This entry examines the philosophical basis and content of the doctrine of human rights. The analysis consists of five
sections and a conclusion. Section one assesses the contemporary significance of human rights, and argues that the
doctrine of human rights has become the dominant moral doctrine for evaluating the moral status of the contemporary
geo-political order. Section two proceeds to chart the historical development of the concept of human rights, beginning
with a discussion of the earliest philosophical origins of the philosophical bases of human rights and culminating in
some of most recent developments in the codification of human rights. Section three considers the philosophical concept
of a human right and analyses the formal and substantive distinctions philosophers have drawn between various forms and
categories of rights. Section four addresses the question of how philosophers have sought to justify the claims of human
rights and specifically charts the arguments presented by the two presently dominant approaches in this field: interest
theory and will theory. Section five then proceeds to discuss some of the main criticisms currently levelled at the
doctrine of human rights and highlights some of the main arguments of those who have challenged the universalist and
objectivist bases of human rights. Finally, a brief conclusion is presented, summarising the main themes addressed.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Introduction: the contemporary significance of human rights
Human rights have been defined as 'basic moral guarantees that people in all countries and cultures allegedly have
simply because they are people. Calling these guarantees "rights" suggests that they attach to particular individuals
who can invoke them, that they are of high priority, and that compliance with them is mandatory rather than
discretionary. Human rights are frequently held to be universal in the sense that all people have and should enjoy them,
and to be independent in the sense that they exist and are available as standards of justification and criticism whether
or not they are recognized and implemented by the legal system or officials of a country.' (Nickel, 1992:561-2) The
moral doctrine of human rights aims at identifying the fundamental prerequisites for each human being leading a
minimally good life. Human rights aim to identify both the necessary negative and positive prerequisites for leading a
minimally good life, such as rights against torture and rights to health care. This aspiration has been enshrined in
various declarations and legal conventions issued during the past fifty years, initiated by the Universal Declaration of
Human Rights (1948) and perpetuated by, most importantly, the European Convention on Human Rights (1954) and the
International Covenant on Civil and Economic Rights (1966). Together these three documents form the centrepiece of a
moral doctrine that many consider to be capable of providing the contemporary geo-political order with what amounts to
an international bill of rights. However, the doctrine of human rights does not aim to be a fully comprehensive moral
doctrine. An appeal to human rights does not provide us with a fully comprehensive account of morality per se. Human
rights do not, for example, provide us with criteria for answering such questions as whether telling lies is inherently
immoral, or what the extent of one's moral obligations to friends and lovers ought to be? What human rights do primarily
aim to identify is the basis for determining the shape, content, and scope of fundamental, public moral norms. As James
Nickel states, human rights aim to secure for individuals the necessary conditions for leading a minimally good life.
Public authorities, both national and international, are identified as typically best placed to secure these conditions
and so, the doctrine of human rights has become, for many, a first port of moral call for determining the basic moral
guarantees all of us have a right to expect, both of one another but also, primarily, of those national and
international institutions capable of directly affecting our most important interests. The doctrine of human rights
aspires to provide the contemporary, allegedly post-ideological, geo-political order with a common framework for
determining the basic economic, political, and social conditions required for all individuals to lead a minimally good
life. While the practical efficacy of promoting and protecting human rights is significantly aided by individual
nation-states' legally recognising the doctrine, the ultimate validity of human rights is characteristically thought of
as not conditional upon such recognition. The moral justification of human rights is thought to precede considerations
of strict national sovereignty. An underlying aspiration of the doctrine of human rights is to provide a set of
legitimate criteria to which all nation-states should adhere. Appeals to national sovereignty should not provide a
legitimate means for nation-states to permanently opt out of their fundamental human rights-based commitments. Thus, the
doctrine of human rights is ideally placed to provide individuals with a powerful means for morally auditing the
legitimacy of those contemporary national and international forms of political and economic authority which confront us
and which claim jurisdiction over us. This is no small measure of the contemporary moral and political significance of
the doctrine of human rights. For many of its most strident supporters, the doctrine of human rights aims to provide a
fundamentally legitimate moral basis for regulating the contemporary geo-political order.
2. Historical origins and development of the theory and practice of human rights
The doctrine of human rights rests upon a particularly fundamental philosophical claim: that there exists a rationally
identifiable moral order, an order whose legitimacy precedes contingent social and historical conditions and applies to
all human beings everywhere and at all times. On this view, moral beliefs and concepts are capable of being objectively
validated as fundamentally and universally true. The contemporary doctrine of human rights is one of a number of
universalist moral perspectives. The origins and development of the theory of human rights is inextricably tied to the
development of moral universalism. The history of the philosophical development of human rights is punctuated by a
number of specific moral doctrines which, though not themselves full and adequate expressions of human rights, have
nevertheless provided a number of philosophical prerequisites for the contemporary doctrine. These include a view of
morality and justice as emanating from some pre-social domain, the identification of which provides the basis for
distinguishing between 'true' and merely ‘conventional’ moral principles and beliefs. The essential prerequisites for a
defence of human rights also include a conception of the individual as the bearer of certain 'natural' rights and a
particular view of the inherent and equal moral worth of each rational individual. I shall discuss each in turn.
Human rights rest upon moral universalism and the belief in the existence of a truly universal moral community
comprising all human beings. Moral universalism posits the existence of rationally identifiable trans-cultural and
trans-historical moral truths. The origins of moral universalism within Europe are typically associated with the
writings of Aristotle and the Stoics. Thus, in his Nicomachean Ethics, Aristotle unambiguously expounds an
argument in support of the existence of a natural moral order. This natural order ought to provide the basis for all
truly rational systems of justice. An appeal to the natural order provides a set of comprehensive and potentially
universal criteria for evaluating the legitimacy of actual 'man-made' legal systems. In distinguishing between ‘natural
justice' and 'legal justice’, Aristotle writes, ‘the natural is that which has the same validity everywhere and does not
depend upon acceptance.' (Nicomachean Ethics, 189) Thus, the criteria for determining a truly rational system of
justice pre-exist social and historical conventions. 'Natural justice' pre-exists specific social and political
configurations. The means for determining the form and content of natural justice is the exercise of reason free from
the distorting effects of mere prejudice or desire. This basic idea was similarly expressed by the Roman Stoics, such as
Cicero and Seneca, who argued that morality originated in the rational will of God and the existence of a cosmic city
from which one could discern a natural, moral law whose authority transcended all local legal codes. The Stoics' argued
that this ethically universal code imposed upon all of us a duty to obey the will of god. The Stoics thereby posited the
existence of a universal moral community effected through our shared relationship with god. The belief in the existence
of a universal moral community was maintained in Europe by Christianity over the ensuing centuries. While some have
discerned intimations towards the notion of rights in the writings of Aristotle, the Stoics, and Christian theologians,
a concept of rights approximating that of the contemporary idea of human rights most clearly emerges during the 17th.
