Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Chronology of Life and Works
French philosopher (1902-1968), born Aleksandr Vladimirovich
Kozhevnikov in Russia. Kojève studied in Germany (Heidelberg) where, under the
supervision of Karl Jaspers, he
completed a thesis (Die religöse Philosophie Wladimir Solowjews, 1931) Vladimir Solovyov,
a Russian religious
philosopher deeply influenced by Hegel. He later settled in Paris, where he
taught at the Ecole Pratique des Hautes Ētudes. Taking over from Alexandre
Koyré, he taught a seminar on Hegel
from 1933 till 1939. Along with Jean Hyppolite,
he was responsible for the serious introduction of Hegel into French thought.
His lectures exerted a profound influence (both direct and indirect) over many
leading French philosophers and intellectuals - amongst them Sartre,
Merleau-Ponty, Lacan, Bataille, Althusser, Queneau, Aron, and Breton. Via his
friend Leo Strauss, Kojève's thought also exerted influence in America, most
especially over Allan Bloom and, later, Francis Fukuyama. His lectures on Hegel
were published in 1947 under the title Introduction à la lecture de Hegel,
appearing in English as Introduction to the Reading of Hegel
(1969). After the Second World War
Kojève worked in the French Ministry of Economic Affairs, until his death in
1968. Here he exercised a profound, mandarin influence over French policy,
including a role as one of the leading architects of the EEC and GATT. He
continued to write philosophy over these years, including works on the
pre-Socratics, Kant, the concept of right, the temporal dimensions of
philosophical wisdom, the relationship between Christianity and both Western
science and communism, and the development of capitalism. Many of these works
were only published posthumously.
2. The Hegelian Context
Hegel's philosophy of history, most especially the
historicist philosophy of consciousness developed in the Phenomenology of
Spirit, provides the core of Kojève's own work. However, Kojève’s Hegel
lectures are not so much an exegesis of Hegel's thought, as a profoundly
original reinterpretation. By reading Hegel's philosophy of consciousness
through the twin lenses of Marx's materialism and Heidegger’s temporalised
ontology of human being (Dasein), Kojève can rightly be said to have
initiated 'existential Marxism'. Here I will briefly sketch the most salient
dimensions of Hegel's philosophy of history, before proceeding to outline
Kojève's own interpretation of it.
Perhaps the core of Hegel's philosophy is the idea that
human history is the history of thought as it attempts to understand
itself and its relation to its world. History is the history of reason,
as it grapples with its own nature and its relation to that with which it is
confronted (other beings, nature, the eternal). The historical movement of this
reason is one of a sequence of alienations (Entfremdungen) or splits,
and the subsequent attempt to reconcile these divisions through a restoration
of unity. Thus, for example, Hegel sees the world of the Athenian Greeks as one
in which people lived in a harmonious relation to their community and the world
about, the basis of this harmony being provided by a pre-reflective commitment
to shared customs, conventions and habits of thought and action. With the
beginnings of Socratic philosophy, however, division and separation is
introduced into thought - customary answers to questions of truth, morality,
and reality are brought under suspicion. A questioning 'I' emerges, one that
experiences itself as distinct and apart from other beings, from customary
rules, and from a natural world that becomes an 'object' for it. This introduces into experience a set of
'dualisms' - between subject and object, man and nature, desire and duty, the
human and the divine, the individual and the collectivity. For Hegel, the
historical movement of thought is a 'dialectical' process wherein these
divisions are put through processes of reconciliation, producing in turn new
divisions, which thought in turn attempts to reconcile. Historically, this task
of reconciliation has been embodied in many forms - in art, in religion, and in
philosophy. Enlightenment philosophy, the philosophy of Hegel's own time, is
the latest and most sophisticated attempt to reconcile these divisions through
reason alone, to freely find man's place amongst others and the universe as a
whole. This, for Hegel, is only to be achieved through the overcoming (Aufhebung)
of false divisions, by grasping that underlying apparent schisms (such as that
between subject and object) there is a unity, with all elements being
manifestations of an Absolute Spirit (Geist). Thus Hegel sees the key to
historical reconciliation lying in the rational realisation of underlying
unity, a unity that can, in time, come to connect individuals with each other
and with the world in which they live. Universal history is the product of
reason, leading (potentially) to a reconciled humanity, at one with itself,
living according to a shared morality that is the outcome of rational
reflection.
3. The Influence of Marx
Hegel's philosophy of universal history furnishes that basic
framework of Kojève's philosophical stance. History is a processual movement in
which division is subjected to reconciliation, culminating in 'the end of
history', its completion in a universal society of mutual recognition and
affirmation.
