be advanced
only by reducing an opponent’s arguments to absurdity. Nāgārjuna is, on
this view, to be interpreted as showing only the unwanted consequences
(“prasaṅga”) entailed by his opponents’ claims, and not as defending
any philosophical “thesis” (pratijñā) of his own. Svātantrikas, in
contrast, are so-called because of their characteristic view that
Nāgārjuna’s verses require restatement as formally valid inferences
(svatantra-anumāna) whose conclusions are to be affirmed. Much
contemporary debate has concerned whether these divergent lines of
interpretation reflect only differing dialectical strategies, or
whether (as influential Tibetan proponents of the distinction claim)
they involve significantly different ontological presuppositions.
Although the characterizations of these two trajectories of
interpretation are not without basis in the antecedent Indian texts,
this doxographic lens is of interest partly for what it can tell us
about some characteristically Tibetan preoccupations (and about the
influence of certain schools of Tibetan Buddhist philosophy on the
contemporary interpretation of Indian Buddhist thought).
Names traditionally associated with the “Prāsaṅgika” stream of
interpretation include Āryadeva, who is traditionally regarded as
Nāgārjuna’s direct disciple (making his date close to Nāgārjuna’s), and
who wrote the Catuḥśataka (“400 Verses”) – a text that is particularly
important insofar as the divergent interpretations of it by the
commentators Dharmapāla (530-561) and Candrakīrti are sometimes taken
to herald a decisive split between Madhyamaka and Yogācāra (see
Tillemans 1990); Buddhapālita (fl. c. 500), the author of a complete
commentary (now extant only in Tibetan translation) on the MMK; and
Candrakīrti (c. 600-650), whose Prasannapadā (“Clear Words”) – the only
commentary on the MMK known to be extant in Sanskrit – preserves the
Sanskrit text of Nāgārjuna’s verse text.
Candrakīrti is also the author of, among other works, the
Madhyamakāvatāra (“Introduction to Madhyamaka”), an independent work
(with auto-commentary) that represents the principal text for the
“Madhyamaka” component of many Tibetan monastic curricula. This work is
structured on the model of texts like the Daśabhūmika Sūtra, with
chapters corresponding to that text’s progression in a bodhisattva’s
mastery of ten “perfections” (pāramitā). The sixth chapter (fittingly
corresponding to prajñāpāramitā, the “perfection of wisdom”) is by far
the longest and the most philosophically rich, comprising, inter alia,
important Mādhyamika critiques of Yogācāra.
Significant later Prāsaṅgikas include Śāntideva (fl. early eighth
century), the author of the Bodhicaryāvatāra (“Introduction to the
Conduct of Awakening”), an eloquent and popular text whose difficult
ninth chapter (helpfully elaborated by the commentary of
Prajñākaramati, who likely flourished in the tenth century) comprises
important Mādhyamika arguments; and Dīpaṃkaraśrījñāna (982-1054; more
popularly known as “Atiśa”), who figured prominently in the
transmission of Indian Buddhism to Tibet, where he lived when he wrote
the Bodhipathapradīpa (“A Lamp for the Path to Awakening”).
The “Svātantrika” line of interpretation originates with Bhāvaviveka
(c. 500-570; his name is also reported as “Bhāviveka,” and he is often
referred to as “Bhavya”), the author not only of a commentary on the
MMK – the Prajñāpradīpa, now extant only in Tibetan and Chinese
translations – but also of an independent work, the
Madhyamakahṛdayakārikās, “Verses on the Heart of Madhyamaka,” with an
auto-commentary entitled Tarkajvāla (“Blaze of Logic”). Other
significant exponents of this line of thought include Jñānagarbha (fl.
early eighth century), who is traditionally regarded as the teacher of
Śāntarakṣita (725-788). The latter is the author of the
Madhyamakālaṃkāra (“Ornament of Madhyamaka”), a relatively concise text
elaborating Śāntarakṣita’s characteristic synthesis of Madhyamaka and
Yogācāra. Śāntarakṣita is perhaps more widely known for the
Tattvasaṃgraha (“Summa of Quiddities”), a massive treatise that takes
on a huge range of Indian philosophical doctrines – and that quotes
extensively from Brahmanical and other Buddhist philosophers, making it
an important source of fragments from Indian works that do not, like
the Tattvasaṃgraha, survive in Sanskrit.
The latter text is (like the Madhyamakālaṃkāra) helpfully illuminated
by a commentary (the Tattvasaṃgrahapañjikā) by Śāntarakṣita’s student
and disciple Kamalaśīla (c.740-795). The latter traveled with his
teacher to Tibet, where both thinkers figure prominently in the
founding events of Tibetan Buddhist thought. Kamalaśīla is, for
example, traditionally regarded by Tibetans as having advocated the
“gradualist” position in a famous debate at the bSam-yas monastery with
a Chinese exponent of the Ch’an (“Zen”) understanding of “sudden
enlightenment.” It was Kamalaśīla’s victory in this debate that
established the “gradualist” understanding as at least officially
normative for most schools of Tibetan Buddhism; while the occurrence of
the debate itself may be apocryphal, such a position is surely
reflected in Kamalaśīla’s three Bhāvanākrama (“stages of cultivation”)
texts, written in Tibet.
