|
Design arguments are empirical arguments for the existence of God. These arguments typically, though not
always, proceed by attempting to identify various empirical features of the world that constitute evidence of
intelligent design and inferring God's existence as the best explanation for these features. Since the
concepts of design and purpose are closely related, design arguments are also known as "teleological
arguments," which incorporates "telos," the Greek word for "goal" or "purpose."
Design arguments
typically consist of (1) a premise that asserts that the material universe exhibits some empirical
property F; (2) a premise (or sub-argument) that asserts (or concludes) that F is
persuasive evidence of intelligent design or purpose; and (3) a premise (or sub-argument) that asserts
(or concludes) that the best or most probable explanation for the fact that the material universe
exhibits F is that there exists an intelligent designer who intentionally brought it about that
the material universe exists and exhibits F.
There are a number of classic and contemporary
versions of the argument from design. This article will cover seven different ones. Among the classical versions are: (1) the "Fifth Way" of St. Thomas Aquinas; (2) the argument from simple analogy; (3) Paley's
watchmaker argument; and (4) the argument from guided evolution. The more contemporary versions include: (5) the argument from irreducible
biochemical complexity; (6) the argument from biological information; and (7) the fine-tuning
argument.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. The Classical Versions of the Design Argument
a. Scriptural Roots and Aquinas's Fifth Way
The scriptures of each of the major classically theistic religions contain language that suggests that
there is evidence of divine design in the world. Psalms 19:1 of the Old Testament, scripture to both
Judaism and Christianity, states that "The heavens declare the glory of God; and the firmament sheweth
his handywork." Similarly, Romans 1:19-21 of the New Testament states:
For what can be known about God is plain to them, because God has shown it to them. Ever since the
creation of the world his eternal power and divine nature, invisible though they are, have been
understood and seen through the things he has made. So they are without excuse.
Further, Koran 31:20 asks "Do you not see that Allah has made what is in the heavens and what is in the
earth subservient to you, and made complete to you His favors outwardly and inwardly?" While these
verses do not specifically indicate which properties or features of the world are evidence of God's
intelligent nature, each presupposes that the world exhibits such features and that they are readily
discernable to a reasonably conscientious agent.
Perhaps the earliest philosophically rigorous version of the design argument owes to St. Thomas Aquinas.
According to Aquinas's Fifth Way:
We see that things which lack knowledge, such as natural bodies, act for an end, and this is evident from
their acting always, or nearly always, in the same way, so as to obtain the best result. Hence it is
plain that they achieve their end, not fortuitously, but designedly. Now whatever lacks knowledge cannot
move towards an end, unless it be directed by some being endowed with knowledge and intelligence; as the
arrow is directed by the archer. Therefore some intelligent being exists by whom all natural things are
directed to their end; and this being we call God (Aquinas, Summa Theologica, Article 3, Question 2).
It is worth noting that Aquinas's version of the argument relies on a very strong claim about the
explanation for ends and processes: the existence of any end-directed system or process can be explained,
as a logical matter, only by the existence of an intelligent being who directs that system or process
towards its end. Since the operations of all natural bodies, on Aquinas's view, are directed towards
some specific end that conduces to, at the very least, the preservation of the object, these operations
can be explained only by the existence of an intelligent being. Accordingly, the empirical fact that the
operations of natural objects are directed towards ends shows that an intelligent Deity exists.
This crucial claim, however, seems to be refuted by the mere possibility of an evolutionary
explanation. If a Darwinian explanation is even coherent (that is, non-contradictory, as opposed to true),
then it provides a logically possible explanation for how the end-directedness of the operations of
living beings in this world might have come about. According to this explanation, such operations evolve
through a process by which random genetic mutations are naturally selected for their adaptive value;
organisms that have evolved some system that performs a fitness-enhancing operation are more likely to
survive and leave offspring, other things being equal, than organisms that have not evolved such systems.
If this explanation is possibly true, it shows that Aquinas is wrong in thinking that "whatever lacks
knowledge cannot move towards an end, unless it be directed by some being endowed with knowledge
and intelligence."
b. The Argument from Simple Analogy
The next important version of the design argument came in the 17th and 18th Centuries. Pursuing a
strategy that has been adopted by the contemporary intelligent design movement, John Ray, Richard
Bentley, and William Derham drew on scientific discoveries of the 16th and 17th Century to argue for the
existence of an intelligent Deity. William Derham, for example, saw evidence of intelligent design in
the vision of birds, the drum of the ear, the eye-socket, and the digestive system. Richard Bentley saw
evidence of intelligent design in Newton's discovery of the law of gravitation. It is noteworthy that
each of these thinkers attempted to give scientifically-based arguments for the existence of God.
David Hume is the most famous critic of these arguments. In Part II of his famous Dialogues
Concerning Natural Religion, Hume formulates the argument as follows:
Look round the world: contemplate the whole and every part of it: you will find it to be nothing but one
great machine, subdivided into an infinite number of lesser machines, which again admit of subdivisions
to a degree beyond what human senses and faculties can trace and explain. All these various machines,
and even their most minute parts, are adjusted to each other with an accuracy which ravishes into
admiration all men who have ever contemplated them. The curious adapting of means to ends, throughout
all nature, resembles exactly, though it much exceeds, the productions of human contrivance; of human
designs, thought, wisdom, and intelligence. Since, therefore, the effects resemble each other, we are
led to infer, by all the rules of analogy, that the causes also resemble; and that the Author of Nature
is somewhat similar to the mind of man, though possessed of much larger faculties, proportioned to the
grandeur of the work which he has executed. By this argument a posteriori, and by this argument alone,
do we prove at once the existence of a Deity, and his similarity to human mind and intelligence.