And 18th. Centuries in Europe and the so-called doctrine of natural law.
The basis of the doctrine of natural law is the belief in the existence of a natural moral code based upon the
identification of certain fundamental and objectively verifiable human goods. Our enjoyment of these basic goods is to
be secured by our possession of equally fundamental and objectively verifiable natural rights. Natural law was deemed to
pre-exist actual social and political systems. Natural rights were thereby similarly presented as rights individuals
possessed independently of society or polity. Natural rights were thereby presented as ultimately valid irrespective of
whether they had achieved the recognition of any given political ruler or assembly. The quintessential exponent of this
position was the 17th. Century philosopher John Locke and, in particular, the argument he outlined in his Two
Treatises of Government (1688). At the centre of Locke's argument is the claim that individuals possess natural
rights, independently of the political recognition granted them by the state. These natural rights are possessed
independently of, and prior to, the formation of any political community. Locke argued that natural rights flowed from
natural law. Natural law originated from God. Accurately discerning the will of God provided us with an ultimately
authoritative moral code. At root, each of us owes a duty of self-preservation to God. In order to successfully
discharge this duty of self-preservation each individual had to be free from threats to life and liberty, whilst also
requiring what Locke presented as the basic, positive means for self-preservation: personal property. Our duty of
self-preservation to god entailed the necessary existence of basic natural rights to life, liberty, and property. Locke
proceeded to argue that the principal purpose of the investiture of political authority in a sovereign state was the
provision and protection of individuals' basic natural rights. For Locke, the protection and promotion of individuals’
natural rights was the sole justification for the creation of government. The natural rights to life, liberty, and
property set clear limits to the authority and jurisdiction of the State. States were presented as existing to serve the
interests, the natural rights, of the people, and not of a Monarch or a ruling cadre. Locke went so far as to argue that
individuals are morally justified in taking up arms against their government should it systematically and deliberately
fail in its duty to secure individuals' possession of natural rights.
Analyses of the historical predecessors of the contemporary theory of human rights typically accord a high degree of
importance to Locke's contribution. Certainly, Locke provided the precedent of establishing legitimate political
authority upon a rights foundation. This is an undeniably essential component of human rights. However, the
philosophically adequate completion of theoretical basis of human rights requires an account of moral reasoning, that is
both consistent with the concept of rights, but which does not necessarily require an appeal to the authority of some
super-human entity in justifying human beings' claims to certain, fundamental rights. The 18th. Century German
philosopher, Immanuel Kant provides such an account.
Many of the central themes first expressed within Kant's moral philosophy remain highly prominent in contemporary
philosophical justifications of human rights. Foremost amongst these are the ideals of equality and the moral autonomy
of rational human beings. Kant bestows upon contemporary human rights' theory the ideal of a potentially universal
community of rational individuals autonomously determining the moral principles for securing the conditions for equality
and autonomy. Kant provides a means for justifying human rights as the basis for self-determination grounded within the
authority of human reason. Kant's moral philosophy is based upon an appeal to the formal principles of ethics, rather
than, for example, an appeal to a concept of substantive human goods. For Kant, the determination of any such goods can
only proceed from a correct determination of the formal properties of human reason and thus do not provide the ultimate
means for determining the correct ends, or object, of human reason. Kant's moral philosophy begins with an attempt to
correctly identify those principles of reasoning that can be applied equally to all rational persons, irrespective of
their own specific desires or partial interests. In this way, Kant attaches a condition of universality to the correct
identification of moral principles. For him, the basis of moral reasoning must rest upon a condition that all rational
individuals are bound to assent to. Doing the right thing is thus not determined by acting in pursuit of one's own
interests or desires, but acting in accordance with a maxim which all rational individuals are bound to accept. Kant
terms this the categorical imperative, which he formulates in the following terms, 'act only on that maxim through which
you can at the same time will that it should become a universal law.' (1948:84). Kant argues that this basic condition
of universality in determining the moral principles for governing human relations is a necessary expression of the moral
autonomy and fundamental equality of all rational individuals. The categorical imperative is self-imposed by morally
autonomous and formally equal rational persons. It provides the basis for determining the scope and form of those laws
which morally autonomous and equally rational individuals will institute in order to secure these very same conditions.
For Kant, the capacity for the exercise of reason is the distinguishing characteristic of humanity and the basis for
justifying human dignity. As the distinguishing characteristic of humanity, formulating the principles of the exercise
of reason must necessarily satisfy a test of universality; they must be capable of being universally recognized by all
equally rational agents. Hence, Kant's formulation of the categorical imperative. Kant’s moral philosophy is notoriously
abstract and resists easy comprehension. Though often overlooked in accounts of the historical development of human
rights, his contribution to human rights has been profound. Kant provides a formulation of fundamental moral principles
that, though exceedingly formal and abstract, are based upon the twin ideals of equality and moral autonomy. Human
rights are rights we give to ourselves, so to speak, as autonomous and formally equal beings. For Kant, any such rights
originate in the formal properties of human reason, and not the will of some super-human being.
