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James
Beattie was a Scottish philosopher and poet who spent his
entire academic career as Professor of Moral Philosophy and Logic at Marischal College in Aberdeen. His best known philosophical work, An
Essay on The Nature and Immutability of Truth In Opposition to
Sophistry and Scepticism (1770), is a rhetorical tour de force
which affirmed the sovereignty of common sense while excoriating
David Hume (1711-1776). A smash bestseller in its day, this Essay
on Truth made Beattie very famous and Hume very angry. The
work´s fame proved fleeting, as did Beattie’s
philosophical reputation.
While the Essay on Truth is little
read today, it is well worth reading. First, it is an
important document in the history of the Scottish common sense school
of philosophy inaugurated by Beattie´s colleague, Thomas Reid
(1710-1796). Second, Beattie´s style-- lively, polished, pure,
and lucid--still has the power to please and charm. Finally, Beattie
is an abler philosopher than his vociferous detractors were willing
to allow. Though by no means an original or profound thinker, he can
and should be given credit for presenting a systematic and accessible
defense of a simple-sounding thesis - that philosophy cannot afford
to despise the plain dictates of common sense.
This
article (1) outlines Beattie´s life and career, (2)
reviews the basic argument of the Essay on Truth, (3)
summarizes the Essay´s neglected critique of Hume´s
racism, (4) briefly describes Beattie´s later Elements
of Moral Science, and (5) reflects on Beattie´s
place in the Scottish common sense school.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Life and Career
James Beattie was born October 25, 1735 in Laurencekirk, Kincardineshire, where his father was a farmer and shopkeeper. In 1749 Beattie began his studies at Marischal College, Aberdeen. In 1753, he was awarded the MA degree. He then spent several years as a schoolteacher and briefly contemplated becoming a minister. During this period he also secured the friendship of several influential personages. One of Beattie´s early patrons was James Burnett (1714-1799), better known to posterity as Lord Monboddo (which name Burnett assumed when appointed to the Court of Session in 1767).
In
1760, at the tender age of 25, Beattie was installed as Professor of
Moral Philosophy and Logic at Marischal College. Shortly thereafter
he was elected to the Aberdeen Philosophical Society, known to
waggish locals as “the Wise Club.” Founded in 1758 by
Thomas Reid (1710-1796) and John Gregory (1724-1773), the Society
continued to hold meetings until 1773, nine years after Reid left for
Glasgow to fill the Chair of Moral Philosophy vacated by Adam Smith
(1723-1790). Much of Beattie´s later work had its origin in
compositions read to his fellow Aberdonian “wise men” in
the 1760s.
A
decade after taking up his Professorship at Aberdeen, Beattie
published the philosophical work for which he was (and is still) best
known: An Essay on the Nature and Immutability of Truth In
Opposition to Sophistry and Scepticism (1770) (hereinafter “Essay
on Truth”). The honors piled up thick and fast: a doctorate
of laws from Oxford; an audience with King George III; a Crown
pension of 200 pounds a year; the approbation of discerning literati
such as Edmund Burke and Samuel Johnson; and the opportunity to pose
for Sir Joshua Reynolds. (Incidentally, Reynold´s portrait of
Beattie – “The Triumph of Truth, with the Portrait of a
Gentleman”- was hung in Marischal College.) Nor was enthusiasm
for Beattie´s anti-skeptical treatise confined to the British
Isles. The Essay was soon translated into French, German, and
Dutch and discussed on the Continent. Beattie´s fame spread to
the New World as well. In 1784 he was made a member of the American
Philosophical Society.
Not
all citizens of the Republic of Letters, however, were impressed by
the Essay on Truth. The book´s target, the amiable and
good-humored Hume, was incensed. “Truth!” he fumed,
“there is no truth in it; it is a horrible large lie in
Octavo.” Yet Hume, who had a policy of not answering critics,
never deigned to reply directly to the cavils of “that bigoted
silly fellow Beattie.” Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), too, had
harsh words for Beattie. In Kant´s Prolegomena to Any Future
Metaphysics (1783), the Scottish prophet of common sense is
portrayed as a superficial, obtuse dogmatist: “I should think
that Hume might fairly have laid as much claim to common sense as
Beattie, and in addition to a critical reason (such as the latter did
not possess).” (For the record, however, it should be noted
that Kant (unlike Hume) had an equally low opinion of Reid.)
