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Carneades was perhaps the most prominent head of the skeptical
Academy. Following the example of Arcesilaus,
who turned the Academy in a skeptical direction, Carneades developed
an array of arguments against the dogmatic positions upheld by other
philosophers, particularly the Stoics. He
went beyond Arcesilaus in
several respects, however. Instead of simply arguing against the
positive positions of other philosophers, Carneades also set forth
arguments of his own in favor of views that sometimes had never been
defended before--not in order to establish their truth, but simply to
counterbalance the arguments of the dogmatists and show that none of
their conclusions can be conclusively established. In doing so,
Carneades made important contributions to several philosophical
debates. Carneades also set forth a more detailed skeptical criterion
of what to believe, to pithanon which means either the
'plausible' or the 'probable.'
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to that part of this article)
Carneades continued the skeptical academy's attack upon Stoic epistemology. Arcesilaus had argued against Zeno, the founder of Stoicism, that no sense-impressions could provide a firm foundation for knowledge, since sense-impressions are always fallible. Carneades maintained this criticism against refinements in the Stoics' theory made by Chrysippus, the head of the Stoa at his time. But Carneades went beyond criticizing the arguments of other philosophers by trying to propound equally convincing arguments for incompatible conclusions, which would have the effect of leaving his interlocutor suspending judgement as to which is true. For instance, while on a mission to Rome with the heads of two other philosophical schools, Carneades gave an eloquent defense of traditional views on justice one day, and the next day offered an equally eloquent attack on those same views. (Unamused traditionalist Romans expelled the philosophers from the city as a result.)
Contributions to philosophical
debates
In arguing for contrary positions, Carneades sometimes came up
with novel positions or arguments. For instance, Carneades gave a
taxonomy of different possible candidates for what the highest good
could be, and in so doing, came up with possibilities not canvassed
by previous philosophers. He also defended original views in the
debate between the Stoics and Epicureans on
human freedom, determinism, and the truth-values of statements about
the future. Against both Epicurus and
the Stoics,
Carneades argued that no deterministic consequences follow from the
principle of bivalence (the principle that for any statement P,
either P is true or P is false). That is because, even if it has
always been true that e.g., I will brush my teeth tomorrow, that does
not imply that there are "immutable eternal causes" which will bring
it about that I will do so. It can be true now simply in virtue of
the fact that brushing my teeth is actually what I will freely choose
to do. Similarly, Carneades said that Epicureans can
defend human freedom from causal determinism without positing a
random atomic swerve. A person can be the cause of his actions by a
"free movement of the mind", without there being antecedent causes
that necessitate that the agent will do what he does. This is
reminiscent of the theories of 'agent-causation' later propounded by
writers like Chisholm.
Practical Criterion: to
pithanon
Carneades also developed a detailed skeptical criterion, to
pithanon--which can mean either 'the plausible' or 'the
probable.' Sense-impressions can never be a sure guide to truth,
thought Carneades, but some are still more convincing to us than
others--some seem plausible, and others not. We need not stop there
however--we can make further investigation of convincing impressions
to see if they stand up or not, as well as seeing whether they cohere
with our other sense-impressions.
Exactly how to understand Carneades' criterion was controversial even
in his own day. Carneades left no writings, other than a few letters,
and Clitomachus, who was Carneades' closest associate and succeeded
him as head of the Academy, said he did not know what Carneades
really thought. Two questions are: (1) Are pithanon beliefs
supposed to be more likely to be true (as Cicero and
Philo thought), or simply more plausible to the person who accepts
them? (2) Is Carneades advocating to pithanon in his own voice
as a criterion that a skeptic could use, or is he simply employing it
in service of his arguments against the Stoics, without being
committed to it himself?
For more information on Carneades, see the
section on him in the entry on ancient Greek
skepticism.