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The beginnings of English Deism appear in the seventeenth century. Its main principles are to be found in the writings of Lord Herbert of Cherbury (d. 1648), who devoted the latter part of a life spent in a military and diplomatic career to a search for a standard and a guide in the conflicts of creeds and systems. He was a friend of Grotius, Casaubon, and Gassendi, and during a long sojourn in France made himself acquainted with the thought of Montaigne, of Bodin, and especially of Charron. His works are: De Veritate (Paris, 1624); Cherbury. De religions Gentilium errorumque apud eos causes (London, 1645); and two minor treatises, De cause errorum and De religions laici. The first work advances a theory of knowledge based upon the recognition of innate universal characteristics on the object perceived, and rigidly opposed to knowledge supernatural in its origin and determinable in only by strife and conflict. The second work lays down the common marks by which religious truth is recognized. These are (1) a belief in the existence of the Deity, (2) the obligation to reverence such a power, (3) the identification of worship with practical morality, (4) the obligation to repent of sin and to abandon it, and, (5) divine recompense in this world and the next. These five essentials (the so-called "Five Articles" of the English Deists) constitute the nucleus of all religions and of Christianity in its primitive, uncorrupted form. The variations between positive religions are explained as due partly to the allegorization of nature, partly to self-deception, the workings of imagination, and priestly guile.
Hobbes and Others
Rejection of theological supernaturalism
stands out as the most conspicuous characteristic in Hobbes's
philosophical writings (d. 1679), which were inspired by the teachings
of the new mathematical and natural sciences. The different religions
are explained as the product of human fear interpreting natural
phenomena in anthropomorphic form, or, in their higher aspects,
as the outcome of reflection on causal relation in the universe.
Miracles and revelations are in themselves improbable, and may
be most easily explained as the imaginings of the ignorant. Positive
religion is the creation of the State, and the sovereign justly
possesses unconditional power to enforce its prescriptions, for
only in this way can religious strife be avoided. Between religion
thus naturally explained and a prophetic and Christian revelation
Hobbes, nevertheless, attempted to mediate; he mentions as the
means that might lead to such a reconciliation the rational interpretation
of miracles, the differentiation between the inner moral sense
of Scripture and mere figurative expression, and the historical
criticisms of Biblical sources. The entire apparatus of Rationalism
is here to be found, limited only in its application. Further,
Spinoza's Tractatus theologico-politicus (1670) and Bayle's
Dictionnaire (1695-97) were effective in shaping the character
of Deism. Of no small importance, also, was the rise of a literature
of comparative religion and the publication of ethnographical
studies and works of travel. China, Arabia, Egypt, Persia, India,
and primal regions, were brought within the horizon of religious
investigation. Philosophy, beginning with Locke's theory of knowledge,
and natural science, with Newton's theory of gravitation, contributed
to the opposition with which theological dogma was confronted.
Yet their attitude was not one of hostility to religions which
they sought rather to utilize for the purpose of establishing
the desired universal standard of truth. Newton and Boyle succeeded
in reconciling the creed of the Church with their mechanical metaphysics;
and this union remained characteristic of England, so that even
men like Priestley and Hartley did not shrink from supporting
their materialistic theories by theological arguments. We have
here the blending of a sensualistic epistemology, a mechanical-teleological
metaphysics, a historical criticism, and an a prioristic
ethics whose product in the shape of natural religion was destined
first to undermine Christianity, then to compete with it, and
finally to supplant it.
Charles Blount
These various tendencies could not
show themselves fully under the ecclesiastical restraint of the
Restoration, yet they appear clearly enough in the writings of
Charles Blount (d. 1693), usually placed second to Herbert in
the lists of Deists. Like his predecessor, Blount dwells on the
conflict between rival religions, and finds a standard of adjustment
in a fusion of Herbert's theory of universal characteristics with
Hobbes's prescription by the State. Like Hobbes and Spinoza, he
touches serious problems of Biblical criticism at this early date.