Since the world, on this analysis, is closely analogous to the most intricate artifacts produced by human
beings, we can infer "by all the rules of analogy" the existence of an intelligent designer who created
the world. Just as the watch has a watchmaker, then, the universe has a universe-maker.
As expressed in this passage, then, the argument is a straightforward argument from analogy with the
following structure:
-
The material universe resembles the intelligent productions of human beings in that it exhibits
design.
- The design in any human artifact is the effect of having been made by an intelligent being.
- Like effects have like causes.
- Therefore, the design in the material universe is the effect of having been made by an
intelligent creator.
Hume criticizes the argument on two main grounds. First, Hume rejects the analogy between the material
universe and any particular human artifact. As Hume states the relevant rule of analogy, "wherever you
depart in the least, from the similarity of the cases, you diminish proportionably the evidence; and may
at last bring it to a very weak analogy, which is confessedly liable to error and uncertainty"
(Hume, Dialogues, Part II). Hume then goes on to argue that the cases are simply too dissimilar
to support an inference that they are like effects having like causes:
If we see a house,… we conclude, with the greatest certainty, that it had an architect or builder because
this is precisely that species of effect which we have experienced to proceed from that species of cause.
But surely you will not affirm that the universe bears such a resemblance to a house that we can with
the same certainty infer a similar cause, or that the analogy is here entire and perfect (Hume,
Dialogues, Part II).
Since the analogy fails, Hume argues that we would need to have experience with the creation of material
worlds in order to justify any a posteriori claims about the causes of any particular material
world; since we obviously lack such experience, we lack adequate justification for the claim that the
material universe has an intelligent cause.
Second, Hume argues that, even if the resemblance between the material universe and human artifacts
justified thinking they have similar causes, it would not justify thinking that an all-perfect God exists
and created the world. For example, there is nothing in the argument that would warrant the inference
that the creator of the universe is perfectly intelligent or perfectly good. Indeed, Hume argues that
there is nothing there that would justify thinking even that there is just one deity: "what shadow of an
argument... can you produce from your hypothesis to prove the unity of the Deity? A great number of men
join in building a house or ship, in rearing a city, in framing a commonwealth; why may not several
deities combine in contriving and framing a world" (Hume Dialogues, Part V)?
c. Paley's Watchmaker Argument
Though often confused with the argument from simple analogy, the watchmaker argument from William Paley is a
more sophisticated design argument that attempts to avoid Hume's objection to the analogy between worlds
and artifacts. Instead of simply asserting a similarity between the material world and some human
artifact, Paley's argument proceeds by identifying what he takes to be a reliable indicator of
intelligent design:
[S]uppose I found a watch upon the ground, and it should be inquired how the watch happened to be in that
place, I should hardly think … that, for anything I knew, the watch might have always been there. Yet
why should not this answer serve for the watch as well as for [a] stone [that happened to be lying on the
ground]?… For this reason, and for no other; viz., that, if the different parts had been differently
shaped from what they are, if a different size from what they are, or placed after any other manner, or
in any order than that in which they are placed, either no motion at all would have been carried on in
the machine, or none which would have answered the use that is now served by it (Paley 1867, 1).
There are thus two features of a watch that reliably indicate that it is the result of an intelligent
design. First, it performs some function that an intelligent agent would regard as valuable; the fact
that the watch performs the function of keeping time is something that has value to an intelligent agent.
Second, the watch could not perform this function if its parts and mechanisms were differently sized or
arranged; the fact that the ability of a watch to keep time depends on the precise shape, size, and
arrangement of its parts suggests that the watch has these characteristics because some intelligent
agency designed it to these specifications. Taken together, these two characteristics endow the watch
with a functional complexity that reliably distinguishes objects that have intelligent designers from
objects that do not.
Paley then goes on to argue that the material universe exhibits the same kind of functional complexity as
a watch:
Every indicator of contrivance, every manifestation of design, which existed in the watch, exists in the
works of nature; with the difference, on the side of nature, of being greater and more, and that in a
degree which exceeds all computation. I mean that the contrivances of nature surpass the contrivances of
art, in the complexity, subtilty, and curiosity of the mechanism; and still more, if possible, do they go
beyond them in number and variety; yet in a multitude of cases, are not less evidently mechanical, not
less evidently contrivances, not less evidently accommodated to their end, or suited to their office,
than are the most perfect productions of human ingenuity (Paley 1867, 13).
Since the works of nature possess functional complexity, a reliable indicator of intelligent design, we
can justifiably conclude that these works were created by an intelligent agent who designed them to
instantiate this property.
Paley's watchmaker argument is clearly not vulnerable to Hume's criticism that the works of nature and
human artifacts are too dissimilar to infer that they are like effects having like causes. Paley's
argument, unlike arguments from analogy, does not depend on a premise asserting a general resemblance
between the objects of comparison. What matters for Paley's argument is that works of nature and human
artifacts have a particular property that reliably indicates design. Regardless of how dissimilar any
particular natural object might otherwise be from a watch, both objects exhibit the sort of functional
complexity that warrants an inference that it was made by an intelligent designer.
Paley's version of the argument, however, is generally thought to have been refuted by Charles Darwin's competing
explanation for complex organisms. In The Origin of the Species, Darwin argued that more complex
biological organisms evolved gradually over millions of years from simpler organisms through a process of
natural selection. As Julian Huxley describes the logic of this process:
The evolutionary process results immediately and automatically from the basic property of living matter—that of self-copying, but with occasional errors. Self-copying leads to multiplication and competition;
the errors in self-copying are what we call mutations, and mutations will inevitably confer different
degrees of biological advantage or disadvantage on their possessors. The consequence will be
differential reproduction down the generations—in other words, natural selection (Huxley 1953, 4).
