The theory of interventionism examines the nature
and justifications of interfering with another polity or choices made
by individuals. Interventionism is characterized by the use or threat
of force or coercion to alter a political or cultural situation
nominally outside the intervenor's moral or political jurisdiction. It
commonly deals with a government's interventions in other governments'
affairs--and is thus an aspect of political philosophy, but it can
also be extended to interventions in others' cultures, religions,
lifestyles, and economic activities--and thus can fit into applied
ethics, covering such issues as paternalism, imperialism, and topics
in business, medical, and environmental ethics.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. A Note on Methodological Considerations
The context of interventionism requires an
epistemological consideration. A methodological individualist will
argue that it involves interventions in the lives of individuals; that
essentially it does not matter whether the individuals are part of
one's political entity or belonging to another--interventionism
applies solely to individuals. A methodological holist on the other
hand will identify the object of interventionism as groups--cultural,
political, religious, national, and so on. Whilst the methodological
individualist will focus on issues that infringe or attempt to alter
individuals' rights or choices, the holist will draw attention to
issues affecting groups and their identities. Methodological
compatibilism holds that interventions do affect individual rights or
choices but individuals also identify themselves with groups who can
also be separately affected by interference. For example, demanding
that all female bank employees wear blue dresses affects the
individual's choice of clothes in the workplace but also interferes
with the banking corporation's right to determine its own standard of
dress.
2. What Does Interventionism Deal With?
Beyond epistemological considerations
interventionism commonly deals with the justifications of governments
to interfere in (a) the lives of its own civilian population--domestic
interventions, and (b) the activities of other nations--foreign
interventions. In the case of domestic interventionism that apparatus
is the police force (or the army acting as a domestic policing force
as with the British army in Northern Ireland 1969-date); in the case
of international interventionism it is the army. In either scenario
interventionism implies the potential or actual use of coercion.
Reasoning or persuading another group of people
that a chosen policy, or a certain tradition, is wrong either morally
(given a certain standard) or on consequentialist considerations (the
policy will not achieve what it's meant to achieve) are not examples
of interventionism. Reasoning includes all forms of rhetoric, example,
persuasion, exhortation, counseling, discourse, and so on. The other
group changes policy or tradition only if it desires --is persuaded--
to change. They do so voluntarily. On the other hand, it may be
claimed that in attempting to persuade others to change their minds is
a form of interventionism. But this definition then becomes too broad
to be of use--merely speaking to another or judging their behavior in
the absence of any threats, coercion, or force, cannot be termed
interventionist, for its goal is not to interfere but to explain
possible choices.
Breaking diplomatic relations
also does not imply the use of force and hence is not a form of
interventionism. This is an essentially peaceful attempt to alter
another government's actions in effect by removing acknowledgement of
its international political status.
Voluntary
decisions on the part of a people may change a nation's values.
Trading in goods and ideas can change a society, yet such changes
should not, for the most part, be deemed interventionist. Changes in
culture and language that result from the voluntary decisions of many
individuals cannot be tied to any form of interventionism, for the
policy of interventionism is a policy of threatening or using coercion
or force of some description. Whether such examples exist is hard to
ascertain, for commonly the expansion of freedom of trade that has led
to an exchange of ideas and hence of cultures is historically almost
universally connected with imperialist policies that do aim at
explicit forms of intervention. Following World War Two (1939-45) when
Western imperialism dwindled as a political value, it can be argued
that various societies (e.g., Taiwan, Malaysia) voluntarily took up
what are referred to as 'Western values' through the influence of
non-violent commercial ventures. However, critics may point out that
previous military interventions could be considered as necessary
precursors to changes in the culture of the people.
Coercion is a form of interventionism. Coercion
implies offering choices that normally would not be accepted, but
which leave the individual to choose the option preferred by the
coercer, or by default one that is less acceptable. For example: if a
knife is held to your throat and you are given the option to hand over
your car keys or die, you are being coerced; if a government demands
that you open up your borders to a free trade in opium or face armed
conflict (China, Opium Wars with Britain) your nation is being
coerced.
Domestic interventions entail
restricting the choices of individuals or groups or altering their
activities through legislative coercion. Limiting freedom of speech or
trade, restricting occupational access to certain religious groups, or
enforcing the draft are examples of interventions in the choices of
individuals or groups, while increasing beer taxes are examples of
altering choices through legislative frameworks; failure to comply may
incur penalties.
On the international level,
interventionist activities involve threatening, coercing, or forcing
another group or nation to alter its behavior or change its government
or policies. International interventionism can incorporate direct
activities such as the use or threat of war, as well as indirect
activities such as assassination, subversion, and economic embargoes
of all descriptions (complete or partial blockades, transport
restrictions, etc.).