The philosophical ideas defended by the likes of Locke and Kant have come to be associated with the general
Enlightenment project initiated during the 17th. and 18th. Centuries, the effects of which were to extend across the
globe and over ensuing centuries. Ideals such as natural rights, moral autonomy, human dignity and equality provided a
normative bedrock for attempts at re-constituting political systems, for overthrowing formerly despotic regimes and
seeking to replace them with forms of political authority capable of protecting and promoting these new emancipatory
ideals. These ideals effected significant, even revolutionary, political upheavals throughout the 18th. Century,
enshrined in such documents as the United States' Declaration of Independence and the French National Assembly’s
Declaration of the Rights of Man and Citizen. Similarly, the concept of individual rights continued to resound
throughout the 19th. Century exemplified by Mary Wollstencraft's Vindication of the Rights of Women and other
political movements to extend political suffrage to sections of society who had been denied the possession of political
and civil rights. The concept of rights had become a vehicle for effecting political change. Though one could argue that
the conceptual prerequisites for the defence of human rights had long been in place, a full Declaration of the doctrine
of human rights only finally occurred during the 20th. Century and only in response to the most atrocious violations of
human rights, exemplified by the Holocaust. The Universal Declaration of Human Rights (UDHR) was adopted by the UN
General Assembly on 10th. December 1948 and was explicitly motivated to prevent the future occurrence of any similar
atrocities. The Declaration itself goes far beyond any mere attempt to reassert all individuals' possession of the right
to life as a fundamental and inalienable human right. The UDHR consists of a Preamble and 30 articles which separately
identify such things as the right not to be tortured (article 5), a right to asylum (article 14), a right to own
property (article 17), and a right to an adequate standard of living (article 25) as being fundamental human rights. As
I noted earlier, the UDHR has been further supplemented by such documents as the European Convention for the Protection
of Human Rights and Fundamental Freedoms (1953) and the International Covenant on Economic, Social and Cultural Rights
(1966). The specific aspirations contained within these three documents have themselves been reinforced by innumerable
other Declarations and Conventions. Taken together these various Declarations, conventions and covenants comprise the
contemporary human rights doctrine and embody both the belief in the existence of a universally valid moral order and a
belief in all human beings' possession of fundamental and equal moral status, enshrined within the concept of human
rights. It is important to note, however, that the contemporary doctrine of human rights, whilst deeply indebted to the
concept of natural rights, is not a mere expression of that concept but actually goes beyond it in some highly
significant respects. James Nickel ( 1987: 8-10) identifies three specific ways in which the contemporary concept of
human rights differs from, and goes beyond that of natural rights. First, he argues that contemporary human rights are
far more concerned to view the realization of equality as requiring positive action by the state, via the provision of
welfare assistance, for example. Advocates of natural rights, he argues, were far more inclined to view equality in
formalistic terms, as principally requiring the state to refrain from 'interfering' in individuals’ lives. Second, he
argues that, whereas advocates of natural rights tended to conceive of human beings as mere individuals, veritable
'islands unto themselves', advocates of contemporary human rights are far more willing to recognize the importance of
family and community in individuals' lives. Third, Nickel views contemporary human rights as being far more
'internationalist' in scope and orientation than was typically found within arguments in support of natural rights. That
is to say, the protection and promotion of human rights are increasingly seen as requiring international action and
concern. The distinction drawn by Nickel between contemporary human rights and natural rights allows one to discern the
development of the concept of human rights. Indeed, many writers on human rights agree in the identification of three
generations of human rights. First generation rights consist primarily of rights to security, property, and political
participation. These are most typically associated with the French and US Declarations. Second generation rights are
construed as socio-economic rights, rights to welfare, education, and leisure, for example. These rights largely
originate within the UDHR. The final and third generation of rights are associated with such rights as a right to
national self-determination, a clean environment, and the rights of indigenous minorities. This generation of rights
really only takes hold during the last two decades of the 20th. Century but represents a significant development within
the doctrine of human rights generally.
While the full significance of human rights may only be finally dawning on some people, the concept itself has a
history spanning over two thousand years. The development of the concept of human rights is punctuated by the emergence
and assimilation of various philosophical and moral ideals and appears to culminate, at least to our eyes, in the
establishment of a highly complex set of legal and political documents and institutions, whose express purpose is the
protection and promotion of the fundamental rights of all human beings everywhere. Few should underestimate the
importance of this particular current of human history.
3. Philosophical analysis of the concept of human rights
Human rights are rights that attach to human beings and function as moral guarantees in support of our claims towards
the enjoyment of a minimally good life. In conceptual terms, human rights are themselves derivative of the concept of a
right. This section focuses upon the philosophical analysis of the concept of a 'right' in order to clearly demonstrate
the various constituent parts of the concept from which human rights emerges. In order to gain a full understanding of
both the philosophical foundations of the doctrine of human rights and the different ways in which separate human rights
function, a detailed analysis is required.
a. Moral vs. Legal Rights
The distinction drawn between moral rights and legal rights as two separate categories of rights is of fundamental
importance to understanding the basis and potential application of human rights. Legal rights refer to all those rights
found within existing legal codes. A legal right is a right that enjoys the recognition and protection of the law.
Questions as to its existence can be resolved by simply locating the relevant legal instrument or piece of legislation.
A legal right cannot be said to exist prior to its passing into law and the limits of its validity are set by the
jurisdiction of the body which passed the relevant legislation. An example of a legal right would be my daughter's legal
right to receive an adequate education, as enshrined within the United Kingdom's Education Act (1944). Suffice it to
say, that the exercise of this right is limited to the United Kingdom. My daughter has no legal right to receive an
adequate education from a school board in Southern California. Legal positivists argue that the only rights that can be
said to legitimately exist are legal rights, rights that originate within a legal system. On this view, moral rights are
not rights in the strict sense, but are better thought of as moral claims, which may or may not eventually be
assimilated within national or international law. For a legal positivist, such as the 19th. Century legal philosopher
Jeremy Bentham, there can be no such thing as human rights existing prior to, or independently from legal codification.
For a positivist determining the existence of rights is no more complicated than locating the relevant legal statute or
precedent. In stark contrast, moral rights are rights that, it is claimed, exist prior to and independently from their
legal counterparts. The existence and validity of a moral right is not deemed to be dependent upon the actions of
jurists and legislators. Many people argued, for example, that the black majority in apartheid South Africa possessed a
moral right to full political participation in that country's political system, even though there existed no such legal
right. What is interesting is that many people framed their opposition to apartheid in rights terms. What many found so
morally repugnant about apartheid South Africa was precisely its denial of numerous fundamental moral rights, including
the rights not to be discriminated against on grounds of colour and rights to political participation, to the majority
of that country's inhabitants. This particular line of opposition and protest could only be pursued because of a belief
in the existence and validity of moral rights. A belief that fundamental rights which may or may not have received legal
recognition elsewhere, remained utterly valid and morally compelling even, and perhaps especially, in those countries
whose legal systems had not recognized these rights. A rights-based opposition to apartheid South Africa could not have
been initiated and maintained by appeal to legal rights, for obvious reasons. No one could legitimately argue that the
legal political rights of non-white South Africans were being violated under apartheid, since no such legal rights
existed. The systematic denial of such rights did, however, constitute a gross violation of those peoples' fundamental
moral rights.
From the above example it should be clear that human rights cannot be reduced to, or exclusively identified with
legal rights. The legal positivist's account of justified law excludes the possibility of condemning such systems as
apartheid from a rights perspective. It might, therefore, appear tempting to draw the conclusion that human rights are
best identified as moral rights. After all, the existence of the UDHR and various International Covenants, to which
South Africa was not a signatory in most cases, provided opponents of apartheid with a powerful moral argument.
Apartheid was founded upon the denial of fundamental human rights. Human rights certainly share an essential quality of
moral rights, namely, that their valid existence is not deemed to be conditional upon their being legally recognized.