Over time, the replication of genetic material in an organism results in mutations that give rise to new
traits in the organism's offspring. Sometimes these new traits are so unfavorable to a being's survival
prospects that beings with the traits die off; but sometimes these new traits enable the possessors to
survive conditions that kill off beings without them. If the trait is sufficiently favorable, only
members of the species with the trait will survive. By this natural process, functionally complex
organisms gradually evolve over millions of years from primordially simple organisms.
Contemporary biologist, Richard Dawkins (1986), uses a programming problem to show that the logic of the process
renders the Darwinian explanation significantly more probable than the design explanation. Dawkins
considers two ways in which one might program a computer to generate the following sequence of
characters: METHINKS IT IS LIKE A WEASEL. The first program randomly producing a new 28-character
sequence each time it is run; since the program starts over each time, it incorporates a "single-step
selection process." The probability of randomly generating the target sequence on any given try is
2728 (that is, 27 characters selected for each of the 28 positions in the
sequence), which amounts to about 1 in (10,000 x 1,000,0006). While a computer running eternally
would eventually produce the sequence, Dawkins estimates that it would take 1,000,0005 years—which is 1,000,0003 years longer than the universe has existed. As is readily evident, a program
that selects numbers by means of such a "single-step selection mechanism" has a very low probability of
reaching the target.
The second program incorporates a "cumulative-step selection mechanism." It begins by randomly
generating a 28-character sequence of letters and spaces and then "breeds" from this sequence in the
following way. For a specified period of time, it generates copies of itself; most of the copies
perfectly replicate the sequence, but some copies have errors (or mutations). At the end of this period,
it compares all of the sequences with the target sequence METHINKS IT IS LIKE A WEASEL and keeps the
sequence that most closely resembles it. For example, a sequence that has an E in the second place more
closely resembles a sequence that is exactly like the first except that it has a Q in the second place.
It then begins breeding from this new sequence in exactly the same way. Unlike the first program which
starts afresh with each try, the second program builds on previous steps, getting successively closer to
the program as it breeds from the sequence closest to the target. This feature of the program increases
the probability of reaching the sequence to such an extent that a computer running this program hit the
target sequence after 43 generations, which took about half-an-hour.
The problem with Paley's watchmaker argument, as Dawkins explains it, is that it falsely assumes that all
of the other possible competing explanations are sufficiently improbable to warrant an inference of
design. While this might be true of explanations that rely entirely on random single-step selection
mechanisms, this is not true of Darwinian explanations. As is readily evident from Huxley's description
of the process, Darwinian evolution is a cumulative-step selection method that closely resembles in
general structure the second computer program. The result is that the probability of evolving
functionally complex organisms capable of surviving a wide variety of conditions is increased to such an
extent that it exceeds the probability of the design explanation.
d. Guided Evolution
While many theists are creationists who accept the occurrence of "microevolution" (that is, evolution
that occurs within a species, such as the evolution of penicillin-resistant bacteria) but deny the
occurrence of "macroevolution" (that is, one species evolving from a distinct species), some theists accept
the theory of evolution as consistent with theism and with their own denominational religious
commitments. Such thinkers, however, frequently maintain that the existence of God is needed to explain
the purposive quality of the evolutionary process. Just as the purposive quality of the cumulative-step
computer program above is best explained by intelligent design, so too the purposive quality of natural
selection is best explained by intelligent design.
The first theist widely known to have made such an argument is Frederick Robert Tennant. As he puts the
matter, in Volume 2 of Philosophical Theology, "the multitude of interwoven adaptations by which
the world is constituted a theatre of life, intelligence, and morality, cannot reasonably be regarded as
an outcome of mechanism, or of blind formative power, or aught but purposive intelligence" (Tennant 1928-30,
121). In effect, this influential move infers design, not from the existence of functionally complex
organisms, but from the purposive quality of the evolutionary process itself. Evolution is, on this line
of response, guided by an intelligent Deity.
2. Contemporary Versions of the Design Argument
Contemporary versions of the design argument typically attempt to articulate a more sophisticated
strategy for detecting evidence of design in the world. These versions typically contain three main
elements—though they are not always explicitly articulated. First, they identify some property
P that is thought to be a probabilistically reliable index of design in the following sense: a
design explanation for P is significantly more probable than any explanation that relies on chance
or random processes. Second they argue that some feature or features of the world exhibits P.
Third, they conclude that the design explanation is significantly more likely to be true.
As we will see, however, all of the contemporary versions of the design inference seem to be vulnerable
to roughly the same objection. While each of the design inferences in these arguments has legitimate
empirical uses, those uses occur only in contexts where we have strong antecedent reason for believing
there exist intelligent agents with the ability to bring about the relevant event, entity, or property.
But since it is the very existence of such a being that is at issue in the debates about the existence of God,
design arguments appear unable to stand by themselves as arguments for God's existence.
a. The Argument from Irreducible Biochemical Complexity
Design theorists distinguish two types of complexity that can be instantiated by any given structure.
As William Dembski describes the distinction: a system or structure is cumulatively complex "if
the components of the system can be arranged sequentially so that the successive removal of components
never leads to the complete loss of function"; a system or structure is irreducibly complex "if it
consists of several interrelated parts so that removing even one part completely destroys the system's
function" (Dembski 1999, 147). A city is cumulatively complex since one can successively remove people,
services, and buildings without rendering it unable to perform its function. A mousetrap, in contrast,
is irreducibly complex because the removal of even one part results in complete loss of function.