General goals of
international interventionism include attempting to change:
governments (e.g., Iran, 1979); people's expectations of governmental
activities; general attitudes of just conduct not held as appropriate
in the wider international community (e.g., South African Apartheid).
Specific goals can include changing a state apparatus or its personnel
(the government), to remove a particular statesperson or group, to
change specific or general policies, to alter cultural or political
beliefs, or even to alter patterns of economic and population
distributions.
3. Arguments for Interventionism
Utilitarian or
consequentialist prescriptions are open-ended: they could support
interventions either generally or in particular circumstances,
depending on expected results. Other positions offer more principled
cases for interventionism, for example on epistemological grounds,
political realism or rights analyses.
a. Epistemological Reasons
Intervening can be justified on grounds of the
government possessing better knowledge than individual agents, or from
paternalistic reasons, which presume the target agents are incapable
of making informed choices themselves. To that extent, governments may
legislate a range of programs from ensuring that people take out
adequate insurance or invest sufficiently into pensions to requiring
health checks or continued education; or economic interventions could
be justified on the grounds that economic agents (investors,
corporations, banks) do not act in the long term interest of the
nation, whereas civil servants who are deemed above the profit motive
can take the longer view (as held by John Maynard Keynes 1883-1946,
for example).
b. Political Realism
Political realism is defined by the primacy of
national interest in international affairs. This can be viewed as
either a moral duty or as a description of the ruling state of
affairs. Policy prescriptions involve pursuing interventions as they
benefit the national interest. The theory implies that states should
be left alone to seek and to defend their own interests. In the
realist tradition, of which there are many shades, such supporters
include Thucydides, Machiavelli, and Hobbes.
Political realism offers a broad interventionist
doctrine that can justify intervening for reasons of economic profit
as well as for balance of power considerations. The history of the
British Empire provides many examples of both justifications (Cf. its
interventions in European politics in the War of the Spanish
Succession 1702-13 and the War of the Austrian Succession 1740-8),
whilst post-war US foreign policy offers more recent case studies
(Vietnam War 1961-73 and the Gulf War 1990-91). It is captured by
Thucydides' description of the Pelopennesian War, that it was Spartan
"fear of Athenian growth" that caused the war. Realists often invoke
consequentialist concerns regarding the developing international state
of affairs--that should the foreign power to grow unchecked, a war
would ensue, or economic resource bases would be lost, or an invasion
could occur. The Schlieffen Plan, prior to the First World War
(1914-18) is another useful example of balance of power
considerations.
Political realism assumes that
interests are to be maintained through the exercise of power, and that
the world is characterized by competing power bases (nation states
[Hegel], for example, or classes [Marx]). Political realism is essence
reduces to the ethical principle that might is right.
c. Rights Theories
Some claim
that rights only pertain to individuals, and that nations and
governments only acquire any rights or privileges by virtue of the
civilians giving them power. Rights theorists thus argue that
individual rights supersede or 'trump' the rights or privileges of
governments. On this basis, interventions in support of rights are
morally justifiable. For example, if a foreign government tyrannizes
its civilians, an intervention to support their rights can be
justified, for the moral status of rights does not end at political
borders. However, what needs to be considered is at what point do
rights violations justify an intervention, or would an intervention do
more harm than good? Second is the argument from hypocrisy--can a
nation be justified in intervening in another's affairs when it does
not have a clean slate of its own? Finally, given that rights are
being violated, is a government guilty of moral failure if it fails to
intervene, and if so, is that moral failure a failure of its duty or
of virtuous behavior?
4. Non-Interventionist Doctrines
Non-interventionism is the theory
that one does not have any moral justification in intervening in
others' affairs. On a rights based analysis, or from Kantian
considerations of duty, this may be considered an absolutist
prohibition on the grounds that it either violates others' rights to
freedom or respect due them as individual moral entities.
Consequentialists may infer from evidence that interventionism is
always counter-productive and should not be practiced. In contemporary
ethical analysis, a rule utilitarian may claim that since
interventions never work (an empirical, testable hypothesis), ethical
considerations aimed at maximizing the greatest good for the greatest
number should employ non-interventionism on principle. However, act
utilitarians may agree that historically interventions have not
worked, but that does not mean that they will not in a future
situation, and hence non-interventionism should not be held
categorically.
As a political-economical
doctrine, non-interventionism includes the economic doctrine of
laissez-faire, which holds that governments should not
intervene in the economic activities of individuals or corporations.
