Juan Donoso Cortés (1809-1853), parliamentary statesman, diplomat, government minister, royal
counselor, theologian, and political theorist, may not be well known
among modern political philosophers. However, his ideas had an enormous influence in the spheres of
politics and religion in the nineteenth and twentieth centuries.
Donoso’s theories were uniquely influential in shaping the ideological trajectory that began with the
reaction against the Enlightenment and the French Revolution in
the eighteenth century and culminated in the rise of fascism in the twentieth century. This Spanish
Catholic and conservative thinker was the philosophical heir of
Joseph de Maistre, one of the most prominent reactionary conservative thinkers of the late eighteenth and
early nineteenth centuries. Even though his life was short
and his works few in number, Donoso's contribution to modern political philosophy and theology cannot be
ignored if we wish to have a more complete
understanding of the ideas and actions that have shaped Europe and the Roman Church in recent centuries.
His most notable idea-the theory on dictatorship-was
Donoso’s most significant and unique contribution to modern political thought.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Philosophical Development and Context
In the early years of his life, Donoso's thinking was deeply influenced by the philosophes of the
Enlightenment. His education was thoroughly grounded in the study of such Enlightenment thinkers as
Rousseau, Montesquieu, Voltaire, and Diderot. It was only in the last years of his life that Donoso
distinguished himself as a standard bearer of an ideological camp that stood in complete opposition to
the philosophes. By the year 1848 Donoso was firmly in the camp of such contre-philosophes as Joseph de
Maistre and Louis de Bonald.
Until the European revolution of 1848, the primary concern of reactionary conservative thinkers was the
restoration of the pre-1789 monarchical ancien régime. The authority and hierarchical order that were
the centerpieces of conservative thought, were seen only in the context of restoring and preserving a
monarchical régime. The revolution of 1848 exposed the inability of many of the European monarchies to
maintain authority and hierarchical order. Donoso was one of the first and most vociferous of
conservative thinkers to acknowledge this. While like de Maistre he was something of a romantic
medievalist who advocated a hierarchical social order, with the Pope of Rome at the head of that order
wielding absolute spiritual and temporal power while all other temporal and ecclesiastical authorities
ruled as his deputies, he was also a realist who could strategically adapt his ideology to contemporary
exigencies. He was the first conservative thinker to develop an alternative theory that posited a
different model of régime calculated to achieve the restoration and maintenance of the authority
and hierarchical order that all conservatives saw as the foundation of civilization. This was his theory
on dictatorship. Even though Donoso was always an ardent monarchist, like his precursor de Maistre, he
was also enough of a political realist to know that the ultimate goal of a stable social order based on
obedience to infallible authority and adherence to a rigid hierarchy of rank and privilege could be
achieved by other means, if necessary. If monarchies were too feeble to maintain such a social order,
then other forms of government, more harsh in nature, need to be instituted in order to subjugate human
beings.
2. View of Human Nature
Like de Maistre, Donoso viewed human beings as essentially and naturally depraved and irrational. To
Donoso, human beings are so irredeemably corrupt in moral capacity and intellectually drawn to absurdity
that they must be ruled with an iron fist. All social and religious order depends upon the will of those
who rule to demand and impose obedience to their dictates and belief in their teachings as well as upon
the willingness of subjects to obey and believe their rulers, both secular and religious. Civilization,
according to Donoso, can only be preserved through the imposition and acceptance of political and
religious commands and dogmas. These commands and dogmas are the repressive mechanisms Donoso held as
essential to the survival and preservation of civilization, especially that mode of civilization which
Donoso called "Catholic." Repression, said Donoso, is one of the most essential elements of
civilization. For Donoso, no amount of free and open discussion could ever arrive at any modicum of
truth. He saw truth as revealed by God and mediated through God's chosen instrument, the Catholic Church
and it's Supreme Pontiff. Discussion only opens the door to doubt, confusion, and discord thus preparing
the ground for socialism. Discussion, which Donoso held as the cornerstone of liberalism, creates a
belief vacuum that can only be filled by Christ or Antichrist, by Catholicism or socialism. In a
begrudging sort of way, Donoso respected socialism more than liberalism because he saw the former as more
akin to Catholicism, as something offering human beings a set of dogmatic beliefs. Liberalism can only
offer doubt and uncertainty.