Beattie
wrote no philosophical work equal to the Essay in appeal or
influence, although he continued to publish throughout the 1770s and
1780s. Many of these ostensibly “later” works (several of
which actually date from the 1760s) are devoted to issues in
aesthetics, rhetoric, and literary theory. They include An Essay
on Poetry and Music (1776), On the Utility of Classical
Learning (1776), An Essay on Laughter, and Ludicrous
Composition (1779), and Dissertations Moral and Critical
(1783). In addition, he compiled a lexicon entitled Scotticisms,
arranged in Alphabetical Order (1787), in which he urged his
educated compatriots to improve their English by “purifying”
it of Scots expressions.
Beattie
also earned plaudits as a poet, largely on the strength of The
Minstrel; or, The Progress of Genius, written in Spenserian
stanzas. The first part of The Minstrel appeared anonymously
in 1771 (a year which also saw two editions of the Essay
printed). The second part, to which the author put his name, followed
in 1774. Replete with reflections upon Nature and the character of
poetic genius, The Minstrel anticipates some of the central
preoccupations of the Romantic movement.
Despite
his apparent “aesthetic turn” in the post-Essay
period, Beattie remained interested in the broader philosophical,
moral, and religious questions that had originally prompted him to
compose the Essay on Truth in the 1760s. 1786 saw the
publication of Evidences of the Christian Religion Briefly and
Plainly Stated, a two volume work of popular apologetics. This
was followed by his final book, Elements of Moral Science
(1790-1793). A lengthy collection of lectures delivered at Marischal
College, the Elements deal with a wide range of topics in the
philosophy of mind, epistemology, metaphysics, logic, ethics,
political philosophy, economics, and natural theology.
Beattie´s
later years were filled with affliction. His wife, Mary Beattie (née
Dunn), went mad and was eventually committed to an asylum. Both of
his children died, the elder son in 1790 and the younger in 1796.
Weakened by grief, ill health, and a series of strokes, Beattie died
in Aberdeen on August 18, 1803.
2. The Essay on Truth (1770)
The
Essay on Truth begins predictably enough, with a definition of
– what else?- truth. Truth, Beattie avows, is identified with
what “the constitution of our nature determines us to believe”;
falsehood is identified with what “the constitution of our
nature determines us to disbelieve.” (Part I. i). The
distinction between common sense and reason is drawn in terms of the
way that distinct classes of truths are apprehended. Common sense is
identified as “that faculty by which we perceive self-evident
truth,” whereas reason is “that power by which we
perceive truth in consequence of a proof.” (I. i). With these
definitions securely in place, Beattie advances the Essay's
principal thesis -- “common sense is the ultimate judge of
truth,” (I. i) and reason must be subordinated to it. All sound
reasoning, we are told, depends upon the principles of common sense:
In a word, the dictates of common sense are, in
respect to human knowledge in general, what the axioms of geometry
are in respect to mathematics: on the supposition that those axioms
are false or dubious, all mathematical reasoning falls to the ground;
and on the supposition that the dictates of common sense are
erroneous and deceitful, all science, truth, and virtue, are vain.
(I. ii. 9)
What
are these axioms of common sense, these foundational principles on
which all sound reasoning rests? It is not necessary to discuss all
the principles listed in Beattie´s catalogue of common sense.