5. More on the Svātantrika-Prāsaṅgika Difference: Madhyamaka and Buddhist EpistemologyAs
indicated, the so-called Svātantrika trajectory of Madhyamaka
constitutively involves recourse to the tools of formal logic and
inference, evincing a characteristic concern to restate Nāgārjuna’s
arguments as formally valid inferences. More generally, it can be said
that this approach is informed by Bhāvaviveka’s use of the logic and
epistemology of Dignāga (c. 480-540), who influentially appealed to the
idiom of pramāṇavidyā (the “discipline of logic and epistemology”) in
advancing the Buddhist position – and who was, indeed, among the most
important figures in developing the broadly Sanskritic conceptual
vocabulary that would predominate in the subsequent course of Indian
philosophy. Similarly, such later Svātantrikas as Śāntarakṣita were
informed by the project of Dignāga’s influential expositor Dharmakīrti
(c. 600-660), and figures such as Dharmakīrti and Śāntarakṣita would be
of decisive importance for the remaining course of the Indian Buddhist
philosophical tradition’s life. (Candrakīrti, in contrast, would
exercise little influence in India, though he re-emerges with the
Tibetan tradition’s interest in him.)
The dispute between these lines of interpretation crystallizes around
the figures of Buddhapālita, Bhāvaviveka, and Candrakīrti – and can be
seen, in particular, in their respective elaborations of Nāgārjuna’s
MMK 1.1 (“There do not exist, anywhere at all, any existents
whatsoever, arisen either from themselves or from something else,
either from both or altogether without cause”). This verse basically
deploys a standard tool in the Mādhyamika arsenal: the “tetralemma”
(catuṣkoṭi), a four-fold statement that is meant to identify all
possible relations between any category and its putative explananda
(e.g., “the same,” “different,” “both the same and different,” “neither
the same nor different”) – with the standard Mādhyamika denial of all
four horns of the tetralemma meant as an exhaustive refutation of the
efficacy and coherence of the category in question. (One modern
interpretive discussion concerns whether or not this apparent violation
of bivalent logic shows Mādhyamikas to have presupposed a non-standard
sort of logic.)
Buddhapālita’s “prāsaṅgika” commentary on this verse does nothing more
than make clear (what he takes to be) the absurd consequences that
would be entailed by affirming any one of the positions here rejected.
For example, the view that existents originate intrinsically – a
position traditionally understood to express the Indian Sāṃkhya
school’s characteristic view that effects are always latent within
their causes – is to be denied “since there would be no point in the
arising of already existent things.” That is, an affirmation of the
causation of something from itself entails that the thing in question
already exists, in which case, its coming-into-being could not be
thought to require causal explanation.
In his commentary on the MMK, Bhāvaviveka then specifically took
Buddhapālita to task, urging that Buddhapālita’s elaboration of the
argument was unreasonable “because no reason and no example are given
and because faults stated by the opponent are not answered” – which is
to say, because the recognized terms of a formally stated inference (as
that had been thematized by Sanskritic philosophers such as Dignāga)
were not present. In contrast, then, to Buddhapālita, Bhāvaviveka
offers a formally valid statement of the reasoning behind Nāgārjuna’s
denial of the first horn of the verse’s tetralemma: “[Thesis:] It is
certain that the inner sense fields (āyatanas) do not ultimately
originate from themselves; [Reason:] because they exist [already],
[Example:] like consciousness.” Among the characteristic features of
Bhāvaviveka’s restatement here is his making explicit the qualifier
“ultimately” (or “essentially,” svabhāvataḥ); that is, Nāgārjuna is
here said to deny only that something is the case essentially or
ultimately. While the first horn of this tetralemma (“existents are
arisen from themselves”) perhaps requires no such qualification in
order for its denial to be intelligible, many interpreters would agree
that such a qualification must be added particularly in order for the
denial of the second (which concerns that origination of things from
other existents) to make any sense; for it is surely counter-intuitive
to think that we cannot even conventionally speak of the origination of
existents from one another. A great many of Nāgārjuna’s prima facie
counter-intuitive refutations can be understood to make more sense if
they are qualified as concerning what is “ultimately” or “essentially”
the case (and not taken simpliciter).
A considerable portion of the first chapter of Candrakīrti’s
Prasannapadā is then given over to defending Buddhapālita’s as the
right way to proceed, and to criticizing Bhāvaviveka’s interpretive
procedure as misguided. How, then, are we to make sense, without
Bhāvaviveka’s characteristic qualification, of Nāgārjuna’s denial of
the second horn of the tetralemma – of his denial, that is, that things
originate from other existents? On Candrakīrti’s reading (which follows
Buddhapālita’s), the absurdity that would be entailed by thinking
otherwise would be that a sprout could just as well be produced from
the coals of a fire as from a seed; and, conversely, if a sprout cannot
be produced from the coals of a fire, it cannot be said to be produced
from a seed, either. Candrakīrti’s argument here is usefully understood
as involving a priori (as contra a posteriori) analysis; that is, the
argument short-circuits any appeal to what we experience to be the
case, instead analyzing only the concepts presupposed in how we explain
experience – and the point is to reduce to absurdity any argument that
presupposes the independence of such concepts (that presupposes, in
other words, that any such concepts might afford a privileged
perspective on what there is). Read this way, the argument turns simply
on the definition of “other,” and the point is that the general concept
of “otherness” leaves us with no principled way to know which other
things are relevantly connected to the thing whose arising we seek to
explain, and we are left to suppose that anything that is “other” than
the latter (even the coals of a fire) could give rise to it.