3. Theory of Dictatorship
In his Speech on Dictatorship, Donoso described two different types of repression which he saw
as necessary for the survival and maintenance of civilization-political and religious. These two forms
of repression must exist in an equilibrium in order to be effective. With a decline in religious
repression must come a corresponding and proportional rise in political repression, and vice versa. As
the "thermometer" of religious repression falls, the "thermometer" of political repression must rise; and
as the "thermometer" of political repression falls, so the "thermometer" of religious repression must
rise. All political and religious régimes must be repressive if political and religious order are to
endure. Donoso emphasized that the legitimacy of a régime is not based upon heredity, but upon the
capacity of a régime to be repressive. This constituted a major shift in conservative thinking. Concern
was not focused as much on who should rule, but on how rule is to be exercised. While authority and
hierarchical order remained the conservative ideal, Donoso introduced a degree of realistic pragmatism to
how this ideal could be achieved and preserved. This shift had ominous consequences in the twentieth
century since the door was opened to more radical and ruthless forms of political and religious
control.
a. Religious Dictatorship
In the religious arena, Donoso's ideas on authority influenced the life of the Roman Catholic Church
for over a century. Again echoing the views of de Maistre, Donoso thought that infallibility is an
essential characteristic of authority. Authority is synonymous with infallibility. The power to command
behavior and impose beliefs is not subject to error and must not be seen as subject to error. Without
the exercise of and belief in infallible authority, Donoso thought that people and societies would sink
into a morass of confusion, doubt, and error.
Donoso's theory on infallibility helped to lay the foundation for the doctrine of papal infallibility
that was promulgated by Pope Pius IX in 1870 at the end of the First Vatican Council. His advice was
sought by Pius IX through the papal nuncio to France in the early 1850s, Rafaello Cardinal Fornari, with
regard to the drawing up of a list of religious and philosophical propositions that were to be condemned
as heretical. Donoso's loathing for democracy, freedom of thought, freedom of speech, freedom of
religion, rationalism, liberalism, socialism, pluralism, freedom of expression, and tolerance was
reflected in his Letter to Cardinal Fornari. The ideas asserted in this letter appeared in Pius
IX's decree the Syllabus of Errors.
The repressive methods of governance advocated by Donoso in his theory on dictatorship also influenced
the development of a papal régime that rested upon the absolute exercise of power by the pope over the
Church. Donoso's theories contributed to the development of a totalitarian ideology of papal supremacy
and authority that dominated the Church until the Second Vatican Council in the early 1960s. A
dictatorial papal régime was established by Pius IX that lasted through and reached its zenith during the
pontificate of Pius XII. The Church endured a form of régime and a vision that pitted it in a holy war
against modernity. His theories helped to shape the ideas and vocabulary that justified the establishment
of a strong and centralized papal régime and the persecution of dissident and progressive Catholic
thinkers—"modernists"— who sought to bring about a reconciliation between Christianity and the modern
world.
b. Political Dictatorship
In the political arena, Donoso's influence was just as ominous. His theory of dictatorship and his
critique of liberal democratic parliamentarianism significantly influenced the thinking of the twentieth
century German conservative political theorist Carl Schmitt. Schmitt figured prominently in the
development of the legal principles and structures of the Nazi régime. Schmitt's critique of
parliamentary democracy rests heavily upon arguments first developed by Donoso. Furthermore, Schmitt's
depiction of politics as a constant struggle of friends against enemies reflects Donoso's quasi-Manichæan
view of politics as a war between Catholic civilization and philosophical civilization. Donoso's notion
of infallible authority resonated in the Nazi Führerprinzip, the Italian fascist principle of
Ducismo, and the principle of Caudillaje of the Franco régime in Spain (1936-75). The
emphasis Donoso placed on infallible authority, his contempt of parliamentary democracy, and his support
of dictatorial rule were common features of both conservative authoritarian as well as fascist régimes.