Human rights are meant to apply to all human beings everywhere, regardless of whether they have received legal
recognition by all countries everywhere. Clearly, there remain numerous countries that wholly or partially exclude
formal legal recognition to fundamental human rights. Supporters of human rights in these countries insist that the
rights remain valid regardless, as fundamental moral rights. The universality of human rights positively entails such
claims. The universality of human rights as moral rights clearly lends greater moral force to human rights. However, for
their part, legal rights are not subject to disputes as to their existence and validity in quite the way moral rights
are. It would be a mistake to exclusively identify human rights with moral rights. Human rights are better thought of as
both moral rights and legal rights. Human rights originate as moral rights and their legitimacy is necessarily dependent
upon the legitimacy of the concept of moral rights. A principal aim of advocates of human rights is for these rights to
receive universal legal recognition. This was, after all, a fundamental goal of the opponents of apartheid. Human rights
are best thought of, therefore, as being both moral and legal rights. The legitimacy claims of human rights are tied to
their status as moral rights. The practical efficacy of human rights is, however, largely dependent upon their
developing into legal rights. In those cases where specific human rights do not enjoy legal recognition, such as in the
example of apartheid above, moral rights must be prioritised with the intention that defending the moral claims of such
rights as a necessary prerequisite for the eventual legal recognition of the rights in question.
b. Claim Rights & Liberty Rights
To gain an understanding of the functional properties of human rights it is necessary to consider the more specific
distinction drawn between claim rights and liberty rights. It should be noted that it is something of a convention to
begin such discussions by reference to W.N. Hohfeld's (1919) more extended classification of rights. Hohfeld identified
four categories of rights: liberty rights, claim rights, power rights, and immunity rights. However, numerous scholars
have subsequently tended to collapse the last two within the first two and hence to restrict attention to liberty rights
and claim rights. The political philosopher Peter Jones (1994) provides one such example.
Jones restricts his focus to the distinction between claim rights and liberty rights. He conforms to a
well-established trend in rights' analysis in viewing the former as being of primary importance. Jones defines a claim
right as consisting of being owed a duty. A claim right is a right one holds against another person or persons who owe a
corresponding duty to the right holder. To return to the example of my daughter. Her right to receive an adequate
education is a claim right held against the local education authority, which has a corresponding duty to provide her
with the object of the right. Jones identifies further necessary distinctions within the concept of a claim right when
he distinguishes between a positive claim right and a negative claim right. The former are rights one holds to some
specific good or service, which some other has a duty to provide. My daughter's claim right to education is therefore a
positive claim right. Negative claim rights, in contrast, are rights one holds against others' interfering in or
trespassing upon one's life or property in some way. My daughter could be said to possess a negative claim right against
others attempting to steal her mobile phone, for example. Indeed, such examples lead on to the final distinction Jones
identifies within the concept of claim rights: rights held 'in personam' and rights held ‘in rem’. Rights held in
personam are rights one holds against some specifically identified duty holder, such as the education authority. In
contrast, rights held in rem are rights held against no one in particular, but apply to everyone. Thus, my daughter's
right to an education would be practically useless were it not held against some identifiable, relevant, and competent
body. Equally, her right against her mobile phone being stolen from her would be highly limited if it did not apply to
all those capable of potentially performing such an act. Claim rights, then, can be of either a positive or a negative
character and they can be held either in personam or in rem.
Jones defines liberty rights as rights which exist in the absence of any duties not to perform some desired activity
and thus consist of those actions one is not prohibited from performing. In contrast to claim rights, liberty rights are
primarily negative in character. For example, I may be said to possess a liberty right to spend my vacations lying on a
particularly beautiful beach in Greece. Unfortunately, no one has a duty to positively provide for this particular
exercise of my liberty right. There is no authority or body, equivalent to an education authority, for example, who has
a responsibility to realize my dream for me. A liberty right can be said, then, to be a right to do as one pleases
precisely because one is not under an obligation, grounded in others' claim rights, to refrain from so acting. Liberty
rights provide for the capacity to be free, without actually providing the specific means by which one may pursue the
objects of one's will. For example, a multi-millionaire and a penniless vagrant both possess an equal liberty right to
holiday in the Caribbean each year.
c. Substantive categories of human rights
The above section was concerned to analyse what might be termed the 'formal properties' of rights. This section, in
contrast, proceeds to consider the different categories of substantive human rights. If one delves into all of the
various documents that together form the codified body of human rights, one can identify and distinguish between five
different categories of substantive human rights. These are as follows: rights to life; rights to freedom; rights to
political participation; rights to the protection of the rule of law; rights to fundamental social, economic, and
cultural goods. These rights span the so-called three generations of rights and involve a complex combination of both
liberty and claim rights. Some rights, such as for example the right to life, consist of both liberty and claim rights
in roughly equal measure. Thus, the adequate protection of the right to life requires the existence of liberty rights
against others trespassing against one's person and the existence of claim rights to have access to basic prerequisites
to sustaining one's life, such as an adequate diet and health-care. Other rights, such as social, economic, and cultural
rights, for example, are weighted more heavily towards the existence of various claim rights, which requires the
positive provision of the objects of such rights. The making of substantive distinctions between human rights can have
controversial, but important, consequences. Human rights are typically understood to be of equal value, each right is
conceived of as equally important as every other. On this view, there can exist no potential for conflict between
fundamental human rights. One is simply meant to attach equal moral weight to each and every human right. This prohibits
arranging human rights in order of importance. However, conflict between rights can and does occur. Treating all human
rights as of equal importance prohibits any attempts to address or resolve such conflict when it arises. Take the
example of a hypothetical developing world country with severely limited financial and material resources. This country
is incapable of providing the resources for realising all of the human rights for all of its citizens, though it is
committed to doing so. In the meantime, government officials wish to know which human rights are more absolute than
others, which fundamental human rights should it immediately prioritise and seek to provide for? This question, of
course, cannot be answered if one sticks to the position that all rights are of equal importance. It can only be
addressed if one allows for the possibility that some human rights are more fundamental than others and that the morally
correct action for the government to take would be to prioritise these rights. A refusal to do so, no matter how
consistent it may be philosophically would be tantamount to dogmatically sticking one's head in the metaphorical sands.
Attempting to make such distinctions is, of course, a philosophically fraught exercise. It clearly requires the
existence of some more ultimate criteria against which one can 'measure' the relative importance of separate human
rights. This is a highly controversial issue within the philosophy of human rights and one which I shall return to when
I consider how philosophers attempt to justify the doctrine of human rights. What remains to be addressed in our
analysis of the concept of a human right are the questions of what adequately implementing human rights generally
requires, and upon whom does this task fall; who has responsibility for protecting and promoting human rights and what
is required of them to do so?
d. Scope of human rights duties
Human rights are said to be possessed equally, by everyone. A conventional corollary of this claim is that everyone has
a duty to protect and promote the human rights of everyone else. However, in practice, the onus for securing human
rights typically falls upon national governments and international, inter-governmental bodies. Philosophers such as
Thomas Pogge (1995) argue that the moral burden for securing human rights should fall disproportionately upon such
institutions precisely because they are best placed and most able to effectively perform the task. On this reading,
non-governmental organizations and private citizens have an important role to play in supporting the global protection
of human rights, but the onus must fall upon the relevant national and international institutions, such as the
governments of nation-states and such bodies as the United Nations and the World Bank. One might wish to argue that, for
example, human rights can be adequately secured by the existence of reciprocal duties held between individuals across
the globe. However, 'privatizing' human rights in this fashion would ignore two particularly salient factors:
individuals have a tendency to prioritise the moral demands of those closest to them, particularly members of their own
family or immediate community; individuals' ability to exercise their duties is, to a large extent, determined by their
own personal financial circumstances. Thus, global inequalities in the distribution of wealth fundamentally undermine
the ability of those in the poorer countries to reciprocate assistance provided them by those living in wealthier
countries. Reasons such as these underlie Pogge's insistence that the onus of responsibility lies at the level of
national and international institutions. Adequately protecting and promoting human rights requires both nation-states
ensuring the adequate provision of services and institutions for their own citizens and the co-operation of
nation-states within international institutions acting to secure the requisite global conditions for the protection and
promotion of everyone's human rights.