Although many Tibetan exegetes were (as noted) inclined to see the
dispute here as turning on subtle ontological presuppositions, this can
be hard to glean from the Indian texts upon which the dispute is based.
The characteristically Svātantrika appeal to the idiom of logic and
epistemology can, however, be understood as meant to address what are
real philosophical problems in the Mādhyamika project as that is
understood by Candrakīrti – just as Candrakīrti, for his part, can be
understood as having philosophically principled reasons for refusing
the epistemological tools characteristically deployed by Bhāvaviveka
and his heirs. What is at issue here is, once again, the question of
how we are to regard the “conventionally” described world once the idea
that there can be an “ultimately” true description thereof has been
jettisoned. Nāgārjuna himself had emphasized the importance of some
kind of relation in this regard, saying, for example, that “without
relying on convention, the ultimate is not taught; without having
understood the ultimate, nirvāṇa is not apprehended” (MMK 24.10). In
other words, the (relative) reality of the conventionally described
world is a condition of the possibility of our coming to understand
what is ultimately the case; but if what is understood thereby is in
fact that there is nothing “more real” than the conventionally
described world – that, e.g., there are no ontological primitives that
are not themselves subject to the conditions that obtain in the world –
then it might be thought that, as it were, “anything goes.”
The philosophical worry, then, is that if Mādhyamika arguments are not
understood in something like the way that Svātantrikas propose,
Madhyamaka could degenerate into a thoroughgoing and pernicious
conventionalism. The broadly Svātantrika line of interpretation
attempts to address this worry by arguing that even if all discourse
(including that of the Mādhyamika) perforce takes place at the
“conventional” level, it is nevertheless the case that some
“conventions” are more nearly true than others – and that the
epistemological tools developed by Dignāga and Dharmakīrti give us the
resources to sort these out. The Svātantrika Jñānagarbha (followed, in
this regard, by his student Śāntarakṣita) emphasized that we can
distinguish between “true convention” (tathya-saṃvṛti) and “false
convention” (mithyā-saṃvṛti).
In his refusal of the characteristically “Svātantrika” use of the
conceptual tools of Buddhist epistemology, Candrakīrti need not be
understood as conceding simply that anything goes. Candrakīrti’s point,
rather, would seem to be to emphasize that there can be no explanatory
categories that do not themselves exhibit the same characteristics
(chiefly, the fact of being dependently originated) already on display
in the conventionally described world; and any constitutively analytic
sort of reasoning (such as that exemplified by the discourse of
epistemology) just is a search for something beyond what is already
given in conventional discourse. What is “conventionally” true, then,
is (by definition) just our conventions – and any demand for some
account or explanation of these could be thought to provide some
purchase only to the extent that what is demanded is something that is
not itself “conventional.” But there cannot be any such discourse, any
more than there can be an existent that is not dependently originated;
the two claims are related insofar as all that could count as a
discursively exhaustive explanation would be one that adduces something
that is not itself subject to the constraints that it explains – which
is to say, something not dependently originated. Although this may
represent an adequate reconstruction of his position, Candrakīrti’s
emphasis on the definitively “non-analytic” character of conventional
discourse can, nevertheless, reasonably be thought to leave his project
vulnerable to charges of incoherence, and it can be seen that the
issues in dispute between Svātantrikas and Prāsaṅgika are the same
paradoxes that bedevil Madhyamaka more generally.
6. Madhyamaka in TibetIndian
Madhyamaka figures decisively in most of the Tibetan schools of
Buddhist philosophy, which tend to agree in judging Madhyamaka to
represent the pinnacle of Buddhist thought. There are, however,
interesting historical and philosophical developments that greatly
complicate this picture. For example, while the scholastic traditions
of Indian Buddhist philosophy were first introduced to Tibet by the
“Svātantrika” Mādhyamikas Śāntarakṣita and Kamalaśīla, many schools of
Tibetan Buddhism nevertheless claim Candrakīrti’s (“Prāsaṅgika”)
interpretation as authoritative – a fact partly owing, perhaps, to the
influence of Atiśa in the so-called “second dissemination” of Indian
Buddhism to Tibet (that is, the period during which Indian Buddhism was
decisively established in Tibet, and during which the systematic
translation of Indian Buddhist texts into Tibetan was brought to
fruition). However, the characteristically Tibetan emphasis on
“Vajrayāna” (i.e., tantric) forms of practice arguably promotes greater
recourse to the idiom of Yogācāra than would be encouraged by
Candrakīrti. In addition, there are, as noted, philosophical reasons
for qualifying some of Candrakīrti’s positions. Hence, even those
Tibetan schools (such as the dGe-lugs) that most forcefully assert the
authoritative character of “Prāsaṅgika” Madhyamaka tend, for example,
to support their interpretation with significant studies in the
Buddhist epistemological tradition – a move, as noted, definitively
characteristic of the “Svātantrika” approach.