However, Kojève reworks Hegel in number of crucial (and,
amongst Hegel scholars, controversial)
ways. The first of these may be identified with the influence of Marx,
especially the writings of the so-called '1848 manuscripts'. Kojève follows
Marx's 'inverted Hegelianism’ by understanding the labour of historical
development in broadly 'materialist' terms. The making of history is no longer
simply a case of reason at work in the world, but of man's activity as a being
who collectively produces his own being. This occurs through the labour of
appropriating and transforming his material world in order to satisfy his own
needs. Whereas Hegel's idealism gives priority to the forms of consciousness
that produce the world as experienced, Kojève follows Marx in tying
consciousness to the labour of material production and the satisfaction of
human desires thereby. While Hegel recuperates human consciousness into a
theological totality (Geist or 'Absolute Spirit'), Kojève secularises
human history, seeing it as solely the product of man's self-production.
Whereas Hegelian reconciliation is ultimately the reconciliation of man with
God (totality or the Absolute), for Kojève the division of man from himself is
transcended in humanist terms. If Hegel sees the end of history as the final
moment of reconciliation with God or Spirit, Kojève (Like Feurbach and Marx)
sees it as the transcendence of an illusion, in which God (man's alienated
essence, Wesen) is reclaimed by man. Whereas the Hegelian totality
provides a prior set of ontological relations between man and world waiting to
be apprehended by a maturing consciousness, Kojève sees human action as the
transformative process that produces those ontological relations. While
Hegel arguably presents a 'panlogistic' relation between man and nature,
unifying the two in the Absolute, Kojève sees a fundamental disjunction between
the two domains, providing the conditions for human self-production through
man's negating and transforming activities.
Perhaps the conceptual key to Kojève's understanding of
universal history is desire. Desire functions as the engine of history -
it is man's pursuit in realisation of his desires that drives the struggles
between men. Desire is the permanent and universal feature of human existence,
and when transformed into action it is the basis of all historical agency. The
desire for 'recognition' (Anerkennung), the validation of human worth
and the satisfaction of needs, propels the struggles and processes that make
for historical progression. History moves through a series of determinate
configurations, culminating in the end of history, a state in which a common
and universal humanity is finally realised. This would entail 'the formation of
a society...in which the strictly particular, personal, individual value of
each is recognised as such'. Hence individual values and needs would converge
upon a common settlement in which a shared human nature (comprising the desires
and inclinations that define humanity as such) would find its satisfaction.
How and why is this realisation of mutuality and equality to
come about? Kojève follows Hegel's famous presentation of the 'master-slave’
dialectic in order to deduce the necessary overcoming of inequality, division
and subordination. The relation of 'master' and ‘slave’ is one in which the
satisfaction of a dominant group's or class’ needs (the 'masters’) is met
through the subordination of others (the 'slaves' or ‘bondsmen’). The ‘slave’
exists only to affirm the superiority and humanity of the 'master', and to
furnish the 'master's’ needs by surrendering up his labour. However, this
relation is doomed to failure, for two fundamental reasons. Firstly, the
'master' desires the recognition and affirmation of his full humanity and
value, and uses the subordinated 'slave' for that end. This means that the
'master', perversely, is dependent upon the ‘slave’, thus inverting the
relation of domination. Moreover, this forced relation of recognition remains
thoroughly incomplete, since the 'slave' is not in a position to grant
affirmation freely, but is compelled to do so due to his subordination.
Affirmation or recognition that is not freely given counts for nothing. As
Kojève puts it:
The relation between Master and Slave...is
not recognition properly so-called...The Master is not the only one to
consider himself Master. The Slave, also, considers him as such. Hence, he is
recognized in his human reality and dignity. But this recognition is one-sided,
for he does not recognize in turn the Slave's human reality and dignity. Hence,
he is recognized by someone whom he does not recognize. And this is what is
insufficient - what is tragic - in his situation...For he can be satisfied only
by recognition from one whom he recognizes as worthy of recognizing him.
This establishes the constitutive need for mutual
recognition and formal equality, if recognition of value is to be established.
It is only when there is mutuality and recognition of all, that the recognition
of any one becomes fully possible.