Freedom from prejudice is his boast; he asserts the supernatural
character of Christianity on the basis of its miracles, after
he has already rendered them dubious by parallels with non-Christian
miracles. His works were: Anima mundi (London, 1679),
Great is Diana of the Ephesians (1680), and The Two
First Books of Philostratus concerning the Life of Apollonius
Tyaneus, published in English with notes (1680).
John Locke
The Revolution of 1688, the establishment
of the freedom of the press in 1694, the political favor that
was bestowed on the new tendencies in theology, in opposition
to the stricter Anglicanism which was tainted with Stuart partizanship,
were conditions favorable to the development of the seed that
had already been planted. Parallel with the liberalization of
orthodox dogma, there ran a more radical development with the
attainment of a standard for the testing of the contents of revelation.
Of surpassing importance in this direction was the influence
and work of John Locke (d. 1704), who, in the field of theology,
found his starting point, like most prominent thinkers of the
age, in the conflict of systems, doctrines, and practices. Out
of his reflections on the data of experience he developed a mechanical-teleological
metaphysics and an empirical-utilitarian ethics, the latter agreeing,
with the old idea of lex naturae in that ethical experience
merely confirms the connection established by a teleological government
of the universe between certain acts and their consequences.
In spite of his supernaturalist tendencies, Locke nevertheless
maintained, in his Letters on Toleration (1689-92), that
only rational demonstration, and not compulsion or mere assertion,
can establish the validity of revelation. In the Essay concerning
Human Understanding (1690) he had investigated the conception
of revelation from the epistemological standpoint, and laid down
the criteria by which the true revelation is to be distinguished
from other doctrines which claim such authority. Strict proof
of the formal character of revelation must be adduced; the tradition
which communicates it to us must be fully accredited by both external
and internal evidence; and its content must be shown to correspond
with rational metaphysics and ethics. Revelation is revelation;
but, after it is once given, it may be shown a posteriori
to be rational, i.e., capable of being deduced from the premises
of our reason. Only where this is possible is there a presumption
in favor of the purely mysterious parts of revelation. Where
these criteria are disregarded the way is open to the excesses
of sects and priesthoods by which religion, the differentia of
reasoning man, has often made him appear less rational than the
beasts. Locke advances therefore the remarkable conception of
a revelation that reveals only the reasonable and the universally
cognizable. The practical consequences of the thesis are deduced
in his Reasonableness of Christianity as Delivered in the Scriptures
(1695), which aims at the termination of religious strife through
the recovery of the truths of primitive, rational Christianity.
From the Gospels and the Acts, as distinguished from the Epistles,
he elicits as the fundamental Christian truths the doctrine of
the messiahship of Jesus and that of the kingdom of God. Inseparably
connected with these are the recognition of Jesus as ruler of
this kingdom, forgiveness of sins, and subjection to the moral
law of the. kingdom. This law is identical with the ethical portion
of the law of Moses, which in its turn corresponds to the lex
naturae or rationis. The Gospel is but the divine summary
and exposition of the law of nature, and it is the advantage of
Christianity over pagan creeds and philosophies that it offers
this law of nature intelligibly, with divine authority, and free
from merely ceremonial sacerdotalism. To do this it requires
the aid of a supernatural revelation, whose message is attainable
through reason also, but only in an imperfect way.
Toland, Collins, and Others
Deducing the full consequences
of Locke's theory, John Toland (d. 1722), in his Christianity
not Mysterious (1696), maintained that the content of revelation
must neither contradict nor transcend the dictates of reason.
Revelation is not the basis of truth, but only a " means
of information " by which man may arrive at knowledge, the
sanction for which must be found in reason. Primitive Christianity
knew nothing of mystery, whose sources are Judaic and Greek, and
the original Christian use of the word mysterium conveyed
no idea of that which transcended reason. The basis is thus laid
for the critical study of early Christianity. Further problems
of Biblical criticism and the distinction between the diverse
parties in primitive Christianity are advanced in Toland's Amyntor
(1699) and Nazarenus ; or Jewish, Gentile and illahometan Christianity
(1718). In like manner, Anthony Collins (d. 1729), in his Discourse
of Freethinking (1713), developed the consequences of Locke's
propositions. Revelation depends for its sanction upon its agreement
with reason, and what is contrary to reason is not revelation.