The attempt thus to wed Madhyamaka to the philosophical project of Dignāga
and Dharmakīrti is worth appreciating not only because it is
intrinsically interesting, but because, particularly in the United
States in the latter part of the 20th century, a great many modern
interpreters of Indian Madhyamaka have been influenced by
characteristically Tibetan appropriations of this tradition. While this
has arguably led to some distortions in the exegesis particularly of
Candrakīrti’s texts, there is much to recommend the Tibetans’
systematic (as opposed to historical) presentation of Madhyamaka in
relation to the other schools of Indian Buddhist philosophy. As
indicated, a distinctive feature of characteristically Tibetan
presentations of Buddhist philosophy is the use of doxographical
digests elaborating what are called “established conclusions” (grub
mtha’; this translates the Sanskrit siddhānta).
On this model, the various schools of Indian Buddhist philosophy
(principally consisting, according to such presentations, in the two
“Ābhidharmika” schools of the Vaibhāṣikas and Sautrāntikas, and the two
“Mahāyāna” schools of Yogācāra and Madhyamaka) are represented in an
ascending hierarchy of progressively more refined positions, the proper
understanding of each of which requires understanding its predecessors.
Ascent through the hierarchy is characterized, most basically, by the
progressive elimination of ontological commitments: the two
Ābhidharmika schools divide over the question of what are to be
admitted as “dharmas” qualifying for inclusion in a final ontology;
Yogācāra further pares down this list to nothing but mental events; the
“Svātantrika” Mādhyamikas are represented as retaining only the
vestigial ontological commitments that are thought to be entailed by
their characteristic deference to the dialectical tools of
epistemology; until, with the “Prāsaṅgika” iteration of Madhyamaka, we
arrive at the school of thought for which the set of “ultimately
existent” (paramārthasat) phenomena is an empty set.
The effect of this is to throw our attention back to the only “set” of
existents with any remaining content: the conventionally described
world, now understood as ineliminable. Hence, on this view, there is
the avoidance of (what Mādhyamikas are always trying to eschew) the
extreme of nihilism or “eliminativism” (ucchedavāda); but there is also
the (constitutively Buddhist) avoidance of the extreme of “eternalism,”
insofar as the effect of cultivating the Mādhyamika insight only as the
culminating stage in a progression is (it is claimed) to have driven
home the realization that the self exists (like everything
“conventional”) only relatively or dependently. Once the project of a
privileged level of description has been abandoned, the “common-sense
realism” that remains can be seen to differ from that of the
unenlightened “by virtue of its being adopted in full cognizance of the
progression through the intervening stages” (Siderits 2003, 185).
The same insight is reflected in the basic monastic curriculum of
dGe-lugs-pa monasteries, which is structured around five topics defined
by representative Indian texts: The Vinaya, or Buddhist monastic code,
as represented by the Vinaya Sūtra of Guṇaprabha; Abhidharma, as
represented by the Abhidharmakośa of Vasubandhu;
logic and epistemology, as represented by the Pramāṇavārttika of
Dharmakīrti; Madhyamaka, as represented by Candrakīrti’s
Madhyamakāvatāra; and the stages on the path to enlightenment, as
represented by the Abhisamayālaṃkāra attributed to Maitreya. In this
way, the study of the Madhyamaka tradition of Buddhist philosophy comes
only in the context of an overarching education in a complete Buddhist
world-view, such that characteristically Mādhyamika teachings
concerning “emptiness” are – like the Prajñāpāramitā Sūtras whose
retrieval by Nāgārjuna was thought to introduce Mahāyāna as
representing the Buddha’s definitive teaching – made intelligible by
the necessarily propaedeutic earlier teachings. Above all, it is the
finally ethical character of Mādhyamika thought that is encouraged by
this pedagogical system; for the characteristically Mādhyamika claim
that “all dharmas are empty” – that, in other words, Abhidharma’s
reductionist account of the person cannot finally be made coherent –
cannot be understood as nihilistic if it has been made clear that the
upshot of it is to return our attention to the irreducibly conventional
world in which persons live and suffer.
Tibetan tradition preserves, however, not only a model for the
integration of Madhyamaka philosophy into a structured set of
transformative religious practices, but also a great deal of innovative
and sophisticated philosophical elaboration of Mādhyamika thought. For
example, the prolific scholar Tsong-kha-pa (1357-1419) – originator of
the influential reformist school that would style itself the “dGe-lugs”
(“virtuous way”) – did much to integrate the Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka of
Candrakīrti with the understanding and teaching of Buddhist
epistemology stemming from Dharmakīrti. Tsong-kha-pa’s works (such as
the massive Lam rim chen mo, “Great [treatise on] the Stages of the
Path”) also bring considerable sophistication to bear on the question
of how Madhyamaka ought to be understood in relation to Yogācāra.