For the purpose of illustration, a representative sample of four
“principles of common sense” should suffice: (i) the
evidence of perception (or “external sense”) is not
fallacious, but fundamentally reliable; (ii) whatever begins to
exist, proceeds from some cause; (iii) Nature is uniform; and (iv)
human testimony is basically trustworthy. Armed with this arsenal of
principles, Beattie can now confidently enter the lists against an
assortment of formidable philosophical foes. Beattie wielded
principle (i) against skeptics (be they Cartesian or Humean), as well
as against Berkeleyan idealists; principle (ii) against atheist
critics of cosmological arguments; principle (iii) against Humean
skeptics about induction; and principle (iv) against Humean scoffers
at miracles.
If
Beattie is right about common sense, much (if not all) of modern
philosophy is wrong. The basic mistake of the moderns lies in their
tendency to make reason, not common-sense, the ultimate judge or
arbiter of truth. Reason is a shameless upstart who, ignorant of its
proper station, disgraces itself by refusing to submit to authority
(in the form of common sense). Such insubordination can only lead to
chaos, catastrophe, and confusion:
When Reason invades the rights of Common Sense, and presumes to
arraign that authority by which she herself acts, nonsense and
confusion must of necessity ensue; science will soon come to have
neither head nor tail, beginning nor end; philosophy will grow
contemptible; and its adherents, far from being treated, as in former
times, upon the footing of conjurers, will be thought by the vulgar,
and by every man of sense, to be little better than downright fools.
(I. ii. 9)
Philosophers therefore
despise common sense at their peril. But how are we to distinguish
genuine principles of common sense from the pretenders? Is Beattie
suggesting that any cherished conviction or idée fixe
that I am unable to prove automatically qualifies as a dictate of
common sense? He endeavours to supply us with criteria or marks by
which authentic principles of common sense can be identified. (1)
We are irresistibly inclined by nature to believe the principles
of common sense. Our powerful attachment to them, being spontaneous
and quasi-instinctive, cannot be destroyed by philosophical argument
- no matter how ingenious. (2) The principles of common sense
are universally accepted. Far from being prejudices peculiar to a
given time, place, culture, sect, or class, they have been believed
by virtually all people in all ages. (3) The principles of
common sense cannot be proven because they are epistemologically
foundational or basic. They cannot be justified by reference to some
more evident proposition(s), because none exist. (4) The
principles of common sense are indispensable presuppositions of our
conduct and practice. We cannot live or act prudently unless we
assume that our senses are reliable, that human testimony can be a
source of knowledge, that past will resemble the future, and so on.
Anyone who actually doubted or denied such principles would
put himself on par with the lunatic or the fool.
Here it
may be asked: In what way does Beattie´s Essay on Truth
improve upon Thomas Reid's earlier Inquiry into the Human Mind on
the Principles of Common Sense (1764)? The short answer is that
it does not. Beattie freely admits that he is heavily indebted to
Reid. However, the Essay differs from the Inquiry in
one obvious respect: Beattie´s tract is infinitely more
hard-hitting and caustic than anything ever penned by Reid. Where
Reid writes respectfully of his opponents, Beattie tends to denounce
and vilify them. Where Reid wraps up his subtle thoughts in
restrained professorial prose, Beattie´s simple arguments are
presented with the spleen and verve of the born orator. These
contrasts reflect a more basic difference between our two defenders
of common sense. Unlike Reid, Beattie is first and foremost a
moralist and an apologist. He is not interested in defending a subtle
or nuanced philosophical thesis. Rather, Beattie is defending a lofty
(albeit vaguely defined) cause - to wit, “the cause of truth,
virtue, and mankind.” Translated into more prosaic (but
precise) terms, Beattie´s “cause” is that of
deflecting philosophical opposition to a broadly Judeo-Christian
understanding of human nature. According to this understanding, human
beings are free but finite creatures made in the image of a good God
or Creator. Neither brutes nor divinities, we occupy an intermediate
place in creation and are better suited for action than for
speculation. Inasmuch as our cognitive faculties are God-given, we
may trust their deliverances - provided we acknowledge their
limitations and exercise them under conditions that define our humble
“middle state” (to quote Alexander Pope). Beattie´s
bold strategy in the Essay was to argue that these familiar
ideas about human nature are unassailable because they rest on the
solid and irrefragable foundation of “common sense”
(rather than philosophic demonstrability). Here was a book apt to
reassure the devout but timorous Christian reader, for it confidently
announced that Humean scepticism – and the bulk of modern
philosophy - was infinitely more suited to be ridiculed than to be
feared.
