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Hamid al-Din al-Kirmani was a prominent Ismaili missionary during the reign of the Fatimid caliph-imam al-Hakim (996-1021). He was of Persian origin and was probably born in the province of Kirman. He seems to have spent the greater part of his life as a Fatimid da‘i (missionary) in Iraq (in Baghdad and Basra) and in central and western parts of Iran.
Al-Kirmani was part of the official Fatimid campaign against the dissident da‘is, who had also proclaimed al-Hakim’s divinity. In Cairo he produced several works in refutation of the Druze movement and religion. Subsequently, al-Kirmani returned to Iraq where he completed his last and magnum opus, Rahat al-‘aql.
A prolific writer, al-Kirmani was one of the most learned Ismaili theologians of the Fatimid times. He was well-acquainted with the Hebrew text of the Old Testament, the Syriac version of the New Testament, and the post-Biblical Jewish writings. He expounded the Ismaili Shi‘i doctrine of the imamate in numerous writings. In a few treatises, al-Kirmani refuted the theological views of the Zaydis, the Twelver Shi‘is, and other Muslim opponents of the Fatimid Ismaili imams. Al-Kirmani was also an accomplished philosopher belonging to that select group of Ismaili da‘is of the Iranian lands who amalgamated in an original manner their Ismaili theology with different philosophical traditions, notably a type of Neoplatonism then current in the Muslim world.
Hamid al-Din al-Kirmani was a prominent Ismaili da‘i or missionary and one of the most learned Ismaili theologians
and philosophers of the Fatimid period. As in the case of other prominent missionaries who observed strict secrecy in their
activities in the midst of hostile milieus, few biographical details are available on al-Kirmani, who flourished during the reign
of the Fatimid caliph-imam al-Hakim (996-1021). Al-Kirmani is not mentioned in any contemporary Muslim historical sources, but
highlights of his life and career can be gathered from his own numerous extant works as well as the writings of the later
Musta‘li-Tayyibi Ismaili authors of Yaman.
Al-Kirmani’s date of birth remains unknown, but he was of Persian origin and was probably born in the province of Kirman.
He seems to have spent the greater part of his life as a Fatimid da‘i in Iraq, having been particularly active in
Baghdad and Basra. In Iraq, al-Kirmani successfully concentrated his efforts on local rulers and influential tribal chiefs, with
whose support the Ismailis aimed to bring about the downfall of the ‘Abbasids. Alarmed by the successes of the Fatimid
da‘wa or mission in Iraq, the ‘Abbasid caliph al-Qadir took retaliatory measures. In 1011, he sponsored the
so-called Baghdad manifesto to discredit the Fatimids, also refuting their ‘Alid ancestry. The honorific title hujjat
al-Iraqayn, meaning the hujja or chief da‘i of both Iraqs (al-Iraq al-Arabi and al-Iraq al-Ajami), which
is often added to al-Kirmani’s name and may be of a late origin, implies that he was also active in central and western parts of
Iran.
Al-Kirmani rose to prominence during the reign of al-Hakim, when the central headquarters of the Fatimid
da‘wa in Cairo considered him as the most learned Ismaili theologian of the time. It was in that capacity that
al-Kirmani played an important role in refuting the extremist ideas of some dissident da‘is, who were then founding
what was to become known as the Druze movement and religion. As part of the official Fatimid campaign against the dissident
da‘is, who had also proclaimed al-Hakim’s divinity, al-Kirmani was summoned in 1014 or shortly earlier to Cairo where
he produced several works in refutation of the extremist doctrines. Al-Kirmani’s writings, which were widely circulated, were to
some extent successful in checking the spread of the extremist doctrines associated with the initiation of the Druze movement.
Subsequently, al-Kirmani returned to Iraq where he completed his last and magnum opus, Rahat al-‘aql, in 1020
and where he died soon afterwards.
A prolific writer, al-Kirmani was one of the most learned Ismaili theologians of the Fatimid times. He was
well-acquainted with the Hebrew text of the Old Testament, the Syriac version of the New Testament, and the post-Biblical Jewish
writings. He expounded the Ismaili Shi‘i doctrine of the imamate in numerous writings. In a few treatises, al-Kirmani
refuted the theological views of the Zaydis, the Twelver Shi‘is, and other Muslim opponents of the Fatimid Ismaili imams. In
his al-Aqwal al-dhahabiya, al-Kirmani refuted the ideas of Abu Bakr Mohammad b. Zakariya al-Razi (d. 934), who had argued
for the necessity of revelation and prophethood while tracing all sciences to revelational origins.
Al-Kirmani was also an accomplished philosopher belonging to that select group of Ismaili da‘is of the
Iranian lands who amalgamated in an original manner their Ismaili theology (kalam) with different philosophical
traditions, notably a type of Neoplatonism then current in the Muslim world. As a philosopher, al-Kirmani was fully acquainted
with Aristotelian and Neoplatonic philosophies as well as the metaphysical systems of the Muslim philosophers (falasifa),
notably al-Farabi, and Ibn Sina (Avicenna) who was his contemporary. In his Kitab al-riyad, al-Kirmani acted as an arbiter
in a philosophical debate that had taken place earlier among some Iranian da‘is, notably Muhammad al-Nasafi, Abu
YaRahat al-‘aql, which is written for the advanced adepts. In this book, al-Kirmani also propounded what may
be regarded as the third stage in the development of Ismaili cosmology in medieval times. Al-Kirmani replaced the Neoplatonic
dyad of the Intellect (‘aql) and Soul (nafs) in the spiritual world, which had been adopted by his Iranian
Ismaili predecessors, by a series of ten separate Intellects in partial adaptation of al-Farabi’s Aristotelian cosmic system.
Al-Kirmani’s cosmology, representing an original synthesis of different philosophical traditions, was not however adopted by the
Fatimid Ismailis; it later provided the basis for the development of the fourth and final stage of Ismaili cosmology at the hands
of the Musta‘li-Tayyibi scholars in Yaman.
References and Further Reading
W. Ivanow, Ismaili
Literature: A Bibliographical Survey, Tehran, 1963, pp. 40-45. Contains a survey of al-Kirmani’s known works and their manuscripts, preserved mainly in Yaman and India.
I. K. Poonawala, Biobibliography of Ismaili Literature
Malibu, Calif., 1977, pp. 94-102. Also contains a survey of al-Kirmani’s known works and their manuscripts, preserved mainly in Yaman and India.
J. van Ess, “Bibliographische
Notizen zur islamischen Theologie. I. Zur Chronologie der Werke des Hamidaddin al-Kirmani”, Die Welt des Orients, 9, 1978,
pp. 255-261. A partial chronology of al-Kirmani’s works.
W. Madelung, “Das
Imamat in der frühen ismailitischen Lehre”, Der Islam, 37, 1961, pp. 114-127.
H. Corbin, Cyclical Time and Ismaili
Gnosis, London, 1983, index.
F. Daftary, The Ismailis: Their History and Doctrines, Cambridge, 1990, pp. 113, 192-193,
196-197, 218, 227, 229-230, 235-236, 240, 245-246, 287, 291, 298.
Paul E. Walker, Early Philosophical Shiism, Cambridge,
1993, index.
Paul. E. Walker, Hamid al-Din al-Kirmani: Ismaili Thought in the Age of al-Hakim, London, 1999.
Daniel De
Smet, La Quiétude de l’intellect: Néoplatonisme et gnose ismaélienne dans l’oeuvre de Hamid ad-Din al-Kirmani, Louvain,
1995.
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