Critics of Tsong-kha-pa – such as, notably, the Sa-skya-pa scholar
Go-ram-pa bSod-nams seng-ge (1429-1489) – stridently condemned his
confidence that the discourse of epistemology could bring Mādhyamika
analysis into contact with ultimate reality. On Go-ram-pa’s reading,
such confidence amounts to the claim that the discursive thought that
understands “ultimate truth” is itself ultimately true – which is to
confuse the (necessarily conventional) activity of thinking about
ultimate truth with what it is that such thought is about. Go-ram-pa
claims that Tsong-kha-pa’s account of Madhyamaka entails the nihilistic
conclusion that what is ultimately true is simply what is
conventionally true. This Tibetan debate, then, recognizably addresses
the perennially vexed issues that go to the heart of Madhyamaka: those
concerning how we are to understand the relation between ultimate and
conventional truth, in the context of a claim to the effect that “the
ultimate truth is that there is no ultimate truth.”
7. Madhyamaka in East AsiaIt is
frequently observed that while Indo-Tibetan schools of Buddhist
philosophy characteristically developed around the systematic treatises
(śāstras) of historical thinkers like Nāgārjuna and Dignāga, Chinese
Buddhist philosophy instead centers on (and its schools are largely
defined by) the interpretation of particular Buddhist sūtras. Whatever
truth there may be in this, it is certainly the case that a great deal
of systematic Indian Buddhist philosophy from the mature scholastic
phase of the tradition (roughly, from the sixth century on) was never
translated into Chinese. Although the texts of (say) Nāgārjuna,
Vasubandhu, and Dignāga are available in Chinese translation, the
Chinese canon does not include the works of such thinkers as
Candrakīrti, Dharmakīrti, or Śāntarakṣita – the later Mādhyamikas and
epistemologists whose works decisively shaped Indo-Tibetan traditions
of interpretation. Accordingly, the development of Madhyamaka in China
centers on a somewhat different group of texts – all of them translated
by the great translator Kumārajīva (350-409), whose efforts figure
prominently in the Chinese reception of Madhyamaka. So, the Chinese
analogue of the Indian Madhyamaka school was originally styled San-lun,
the “Three Śāstra” school, so called for its reliance upon three of
Kumārajīva’s translations. Only one of these (the MMK, here called
Chung lun, “Madhyamakaśāstra”; Taishō 1564) has an extant Sanskrit
antecedent. The other two – the Dvādaśanikāyaśāstra (Shih erh men lun,
Taishō 1568), attributed to Nāgārjuna, and the Śata[ka]śāstra (Pai lun,
Taishō 1569), attributed to Āryadeva – are extant neither in Sanskrit
nor in Tibetan translation.
It was, however, arguably another treatise attributed to Nāgārjuna (and
also “translated” by Kumārajīva) that was ultimately to have greater
influence on East Asian interpretations of Madhyamaka: the Ta-chih-tu
lun, or *Mahāprajñāpāramitopadeśa Śāstra (“Treatise which is a Teaching
on the Great Perfection of Wisdom [Sūtra]”). This text – a massive
summa of Buddhist doctrine, comparable in scope to the
*Vijñaptimātratāsiddhi (which is ostensibly a digest and compilation of
several Indian commentaries on one of the works by Vasubandhu that is
foundational for Yogācāra) – is extant in no other translation than
Kumārajīva’s, and comprises a great deal of material that is not easily
reconciled with what is taught in Nāgārjuna’s MMK. However, despite the
scholarly consensus to the effect that this text is not authentically
attributed to Nāgārjuna, East Asian authors citing Nāgārjuna tend most
frequently to cite Kumārajīva’s text (and not the MMK). The reasons for
this are, along with one of the salient features of characteristically
East Asian interpretations of Nāgārjuna, reflected in a comment by the
Japanese scholar Junjirō Takakusu, who observed that while such
Mādhyamika texts as the MMK are “much inclined to be negativistic
idealism,” in the Ta-chih-tu lun “we see that [Nāgārjuna] establishes
his monistic view much more affirmatively than in any other text”
(Takakusu 1949: 100).
Takakusu’s assessment of the MMK as “negativistic” arguably relates to
the ways in which characteristically East Asian interpretations of
Madhyamaka have been (not surprisingly) influenced by the vicissitudes
of Chinese translations from Sanskrit. For example, it has been noted
(by, e.g., Swanson 1989: 14) that Chinese terms centrally associated
with the two truths – yu (“existence” or “being”) and wu
(“non-existence” or non-being”), identified, respectively, with
saṃvṛtisatya (conventional truth) and paramārthasatya (ultimate truth)
– had strongly ontological implications that can alter the sense of
characteristically Mādhyamika claims (originally stated in Sanskrit)
when those were translated into Chinese. In particular, the
ontologically “negative” sense of the term wu has arguably had the
effect of recommending that Mādhyamika claims regarding emptiness be taken (notwithstanding Nāgārjuna’s repeated cautions in this
regard) as rather more nihilistic than was intended.