Practical morality is independent of dogma, which, on the contrary,
has been the cause of much evil in the history of the world.
Christ and the Apostles, the prototypes. of the freethinkers,
never made use of supernatural authority, but confined themselves
to simple, rational demonstration. Collins's work elicited numerous
replies; but none really made answer to his main thesis. After
remaining silent for eleven years, Collins renewed the contest
with a contribution on prophecy and miracles. Setting out from
Locke's proposition that revelation was truth sanctioned by reason,
he found it a simple step to reject prophecy and miracles as non-essential
characteristics of religion, amounting at most to mere didactic
devices. The mathematician William Whiston (d. 1752) gave a new
impulse to the controversy by the publication of The True Text
(1722), in which the lack of real concordance between the New
Testament interpretation of Old Testament prophecies is pointed
out, and the prevailing allegorical method of reconciling such
differences summarily rejected. The present form of the Old Testament
is characterized as a forgery perpetrated by the Jews, and an
attempt is made by Whiston to restore the original text. Collins,
in his Discourse on the Grounds and Reasons of the Christian
Religion (1724), agreed with Whiston as to the discrepancies
between the two Testaments, but defended the allegorical method
of interpretation. Thomas Woolston (d. 1733) came to the support
of Collins in this controversy over the Biblical prophecies; and
when his opponents shifted their appeal from the prophecies to
the miraculous acts of Jesus he applied his destructive allegorical
method to those also, in his Discourses on the Miracles of
our Saviour (1727-30).
Matthew Tindal
Matthew Tindal (d. 1733), in his dialogue
Christianity as Old as the Creation, or the Gospel a Republication
of the Religion of Nature (1730), produced the standard text-book
of Deism. Proceeding from Locke's proposition of the identity
of the truths of revelation with those of reason, he adduces a
new array of arguments in support of that position. The goodness
of God, the vast extent of the earth, the long duration of human
life on earth render it improbable that only to Jews and Christians
was vouchsafed the favor of perceiving truth. We now have brought
in the classic example of the three hundred million Chinese who
surely could not all be excluded from the truth, and Confucianism
begins to be extolled against much that is repugnant and harsh
in the Mosaic law. Christianity, to be the truth, must find the
substance in all religions; it must be as old as creation. The
doctrines of the fall and of original sin can not stand, since
it is irrational to believe in the exclusion from the truth of
the vast majority of humanity. Tindal's position is orthodox
to the extent that Judaism and Christianity are acknowledged as
revelations, though revelations only of the lex naturae,
which is identified with natural religion, the primitive, uncorrupted
faith, consisting in "the practise of morality in obedience
to the will of God." An echo of the teachings of Tindal
is found in Thomas Chubb (d. 1747), whose True Gospel of Jesus
Christ (1738) attempts to prove that what Jesus sought to
teach his followers was but natural morality, or the law of nature.
Morgan, Annet, and Middleton
Thomas Morgan (d. 1743)
continued Tindal's argument on its historical side in The Moral
Philosopher (1737-40),displaying much originality in tracing
the development of heathen religions, as well as of Judaism and
Christianity. Abandoning the old method of deriving specific
religions from priestly deception, he explains their rise through
the gradual supplanting of the one God of the law of nature by
a crowd of divinities connected with definite natural phenomena.
The legislation of Moses, under Egyptian influences, imposed
a rigid and nationally restricted form upon the lex naturae,
and the Jewish ritual and ceremonial is in essence a purely political
institution. Full revelation of the law of nature came with Christ,
who gave to the world in concentrated form the truth that had
already been revealed to Confucius, Zoroaster, Socrates, and Plato.
