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With other English influences Deism entered France, where, however,
only its materialistic and revolutionary phases were seized upon,
to the exclusion of that religiosity which had never been lost
in England. French Deism stood outside of theology. The English
writers who came to exercise the greatest influence were Hobbes,
Locke, Shaftesbury, Pope, Bolingbroke, and Hume. Of the true Deists
only Collins, the most critical and the least theological, became
prominent.
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Voltaire (d. 1778) embraced the conception of natural religion with ardor, and entered into a polemics against intolerance in Church and State relations as well as against the philosophy of the Church and the prevailing religious Cartesianism (Essai sur les mmurs et l'esprit des nations, 1754-58; Dictionnaire philosophique, 1764). He derived his natural philosophy from Newton and Clarke, his theory of knowledge and his ideas on toleration from Locke, the main principles of his ethics from Shaftesbury, his critical method and the conception of natural religion from the Deists. All phenomena are explained historically by the interaction between man and his environment, and all things are governed by God acting only in accordance with natural laws. Natural morality and religion are not entirely innate ideas, but rather simple and universally prevalent conditions standing in need of development and following a course that leads through errors arising from ignorance and fear to an ultimate standard truth which is characterized as the "fruit of the cultivated reason." Deism is thereby emptied of all religious content and restricted to the field of morals and rational metaphysics.
All that is essentially characteristic of human nature
is the same everywhere; all that depends on custom varies. The
chief influences for changes in the human mind are climate, government,
religion, and in opposition to these one should seek to arrive
at the underlying, undiversified unity. "Dogma leads to
fanaticism and strife; morality everywhere inspires harmony."
The rise of positive religions may be studied psychologically
in children and savages. Fear and ignorance of the law of nature
are the primary causes; the parallel growth of social groups
and the need of authority cooperate. In China alone natural
religion has escaped this pernicious development. India be came
the home of theological speculation, and influenced the religions
of the West, of which the most important was Judaism as the parent
of Christianity and Islam. Moses was a shrewd politician; the
prophets were enthusiasts like the dervishes, or else epileptics;
Jesus was a visionary like the founder of the Quakers, and his
religion received life only through its union with Platonism.
Voltaire's conception of the evolution of history entered deep
into European thought. By the side of the party of the juste
milieu and of good sense," of which Voltaire is the most
prominent representative, there arose a school which carried
the doctrines of mechanism and sensualism to their furthest consequences.
and evolved a philosophy of materialism.
Encyclopedists
The Encyclopedists removed from Deism
the great factor of natural religion, retaining only its critical
method as applied to the history of religion. The head of this
school was Denis Diderot (d. 1784), and its great organ of expression
was the Encyclopedie. The state censorship, however,
compelled the projectors to call to their aid a number of contributors
of conservative views and to bring their skeptical method to
the task of defending the compromise between reason and revelation.
In this spirit the main religious topics were treated, but by
a subtle infusion of the spirit of Bayle and the expedient of
cross-references from these articles to topics which might be
handled with greater freedom, Diderot succeeded in supplying
the desired corrective. It was the circle of Holbach (d. 1789)
that dared to apply the most extreme consequences of materialism
to religious questions. Helvetius (d. 1771) prepared the way
with his De l'esprit (17,58), in which he expounded a
materialistic psychology and ethics. Their moral theories, deriving
though they did from Hobbes and Hume, lost all connection with
the position of Deism, which became for them a mere armory of
weapons for the destruction of all religion with its consequences,
intolerance and moral corruption. Holbach is undoubtedly the
author of the Systeme de la nature, which appeared in
1770 as the work of Mirabaud. The Systeme is not original
in ascribing the beginnings of religion to human hope and fear
and to ignorance of the laws of nature. Fraud, ambition, and
unhealthy enthusiasm have made use of it as a means of political
and social influence and have succeeded in crystallizing its
primitive emotions into positive creeds, within which animistic
tendencies have been developed and subtilized into systems of
metaphysics and theology -- the sources of irrational intolerance.
From Holbach and his circle, and from the cognate group of the
Encyclopedists, proceeded the so-called ideological school, who
held the main problem of philosophy to be the analysis of the
mental conceptions aroused by sensations from the material world
(Condorcet, Naigeon, Garat, Volney, Dupuis, Saint-Lambert, Laplace,
Cabinis, De Tracy, J. B. Say, Benjamin Constant, Bichat, Lamarck,
Saint-Simon, Thurot, Stendhal). Out of this school, in turn,
developed the positivism of Comte.