We can consider, in this regard, chapter 24, verse 18 of Nāgārjuna’s
MMK – a pivotal verse that may be rendered: “We call that which is
dependent origination [pratītyasamutpāda] emptiness [śūnyatā]. That
[emptiness,] a relative indication [upādāya prajñapti], is itself the
middle path [madhyamā pratipad].” This often cited (and variously
translated) verse is significant chiefly for its asserting that the
authentic “middle path” – and hence (given the centrality of the middle
way trope in Buddhist thought) the authentically Buddhist doctrine –
lies in realizing the identity of three terms: dependent origination,
emptiness, and “dependent designation” or “relative indication”
(upādāya prajñapti). The semantic range of the latter term is such as
to suggest that emptiness-cum-dependent origination is itself
“conventional,” and one upshot of the verse is therefore to express, in
effect, the idea of the “emptiness of emptiness.” More
straightforwardly, though, this verse clearly represents one of the
countless occasions on which Nāgārjuna is concerned to emphasize that
by “emptiness” he means simply “dependent origination.”
On one characteristically East Asian interpretation of this verse (that
of the modern Japanese scholar Gadjin Nagao), however, we are to
understand here that the verse’s initial predication (“we call that
which is dependent origination emptiness”) amounts to a negation of
(the ontologically “positive” phenomenon which is) dependent
origination. As Nagao states this idea, “This pratītya-samutpāda dies
in the second [quarter verse].” The second predication – which
characterizes this “emptiness” as a “relative indication” – then
amounts to a return to the ontologically “positive.” On this reading,
then, the verse “is dialectical, moving from affirmation to negation
and again to affirmation.” (Nagao 1991: 193-94) This “dialectical”
reading of a quintessentially Mādhyamika claim is frequently
encountered in modern Japanese scholarship – a fact that arguably
reflects the extent to which many Japanese scholars (even those who
have developed deep acquaintance with the Sanskrit texts of Indian
Buddhism) have their initial grounding in the characteristically East
Asian traditions of interpretation in which the Ta-chih-tu lun of
Kumārajīva is paramount.
Another characteristic preoccupation of East Asian interpreters of
Madhyamaka is one also evident in some of the Indo-Tibetan traditions
of interpretation: that of attempting to harmonize Madhyamaka and
Yogācāra. In the East Asian case, the fact that so many Buddhist
interpreters of Madhyamaka should attempt – notwithstanding the extent
to which many Indian Mādhyamika and Yogācāra texts are framed as
mutually polemical – to develop a synthesis of these two great schools
of Mahāyāna philosophy partly reflects the predominance of Yogācāra in
East Asian Buddhist thought. If, however, Madhyamaka philosophy was
largely eclipsed by Yogācāra (and more importantly, by other indigenous
developments) in the East Asian context, it nevertheless arguably lives
on in the enigmatic discourse of Ch’an/Zen Buddhism that many take to
be quintessentially East Asian. While any Mādhyamika influence on Zen
is surely indirect, the latter tradition’s particular debt to the
Prajñāpāramitā literature (the Vajracchedikā, or “Diamond,” Sūtra
figures most importantly here) perhaps explains why many modern
observers are inclined to see affinities with Madhyamaka.
8. References and Further Reading
Ames, William L. 1986. “Buddhapālita’s Exposition of the Madhyamaka.” Journal of Indian Philosophy 14: 313-348.
Ames, William L. 1993-94. “Bhāvaviveka's Prajñāpradīpa: A
Translation of Chapter One: ‘Examination of Causal Conditions’
(Pratyaya),” [in two parts], Journal of Indian Philosophy 21: 209-259;
22: 93-135.
These articles provide a good point of access to the interpretations of
Nāgārjuna ventured by two of his earliest commentators (the two
discussed at length in the commentary of Candrakīrti).
Arnold, Dan. 2005. Buddhists, Brahmins, and Belief: Epistemology in South Asian Philosophy of Religion.
New York: Columbia University Press.
Part 3 of this work makes a case (based on an engagement with
Candrakīrti’s critique of the Buddhist epistemologist Dignāga) for the
interpretation of Madhyamaka as involving transcendental arguments.
Bhattacharya, Kamaleswar. 1990. The Dialectical Method of Nāgārjuna: Vigrahavyāvartanī. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
Contains (along with an edition of the Sanskrit text) a reliable translation of one of Nāgārjuna’s major works.
Blumenthal, James. 2004. The Ornament of the Middle Way: A Study of the Madhyamaka Thought of Śāntarakṣita. Ithaca, NY: Snow Lion Publications.
A translation and extensive study (together with a translated dGe-lugs-pa commentary) of Śāntarakṣita’s Madhyamakālaṃkāra.
Burton, David F. 1999. Emptiness Appraised: A Critical Study of Nāgārjuna’s Philosophy. London: Curzon.
Argues that despite Nāgārjuna’s expressed intentions, his arguments entail nihilistic conclusions.
Cabezón, José Ignacio. 1992. A Dose of Emptiness: An Annotated Translation of the sTong thun chen mo of mKhas grub dGe legs dpal bzang.