Design proponents, like Michael J. Behe, have identified a number of biochemical systems that they take
to be irreducibly complex. Like the functions of a watch or a mousetrap, a cilium cannot perform its
function unless its microtubules, nexin linkers, and motor proteins are all arranged and structured in
precisely the manner in which they are structured; remove any component from the system and it cannot
perform its function. Similarly, the blood-clotting function cannot perform its function if either of
its key ingredients, vitamin K and antihemophilic factor, are missing. Both systems are, on this view,
irreducibly complex—rather than cumulatively complex.
According to Behe, the probability of evolving irreducibly complex systems along Darwinian lines is
sufficiently small that it can be ruled out as an explanation of irreducible biochemical complexity:
An irreducibly complex system cannot be produced … by slight, successive modifications of a
precursor system, because any precursor to an irreducibly complex system that is missing a part is by
definition nonfunctional…. Since natural selection can only choose systems that are already working, if
a biological system cannot be produced gradually it would have to arise as an integrated unit, in one
fell swoop, for natural selection to have anything to act on (Behe 1996, 39; emphasis added).
Since, for example, a cilium-precursor (that is, one that lacks at least one of a cilium's parts) cannot
perform the function that endows a cilium with adaptive value, organisms that have the cilium-precursor
are no "fitter for survival" than they would have been without it. Since chance-driven evolutionary
processes would not select organisms with the precursor, intelligent design is a better explanation for
the existence of organisms with fully functional cilia.
Though Behe states his conclusion in categorical terms (that is, irreducibly complex systems "cannot be
produced gradually"), he is more charitably construed as claiming only that the probability of gradually
producing irreducibly complex systems is very small. The stronger construction of the conclusion (and
argument) incorrectly presupposes that Darwinian theory implies that every precursor to a fully
functional system must itself perform some function that makes the organism more fit to survive.
Organisms that have, say, a precursor to a fully functional cilium are no fitter than they would have
been without it, but there is nothing in Darwinian theory that implies they are necessarily any less fit.
Thus, there is no reason to think that it is logically or nomologically impossible, according to
Darwinian theory, for a set of organisms with a precursor to a fully functional cilium to evolve into a
set of organisms that has fully functional cilia. Accordingly, the argument from irreducible biochemical
complexity is more plausibly construed as showing that the design explanation for such complexity is more
probable than the evolutionary explanation.
Nevertheless, this more modest interpretation is problematic. First, there is little reason to think
that the probability of evolving irreducibly complex systems is, as a general matter, small enough to
warrant assuming that the probability of the design explanation must be higher. If having a precursor to
an irreducibly complex system does not render the organism less fit for survival, the probability a
subspecies of organisms with the precursor survives and propagates is the same, other things being equal,
as the probability that a subspecies of organisms without the precursor survives and propagates. In such
cases, then, the prospect that the subspecies with the precursor will continue to thrive, leave
offspring, and evolve is not unusually small.
Second, the claim that intelligent agents of a certain kind would (or should) see functional value in a
complex system, by itself, says very little about the probability of any particular causal explanation.
While this claim surely implies that intelligent agents with the right causal abilities have a reason for
bringing about such systems, it does not tell us anything determinate about whether it is likely that
intelligent agents with the right causal powers did bring such systems about—because it does not
tell us anything determinate about whether it is probable that such agents exist. As a logical matter,
the mere fact that some existing thing has a feature, irreducibly complex or otherwise, that would
be valuable to an intelligent being with certain properties, by itself, does not say anything about
the probability that such a being exists.
Accordingly, even if we knew that the prospect that the precursor-subspecies would survive was
"vanishingly small," as Behe believes, we would not be justified in inferring a design explanation on
probabilistic grounds. To infer that the design explanation is more probable than an explanation of
vanishingly small probability, we need some reason to think that the probability of the design
explanation is not vanishingly small. The problem, however, is that the claim that a complex system has
some property that would be valued by an intelligent agent with the right abilities, by itself, simply
does not justify inferring that the probability that such an agent exists and brought about the existence
of that system is not vanishingly small. In the absence of some further information about the
probability that such an agent exists, we cannot legitimately infer design as the explanation of
irreducible biochemical complexity.
b. The Argument from Biological Information
While the argument from irreducible biochemical complexity focuses on the probability of evolving
irreducibly complex living systems or organisms from simpler living systems or organisms, the argument
from biological information focuses on the problem of generating living organisms in the first place.
Darwinian theories are intended only to explain how it is that more complex living organisms developed
from primordially simple living organisms, and hence do not even purport to explain the origin of the
latter. The argument from biological information is concerned with an explanation of how it is that the
world went from a state in which it contained no living organisms to a state in which it contained living
organisms; that is to say, it is concerned with the explanation of the very first forms of life.
There are two distinct problems involved in explaining the origin of life from a naturalistic standpoint.
The first is to explain how it is that a set of non-organic substances could combine to produce the
amino acids that are the building blocks of every living substance. The second is to explain the origin
of the information expressed by the sequences of nucleotides that form DNA molecules. The precise
ordering of the four nucleotides, adenine, thymine, guanine, and cytosine (A, T, G, and C, for short),
determine the specific operations that occur within a living cell and is hence fairly characterized as
representing (or embodying) information. As Stephen C. Meyer puts the point: "just as the letters in the
alphabet of a written language may convey a particular message depending on their sequence, so too do the
sequences of nucleotides or bases in the DNA molecule convey precise biochemical instructions that direct
protein synthesis within the cell" (Meyer 1998, 526).
