As Lord Chancellor, Bacon wielded a degree of power and influence that he could only have imagined as a young lawyer seeking preferment. Yet it was at this point, while he stood at the very pinnacle of success, that he suffered his great Fall. In 1621 he was arrested and charged with bribery. After pleading guilty, he was heavily fined and sentenced to a prison term in the Tower of London. Although the fine was later waived and Bacon spent only four days in the Tower, he was never allowed to sit in Parliament or hold political office again.

The entire episode was a terrible disgrace for Bacon personally and a stigma that would cling to and injure his reputation for years to come. As various chroniclers of the case have pointed out, the accepting of gifts from suppliants in a law suit was a common practice in Bacon’s day, and it is also true that Bacon ended up judging against the two petitioners who had offered the fateful bribes. Yet the damage was done, and Bacon to his credit accepted the judgment against him without excuse. According to his own Essayes, or Counsels, he should have known and done better. (In this respect it is worth noting that during his forced retirement, Bacon revised and republished the Essayes, injecting an even greater degree of shrewdness into a collection already notable for its worldliness and keen political sense.) Macaulay in a lengthy essay declared Bacon a great intellect but (borrowing a phrase from Bacon’s own letters) a “most dishonest man,” and more than one writer has characterized him as cold, calculating, and arrogant. Yet whatever his flaws, even his enemies conceded that during his trial he accepted his punishment nobly, and moved on.

Bacon spent his remaining years working with renewed determination on his lifelong project: the reform of learning and the establishment of an intellectual community dedicated to the discovery of scientific knowledge for the “use and benefit of men.” The former Lord Chancellor died on 9 April, 1626, supposedly of a cold or pneumonia contracted while testing his theory of the preservative and insulating properties of snow.

In a way Bacon’s descent from political power was a fortunate fall, for it represented a liberation from the bondage of public life resulting in a remarkable final burst of literary and scientific activity. As Renaissance scholar and Bacon expert Brian Vickers has reminded us, Bacon’s earlier works, impressive as they are, were essentially products of his “spare time.” It was only during his last five years that he was able to concentrate exclusively on writing and produce, in addition to a handful of minor pieces:

These late productions represented the capstone of a writing career that spanned more than four decades and encompassed virtually an entire curriculum of literary, scientific, and philosophical studies.

Despite the fanatical claims (and very un-Baconian credulity) of a few admirers, it is a virtual certainty that Bacon did not write the works traditionally attributed to William Shakespeare. Even so, the Lord Chancellor’s high place in the history of English literature as well as his influential role in the development of English prose style remain well-established and secure. Indeed even if Bacon had produced nothing else but his masterful Essayes (first published in 1597 and then revised and expanded in 1612 and 1625), he would still rate among the top echelon of 17th-century English authors. And so when we take into account his other writings, e.g., his histories, letters, and especially his major philosophical and scientific works, we must surely place him in the first rank of English literature’s great men of letters and among its finest masters (alongside names like Johnson, Mill, Carlyle, and Ruskin) of non-fiction prose.

Bacon’s style, though elegant, is by no means as simple as it seems or as it is often described. In fact it is actually a fairly complex affair that achieves its air of ease and clarity more through its balanced cadences, natural metaphors, and carefully arranged symmetries than through the use of plain words, commonplace ideas, and straightforward syntax. (In this connection it is noteworthy that in the revised versions of the essays Bacon seems to have deliberately disrupted many of his earlier balanced effects to produce a style that is actually more jagged and, in effect, more challenging to the casual reader.)