Albany: SUNY Press.
This extensively annotated and reliable translation makes available a
representative example of a Tibetan dGe-lugs-pa interpretation of
Madhyamaka (this one by one of Tsong-kha-pa’s two major disciples).
Chimpa, Lama, and Alaka Chattopadhyaya, trans. 1970. Tāranātha’s History of Buddhism in India.
Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
A useful translation of a traditional history of the Indian Buddhist
tradition, containing representative accounts of the careers and works
of important Indian thinkers.
Conze, Edward, trans. 1975. The Large Sutra on Perfect Wisdom, with the divisions of the Abhisamayālaṅkāra.
Berkeley: University of California Press.
A useful point of access to the paradoxical style of discourse that is
characteristic of the “Prajñāpāramitā” literature that figures in
Nāgārjuna’s background.
Crosby, Kate, and Andrew Skilton, trans. 1995. The Bodhicaryāvatāra. New York: Oxford University Press.
A translation of the major work of Śāntideva, with an introduction and annotations.
Dreyfus, Georges. 2003. The Sound of Two Hands Clapping: The Education of a Tibetan Buddhist Monk. Berkeley: University of California Press.
An insightful study of the pedagogical context for the Tibetan interpretation and transmission of Madhyamaka.
Dreyfus, Georges, and Sara McClintock, eds. 2003. The Svātantrika-Prāsaṅgika Distinction: What Difference Does a Difference Make?
Boston: Wisdom Publications.
A collection of scholarly essays representative of the current state of
debate on this division of Madhyamaka, with attention both to this as a
Tibetan doxographical category, and to matters of interpretation
regarding the antecedent Indian texts.
Garfield, Jay L., trans. 1995. The Fundamental Wisdom of the Middle Way: Nāgārjuna’s Mūlamadhyamakakārikā.
New York: Oxford University Press.
Though translated from the Tibetan (and not from the extant Sanskrit),
this is the most accessible of the available translations of
Nāgārjuna’s foundational text – and far and away the most
philosophically sophisticated and illuminating.
Hayes, Richard P. 1994. “Nāgārjuna’s Appeal.” Journal of Indian Philosophy 22: 299-378.
Argues that Nāgārjuna’s works centrally involve an equivocation on the word svabhāva.
Huntington, C. W., with Geshe Namgyal Wangchen. 1989. The Emptiness of Emptiness: An Introduction to Early Indian Mādhyamika.
Honolulu: University of Hawaii Press.
An annotated translation of Candrakīrti’s Madhyamakāvatāra, with a
lengthy introduction that makes a case for the interpretation of
Madhyamaka along lines suggested by poststructuralist philosophy.
Iida Shotaro. 1980. Reason and Emptiness: A Study in Logic and Mysticism. Tokyo: Hokuseido.
A study, with texts and translations, of major works of Bhāvaviveka.
Jha, Ganganath, trans. 1986. The Tattvasaṁgraha of Shāntarakṣita with the Commentary of Kamalashīla. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass. (Reprint; first published in Gaekwad’s Oriental Series, 1937-1939.)
A relatively inaccessible (but nonetheless complete) translation of this major work by Śāntarakṣita.
La Vallée Poussin, Louis de, ed. 1970. Mūlamadhyamakakārikās (Mādhyamikasūtras) de Nāgārjuna, avec la Prasannapadā Commentaire de Candrakīrti. Bibliotheca Buddhica, Vol. IV. Osnabrück: Biblio Verlag. (Reprint; originally published 1903-1913.)
This work warrants mention as the standard edition of the foundational text of Madhyamaka.
Lamotte, Etienne, trans. 1944-1980. Le Traité de la Grande Vertu de Sagesse.
5 volumes. Louvain: Insitut orientaliste, Bibliothèque de l’Université
de Louvain.
The characteristically extensive annotations alone make this monumental
work a treasure trove. Despite its vastness, this represents only a
partial translation of the Ta-chih-tu Lun (*Mahāprajñāpārmitāśāstra) of
Nāgārjuna/Kumārajīva.
Lang, Karen. 1986. Āryadeva’s Catuḥśataka: On the Bodhisattva's Cultivation of Merit and Knowledge. Copenhagen: Akademisk Forlag.
A reliable translation of the major work of Āryadeva.
Lindtner, Chr. 1987. Nagarjuniana: Studies in the Writings and Philosophy of Nāgārjuna. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1987. (Reprint; first published in Copenhagen, Institute for indisk filologi, 1982.)
A study of the works that are (and are not) appropriately attributed to Nāgārjuna, with editions and translations of several.
Murti, T. R. V. 1960. The Central Philosophy of Buddhism: A Study of the Mādhyamika System. Second edition. London: George Allen and Unwin.
An important early study of Madhyamaka, representing one of a few influential neo-Kantian interpretations thereof.
Nagao Gadjin. 1991. Mādhyamika and Yogācāra: A Study of Mahāyāna Philosophies. Trans. Leslie S. Kawamura. Albany: SUNY Press.