The argument from biological information is concerned with only the second of these problems. In
particular, it attempts to evaluate four potential explanations for the origin of biological information:
(1) chance; (2) a pre-biotic form of natural selection; (3) chemical necessity; and (4) intelligent
design. The argument concludes that intelligent design is the most probable explanation for the
information present in large biomacromolecules like DNA, RNA, and proteins.
The argument proceeds as follows. Pre-biotic natural selection and chemical necessity cannot, as
a logical matter, explain the origin of biological information. Theories of pre-biotic natural selection
are problematic because they illicitly assume the very feature they are trying to explain. These
explanations proceed by asserting that the most complex nonliving molecules will reproduce more
efficiently than less complex nonliving molecules. But, in doing so, they assume that nonliving
chemicals instantiate precisely the kind of replication mechanism that biological information is needed
to explain in the case of living organisms. In the absence of some sort of explanation as to how
non-organic reproduction could occur, theories of pre-biotic natural selection fail.
Theories of chemical necessity are problematic because chemical necessity can explain, at most, the
development of highly repetitive ordered sequences incapable of representing information. Because
processes involving chemical necessity are highly regular and predictable in character, they are capable
of producing only highly repetitive sequences of "letters." For example, while chemical necessity could
presumably explain a sequence like "ababababababab," it cannot explain specified but highly irregular
sequences like "the house is on fire." The problem is that highly repetitive sequences like the former
are not sufficiently complex and varied to express information. Thus, while chemical necessity can
explain periodic order among nucleotide letters, it lacks the resources logically needed to explain the
aperiodic, highly specified, complexity of a sequence capable of expressing information.
Ultimately, this leaves only chance and design as logically viable explanations of biological
information. Although it is logically possible to obtain functioning sequences of amino acids through
purely random processes, some researchers have estimated the probability of doing so under the most
favorable of assumptions at approximately 1 in 1065. Factoring in more
realistic assumptions about pre-biotic conditions, Meyer argues the probability of generating short
functional protein is 1 in 10125—a number that is vanishingly small.
Meyer concludes: "given the complexity of proteins, it is extremely unlikely that a random search through
all the possible amino acid sequences could generate even a single relatively short functional protein in
the time available since the beginning of the universe (let alone the time available on the early earth)"
(Meyer 2002, 75).
Next, Meyer argues that the probability of the design explanation for the origin of biological
information is considerably higher:
[O]ne can detect the past action of an intelligent cause from the presence of an information-rich effect,
even if the cause itself cannot be directly observed. For instances, visitors to the gardens of Victoria
harbor in Canada correctly infer the activity of intelligent agents when they see a pattern of red and
yellow flowers spelling "Welcome to Victoria", even if they did not see the flowers planted and arranged.
Similarly, the specifically arranged nucleotide sequences—the complex but functionally specified
sequences—in DNA imply the past action of an intelligent mind, even if such mental agency cannot be
directly observed (Meyer 2002, 93).
Further, scientists in many fields typically infer the causal activity of intelligent agents from the
occurrence of information content. As Meyer rightly observes by way of example, "[a]rcheologists assume
a mind produced the inscriptions on the Rosetta Stone" (Meyer 2002, 94).
Meyer's reasoning appears vulnerable to the same objection to which the argument from biochemical
complexity is vulnerable. In all of the contexts in which we legitimately make the design inference in
response to an observation of information, we already know that there exist intelligent agents with the
right sorts of motivations and abilities to produce information content; after all, we know that human
beings exist and are frequently engaged in the production and transmission of information. It is
precisely because we have this background knowledge that we can justifiably be confident that intelligent
design is a far more probable explanation than chance for any occurrence of information that a human
being is capable of producing. In the absence of antecedent reason for thinking there exist intelligent
agents capable of creating information content, the occurrence of a pattern of flowers in the shape of
"Welcome to Victoria" would not obviously warrant an inference of intelligent design.
The problem, however, is that it is the very existence of an intelligent Deity that is at issue. In the
absence of some antecedent reason for thinking there exists an intelligent Deity capable of creating
biological information, the occurrence of sequences of nucleotides that can be described as "representing
information" does not obviously warrant an inference of intelligent design—no matter how improbable the
chance explanation might be. To justify preferring one explanation as more probable than another, we
must have information about the probability of each explanation. The mere fact that certain sequences
take a certain shape that we can see meaning or value in, by itself, tells us nothing
obvious about the probability that it is the result of intelligent design.
It is true, of course, that "experience affirms that information content not only routinely arises but
always arises from the activity of intelligent minds" (Meyer 2002, 92), but our experience is limited to
the activity of human beings—beings that are frequently engaged in activities that are intended to
produce information content. While that experience will inductively justify inferring that some human
agency is the cause of any information that could be explained by human beings, it will not inductively
justify inferring the existence of an intelligent agency with causal powers that depart as radically from
our experience as the powers that are traditionally attributed to God. The argument from biological
information, like the argument from biochemical complexity, seems incapable of standing alone as an
argument for God's existence.
c. The Fine-Tuning Arguments
Scientists have determined that life in the universe would not be possible if more than about two
dozen properties of the universe were even slightly different from what they are; as the matter is
commonly put, the universe appears "fine-tuned" for life. For example, life would not be possible if the
force of the big bang explosion had differed by one part in 1060; the universe would have either
collapsed on itself or expanded too rapidly for stars to form. Similarly, life would not be possible if
the force binding protons to neutrons differed by even five percent.