Furthermore, just as Bacon’s personal style and living habits were prone to extravagance and never particularly austere, so in his writing he was never quite able to resist the occasional grand word, magniloquent phrase, or orotund effect. (As Dr. Johnson observed, “A dictionary of the English language might be compiled from Bacon’s works alone.”) Bishop Sprat in his 1667 History of the Royal Society honored Bacon and praised the society membership for supposedly eschewing fine words and fancy metaphors and adhering instead to a natural lucidity and “mathematical plainness.” To write in such a way, Sprat suggested, was to follow true, scientific, Baconian principles. And while Bacon himself often expressed similar sentiments (praising blunt expression while condemning the seductions of figurative language), a reader would be hard pressed to find many examples of such spare technique in Bacon’s own writings. Of Bacon’s contemporary readers, at least one took exception to the view that his writing represented a perfect model of plain language and transparent meaning. After perusing the New Organon, King James (to whom Bacon had proudly dedicated the volume) reportedly pronounced the work “like the peace of God, which passeth all understanding.”

As a work of narrative fiction, Bacon’s novel New Atlantis may be classified as a literary rather than a scientific (or philosophical) work, though it effectively belongs to both categories. According to Bacon’s amanuensis and first biographer William Rawley, the novel represents the first part (showing the design of a great college or institute devoted to the interpretation of nature) of what was to have been a longer and more detailed project (depicting the entire legal structure and political organization of an ideal commonwealth). The work thus stands in the great tradition of the utopian-philosophical novel that stretches from Plato and More to Huxley and Skinner.

The thin plot or fable is little more than a fictional shell to contain the real meat of Bacon’s story: the elaborate description of Salomon’s House (also known as the College of the Six Days Works), a centrally organized research facility where specially trained teams of investigators collect data, conduct experiments, and (most importantly from Bacon’s point of view) apply the knowledge they gain to produce “things of use and practice for man’s life.” These new arts and inventions they eventually share with the outside world.

In terms of its sci-fi adventure elements, the New Atlantis is about as exciting as a government or university re-organization plan. But in terms of its historical impact, the novel has proven to be nothing less than revolutionary, having served not only as an effective inspiration and model for the British Royal Society, but also as an early blueprint and prophecy of the modern research center and international scientific community.

It is never easy to summarize the thought of a prolific and wide-ranging philosopher. Yet Bacon somewhat simplifies the task by his own helpful habits of systematic classification and catchy mnemonic labeling. (Thus, for example, there are three “distempers” – or diseases – of learning,” eleven errors or “peccant humours,” four “Idols,” three primary mental faculties and categories of knowledge, etc.) In effect, by following Bacon’s own methods it is possible to produce a convenient outline or overview of his main scientific and philosophical ideas.

As early as 1592, in a famous letter to his uncle, Lord Burghley, Bacon declared “all knowledge” to be his province and vowed his personal commitment to a plan for the full-scale rehabilitation and reorganization of learning. In effect, he dedicated himself to a long-term project of intellectual reform, and the balance of his career can be viewed as a continuing effort to make good on that pledge. In 1620, while he was still at the peak of his political success, he published the preliminary description and plan for an enormous work that would fully answer to his earlier declared ambitions. The work, dedicated to James, was to be called Magna Instauratio (i.e., the “grand edifice” or Great Instauration), and it would represent a kind of summa or culmination of all Bacon’s thought on subjects ranging from logic and epistemology to practical science (or what in Bacon’s day was called “natural philosophy,” the word science being then but a general synonym for “wisdom” or “learning”).

Like several of Bacon’s projects, the Instauratio in its contemplated form was never finished. Of the intended six parts, only the first two were completed, while the other portions were only partly finished or barely begun. Consequently, the work as we have it is less like the vast but well-sculpted monument that Bacon envisioned than a kind of philosophical miscellany or grab-bag. Part I of the project, De Dignitate et Augmentis Scientiarum (“Nine Books of the Dignity and Advancement of Learning”), was published in 1623. It is basically an enlarged version of the earlier Proficience and Advancement of Learning, which Bacon had presented to James in 1605. Part II, the Novum Organum (or “New Organon”) provides the author’s detailed explanation and demonstration of the correct procedure for interpreting nature. It first appeared in 1620. Together these two works present the essential elements of Bacon’s philosophy, including most of the major ideas and principles that we have come to associate with the terms “Baconian” and “Baconianism.”