Some thinkers, notably Herbert Spencer (1820-1903) have extended the
doctrine to moral issues too, arguing, for example, that intervening
in the plight of the poor only makes their condition worse by creating
an atmosphere of dependency, rather than leaving them to independently
struggle and find their own values. Other supporters of the economic
laissez-faire doctrine do not go as far as Spencer; Friedrich
von Hayek argues (Constitution of Liberty, 1956) that
governments do have responsibilities to the poor resulting from their
duty to provide a general framework to ensure the smooth operation of
the free market system.
On a broader view,
non-interventionism is applied by John Stuart Mill in On
Liberty; he claims that responsibility to others only goes so far
as ensuring they know of the dangers that may befall them, but does
not extend to actually physically restraining those who would
knowingly injure themselves. In the international sphere, Mill ("Notes
on Intervention" Collected Works) argues for a policy of
self-determination: that other people be allowed to make their own
mistakes, and hence forge their own paths to freedom; intervening
paternalistically on their behalf will not be conducive to their
learning the value of freedom in its own right. Such a stance can be
used in a variety of issues including freedom of press and expression.
For example, John Milton in Areopagitica argues: "And though
all the winds of doctrine were let loose to play on the earth, so
Truth be in the field, we do injuriously by licensing and prohibiting
to misdoubt her strength. Let her and Falsehood grapple; who ever knew
Truth put to the worse in a free and open encounter?"
5. Legal Positivism and Non-Interventionism
In the international sphere, legal positivists are
commonly non-interventionists. Legal positivists, following Christian
Wolff (1679-1754), argue that nation states possess absolute rights to
political sovereignty and territorial integrity, which implies that
national borders be inviolable. Wolff writes: "Nations are regarded as
individual free persons living in a state of nature. For they consist
of a multitude of men united into a state. Therefore since states are
regarded as individual free persons living in a state of nature,
nations must also be regarded in relation to each other as individual
free persons living in a state of nature." (Jus Gentium Methodo
Scientifica Pertractatum Trans. Joseph Drake. Clarendon Press:
Oxford, 1934, §2, p.9) The positivist theory of international
relations implies that interventions would violate international
borders; this position itself resolves into an absolutist doctrine
that deems interventions should never be condoned and more pragmatic
positions that permit some exceptions to the rule.
Positivist exceptions to non-interventionism emanate
from humanitarian considerations that overwhelm nominally sacrosanct
national borders, if the target state is violating basic human rights
to such an extent that it can no longer be deemed a proper
representative of its people. The type of interventionism supported
depends on the theory of the state entertained.
If governments are viewed as instrumental institutions
that exist to uphold the domestic rights of civilians, then a
violation of its remit can warrant an intervention on behalf of the
citizens. Michael Walzer in Just and Unjust Wars (1977)
entertains this position, arguing that only in extreme cases of rights
violations "that shock the moral conscience of mankind" (p.107), can
interventions be supported. He gives the examples of genocide, mass
murder or enslavement. Rights violations above this level, he implies,
are not grounds for interventionism (e.g., removal of free movement,
freedom of the press, etc).
A Hobbesian case
for interventionism can be maintained by those who consider
governments the sole and proper moral and legal authorities. Hobbes
claims that individuals give up the rights that they possess in the
state of nature (except the right of self-preservation) to the state
(the 'Leviathan'). He argues the State should be obeyed, even it is
acting quite tyrannically, for the alternative --and the greater
evil-- is the state of war in which justice and morality do not hold.
However, if a state acts to takes its civilians into the state of
nature by governing incompetently or unjustly then the people have a
right to form a new state. This allows the legal positivist to condone
interventions where governments have obviously failed in their
obligations and have brought war to the people through their
ineptitude.
The third possible justification
for the positivist is when a supra-legal body legislates in favor of
an intervention. For example, the United Nations has the jurisdiction
to pass a resolution of intervention, but it does not condone
unilateral interventions. Positivists draw parallels here between
governments arbitrating in domestic disputes and a world body acting
to dissolve international disputes.
6. Isolationism
Isolationism
is the political doctrine of non-involvement in foreign affairs. The
state, it is argued, should confine its activities to its own
jurisdiction, and therefore, what happens abroad is of no concern.
Isolationism can be argued from a consequentialist perspective: that
getting involved would only make matters (whatever those matters are)
worse; or from an intrinsicist perspective similar to the legal
positivist case, that national jurisdiction (and hence moral and
political concerns) ends at the political borders.
7. Economic Interventionism
Government intervention in
the economy was noted above. Whilst the effects and the principles are
the subject matter of economics, philosophers can fruitfully examine
the nature of the epistemological arguments used in the debates which
involve considerations of methodological individualism versus holism,
and a-priori versus a-posteriori reasoning.
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