It is immediately tempting to think that the probability of a fine-tuned universe is so small that
intelligent design simply must be the more probable explanation. The supposition that it is a matter of
chance that so many things could be exactly what they need to be for life to exist in the universe just
seems implausibly improbable. Since, on this intuition, the only two explanations for the highly
improbable appearance of fine-tuning are chance and an intelligent agent who deliberately designed the
universe to be hospitable to life, the latter simply has to be the better explanation.
This natural line of argument is vulnerable to a cogent objection. The mere fact that it is enormously
improbable that an event occurred by chance, by itself, gives us no reason to think that it
occurred by design. Suppose we flip a fair coin 1000 times and record the results in succession. The
probability of getting the particular outcome is vanishingly small: 1 in 21000 to be precise. But it is clear that the mere fact that such a sequence is so
improbable, by itself, does not give us any reason to think that it was the result of intelligent design.
As intuitively tempting as it may be to conclude from just the apparent improbability of a
fine-tuned universe that it is the result of divine agency, the inference is unsound.
i. The Argument from Suspicious Improbabilitys
George N. Schlesinger, however, attempts to formalize the fine-tuning intuition in a way that avoids
this objection. To understand Schlesinger's argument, consider your reaction to two different events.
If John wins a 1-in-1,000,000,000 lottery game, you would not immediately be tempted to think that John
(or someone acting on his behalf) cheated. If, however, John won three consecutive 1-in-1,000 lotteries,
you would immediately be tempted to think that John (or someone acting on his behalf) cheated.
Schlesinger believes that the intuitive reaction to these two scenarios is epistemically justified. The
structure of the latter event is such that it is justifies a belief that intelligent design is the cause:
the fact that John got lucky in three consecutive lotteries is a reliable indicator that his winning was
the intended result of someone's intelligent agency. Despite the fact that the probability of winning
three consecutive 1-in-1,000 games is exactly the same as the probability of winning one
1-in-1,000,000,000 game, the former event is of a kind that is surprising in a way that warrants
an inference of intelligent design.
Schlesinger argues that the fact that the universe is fine-tuned for life is improbable in exactly the
same way that John's winning three consecutive lotteries is improbable. After all, it is not just that
we got lucky with respect to one property-lottery game; we got lucky with respect to two dozen
property-lottery games—lotteries that we had to win in order for there to be life in the universe.
Given that we are justified in inferring intelligent design in the case of John's winning three
consecutive lotteries, we are even more justified in inferring intelligent design in the case of our
winning two dozen much more improbable property lotteries. Thus, Schlesinger concludes, the most
probable explanation for the remarkable fact that the universe has exactly the right properties to
sustain life is that an intelligent Deity intentionally created the universe such as to sustain life.
This argument is vulnerable to a number of criticisms. First, while it might be clear that carbon-based
life would not be possible if the universe were slightly different with respect to these two-dozen
fine-tuned properties, it is not clear that no form of life would be possible. Second, some physicists
speculate that this physical universe is but one material universe in a "multiverse" in which all
possible material universes are ultimately realized. If this highly speculative hypothesis is correct,
then there is nothing particularly suspicious about the fact that there is a fine-tuned universe, since
the existence of such a universe is inevitable (that is, has probability 1) if all every material universe
is eventually realized in the multiverse. Since some universe, so to speak, had to win, the fact that
ours won does not demand any special explanation.
Schlesinger's fine-tuning argument also appears vulnerable to the same criticism as the other versions of
the design argument (see Himma 2002). While Schlesinger is undoubtedly correct in thinking that we are
justified in suspecting design in the case where John wins three consecutive lotteries, it is because—and only because—we know two related empirical facts about such events. First, we already know that
there exist intelligent agents who have the right motivations and causal abilities to deliberately bring
about such events. Second, we know from past experience with such events that they are usually explained
by the deliberate agency of one or more of these agents. Without at least one of these two pieces of
information, we are not obviously justified in seeing design in such cases.
As before, the problem for the fine-tuning argument is that we lack both of the pieces that are needed to
justify an inference of design. First, the very point of the argument is to establish the fact that
there exists an intelligent agency that has the right causal abilities and motivations to bring the
existence of a universe capable of sustaining life. Second, and more obviously, we do not have any past
experience with the genesis of worlds and are hence not in a position to know whether the existence of
fine-tuned universes are usually explained by the deliberate agency of some intelligent agency. Because
we lack this essential background information, we are not justified in inferring that there exists an
intelligent Deity who deliberately created a universe capable of sustaining life.
ii. The Confirmatory Argument
Robin Collins defends a more modest version of the fine-tuning argument that relies on a general
principle of confirmation theory, rather than a principle that is contrived to distinguish events or
entities that are explained by intelligent design from events or entities explained by other factors.
Collins's version of the argument relies on what he calls the Prime Principle of Confirmation: If
observation O is more probable under hypothesis H1 than under hypothesis H2, then O provides a reason for
preferring H1 over H2. The idea is that the fact that an observation is more likely under the assumption
that H1 is true than under the assumption H2 is true counts as evidence in favor of H1.
This version of the fine-tuning argument proceeds by comparing the relative likelihood of a fine-tuned
universe under two hypotheses:
- The Design Hypothesis: there exists a God who created the universe such
as to sustain life;
- The Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis: there exists one material
universe, and it is a matter of chance that the universe has the fine-tuned properties needed to sustain
life.
Assuming the Design Hypothesis is true, the
probability that the universe has the fine-tuned properties approaches (if it does not equal) 1.
Assuming the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis is true, the probability that the universe has the
fine-tuned properties is very small—though it is not clear exactly how small. Applying the Prime
Principle of Confirmation, Collins concludes that the observation of fine-tuned properties provides
reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis.