Relatively early in his career Bacon judged that, owing mainly to an undue reverence for the past (as well as to an excessive absorption in cultural vanities and frivolities), the intellectual life of Europe had reached a kind of impasse or standstill. Yet he believed there was a way beyond this stagnation if persons of learning, armed with new methods and insights, would simply open their eyes and minds to the world around them. This at any rate was the basic argument of his seminal 1605 treatise The Proficience and Advancement of Learning, arguably the first important philosophical work to be published in English.

It is in this work that Bacon sketched out the main themes and ideas that he continued to refine and develop throughout his career, beginning with the notion that there are clear obstacles to or diseases of learning that must be avoided or purged before further progress is possible.

“There be therefore chiefly three vanities in studies, whereby learning hath been most traduced.” Thus Bacon, in the first book of the Advancement. He goes on to refer to these vanities as the three “distempers” of learning and identifies them (in his characteristically memorable fashion) as “fantastical learning,” “contentious learning,” and “delicate learning” (alternatively identified as “vain imaginations,” “vain altercations,” and “vain affectations”).

By fantastical learning (“vain imaginations”) Bacon had in mind what we would today call pseudo-science: i.e., a collection of ideas that lack any real or substantial foundation, that are professed mainly by occultists and charlatans, that are carefully shielded from outside criticism, and that are offered largely to an audience of credulous true believers. In Bacon’s day such “imaginative science” was familiar in the form of astrology, natural magic, and alchemy.

By contentious learning (“vain altercations”) Bacon was referring mainly to Aristotelian philosophy and theology and especially to the Scholastic tradition of logical hair-splitting and metaphysical quibbling. But the phrase applies to any intellectual endeavor in which the principal aim is not new knowledge or deeper understanding but endless debate cherished for its own sake.

Delicate learning (“vain affectations”) was Bacon’s label for the new humanism insofar as (in his view) it seemed concerned not with the actual recovery of ancient texts or the retrieval of past knowledge but merely with the revival of Ciceronian rhetorical embellishments and the reproduction of classical prose style. Such preoccupation with “words more than matter,” with “choiceness of phrase” and the “sweet falling of clauses” – in short, with style over substance – seemed to Bacon (a careful stylist in his own right) the most seductive and decadent literary vice of his age.

Prodigal ingenuity – i.e., each distemper represents a lavish and regrettable waste of talent, as inventive minds that might be employed in more productive pursuits exhaust their energy on trivial or puerile enterprises instead.
Sterile results – i.e., instead of contributing to the discovery of new knowledge (and thus to a practical “advancement of learning” and eventually to a better life for all), the distempers of learning are essentially exercises in personal vainglory that aim at little more than idle theorizing or the preservation of older forms of knowledge.

In short, in Bacon’s view the distempers impede genuine intellectual progress by beguiling talented thinkers into fruitless, illusory, or purely self-serving ventures. What is needed – and this is a theme reiterated in all his later writings on learning and human progress – is a program to re-channel that same creative energy into socially useful new discoveries.

Though it is hard to pinpoint the birth of an idea, for all intents and purposes the modern idea of technological “progress” (in the sense of a steady, cumulative, historical advance in applied scientific knowledge) began with Bacon’s The Advancement of Learning and became fully articulated in his later works.

Knowledge is power, and when embodied in the form of new technical inventions and mechanical discoveries it is the force that drives history – this was Bacon’s key insight. In many respects this idea was his single greatest invention, and it is all the more remarkable for its having been conceived and promoted at a time when most English and European intellectuals were either reverencing the literary and philosophical achievements of the past or deploring the numerous signs of modern degradation and decline. Indeed, while Bacon was preaching progress and declaring a brave new dawn of scientific advance, many of his colleagues were persuaded that the world was at best creaking along towards a state of senile immobility and eventual darkness. “Our age is iron, and rusty too,” wrote John Donne, contemplating the signs of universal decay in a poem published six years after Bacon’s Advancement.

