Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Life
In striking contrast to other Ismaili writers of the time (s.v., Hamid ai-din al
Kirmani; Abu Ya‘qub al-Sijistani), a good deal of information exists on Khusraw’s life, most written by his own hand,
some by a (hostile) contemporary, some by later historians, and some apocryphal. He has been included in every major literary or
historical survey produced since his lifetime. We can divide Khusraw’s life into
four periods: his early years up to age forty (for which we must pull snippets from
various texts); his conversion to Ismailism (of which he has left two different versions,
one prose, one poetry); his seven-year journey (found in his Safarnama); and his years of
preaching followed by persecution and exile (drawn primarily from his poetry, but also a
few statements in his philosophical works).
Abu Mo’in Hamid al-Din Nasir ibn Khusraw was born in 1004 in Qobadiyan in
the district of Marv, in the eastern Iranian province of Khurasan. He and at least two of
his brothers enjoyed high positions in the administrative ranks of the Saljuq court (he
says he himself was in the revenue department), and there is evidence that he was also
familiar with the court of previous dynasty, the Ghaznavids. Based on the quality of his
writings, it is obvious he received an excellent education in the sciences, literatures and
philosophies of his time, including the study of Greek and Neoplatonic philosophy. He
tells us he examined the doctrines of the different Islamic schools and was not satisfied
until he found and understood the Ismaili faith. From this event of conversion, he
embarked on his journey, during which time he spent three years in the Ismaili court in
Cairo of the Fatimid caliph, al-Mustansir (1029-1094). The Fatimid dynasty (909-1171)
aimed at creating an Islamic state based on Ismaili tenets, and thus presented a direct
theological and military challenge to the Sunni ‘Abbasid caliphate based in Baghdad. He
left Cairo as the head (hujjat) of Ismaili missionary activities in his home province of
Khurasan. At some point, he was forced by the Sunni authorities to flee for his life; he
lived the rest of his life in exile further east, in the Pamir Mountains in Badakhshan,
located in today’s Tajikistan and Afghanistan.
2. Philosophy
Khusraw’s philosophical works reveal a strong Neoplatonic
structure and vocabulary. For example, his cosmogony closely follows Plotinus, moving
from God and God’s word (logos), to Intellect, Soul, and the world of Nature. In
holding to this cosmogonic description, Khusraw follows his fellow Ismailis
(Nasafi and al-Sijistani) and ignores the structure introduced by al-Farabi and picked up
by Ibn Sina and the Ismaili philosopher al-Kirmani.
Before looking at this more closely, it is important to understand that underlying
each of the Ismaili cosmogonic systems is a fundamental division of all into two realms,
the esoteric and the exoteric, the batin and zahir. With this division, everything in the physical world points to
its counterpart in the spiritual, which is seen as its source, its
home, its true form. Thus the cosmogonic structure itself reveals a purposeful,
providential unfolding from the imaginal, spiritual into the physical, which looks back at
the spiritual and seeks to grasp it and comprehend it.
Khusraw begins with a discussion of tawhid (oneness, God’s unity), the
clear understanding of which is the only way to achieve spiritual perfection. For Nasir,
God Himself is indescribable (nothing which has an opposite can be ascribed to Him,
since that would be limiting Him to human concepts) and is not a being, in fact, is beyond
all categories of being and non-being alike. However, from God emerges his Word
(kalmia), ‘Be!’, which brings into existence Universal Intellect, perfect in potentiality and actuality.
Intellect contains all being within itself, with no time or space, all opposites with no differentiation. Intellect enjoys a
worshipful intimacy with God and a perfection born of this intimacy. From this worship, emerges Universal Soul, perfect in
potentiality but not in actuality, because it is separated from God by Intellect. Universal Soul
recognises this separation, desires the perfection enjoyed by Intellect, and moves to
approach closer to God. With these three actions, and its movement seeking perfection,
Soul introduces the first movement into the entire structure, thus also time and place.
The entire cosmos has thus been set into motion, and with it the oppositions of hot, cold,
wet, dry, and from them the four elements: earth, air, fire and water. From these
elements arise first the minerals, then the plants, then the animals, and finally, the summit
of physical creation, human beings, embedded within whom are individual intellects and
individual souls manifesting the same characteristics (but on an smaller level) as the
universals. In fact, the entire cosmos is laid down on a matrix of Intellect and Soul;
everything within it displays the original intelligence and drive exhibited by the original
duo.
Khusraw’s ethics grow from and reflect this cosmogony. Each individual’s
task is to recognise his or her own imperfections and then move to correct them, seeking
the closest relationship possible with God. For Khusraw, this is achieved by
stringent and repeated application of the intellect, to both physical and spiritual matters.
The believer must find a guide, must study diligently, must perform all required religious
acts with full understanding, and must accompany new understanding with new, superior
levels of worldly activity.
As an Ismaili, Khusraw held the Shi‘i doctrine that God would not send a
revelation without a guide to interpret it. For the Ismailis, this guide must be a living
person, the Imam of the Time, divinely inspired, infallible, and perfectly capable of
providing guidance in spiritual and worldly affairs, who thus serves as a living bridge
between the two realms.
3. References and Further Reading
The following sources elucidate Khusraw’s philosophy: H. Corbin,
‘Nasir-i Khusrau and Iranian Ismailism,’ in The Cambridge History of Iran: Volume 4, ed., R. N. Frye (Cambridge
1975), pp. 520-42 and 689-90; A. Hunsberger, ‘Nasir Khusraw: Fatimid Intellectual,’ in F. Daftary, ed., Intellectual
Traditions in Islam (London 2000), pp. 112-29; A. Hunsberger, Nasir Khusraw’s Doctrine of the Soul: From the
Universal Intellect to the Physical World in Isma‘ili Philosophy, PhD thesis, Columbia University, New York, 1992; S.
Meskoob, Shahrokh, ‘The Origin and Meaning of ‘Aql (Reason) in the View of Nasir Khusraw,’ Iran
Nameh, 6 (1989), pp. 239-57, and 7 (1989), pp. 405-29. For a full bibliography of Nasir Khusraw’s works and ideas, see
A. C. Hunsberger, Nasir Khusraw, the Ruby of Badakhshan: A Portrait of the Persian Poet, Traveller and Philosopher (London
2000). For works still in manuscript, see I. K. Poonawala, Biobibliography of Ismaili Literature, Malibu, Calif., 1977),
p. 123.
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