The protagonist of this divinely revealed truth after Christ
was Paul, who, in his form of expression, indeed, was compelled
to make concessions to the influence of Judaism, and in whom,
therefore, much is to be taken figuratively. Peter, on the other
hand, and the author of the Apocalypse misunderstood the import
of the revelation of Christ and corrupted it in the spirit of
Messianic Judaism. Persecution forced the two tendencies into
union in the Catholic Church, and the Reformation has only partially
succeeded in separating them. Morgan's argument results, therefore,
in the rejection of the formerly assumed identity between the
law of Moses and the lex naturm, and the restriction of
the latter, in the fullness of revelation, to Christianity. His
conclusions were denied by William Warburton in The Divine
Legation of Moses (1738-41). When the Christian apologists
substituted for the argument from miracles the argument from personal
witness and the credibility of Biblical evidence, Peter Annet
(d. 1769), in his Resurrection of Jesus (1744), assailed
the validity of such evidence, and first advanced the hypothesis
of the illusory. death of Jesus, suggesting also that possibly
Paul should be regarded as the founder of a new religion. In Supernaturals
Examined (1747) Annet roundly denies the possibility of miracles.
Conyers Middleton (d. 1750) in his later writings sought to bridge
over the gulf between sacred and profane history, and to test
them equally by the same method. His Inquiry into the Miraculous
Powers (1748) demonstrates that the belief in miracles is
common to primitive Christianity and heathen creeds, and that
it developed to great proportions in the later life of the Church,,
so that one is then confronted with an endless succession of miracle
to which belongs the same degree of credibility that the apologists
attributed to the miracles of the Bible. Though special reference
to the New Testament was omitted, Middleton propounded a question
to answer which no serious attempt was mad when he asked why credence
should be granted to one faith that is denied to another.
Shaftesbury, Mandeville, Dodwell, Bolingbroke
The
Deistic controversy died out in England about the middle of the
eighteenth century. The Deistic literature had exhausted its
stock of materials, while its tenets had never obtained a strong
hold on the people. The cold, inflexible, rational supernaturalism
of Paley (d. 1805) was considered as the final settlement of these
long conflicts. From the beginning, however, there had been a
class of critics, representatives of the old Renaissance spirit,
and inimical, therefore, to the Stoic and Christian ethics, who
had only partially shared the views of the Deists, and in some
ways had advanced to a position far beyond them. Shaftesbury
(d. 1713), in opposition to the utilitarian and supernaturalist
ethics of Locke and Clarke, developed the conception of a strictly
autonomous moral code having its basis in a moral instinct in
man whose end is to bring individual and society to harmonious
self-perfection. Bernard Mandeville (1733) adopted the Epicureanism
of Hobbes and Gassendi, studied moral problems in the skeptical
spirit of Montaigne and La Rochefoucauld, gave the preference
to Bayle over the Deists, and developed empiricism into a sort
of Agnosticism. He criticized the prevailing morality as a more
conventional lie. Christianity-which the Deists had wished, while
reforming, to maintain-he declared impossible, not only as a religion,
but as a system of morality. His Free Thought on Religion
(1720) has caused him to be included in the ranks of the Deists;
but his real position is brought out in the Fable of the Bees
(1714). Henry Dodwell (d. 1711), in Christianity not Founded
on Argument (1742), attempted to demonstrate the invalidity
of the rationalistic basis for Christian truth constructed by
the Deists, from the very nature of the religious impulse, which,
being opposed to rational argumentation, calls for the support
of tradition and mystery, and finds fascination in the attitude
of credo quia absurdum. The only proof proceeds from a mystic
inner enlightenment; logical demonstrations like those of Clarke
or the Boyle lectures are only destructive of religion. Bolingbroke
(d. 1751) voices the French influence in a capricious and dilettante
manner. Despising all religions as the product of enthusiasm,
fraud, and superstition, he nevertheless concedes to real Christianity
the possession of moral and rational truth; an advocate of freedom
of thought, he supports an established church in the interest
of the State and of public morals (Letters on the Study and
Use of History 1752; Essays, 1753).