Secondly, for Kojève (as for Marx) it is the labouring
'slave' who is the key to historical progress. It is the ‘slave’ who works, and
consequently it is he and not the 'master' who exercises his ‘negativity’ in
transforming the world in line with human wants and desires. So, on the
material level, the slave possesses the key to his own liberation, namely his
active mastery of nature. Moreover, the 'master' has no desire to transform the
world, whereas the 'slave', unsatisfied with his condition, imagines and
attempts to realise a world of freedom in which his value will finally be
recognised and his own desires satisfied. The slave's ideological struggle is
to overcome his own fear of death and take-up struggle against the 'master',
demanding the recognition of his value and freedom. The coincidence of material
and ideological conditions of liberation were already made manifest, for
Kojève, by the revolutions of the 18th, 19th and 20th
centuries; these struggles set the conditions for the completion of history in
the form of universal society.
4. The Influence of Heidegger
If Marx furnishes one central resource for Kojève's
rereading of Hegel, Heidegger provides the other. From Heidegger, Kojève takes
the insight that humankind is distinguished from nature through its distinctive
ontological self-relation. Man's being is conditioned by its radically temporal
character, its understanding of its being in time, with finitude or death as
its ultimate horizon. Kojève's ontology is, pace Heidegger’s analysis of
Dasein in Being & Time, first and foremost experiential and
existential. By bringing together Hegel with Heidegger, Kojève attempts to
radically historicise existentialism, while simultaneously giving Hegelian
historicity a radically existential twist, wherein man's existential freedom
defines his being. Freedom is understood as the ontological relation of
'negativity', the incompleteness of human being, its constitutive ‘lack’. It is
precisely because of this lack of a fully constituted being that man
experiences (or, more properly is nothing other than) desire. The
negativity of being, manifest as desire, makes possible man's self-making, the
process of 'becoming'. This position can be see to draw inspiration from
Heidegger's critique of the transcendental preoccupations of Western thought,
which he claims set reified, metaphysically assured figurations of Being over
and above the processes of Becoming (wherein the 'Being of Beings', das Sein
des Seieinden, is variously revealed within the horizon of temporality).
The disavowal of such
metaphysically anchored and ultimately timeless configurations of human being
frees man from determinism and 'throws' him into his existential freedom. In
Kojève's thinking, man’s struggle is to exercise this freedom in order to
produce a world in which his desires are satisfied, in the course of which he
comes to accept his own freedom, ridding himself of the illusions of religion
and superstition, 'heroically' claiming his own finitude or mortality.
We can see, then, how Kojève attempts to synthesise Hegel,
Marx and Heidegger. From Hegel he takes the notion of a universal historical
process within which reconciliation unfolds through an intersubjective
dialectic, resulting in unity. From Marx he takes a secularised,
de-theologised, and productivist philosophical anthropology, one that places
the transformative activity of a desiring being centre stage in the historical
process. From Heidegger, he takes the existentialist interpretation of human
being as free, negative, and radically temporal. Pulling three together, he
presents a vision of human history in which man grasps his freedom to produce
himself and his world in pursuit of his desires, and in doing so drives history
toward its end (understood both as culmination or exhaustion, and its goal or
completion).
5. The End of History and the Last Man
Kojève's vision of the culmination of history has, in recent
years, exercised a renewed influence, not least in light of the collapse of
Soviet communism and its satellite states. If we examine the vision of
completion that Kojève held-out, we can see precisely why the advocates (or
apologists) of a post-Cold War global capitalist order have drawn such
inspiration from Kojève's thesis.
For Kojève, historical reconciliation will culminate in the
equal recognition of all individuals. This recognition will remove the
rationale for war and struggle, and so will usher-in peace. In this way,
history, politically speaking, culminates in a universal (global) order which
is without classes or distinctions - in Hegelian terms, there are no longer any
'masters' and ‘slaves’, only free human beings who mutually recognise and
affirm each others' freedom. This political moment takes the form of law, which
confers universal recognition upon all individuals, thereby satisfying the
particular individual's desire to be affirmed as an equal amongst others.
Simultaneously, the progression of man's productive
capacities, his ability to take nature and transform it in order to satisfy his
own needs and desires, will result in prosperity and freedom from such want.