At the outset, it is crucial to note that Collins does not intend the fine-tuned argument as a proof of
God's existence. As he explains, the Prime Principle of Confirmation "is a general principle of
reasoning which tells us when some observation counts as evidence in favor of one hypothesis over
another" (Collins 1999, 51). Indeed, he explicitly acknowledges that "the argument does not say that the
fine-tuning evidence proves that the universe was designed, or even that it is likely that the universe
was designed" (Collins 1999, 53). It tells us only that the observation of fine-tuning provides one reason for
accepting the Theistic Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis—and one that can be
rebutted by other evidence.
The confirmatory version of the fine-tuning argument is not vulnerable to the objection that it relies on
an inference strategy that presupposes that we have independent evidence for thinking the right kind of
intelligent agency exists. As a general scientific principle, the Prime Principle of Confirmation can be
applied in a wide variety of circumstances and is not limited to circumstances in which we have other
reasons to believe the relevant conclusion is true. If the observation of a fine-tuned universe is more
probable under the Theistic Hypothesis than under the Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis, then this
fact is a reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis to Atheistic Single-Universe Hypothesis.
Nevertheless, the confirmatory version of the argument is vulnerable on other fronts. As a first step
towards seeing one worry, consider two possible explanations for the observation that John Doe wins a
1-in-7,000,000 lottery (see Himma 2002). According to the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis, God wanted John
Doe to win and deliberately brought it about that his numbers were drawn. According to the Chance
Lottery Hypothesis, John Doe's numbers were drawn by chance. It is clear that John's winning the lottery
is vastly more probable under the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis than under the Chance Lottery Hypothesis.
By the Prime Principle of Confirmation, then, John's winning the lottery provides a reason to prefer the
Theistic Lottery Hypothesis over the Chance Lottery Hypothesis.
As is readily evident, the above reasoning, by itself, provides very weak support for the Theistic
Lottery Hypothesis. If all we know about the world is that John Doe won a lottery and the only possible
explanations for this observation are the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis and the Chance Lottery Hypothesis,
then this observation provides some reason to prefer the former. But it does not take much
counterevidence to rebut the Theistic Lottery Hypothesis: a single observation of a lottery that relies
on a random selection process will suffice. A single application of the Prime Principle of Confirmation,
by itself, is simply not designed to provide the sort of reason that would warrant much confidence in
preferring one hypothesis to another.
For this reason, the confirmatory version of the fine-tuning argument, by itself, provides a weak
reason for preferring the Design Hypothesis over the Atheistic Single Universe Hypothesis. Although
Collins is certainly correct in thinking the observation of fine-tuning provides a reason for accepting
the Design Hypothesis and hence rational ground for belief that God exists, that reason is simply not
strong enough to do much in the way of changing the minds of either agnostics or atheists.
3. The Scientifically Legitimate Uses of Design Inferences
It is worth noting that proponents are correct in thinking that design inferences have a variety of
legitimate scientific uses. Such inferences are used to detect intelligent agency in a large variety of
contexts, including criminal and insurance investigations. Consider, for example, the notorious case of
Nicholas Caputo. Caputo, a member of the Democratic Party, was a public official responsible for
conducting drawings to determine the relative ballot positions of Democrats and Republicans. During
Caputo's tenure, the Democrats drew the top ballot position 40 of 41 times, making it far more likely
that an undecided voter would vote for the Democratic candidate than for the Republican candidate. The
Republican Party filed suit against Caputo, arguing he deliberately rigged the ballot to favor his own
party. After noting that the probability of picking the Democrats 40 out of 41 times was less than 1 in
50 billion, the court legitimately made a design inference, concluding that "few persons of reason will
accept the explanation of blind chance."
What proponents of design arguments for God's existence, however, have not noticed is that each one of
these indubitably legitimate uses occurs in a context in which we are already justified in thinking that
intelligent beings with the right motivations and abilities exist. In every context in which design
inferences are routinely made by scientists, they already have conclusive independent reason for
believing there exist intelligent agents with the right abilities and motivations to bring about the
apparent instance of design.
Consider, for example, how much more information was available to the court in the Caputo case than is
available to the proponent of the design argument for God's existence. Like the proponent of the design
argument, the court knew that (1) the relevant event or feature is something that might be valued by an
intelligent agent; and (2) the odds of it coming about by chance are astronomically small. Unlike the
proponent of the design argument, however, the court had an additional piece of information available to
it: the court already knew that there existed an intelligent agent with the right causal abilities and
motives to bring about the event; after all, there was no dispute whatsoever about the existence of
Caputo. It was that piece of information, together with (1), that enabled the court to justifiably
conclude that the probability that an intelligent agent deliberately brought it about that the Democrats
received the top ballot position 40 of 41 times was significantly higher than the probability that this
happened by chance. Without this crucial piece of information, however, the court would not have been so
obviously justified in making the design inference. Accordingly, while the court was right to infer a
design explanation in the Caputo case, this is, in part, because the judges already knew that the right
kind of intelligent beings exist—and one of them happened to have occupied a position that afforded him
with the opportunity to rig the drawings in favor of the Democrats.
In response, one might be tempted to argue that there is one context in which scientists employ the
design inference without already having sufficient reason to think the right sort of intelligent agency
exists. As is well-known, researchers monitor radio transmissions for patterns that would support a
design inference that such transmissions are sent by intelligent beings. For example, it would be
reasonable to infer that some intelligent extraterrestrial beings were responsible for a transmission of
discrete signals and pauses that effectively enumerated the prime numbers from 2 to 101. In this case,
the intelligibility of the pattern, together with the improbability of its occurring randomly, seems to
justify the inference that the transmission sequence is the result of intelligent design.