3. Beattie Contra Hume on Racism
Although the Essay on Truth
is largely devoted to re-instating the rights of common sense in the
spheres of epistemology and metaphysics, it includes a forceful
critique of Hume´s racism.
Hume´s racism?
To some, this phrase may have a strange and novel sound. After all,
Hume is usually portrayed as a patron saint of the Enlightenment: a
genial cosmopolitan, sweetly reasonable, unfailingly courteous and
amiable, “as approaching as nearly to the idea of a perfectly
wise and virtuous man, as perhaps the nature of human frailty will
permit” (in the oft-cited words of his friend, Adam Smith). Yet
in Hume's essay “Of National Characters,” we catch a
glimpse of a different side of le bon David. For there, in an
infamous footnote, Hume writes:
I am apt to suspect the
negroes to be naturally inferior to the whites. There scarcely ever
was a civilized nation of that complexion, nor any individual,
eminent either in action or speculation. No ingenious manufactures
amongst them, no arts, no sciences ... [T]here are Negroe slaves
dispersed all over Europe, of whom none ever discovered any symptoms
of ingenuity.
In the Essay on Truth,
Beattie condemns these sentiments: “These assertions are
strong; but I know not whether they have anything else to recommend
them.” (III. ii). Beattie does not stop there. Beattie does not
merely fulminate against Hume's racism with a self-serving show of
conspicuous indignation; instead he rolls up his sleeves and adroitly
dissects Hume's pro-racist arguments. (1) Beattie disputes
Hume's basic assertions about the achievements (or alleged lack
thereof) of non-European societies: “[W]e know that these
assertions are not true ... The Africans and Americans are known to
have many ingenious manufactures and arts among them, which even
Europeans would find it no easy matter to imitate.” (III. ii).
(2) Moreover, Beattie says, Hume´s reasoning is invalid.
For even if Hume's claims were correct, his conclusion would not
follow. “[O]ne may as well say of an infant, that he can never
become a man, as of a nation now barbarous, that it never can be
civilized.” (III. Ii). Should anyone doubt this, he need only
recall that “[t]hat the inhabitants of Great Britain and France
were as savage two thousand years ago, as those of Africa and America
are at this day.” (III. ii). (3) Beattie is unimpressed
by Hume's argument that “there are Negroe slaves dispersed all
over Europe, of whom none ever discovered any symptoms of ingenuity.”
Beattie insists that this claim is unwarranted as well as false. But
even if it were true, it would not justify belief in Hume´s
natural inferiority thesis, for “the condition of a slave is
not favourable to genius of any kind.” (III. ii). (4)
While Beattie does not downgrade European achievements in the arts
and sciences, he denies that they can be used to prove that European
nations or “races” are superior. He stresses the extent
that the achievements on which European nations pride themselves were
either discovered by accident or the inventions of a gifted few, to
whom alone all credit must go.
Beattie caps his rebuttal with
two observations. First, his critique of Hume´s natural
inferiority thesis indirectly supports the cause of religion because
such racism cannot be reconciled neatly with a true Judeo-Christian
understanding of human nature. Second, Beattie stresses that his
disagreement with Hume on the subject of racism is not merely
theoretical or speculative. On the contrary, the dispute is intensely
practical, for the natural inferiority thesis can (and frequently
was) invoked to justify slavery - an institution that Beattie, a
committed abolitionist, decried as “a barbarous piece of
policy.”
4. Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793)
There is
considerable overlap between the Essay on Truth and Beattie´s
later Elements of Moral Science (1790-1793). The creed of
common sense is again soberly recited. We are told that
consciousness, memory, and testimony must be taken as trustworthy,
that we can assume that Nature is uniform, that we are free moral
agents, and that whatever begins to exist must proceed from some
cause.