That history might in fact be progressive, i.e., an onward and upward ascent – and not, as Aristotle had taught, merely cyclical or, as cultural pessimists from Hesiod to Spengler have supposed, a descending or retrograde movement, became for Bacon an article of secular faith which he propounded with evangelical force and a sense of mission. In the Advancement, the idea is offered tentatively, as a kind of hopeful hypothesis. But in later works such as the New Organon, it becomes almost a promised destiny: Enlightenment and a better world, Bacon insists, lie within our power; they require only the cooperation of learned citizens and the active development of the arts and sciences.

In Book II of De Dignitate (his expanded version of the Advancement) Bacon outlines his scheme for a new division of human knowledge into three primary categories: History, Poesy, and Philosophy (which he associates respectively with the three fundamental “faculties” of mind – memory, imagination, and reason). Although the exact motive behind this reclassification remains unclear, one of its main consequences seems unmistakable: it effectively promotes philosophy – and especially Baconian science – above the other two branches of knowledge, in essence defining history as the mere accumulation of brute facts, while reducing art and imaginative literature to the even more marginal status of “feigned history.”

Evidently Bacon believed that in order for a genuine advancement of learning to occur, the prestige of philosophy (and particularly natural philosophy) had to be elevated, while that of history and literature (in a word, humanism) needed to be reduced. Bacon’s scheme effectively accomplishes this by making history (the domain of fact, i.e., of everything that has happened) a virtual sub-species of philosophy (the domain of realistic possibility, i.e., of everything that can theoretically or actually occur). Meanwhile, poesy (the domain of everything that is imaginable or conceivable) is set off to the side as a mere illustrative vehicle. In essence, it becomes simply a means of recreating actual scenes or events from the past (as in history plays or heroic poetry) or of allegorizing or dramatizing new ideas or future possibilities (as in Bacon’s own interesting example of “parabolic poesy,” the New Atlantis.)

To the second part of his Great Instauration Bacon gave the title New Organon (or “True Directions concerning the Interpretation of Nature”). The Greek word organon means “instrument” or “tool,” and Bacon clearly felt he was supplying a new instrument for guiding and correcting the mind in its quest for a true understanding of nature. The title also glances at Aristotle’s Organon (a collection that includes his Categories and his Prior and Posterior Analytics) and thus suggests a “new instrument” destined to transcend or replace the older, no longer serviceable one. (This notion of surpassing ancient authority is aptly illustrated on the frontispiece of the 1620 volume containing the New Organon by a ship boldly sailing beyond the mythical pillars of Hercules, which supposedly marked the end of the known world.)

The New Organon is presented not in the form of a treatise or methodical demonstration but as a series of aphorisms, a technique that Bacon came to favor as less legislative and dogmatic and more in the true spirit of scientific experiment and critical inquiry. Combined with his gift for illustrative metaphor and symbol, the aphoristic style makes the New Organon in many places the most readable and literary of all Bacon’s scientific and philosophical works.

In Book I of the New Organon (Aphorisms 39-68), Bacon introduces his famous doctrine of the “idols.” These are characteristic errors, natural tendencies, or defects that beset the mind and prevent it from achieving a full and accurate understanding of nature. Bacon points out that recognizing and counteracting the idols is as important to the study of nature as the recognition and refutation of bad arguments is to logic. Incidentally, he uses the word “idol” – from the Greek eidolon (“image” or “phantom”) – not in the sense of a false god or heathen deity but rather in the sense employed in Epicurean physics. Thus a Baconian idol is a potential deception or source of misunderstanding, especially one that clouds or confuses our knowledge of external reality.

Bacon identifies four different classes of idol. Each arises from a different source, and each presents its own special hazards and difficulties.