As it turns out, we are already justified in thinking that the right sort of intelligent beings exist
even in this case. We already know, after all, that we exist and have the right sort of motivations and
abilities to bring about such transmissions because we send them into space hoping that some other life
form will detect our existence. While our existence in the universe—and this is crucial—does not, by
itself, justify thinking that there are other intelligent life forms in the universe, it does justify
thinking that the probability that there are such life forms is higher than the astronomically small
probability (1 in 21136 to be precise) that a sequence of discrete radio
signals and pauses that enumerates the prime numbers from 2 to 101 is the result of chance. Thus, we
would be justified in inferring design as the explanation of such a sequence on the strength of three
facts: (1) the probability of such a chance occurrence is 1 in 21136; (2)
there exist intelligent beings in the universe capable of bringing about such an occurrence; and (3) the
sequence of discrete signals and pauses has a special significance to intelligent beings. In particular,
(2) and (3) tell us that the probability that design explains such an occurrence is significantly higher
than 1 in 21136—though it is not clear exactly what the probability is.
Insofar as the legitimate application of design inferences presupposes that we have antecedent reason to
believe the right kind of intelligent being exists, they can enable us to distinguish what such beings do from what merely happens. If we already know, for example, that there exist beings
capable of rigging a lottery, then design inferences can enable us to distinguish lottery results that
merely happen from lottery results that are deliberately brought about by such agents. Similarly, if we
already have adequate reason to believe that God exists, then design inferences can enable us to
distinguish features of the world that merely happen from features of the world that are deliberately
brought about by the agency of God. Indeed, to the extent that we are antecedently justified in
believing that God exists, it is obviously more reasonable to believe that God deliberately structured
the universe to have the fine-tuned properties than it is to believe that somehow this occurred by
chance.
If this is correct, then design inferences simply cannot do the job they are asked to do in design
arguments for God's existence. Insofar as they presuppose that we already know the right kind of
intelligent being exists, they cannot stand alone as a justification for believing that God exists. It
is the very existence of the right kind of intelligent being that is at issue in the dispute over whether
God exists. While design inferences have a variety of scientifically legitimate uses, they cannot stand
alone as arguments for God's existence.
4. References and Further Reading
- Michael J. Behe, Darwin's Black Box: The Biochemical Challenge to Evolution (New York:
Touchstone Books, 1996)
- Richard Bentley, A Confutation of Atheism from the Origin and Frame of the World (London: H.
Mortlock, 1692-1693)
- Robin Collins, "A Scientific Argument for the Existence of God," in Michael J. Murray (ed.), Reason
for the Hope Within (Grand Rapids, MI: William B. Eerdmans Publishing Co., 1999)
- Charles Darwin, The Origin of Species, Everyman's Library (London: J.M. Dent, 1947)
- Richard Dawkins, The Blind Watchmaker: Why the Evidence of Evolution Reveals a Universe without
Design (New York: Norton Publishing, 1996; originally published in 1986)
- William Dembski, The Design Inference (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998)
- William Dembski, No Free Lunch: Why Specified Complexity Cannot Be Purchased without Intelligence (Rowman & Littlefield, 2002)
- William Derham, Physico-theology, or, A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God from his
Works of Creation Being the Substance of XVI Sermons Preached in St. Mary le Bow-Church, London, at the
Hon'ble Mr. Boyle's Lectures in the Years 1711 and 1712 (London: W. Innys, 1713)
- William Derham, Astro-theology, or, A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God: From a Survey
of the Heavens (London: W. Innys, 1715)
- Kenneth Einar Himma, "Prior Probabilities and Confirmation Theory: A Problem with the Fine-Tuning
Argument," International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, vol. 51, no. 4 (June 2002)
- Kenneth Einar Himma, "The Application-Conditions for Design Inferences: Why the Design Arguments Need the
Help of Other Arguments for God's Existence,"International Journal for Philosophy of
Religion., vol. 57, no. 1 (February 2005).
- David Hume, Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, edited with an introduction by Norman Kemp
Smith, (New York: Social Sciences Publishers, 1948)
- Julian Huxley, Evolution as Process (New York: Harper and Row, 1953).
- Stephen C. Meyer, "DNA by Design: An Inference to the Best Explanation," Rhetoric and Public
Affairs, vol. 1, no. 4 (Winter 1998)
- Stephen C. Meyer, "Evidence for Design in Physics and Biology: From the Origin of the Universe to the
Origin of Life," in Behe, Dembski, and Meyer (eds.), Science and Evidence for Design in the
Universe (San Francisco: Ignatius Press, 2002)
- William Paley, Natural Theology: Or Evidences of the Existence and Attributes of the Deity Collected
from the Appearances of Nature (Boston: Gould and Lincoln, 1867)
- Del Ratzsch, Nature, Design, and Science: The Status of Design in Natural Science (Albany, NY:
SUNY Press, 2001)
- John Ray, The Wisdom of God Manifested in the Works of the Creation Being the Substance of Some Common
Places Delivered in the Chappel of Trinity-College, in Cambridge (London: Printed for Samuel Smith,
1691)
- Hugh Ross, Beyond the Cosmos: What Recent Discoveries in Astronomy and Physics Reveal about the Nature
of God (Colorado Springs: Nav Press, 1996)
- George N. Schlesinger, New Perspectives on Old-time Religion (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1988)
- Frederick Robert Tennant, Philosophical Theology, Volume 2 (1928-30)
|