Despite
these and other doctrinal similarities, the Elements differs
from the Essay in at least four respects. First, stylistically
the Essay was full of sarcasm, scorn and splendid invective,
while the Elements is comparatively tame, subdued, and dry.
Second, the Elements is more philosophically constructive than
the Essay, as Beattie now appears more interested in building
and inhabiting his own modest system than in laying siege to the
systems of foes and rivals. Third, the Elements offers a more
in-depth exploration of several topics only lightly touched upon in
the Essay (for example, perception, natural theology, and
immortality). Finally, the Elements offers sustained coverage
of several areas, such as political philosophy and economics, that
are not meaningfully discussed in the Essay.
5. Beattie and Scottish Common Sense Philosophy
Historians
of Scottish philosophy frequently describe Beattie´s Essay
as a simplified version of the philosophy of common sense
expounded by Reid in his Inquiry of 1764. While there is much
truth in this judgment, it need not be construed as a reproach.
Popularization can be done well or badly. Beattie did it well.
Nevertheless,
it is undeniable that Reid´s views on matters philosophical
evolved in a way that Beattie´s never did. After retiring from
teaching in 1781, Reid published two major works, Essays on the
Intellectual Powers of Man (1785) and Essays on the Active
Powers of Man (1788). More sophisticated and constructive than
anything Beattie ever produced, these two books, along with Reid´s
earlier Inquiry, became the founding documents of the Scottish
common sense school of philosophy. The Reidian gospel was soon
propagated with aplomb by Edinburgh Chair-holder Dugald Stewart
(1753-1828), who had listened to Reid´s lectures in Glasgow. An
elegant stylist, Stewart championed common sense both in his
well-attended lectures and in his edifying books, the first pair of
which - Elements of the Philosophy of the Human Mind (1792)
and Outlines of Moral Philosophy (1793) - appeared around the
same time as Beattie´s Elements of Moral Science. Stewart's
interest in Reid was shared by another renowned Edinburgh professor,
the erudite but preternaturally verbose Sir William Hamilton
(1788-1856). No slavish disciple, Hamilton sought to “improve”
on Reid's philosophy in various ways, often by drawing on Kantian
doctrines. A singular philosophical beast, the resulting hybrid was
slain, stuffed, and mounted by John Stuart Mill (1806-1873) in An
Examination of Sir William Hamilton´s Philosophy (1865).
Nevertheless, Hamilton´s extensively (or, as some might say,
obsessively) annotated edition of Reid's Collected Works did
much to make them more widely available.
With Reid
cast thus as the heroic founder of the emerging Scotch school,
Beattie was relegated to the supporting role of ardent and skilful
propagandist. This, at any rate, was how Dugald Stewart portrays
Beattie in a letter to Sir William Forbes, Beattie's friend and
biographer. Stewart declares that the Essay on Truth is
effective as “a popular antidote against the illusions of
metaphysical scepticism,” but, he is quick to add, Beattie's
polemic lacks the subtlety, patience, and precision we find in Reid.
Nevertheless, Stewart avers that Beattie's achievement is not
negligible:
These critical remarks on the “Essay on Truth” (I must
request you to observe) do not in the least affect the essential
merits of that very valuable performance; and I have stated them with
the greater freedom, because your late excellent friend possessed so
many other unquestionable claims to high distinction – as a
moralist, as a critic, as a grammarian, as a pure and classical
writer, and, above all, as the author of the “Minstrel.”
In any one of the different paths to which his ambition has led him,
it would not perhaps be difficult to name some of his
contemporaries by whom he has been surpassed; but where is the
individual to be found, who has aspired with greater success to an
equal variety of literary honours?