Similarly adulatory if more prosaic assessments were offered by learned contemporaries or near contemporaries from Descartes and Gassendi to Robert Hooke and Robert Boyle. Leibniz was particularly generous and observed that, compared to Bacon’s philosophical range and lofty vision, even a great genius like Descartes “creeps on the ground.” On the other hand, Spinoza, another close contemporary, dismissed Bacon’s work (especially his inductive theories) completely and in effect denied that the supposedly grand philosophical revolution decreed by Bacon, and welcomed by his partisans, had ever occurred.

The response of the later Enlightenment was similarly divided, with a majority of thinkers lavishly praising Bacon while a dissenting minority castigated or even ridiculed him. The French encyclopedists Jean d’Alembert and Denis Diderot sounded the keynote of this 18th-century re-assessment, essentially hailing Bacon as a founding father of the modern era and emblazoning his name on the front page of the Encyclopedia. In a similar gesture, Kant dedicated his Critique of Pure Reason to Bacon and likewise saluted him as an early architect of modernity. Hegel, on the other hand, took a dimmer view. In his “Lectures on the History of Philosophy” he congratulated Bacon on his worldly sophistication and shrewdness of mind, but ultimately judged him to be a person of depraved character and a mere “coiner of mottoes.” In his view, the Lord Chancellor was a decidedly low-minded (read typically English and utilitarian) philosopher whose instruction was fit mainly for “civil servants and shopkeepers.”

Probably the fullest and most perceptive Enlightenment account of Bacon’s achievement and place in history was Voltaire’s laudatory essay in his Letters on the English. After referring to Bacon as the father of experimental philosophy, he went on to assess his literary merits, judging him to be an elegant, instructive, and witty writer, though too much given to “fustian.”

Bacon’s reputation and legacy remain controversial even today. While no historian of science or philosophy doubts his immense importance both as a proselytizer on behalf of the empirical method and as an advocate of sweeping intellectual reform, opinion varies widely as to the actual social value and moral significance of the ideas that he represented and effectively bequeathed to us. The issue basically comes down to one’s estimate of or sympathy for the entire Enlightenment/Utilitarian project. Those who for the most part share Bacon’s view that nature exists mainly for human use and benefit, and who furthermore endorse his opinion that scientific inquiry should aim first and foremost at the amelioration of the human condition and the “relief of man’s estate,” generally applaud him as a great social visionary. On the other hand, those who view nature as an entity in its own right, a higher-order estate of which the human community is only a part, tend to perceive him as a kind of arch-villain – the evil originator of the idea of science as the instrument of global imperialism and technological conquest.

On the one side, then, we have figures like the anthropologist and science writer Loren Eiseley, who portrays Bacon (whom he calls “the man who saw through time”) as a kind of Promethean culture hero. He praises Bacon as the great inventor of the idea of science as both a communal enterprise and a practical discipline in the service of humanity. On the other side, we have writers, from Theodor Adorno, Max Horkheimer, and Lewis Mumford to, more recently, Jeremy Rifkin and eco-feminist Carolyn Merchant, who have represented him as one of the main culprits behind what they perceive as western science’s continuing legacy of alienation, exploitation, and ecological oppression.

Clearly somewhere in between this ardent Baconolotry on the one hand and strident demonization of Bacon on the other lies the real Lord Chancellor: a Colossus with feet of clay. He was by no means a great system-builder (indeed his Magna Instauratio turned out to be less of a “grand edifice” than a magnificent heap) but rather, as he more modestly portrayed himself, a great spokesman for the reform of learning and a champion of modern science. In the end we can say that he was one of the giant figures of intellectual history – and as brilliant, and flawed, a philosopher as he was a statesman.

Note: The standard edition of Bacon’s Works and Letters and Life is still that of James Spedding, et. al., (14 volumes, London, 1857- 1874), also available in a facsimile reprint (Stuttgart, 1989).

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Eiseley, Loren. The Man Who Saw Through Time. New York: Scribners, 1973.

Fish, Stanley E. “The Experience of Bacon’s Essays.” In Self-Consuming Artifacts. Berkeley, CA: University of California Press, 1972.

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