Donoso's ideas were held in high esteem in Spain during the time of the Franco dictatorship and were also
reflected in other conservative authoritarian régimes in Portugal under Salazar and Caetano, France under
Pétain (the Vichy régime), Austria under Dollfuss and Schuschnigg, and Hungary under Horthy.
4. Views on Violence
Donoso's theory on sacrifices, developed in his Ensayo sobre el catolicismo, el liberalismo y el
socialismo, endorsed violence as a social necessity. The spilling of blood by the State is
essential in keeping the repressive equilibrium required to maintain a society. For every drop of blood
spilled in crime, there must be an equal amount of blood spilled in the name of justice if authority and
order are to be preserved. Criminal violence must be balanced with just violence; the violence that
promotes evil must be met with the violence that promotes the good. Donoso saw human beings as so
morally depraved and feeble in intellect that they require dictatorial rulers to regulate their behavior,
priests to tell then what to believe and think, and executioners to punish them when they waver or depart
from the commanded norms of behavior, thought, and belief. Kings, priests, and executioners are the
pillars of civilization.
5. Views on History
Donoso's view of history reflect the influence of St. Augustine, Vico, and Hegel. It combines the
eschatological perspective of Augustine with the historical cycles of Vico and the dialectical process of
Hegel. History is a process of the unfolding of a divine plan guided by Providence toward a specific
end, which is the triumph of good over evil, of Catholic civilization over philosophical civilization.
The process advances in cycles wherein the recurrent theme of good against evil is played out in a
dialectical manner until the end is reached. Each cycle in the dialectical process ends with what Donoso
called the "supernatural triumph of good over evil." The action of divine Providence is essential in
this process. Just as the executioner turns an evil into a good by replacing criminal violence with just
violence, so Providence turns the natural triumph of evil into the supernatural triumph of the good.
Donoso saw the natural triumph of evil in Jesus' death as a supernatural triumph at the same time. The
evil of the crucifixion accomplished the good of human redemption. The evil that afflicts can also be a
good that strengthens and saves. The evil of sin allows God to display the good that is manifested in
his justice and his mercy. History is the playing out of this drama in a cyclic and dialectically
structured process guided by divine Providence toward a definite conclusion-the ultimate triumph of good
over evil. Catholic civilization, which Donoso depicted as totally good, will ultimately crush and
triumph over that evil he called philosophical civilization.
Donoso can also be seen as a modern-day Cassandra uttering prophecies of apocalyptic doom. He saw the
development of modern technology, symbolized by the telegraph for him, and the establishment of mass
permanent armies and police forces as potential instruments in the hands of a future godless and
socialistic tyranny. All of his efforts in the arenas of politics, philosophy, and religion were aimed
at preventing the rise of such an evil. Revolution had to be met with counterrevolution, anarchy with
dictatorship, freethinking with dogma, doubt with certainty, and discussion with decree. The ultimate
battle for Donoso was to be a quasi-Manichæan struggle between Catholicism and socialism, or Catholic
civilization and philosophical civilization, two systems of belief in a combat to the death for the
control of societies and souls.
6. Select Bibliography
Works by Juan Donoso Cortés:
Juan Donoso Cortés, Antologia de Juan Donoso Cortés, edited by Francisco Elías de
Tejada (Madrid: Editorial
Tradicionalista, 1953)
Artículos políticos en "El Porvenir," edited by Federico Súarez Verdeguer (Pamplona: Ediciones
Universidad de Navarra, 1992
Donoso Cortés y la fundación de "El Heraldo" y "El Sol," edited by Federico Súarez
Verdeguer (Pamplona: Ediciones Universidad de
Navarra, 1986)
Essai sur le catholicisme, le libéralisme et le socialisme, introduction by Arnaud Imatz
(Bouère: Editions Dominique Martin Morin, 1986). French translation of the Ensayo sobre el
catolicismo, el liberalismo y el socialismo
Essay on Catholicism, Liberalism, and Order, translated by Madeleine Vincent Goddard, edited J.