What must such bodies actively do to adequately secure individuals' human rights? Does my daughter’s human right to
receive an adequate education require the education authority to do everything possible to assist and enhance my child's
education? Does it require the provision of a world-class library, frequent study trips abroad, and employing the most
able and best-qualified teachers? The answer is, of course, no. Given the relative scarcity of resources and the demands
placed upon those resources, we are inclined to say that adequately securing individuals' human rights extends to the
establishment of decent social and governmental practice so as to ensure that all individuals have the opportunity of
leading a minimally good life. In the first instance, national governments are typically held to be primarily
responsible for the adequate provision of their own citizens' human rights. Philosophers such as Brian Orend (2002)
endorse this aspiration when he writes that the object of human rights is to secure 'minimal levels of decent and
respectful treatment.' It is important to note, however, that the duty ensure the provision of even minimal levels of
decent and respectful treatment cannot be strictly limited by national boundaries. The adequate protection and promotion
of everyone's human rights does require, for example, the more affluent and powerful nation-states providing sufficient
assistance to those countries currently incapable of adequately ensuring the protection of their own citizens' basic
human rights. While some may consider Orend's aspirations for human rights to be unduly cautious, even the briefest
survey of the extent of human suffering and deprivation in many parts of the world today is sufficient to demonstrate
just how far we are from realizing even this fairly minimal standard.
National and international institutions bear the primary responsibility of securing human rights and the test for
successfully fulfilling this responsibility is the creation of opportunities for all individuals to lead a minimally
good life. The realization of human rights requires establishing the conditions for all human beings to lead minimally
good lives and thus should not be confused as an attempt to create a morally perfect society. The impression that many
have of human rights as being unduly utopian testifies less to the inherent demands of human rights and more to the
extent to which even fairly modest aspirations are so far from being realized in the world today. The actual aspirations
of human rights are, on the face of it, quite modest. However, this should not distract from a full appreciation of the
possible force of human rights. Human rights call for the creation of politically democratic societies in which all
citizens have the means of leading a minimally good life. While the object of individual human rights may be modest, the
force of that right is intended to be near absolute. That is to say, the demands of rights are meant to take precedence
over other possible social goals. Ronald Dworkin has coined the term 'rights as trumps' to describe this property. He
writes that, 'rights are best understood as trumps over some background justification for political decisions that
states a goal for the community as a whole.' (1977:153) In general, Dworkin argues, considerations of rights claims must
take priority over alternative considerations when formulating public policy and distributing public benefits. Thus, for
example, a minority's possession of rights against discriminatory treatment should trump any and all considerations of
the possible benefits that the majority would derive from discriminating against the minority group. Similarly, an
individual's right to an adequate diet should trump other individuals’ desires to eat lavish meals, despite the
aggregate gain in pleasure these individuals would derive. For Dworkin, rights as trumps expresses the fundamental ideal
of equality upon which the contemporary doctrine of human rights rests. Treating rights as trumps is a means for
ensuring that all individuals are treated in an equal and like fashion in respect of the provision of fundamental human
rights. Fully realizing the aspirations of human rights may not require the provision of 'state of the art' resources,
but this should not detract from the force of human rights as taking priority over alternative social and political
considerations.
4. Philosophical justifications of human rights
We have established that human rights originate as moral rights but that the successful passage of many human rights
into international and national law enables one to think of human rights as, in many cases, both moral rights and legal
rights. Furthermore, human rights may be either claim rights or liberty rights, and have a negative or a positive
complexion in respect of the obligations imposed by others in securing the right. Human rights may be divided into five
different categories and the principal object of securing human rights is the creation of the conditions for all
individuals to have the opportunity to lead a minimally good life. Finally, human rights are widely considered to trump
other social and political considerations in the allocation of public resources. Broadly speaking, philosophers
generally agree on such issues as the formal properties of human rights, the object of human rights, and the force of
human rights. However, there is much less agreement upon the fundamental question on how human rights may be
philosophically justified. It would be fair to say that philosophers have provided many different, at times even
conflicting, answers to this question. Philosophers have sought to justify human rights by appeal to single ideals such
as equality, autonomy, human dignity, fundamental human interests, the capacity for rational agency, and even democracy.
For the purposes of clarity and relative simplicity I will focus upon the two, presently most prominent, philosophical
attempts to justify human rights: interests theory and will theory. Before I do that, it is necessary to address a prior
question.
a. Do human rights require philosophical justification?
Many people tend to take the validity of human rights for granted. Certainly, for many non-philosophers human rights may
all too obviously appear to rest upon self-evidently true and universally valid moral principles. In this respect, human
rights may be perceived as empirical facts about the contemporary world. Human rights do exist and many people do act in
accordance with the correlative duties and obligations respecting human rights entails. No supporter of human rights
could possibly complain about such perceptions. If nothing else, the prevalence of such views is pragmatically valuable
for the cause of human rights. However, moral philosophers do not enjoy such licence for epistemological complacency.
Moral philosophers remain concerned by the question of the philosophical foundations of human rights. There is a good
reason why we should all be concerned with such a question. What might be termed the 'philosophically naïve' view of
human rights effectively construes human rights as legal rights. The validity of human rights is closely tied to, and
dependent upon, the legal codification of human rights. However, as was argued earlier, such an approach is not
sufficient to justify human rights. Arguments in support of the validity of any moral doctrine can never be settled by
simply pointing to the empirical existence of particular moral beliefs or concepts. Morality is fundamentally concerned
with what ought to be the case, and this cannot be settled by appeals to what is the case, or is perceived to be the
case. From such a basis, it would have been very difficult to argue that apartheid South Africa, to take an earlier
example, was a morally unjust regime. One must not confuse the law with morality, per se. Nor consider the two to be
simply co-extensional. Human rights originate as moral rights. Human rights claim validity everywhere and for everyone,
irrespective of whether they have received comprehensive legal recognition, and even irrespective of whether everyone is
agreement with the claims and principles of human rights. Thus, one cannot settle the question of the philosophical
validity of human rights by appealing to purely empirical observations upon the world. As a moral doctrine, human rights
have to be demonstrated to be valid as norms and not facts. In order to achieve this, one has to turn to moral
philosophy. Presently, two particular approaches to the question of the validity of human rights predominate: what might
be loosely termed the 'interests theory approach' and the ‘will theory approach’.