A selection of translated essays representative of the approach and legacy of this important Japanese scholar.
Ramanan, K. Venkata. 1975. Nāgārjuna’s Philosophy as presented in the Mahā-Prajñāpāramitā-Śāstra.
Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass. (Reprint; first published Charles Tuttle,
1966.)
This work is useful for its making accessible the contents and style of
the text (extant only in Kumārajīva’s Chinese translation) that most
influenced the East Asian reception of Madhyamaka. (Ramanan is in the
scholarly minority in accepting the Chinese tradition’s attribution of
the text to Nāgārjuna.)
Ruegg, David Seyfort. 1981. The Literature of the Madhyamaka School of Philosophy in India. A History of Indian Literature (ed. Jan Gonda), Vol. VII, Fasc. 1. Wiesbaden: Otto Harrassowitz.
This authoritative work on the history and texts of Indian Madhyamaka is the standard reference work on the subject.
Siderits, Mark. 2003. Personal Identity and Buddhist Philosophy: Empty Persons.
Burlington, VT: Ashgate.
Chapters 6-9 develop a sophisticated philosophical reconstruction of
Madhyamaka (here characterized as a philosophically “anti-realist”
position), which is represented as constitutively related to the
reductionism of Ābhidharmika Buddhism (treated in the first half of the
book). A difficult work that can seem to owe more to analytic
philosophy than to Indian Buddhism, but an exceptionally sensitive
account of the issue of truth vis-à-vis Madhyamaka. In particular,
Siderits argues for a version of Madhyamaka as involving a
“deflationist” account of truth (here called “semantic non-dualism”).
Sopa, Geshe Lhundup, and Jeffrey Hopkins, trans., Cutting Through Appearances: The Practice and Theory of Tibetan Buddhism.
2nd ed. Ithaca, NY: Snow Lion Publications, 1989.
Includes a somewhat inaccessible translation of a standard Tibetan
doxographical text, which is useful for a sense of how Madhyamaka is
represented by Tibetans in relation to other Buddhist schools of
thought.
Sprung, Mervyn, trans. 1979. Lucid Exposition of the Middle Way: The Essential Chapters from the Prasannapadā of Candrakīrti.
London: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
Currently the closest thing to a complete Western-language translation
of Candrakīrti’s text (hence, the translation also comprises most of
Nāgārjuna’s MMK). While not an altogether reliable translation, this
provides some access to the discourse of Candrakīrti.
Stcherbatsky, Th. 1927. The Conception of Buddhist Nirvāṇa.
Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1989. (Reprint.)
This early work includes a dated and eccentric (but nonetheless useful)
translation of the first chapter of Candrakīrti’s Prasannapadā.
Stcherbatsky influentially advanced a broadly neo-Kantian
interpretation of Madhyamaka.
Swanson, Paul L. 1989. Foundations of T’ien-T’ai Philosophy: The Flowering of the Two Truths Theory in Chinese Buddhism. Berkeley: Asian Humanities Press.
An accessible study of the East Asian reception and interpretation of Madhyamaka.
Takakusu Junjirō. 1949. The Essentials of Buddhist Philosophy. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass,
1975. (Reprint; first published by the University of Hawaii.)
A concise presentation of the various schools of Buddhist philosophy as
they are reckoned in East Asian traditions. The presentation of
Madhyamaka (“Sanron,” the “Three Treatise” school) is at pp.99-111.
Thurman, Robert. 1991. The Central Philosophy of Tibet: A Study and Translation of Jey Tsong Khapa’s Essence of True Eloquence.
Princeton: Princeton University Press.
A translation of part of an important work by Tsong-kha-pa,
representing a Tibetan Mādhyamika engagement with Yogācāra. The
author’s lengthy introduction advances a broadly Wittgensteinian
understanding of Madhyamaka.
Tillemans, Tom J. F. 1990. Materials for the Study of Āryadeva, Dharmapāla and Candrakīrti. Wiener Studien zur Tibetologie und Buddhismuskunde,
Heft 24, 1-2. Wien: Arbeitskreis für tibetische und buddhistische
Studien.
Annotated translations (with a philosophically sophisticated
introduction and annotations) of parts of the divergent commentaries on
Āryadeva by the Mādhyamika Candrakīrti and the Yogācārin Dharmapāla.
Tuck, Andrew. 1990. Comparative Philosophy and the Philosophy of Scholarship: On the Western Interpretation of Nāgārjuna. New York: Oxford University Press.
An illuminating study of the philosophical presuppositions informing important modern interpretations of Nāgārjuna.
Walser, Joseph. 2005. Nāgārjuna in Context: Mahāyāna Buddhism and Early Indian Culture.
New York: Columbia University Press.
An attempt to locate the figure of Nāgārjuna in socio-historical
context (and particularly in relation to the then nascent Mahāyāna
movement).
Williams, Paul. 1989. Mahāyāna Buddhism: The Doctrinal Foundations.
London: Routledge.
An accessible and lucid survey of Mahāyāna Buddhist thought. Chapter 3
treats Madhyamaka, with some attention to Tibetan and East Asian
developments therein.
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