Stewart´s
verdict still seems a just one. Beattie was a talented, ambitious,
and multi-faceted man of letters, but his gifts and merits as a
philosopher were not the greatest. If philosophy is indeed “a
series of footnotes to Plato” (Whitehead), then Beattie can be
read as a dramatic footnote to Reid and - ironically - to the
abhorred Hume.
6. References and Further Reading
Cloyd,
E. L. (1972) James Burnett, Lord Monboddo. Oxford: Clarendon
Press. Touches on Monboddo's relationship with Beattie; indicates why
their friendship did not last.
Fieser,
J. (1994) “Beattie’s Lost Letter to the London Review,”
Hume Studies 20: 1-12. Reconstructs a controversy between
Beattie and a pro-Humean literary faction.
Fieser,
J. (2000) “Introduction” to James Beattie's Essay on
the Nature and Immutability of Truth in Opposition to Sophistry and
Scepticism. Volume 2 of the 5 volume set, Scottish Common
Sense Philosophy: Sources and Origins. (ed. J. Fieser) Bristol,
UK: Thoemmes Press. Thorough presentation of Beattie's defence of
common sense in the Essay on Truth.
Fieser,
J. (ed.) (2000) Early Responses to Reid, Oswald, Beattie, and
Stewart: I. Volume 3 of the 5 volume set, Scottish Common
Sense Philosophy: Sources and Origins. Bristol, UK: Thoemmes
Press. Contains early reviews of the Essay (including Edmund Burke's
positive notice of the second edition of 1771).
Grave,
S.A. (1960) The Scottish Philosophy of Common Sense. Oxford:
Clarendon Press. Beattie's epistemological and metaphysical views are
portrayed as vulgarized versions of Reid's.
Harris,
J. A. (2002) “James Beattie, The Doctrine of Liberty, and the
Science of the Mind,” Reid Studies (5): 16-29.
Acknowledges Beattie's shortcomings as a philosopher, but credits him
with a commitment to understanding the human mind scientifically.
Sheds light on the Essay's critique of necessitarianism.
King,
E.H. (1971) “A Scottish “Philosophical” Club in the
Eighteenth Century,” Dalhousie Review (50): 201-214.
Describes the inner workings of the Aberdeen Philosophical Society,
and discusses Beattie's participation.
King,
E.H. (1972) “James Beattie's Essay on Truth (1770): An
Enlightenment “Bestseller”,” Dalhousie Review
(51): 390-403. An account of the Essay's popularity.
Kuehn,
M. (1987) Scottish Common Sense in Germany, 1768-1800: A
Contribution to the History of the Critical Philosophy. Kingston
and Montreal: McGill-Queen's University Press. Discusses the
influence of Reid and, to a lesser extent, Beattie and Oswald upon
Kant and his German contemporaries. A clear-headed, fair assessment
of Beattie´s strengths and weaknesses.
McCosh,
J. (1875) The Scottish Philosophy. London: Macmillan. Chapter
XXIX contains a biographical sketch and an outline of the Essay.
Depicts Beattie as an eloquent popularizer of the philosophy of
common sense.
Mossner,
E.C. (1980) The Life of David Hume. 2nd edition. Oxford:
Clarendon Press. Briefly describes the reaction of Hume and his
Edinburgh circle to the Essay's success.
Popkin,
R.H. (1980) The High Road to Pyrrhonism. San Diego: Austin
Hill Press. Contains an article entitled “Hume´s Racism”
(pp. 251-266), in which Popkin helpfully puts Beattie´s
critique of Hume´s racism in historical context.
Priestley,
J. (1774) An Examination of Dr. Reid's Inquiry into the Human Mind
on the Principles of Common Sense, Dr. Beattie's Essay on the Nature
and Immutability of Truth, and Dr. Oswald's Appeal to Common Sense in
Behalf of Religion.
London: J. Johnson. Includes an extended
critique of Beattie, composed shortly after the Essay's publication.
Priestley complains that the Essay´s author is (among
other things) an incorrigible dogmatist who relies too heavily on ad
hominem arguments. The Appendix includes some correspondence between
Beattie and Priestley.
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