b. The interests theory approach
Advocates of the interests theory approach argue that the principal function of human rights is to protect and promote
certain essential human interests. Securing human beings' essential interests is the principal ground upon which human
rights may be morally justified. The interests approach is thus primarily concerned to identify the social and
biological prerequisites for human beings leading a minimally good life. The universality of human rights is grounded in
what are considered to be some basic, indispensable, attributes for human well-being, which all of us are deemed
necessarily to share. Take, for example, an interest each of us has in respect of our own personal security. This
interest serves to ground our claim to the right. It may require the derivation of other rights as prerequisites to
security, such as the satisfaction of basic nutritional needs and the need to be free from arbitrary detention or
arrest, for example. The philosopher John Finnis provides a good representative of the interests theory approach. Finnis
(1980) argues that human rights are justifiable on the grounds of their instrumental value for securing the necessary
conditions of human well-being. He identifies seven fundamental interests, or what he terms 'basic forms of human good',
as providing the basis for human rights. These are: life and its capacity for development; the acquisition of knowledge,
as an end in itself; play, as the capacity for recreation; aesthetic expression; sociability and friendship; practical
reasonableness, the capacity for intelligent and reasonable thought processes; and finally, religion, or the capacity
for spiritual experience. According to Finnis, these are the essential prerequisites for human well-being and, as such,
serve to justify our claims to the corresponding rights, whether they be of the claim right or liberty right variety.
Other philosophers who have defended human rights from an interests-based approach have addressed the question of how
an appeal to interests can provide a justification for respecting and, when necessary, even positively acting to promote
the interests of others. Such questions have a long heritage in western moral and political philosophy and extend at
least as far back as the 17th. Century philosopher Thomas Hobbes. Typically, this approach attempts to provide what
James Nickel (1987:84) has termed 'prudential reasons' in support of human rights. Taking as the starting point the
claim that all human beings possess basic and fundamental interests, advocates of this approach argue that each
individual owes a basic and general duty to respect the rights of every other individual. The basis for this duty is not
mere benevolence or altruism, but individual self-interest. As Nickel writes, 'a prudential argument from fundamental
interests attempts to show that it would be reasonable to accept and comply with human rights, in circumstances where
most others are likely to do so, because these norms are part of the best means for protecting one's fundamental
interests against actions and omissions that endanger them.' (ibid). Protecting one’s own fundamental interests requires
others' willingness to recognize and respect these interests, which, in turn, requires reciprocal recognition and
respect of the fundamental interests of others. The adequate protection of each individual's fundamental interests
necessitates the establishment of a co-operative system, the fundamental aim of which is not to promote the common good,
but the protection and promotion of individuals' self-interest.
For many philosophers the interests approach provides a philosophically powerful defence of the doctrine of human
rights. It has the apparent advantage of appealing to human commonality, to those attributes we all share, and, in so
doing, offers a relatively broad-based defence of the plethora of human rights considered by many to be fundamental and
inalienable. The interests approach also provides for the possibility of resolving some of the potential disputes which
can arise over the need to prioritise some human rights over others. One may do this, for example, by hierarchically
ordering the corresponding interests identified as the specific object, or content, of each right.
However, the interests approach is subject to some significant criticisms. Foremost amongst these is the necessary
appeal interests' theorists make to some account of human nature. The interests-approach is clearly operating with, at
the very least, an implicit account of human nature. Appeals to human nature have, of course, proven to be highly
controversial and typically resist achieving the degree of consensus required for establishing the legitimacy of any
moral doctrine founded upon an account of human nature. For example, combining the appeal to fundamental interests with
the aspiration of securing the conditions for each individual leading a minimally good life would be complicated by
social and cultural diversity. Clearly, as the economic philosopher Amartya Sen (1999) has argued, the minimal
conditions for a decent life are socially and culturally relative. Providing the conditions for leading a minimally good
life for the residents of Greenwich Village would be significantly different to securing the same conditions for the
residents of a shanty town in Southern Africa or South America. While the interests themselves may be ultimately
identical, adequately protecting these interests will have to go beyond the mere specification of some purportedly
general prerequisites for satisfying individuals' fundamental interests. Other criticisms of the interests approach have
focused upon the appeal to self-interest as providing a coherent basis for fully respecting the rights of all human
beings. This approach is based upon the assumption that individuals occupy a condition of relatively equal vulnerability
to one another. However, this is simply not the case. The model cannot adequately defend the claim that a
self-interested agent must respect the interests of, for example, much less powerful or geographically distant
individuals, if she wishes to secure her own interests. On these terms, why should a purely self-interested and
over-weight individual in, say, Los Angeles or London, care for the interests of a starving individual in some distant
and impoverished continent? In this instance, the starving person is not in a position to affect their overweight
counterpart's fundamental interests. The appeal to pure self-interest ultimately cannot provide a basis for securing the
universal moral community at the heart of the doctrine of human rights. It cannot justify the claims of universal human
rights. An even more philosophically oriented vein of criticism focuses upon the interests' based approach alleged
neglect of constructive human agency as a fundamental component of morality generally. Put simply, the interests-based
approach tends to construe our fundamental interests as pre-determinants of human moral agency. This can have the effect
of subordinating the importance of the exercise of freedom as a principal moral ideal. One might seek to include freedom
as a basic human interest, but freedom is not constitutive of our interests on this account. This particular concern
lies at the heart of the so-called 'will approach' to human rights.