C. Reville (New York: Joseph F. Wagner, 1925). English translation of the Ensayo
Essays on Catholicism, Liberalism, and Socialism, translated by Rev. William McDonald (Dublin: M.
H. Gill and Son, 1879). The second English translation of the Ensayo
Der Staat Gottes, translated by Ludwig Fischer (Darmstadt: Wissenschaftliche Buchgesellschaft,
1966). German translation of the Ensayo
Obras completas de Don Juan Donoso Cortés, 2 vols., edited by Juan Juretschke (Madrid:
Biblioteca de Autores Cristianos, 1946)
Obras completas de Donoso Cortés, 2 vols., edited by Carlos Valverde, S.J., (Madrid:
Biblioteca de Autores Cristianos, 1970)
Selected Works of Juan Donoso Cortés, translated, edited, and introduced by Jeffrey P.
Johnson (Wesport: Greenwood Press, 2000)
"Speech on Dictatorship," in Catholic Political Thought: 1789-1848, edited by Bela Menczer (South
Bend: University of Notre Dame Press, 1962).
Works on Juan Donoso Cortés:
Gabriel de Armas, Donoso Cortés: su sentido trascendente de la vida (Madrid: Colección
Cálamo, 1953)
Orestes Brownson, Orestes Brownson: Selected Essays, edited by Russell Kirk (Chicago: Regnery,
1955)
Catholic Encyclopedia, 1909 edition, s.v. "Donoso Cortés," by Condé B. Pallen;
Jules Chaix-Ruy Donoso Cortés: Théologien de l'histoire et prophète (Paris:
Beauchesne, 1956)
Alois Dempf, Christliche Staatsphilosophie in Spanien (Salzburg: Verlag Anton Pustet, 1937)
John T. Graham, Donoso Cortés: Utopian Romanticist and Political Realist (Columbia:
University of Missouri Press, 1974)
R. A. Herrera, Donoso Cortés: Cassandra of the Age (Grand Rapids: Eerdmans, 1995); Ramon
Menéndez Pidal, La historia de España: la era Isabelina y el sexenio democrático
(1834-1874), vol. XXXIV (Madrid: Espasa Calpe, 1981)
Raúl Sánchez Abelenda, La teoría del poder en el pensamiento político de Juan Donoso
Cortés (Buenos Aires: Editorial Universitaria de Buenos Aires, 1969); Carl Schmitt, La
interpretación europea de Donoso Cortés (Madrid: Rialp, 1953)
Political Theology, translated by George Schwab (Cambridge: MIT Press, 1985); Edmund Schramm, Donoso
Cortés: ejemplo del pensamiento de la tradición, (Madrid: Publicaciones Españolas, 1961)
Donoso Cortés: Su vida y su pensamiento (Madrid: Espasa Calpe, 1936)
Federico Súarez Verdeger, Introducción a Donoso Cortés (Madrid: Rialp, 1964)
Carlos Valverde, S.J., "Introducción" in Obras completas de Donoso Cortés, vol. 1,
edited by Carlos Valverde, S.J. ( Madrid: Biblioteca de Autores Cristianos, 1970); Dietmar Westemeyer,
Donoso Cortés, hombre de estado y teólogo, translated by J. S. Mazpule (Madrid:
Editora Nacional, 1957)
Frederick D. Wilhelmsen, Christianity and Political Philosophy (Athens: University of Georgia
Press, 1978); Francis G. Wilson, Political Thought in National Spain (Champaign: Stipes, 1967).
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