c. The Will Theory Approach
In contrast to the interests approach, the will theory attempts to establish the philosophical validity of human rights
upon a single human attribute: the capacity for freedom. Will theorists argue that what is distinctive about human
agency is the capacity for freedom and that this ought to constitute the core of any account of rights. Ultimately,
then, will theorists view human rights as originating in, or reducible to, a single, constitutive right, or
alternatively, a highly limited set of purportedly fundamental attributes. H.L.A. Hart, for example, inferentially
argues that all rights are reducible to a single, fundamental right. He refers to this as 'equal right of all men to be
free.' (1955:77). Hart insists that rights to such things as political participation or to an adequate diet, for
example, are ultimately reducible to, and derivative of, individuals' equal right to liberty. Henry Shue (1996) develops
upon Hart's inferential argument and argues that liberty alone is not ultimately sufficient for grounding all of the
rights posited by Hart. Shue argues that many of these rights imply more than mere individual liberty and extend to
include security from violence and the necessary material conditions for personal survival. Thus, he grounds rights upon
liberty, security, and subsistence. The moral philosopher Alan Gewirth (1978, 1982) has further developed upon such
themes. Gewirth argues that the justification of our claims to the possession of basic human rights is grounded in what
he presents as the distinguishing characteristic of human beings generally: the capacity for rationally purposive
agency. Gewirth states that the recognition of the validity of human rights is a logical corollary of recognizing
oneself as a rationally purposive agent since the possession of rights are the necessary means for rationally purposive
action. Gewirth grounds his argument in the claim that all human action is rationally purposive. Every human action is
done for some reason, irrespective of whether it be a good or a bad reason. He argues that in rationally endorsing some
end, say the desire to write a book, one must logically endorse the means to that end; as a bare minimum one's own
literacy. He then asks what is required to be a rationally purposive agent in the first place? He answers that freedom
and well-being are the two necessary conditions for rationally purposive action. Freedom and well-being are the
necessary means to acting in a rationally purposive fashion. They are essential prerequisites for being human, where to
be human is to possess the capacity for rationally purposive action. As essential prerequisites, each individual is
entitled to have access to them. However, Gewirth argues that each individual cannot simply will their own enjoyment of
these prerequisites for rational agency without due concern for others. He bases the necessary concern for others' human
rights upon what he terms the 'principle of generic consistency' (PGC). Gewirth argues that each individual’s claim to
the basic means for rationally purposive action is based upon an appeal to a general, rather than, specific attribute of
all relevant agents. I cannot logically will my own claims to basic human rights without simultaneously accepting the
equal claims of all rationally purposive agents to the same basic attributes. Gewirth has argued that there exists an
absolute right to life possessed separately and equally by all of us. In so claiming, Gewirth echoes Dworkin's concept
of rights as trumps, but ultimately goes further than Dworkin is prepared to do by arguing that the right to life is
absolute and cannot, therefore, be overridden under any circumstances. He states that a 'right is absolute when it
cannot be overridden in any circumstances, so that it can never be justifiably infringed and it must be fulfilled
without any exceptions.' (1982:92). Will theorists then attempt to establish the validity of human rights upon the ideal
of personal autonomy: rights are a manifestation of the exercise of personal autonomy. In so doing, the validity of
human rights is necessarily tied to the validity of personal autonomy. On the face of it, this would appear to be a very
powerful, philosophical position. After all, as someone like Gewirth might argue, critics of this position would
themselves necessarily be acting autonomously and they cannot do this without simultaneously requiring the existence of
the very means for such action: even in criticizing human rights one is logically pre-supposing the existence of such
rights.
Despite the apparent logical force of the will approach, it has been subjected to various forms of criticism. A
particularly important form of criticism focuses upon the implications of will theory for so-called 'marginal cases';
human beings who are temporarily or permanently incapable of acting in a rationally autonomous fashion. This would
include individuals who have diagnosed from suffering from dementia, schizophrenia, clinical depression, and, also,
individuals who remain in a comatose condition, from which they may never recover. If the constitutive condition for the
possession of human rights is said to be the capacity for acting in a rationally purposive manner, for example, then it
seems to logically follow, that individuals incapable of satisfying this criteria have no legitimate claim to human
rights. Many would find this conclusion morally disturbing. However, a strict adherence to the will approach is entailed
by it. Some human beings are temporarily or permanently lacking the criteria Gewirth, for instance, cites as the basis
for our claims to human rights. It is difficult to see how they could be assimilated within the community of the bearers
of human rights on the terms of Gewirth's argument. Despite this, the general tendency is towards extending human rights
considerations towards many of the so-called 'marginal cases'. To do otherwise would appear to many to be intuitively
wrong, if not ultimately defensible by appeal to practical reason. This may reveal the extent to which many peoples'
support of human rights includes an ineluctable element of sympathy, taking the form of a general emotional concern for
others. Thus, strictly applying the will theorists' criteria for membership of the community of human rights bearers
would appear to result in the exclusion of some categories of human beings who are presently recognized as legitimate
bearers of human rights.
The interests theory approach and the will theory approach contain strengths and weaknesses. When consistently and
separately applied to the doctrine of human rights, each approach appears to yield conclusions that may limit or
undermine the full force of those rights. It may be that philosophical supporters of human rights need to begin to
consider the potential philosophical benefits attainable through combining various themes and elements found within
these (and other) philosophical approaches to justifying human rights. Thus, further attempts at justifying the basis
and content of human rights may benefit from pursuing a more thematically pluralist approach than has typically been the
case to date.
5. Philosophical criticisms of human rights
The doctrine of human rights has been subjected to various forms of fundamental, philosophical criticism. These
challenges to the philosophical validity of human rights as a moral doctrine differ from critical appraisals of the
various philosophical theories supportive of the doctrine for the simple reason that they aim to demonstrate what they
perceive to the philosophical fallacies upon which human rights are founded. Two such forms of critical analysis bear
particular attention: one which challenges the universalist claims of human rights, and another which challenges the
presumed objective character of human rights principles.
a. Moral relativism
Philosophical supporters of human rights are necessarily committed to a form of moral universalism. As moral principles
and as a moral doctrine, human rights are considered to be universally valid. However, moral universalism has long been
subject to criticism by so-called moral relativists. Moral relativists argue that universally valid moral truths do not
exist. For moral relativists, there is simply no such thing as a universally valid moral doctrine. Relativists view
morality as a social and historical phenomenon. Moral beliefs and principles are therefore thought of as socially and
historically contingent, valid only for those cultures and societies in which they originate and within which they are
widely approved. Relativists point to the vast array of diverse moral beliefs and practices apparent in the world today
as empirical support for their position. Even within a single, contemporary society, such as the United States or Great
Britain, one can find a wide diversity of fundamental moral beliefs, principles, and practices. Contemporary, complex
societies are thus increasingly considered to be pluralist and multicultural in character. For many philosophers the
multicultural character of such societies serves to fundamentally restrict the substance and scope of the regulative
political principles governing those societies. In respect of human rights, relativists have tended to focus upon such
issues as the presumed individualist character of the doctrine of human rights. It has been argued by numerous
relativists that human rights are unduly biased towards morally individualist societies and cultures, at the necessary
expense of the communal moral complexion of many Asian and African societies. At best, some human rights' articles may
be considered to be redundant within such societies, at worse they may appear to be positively harmful if fully
implemented, replacing the fundamental values of one civilization with those of another and thereby perpetuating a form
of cultural and moral imperialism.
The philosophical debate between universalists and relativists is far too complex to adequately summarise here.
However, certain immediate responses to the relativist critique of human rights are immediately available. First, merely
pointing to moral diversity and the presumed integrity of individual cultures and societies does not, by itself, provide
a philosophical justification for relativism, nor a sufficient critique of universalism. After all, there have existed
and continue to exist many cultures and societies whose treatment of their own people leaves much to be desired. Is the
relativist genuinely asking us to recognize and respect the integrity of Nazi Germany, or any other similarly repressive
regime? There can be little doubt that, as it stands, relativism is incompatible with human rights. On the face of it,
this would appear to lend argumentative weight to the universalist support of human rights. After all, one may speculate
as to the willingness of any relativist to actually forego their possession of human rights if and when the social
surroundings demanded it. Similarly, relativist arguments are typically presented by members of the political elites
within those countries whose systematic oppression of their peoples has attracted the attention of advocates of human
rights. The exponential growth of grass-roots human rights organizations across many countries in the world whose
cultures are alleged to be incompatible with the implementation of human rights, raises serious questions as to the
validity and integrity of such 'indigenous' relativists. At its worst, the doctrine of moral relativism may be being
deployed in an attempt to illegitimately justify oppressive political systems. The concern over the presumed
incompatibility between human rights and communal moral systems appears to be a more valid issue. Human rights have
undeniably conceived of the principal bearer of human rights as the individual person. This is due, in large part, to
the Western origins of human rights. However, it would be equally fair to say that the so-called 'third generation' of
human rights is far more attuned to the communal and collective basis of many individuals' lives. In keeping with the
work of political philosophers such as Will Kymlicka, there is increasing awareness of the need to tailor human rights
principles to such things as the collective rights of minorities and, for example, these minorities' claims to such
things as communal land rights. While human rights remain philosophically grounded within an individualist moral
doctrine, there can be no doubt that attempts are being made to adequately apply and human rights to more communally
oriented societies. Human rights can no longer be accused of being 'culture-blind'.
b. Epistemological criticisms of human rights
The second most important contemporary philosophical form of human rights' criticism challenges the presumed objective
basis of human rights as moral rights. This form of criticism may be thought of as a river into which run many
philosophical tributaries. The essence of these attempts to refute human rights consists in the claim that moral
principles and concepts are inherently subjective in character. On this view moral beliefs do not emanate from a correct
determination of a rationally purposive will, or even gaining insight into the will of some divine being. Rather, moral
beliefs are fundamentally expressions of individuals' partial preferences. This position therefore rejects the principal
ground upon which the concept of moral rights rests: that there exist rational and a priori moral principles upon which
a correct and legitimate moral doctrine is to be founded. In modern, as opposed to ancient, philosophy this argument is
most closely associated with the 18th. Century Scottish philosopher David Hume. More recently versions of it have been
defended by the likes of C.L.Stevenson, Ludwig Wittgenstein, J.L.Mackie, and Richard Rorty. Indeed, Rorty (1993) has
argued that human rights are based not upon the exercise of reason, but a sentimental vision of humanity. He insists
that human rights are not rationally defensible. He argues that one cannot justify the basis of human rights by appeal
to moral theory and the canons of reason since, he insists, moral beliefs and practices are not ultimately motivated by
an appeal to reason or moral theory, but emanate from a sympathetic identification with others: morality originates in
the heart, and not in the head. Interestingly, though unambiguously sceptical about the philosophical basis of human
rights, Rorty views the existence of human rights as a 'good and desirable thing', something whose existence we all
benefit from. His critique of human rights is this not motivated by an underlying hostility to the doctrine. For Rorty,
human rights are better served by emotional appeals to identify with the unnecessary suffering of others, than by
arguments over the correct determination of reason.
Rorty's emphasis upon the importance of an emotional identification with others is a legitimate concern. It may, for
example, provide additional support for the philosophical arguments presented by the likes of Gewirth. However, as
Michael Freeman has recently pointed out, 'Rorty's argument…confuses motivation and justification.
Sympathy is an emotion. Whether the action we take on the basis of our emotions is justified depends on the reasons for
the action. Rorty wishes to eliminate unprovable metaphysical theories from philosophy, but in his critique of
human-rights theory he goes too far, and eliminates reasoning.' (2002:56) Rorty’s own account of the basis and scope of
moral knowledge ultimately prohibits him from claiming that human rights is a morally desirable phenomenon, since he
explicitly rules out the validity of appealing to the independently verifiable criteria required to uphold any such
judgement. What we require from Rorty is an independent reason for accepting his conclusion. It is precisely this that
he denies may be legitimately provided by moral philosophy.
Rorty aside, the general critique of moral objectivity has a long and very well-established heritage in modern moral
philosophy. It would be false to claim that either the objectivists or the subjectivists have scored any ultimate
'knock-down' over their philosophical opponents. Human rights are founded upon the claim to moral objectivity, whether
by appeal to interests or the will. Any critique of moral objectivism is bound, therefore, to have repercussions for the
philosophical defence of human rights. As I noted above, philosophers such as Alan Gewirth and John Finnis, in their
separate and different ways, have attempted to establish the rational and objective force of human rights. The reader
interested in pursuing this particular theme further is therefore recommended to pursue a close philosophical analysis
of either, or both, of these two philosophers.
6. Conclusion
Human rights have a long historical heritage. The principal philosophical foundation of human rights is a belief in the
existence of a form of justice valid for all peoples, everywhere. In this form, the contemporary doctrine of human
rights has come to occupy centre stage in geo-political affairs. The language of human rights is understood and utilized
by many peoples in very diverse circumstances. Human rights have become indispensable to the contemporary understanding
of how human beings should be treated, by one another and by national and international political bodies. Human rights
are best thought of as potential moral guarantees for each human being to lead a minimally good life. The extent to
which this aspiration has not been realized represents a gross failure by the contemporary world to institute a morally
compelling order based upon human rights. The philosophical basis of human rights has been subjected to consistent
criticism. While some aspects of the ensuing debate between philosophical supporters and opponents of human rights
remain unresolved and, perhaps, irresolvable, the general case for human rights remains a morally powerful one.
Arguably, the most compelling motivation for the existence of human may rest upon the exercise of imagination. Try
imagining a world without human rights!
7. Sources
Dworkin, Ronald. Taking Rights Seriously, (London: Duckworth, 1978)
Freeman, Michael. Human Rights: An Interdisciplinary Approach, (Cambridge: Polity, 2002)
Finnis, John. Natural Law and Natural Rights, (Oxford; Clarendon Press, 1980)
Gewirth, Alan. Reason and Morality, (Chicago: Chicago University Press, 1978)
Gewirth, Alan. Human Rights: Essays on Justification and Applications, (Chicago; University of Chicago Press,
1982)
Jones, Peter. Rights, (Basingstoke; Macmillan, 1994)
Mackie, J.L. Ethics: Inventing Right and Wrong, (Harmondsworth; Penguin, 1977)
Nickel, James. Making Sense of Human Rights: Philosophical Reflections on the Universal Declaration of Human
Rights, (Berkeley; University of California Press, 1987)
Rorty, Richard. "Human rights, rationality, and sentimentality". In S.Shute & S. Hurley (eds.) On Human Rights: the
Oxford Amnesty Lectures 1993, (New York; Basic Books, 1993)
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