For Kojève, the economic culmination of human productive capacities finds its
apotheosis not in communism, but in capitalism. Like Marx, Kojève believed that
capitalism had unleashed productive forces, generating heretofore unimagined
wealth. Moreover, like Marx he believed that the expansion of capitalism was an
homogenising force, producing a globalising cultural standard that laid waste
to local attachments, traditions and boundaries, replacing them with
bourgeoisie values. Kojève departs from
Marxism (and its variants such as Leninism) by rejecting the notion that
capitalism contained inherent contradictions that would inevitably bring about
its demise and supercession by communism. Marx thought that the immiseration of
workers under 19th century capitalism would worsen as the pressure
of market competition would lead to ever-more brutal extraction of surplus from
workers' labour, in attempt to offset the falling rate of profit. This would
result in the pauperisation of the proletariat, and capitalism's inability to
avoid such crisis would necessitate the overthrow of its relations by a
proletariat raised up to class consciousness under the conditions of its
immiseration. Kojève, in contrast, believed that 20th century
capitalism had found a way out of these contradictions, finding ways to yoke
the market system to a redistributive arrangement that managed to spread the
wealth it produced. Far from becoming increasingly impoverished, the working
class was coming to enjoy unprecedented prosperity. This is why Kojève, as
early as 1948, was proclaiming the United States as the economic model for the
'post-historical' world, the most efficient and successful in conquering nature
in order to provide for human material needs. Hence he asserted, long before
the final collapse of the Soviet empire, that the Cold War would end in the
triumph of the capitalist West, achieved through economic rather than military
means.
The end of history would also usher-in other distinctive
forms. Philosophically, it would end in absolute knowledge displacing ideology.
Artistically, the reconciled consciousness would express itself through
abstract art - while pictorial and representational art captured cultural
specifics, these specifics would have been effaced, leaving abstract aesthetic
forms as the embodiment of universal and homogeneous consciousness.
However, Kojève's disposition to the culmination of
universal history is radically ambivalent. On the one hand, he follows Marx by
seeing in idyllic terms the post-historical world, one of universal freedom,
emancipation from war and want, leaving space for "art, love, play, etc., etc.,
etc.,; in short, everything that makes Man happy". However, Kojève is
simultaneously beset by pessimism. In his philosophical anthropology, man is
defined by his negating activity, by his struggle to overcome himself and
nature through struggle and contestation. This is the ontological definition of
man, his raison d'etre. Yet the end of history marks the end of this
struggle, thereby exhausting man of the activity which has defined his essence.
The end of history ushers-in the 'death of man'; paradoxically, man is robbed
of the definitional core of his existence precisely at the moment of his
triumph. Post-historical man will no longer be 'man' as we understand him, but
will be 'reanimalized', such that the end of history marks the ‘definitive
annihilation of Man properly so-called'.
6. Kojève's Influence
The influence of Kojève's thought has been profound, both
within France and beyond. It is possible to trace many connections within
French philosophy that owe varying degrees of debt to Kojève, given that his
distinctive reinterpretation of Hegel was key for the French reception of
Hegel's thought. However, there are also a number of important philosophers for
whom Kojève's Hegelianism provided direct insights that were taken-up and
in-turn used to found distinctive philosophical positions.
Firstly, we must note the importance of Kojève's Hegelianism
for Sartre's philosophical development. It is a matter of on-going contention
whether or not Sartre personally attended the Hegel seminars of the 1930s.
However, it can reasonably be claimed that Kojève's existential and Marxian
reading of the Phenomenology was equally important as Heidegger's Being
& Time for the position presented in Sartre's Being & Nothingness. Central to Sartre’s account is
a thoroughly Kojèveian philosophical anthropology, one which finds man's
essence in his freedom as pure negative activity, existentially separating the
human for-itself (pour-soi) from the natural world of reified Being (en-soi).
Sartre's account of the 'master-slave' dialectic follows Kojève’s in its
existential reworking, albeit without the optimism that finds a possibility of
reconciliation in this intersubjective struggle (for Sartre, the dialectic is
doomed to repeat a struggle for domination in which each party attempts to
claim its own freedom via the mortification of the other's Being). Moreover,
Sartre's subsequent attempts to reconcile historical materialism with
existentialism owe more than a passing debt to Kojève's original formulation of
an 'existential Marxist' position.
Another eminent thinker for whom Kojève proved decisive was
Jacques Lacan. Lacan's account of psycho-social formation was developed through
a synthesis of Freud and
structuralism, read through Kojève's ontologised version of the 'master-slave'
dialectic. For Lacan, following Kojève, human subjectivity is defined first and
foremost by desire. It is the experience of lack, the twin of the
experience of desire, that provides the ontological condition of subject
formation; it is only through the lack-desire dyad that a being comes into the
awareness of its own separation from the world in which it is, at first,
thoroughly immersed. Moreover, Lacan's account of the childhood development of
self-consciousness, captured through his analysis of the 'mirror-stage',
replays the intersubjective mediation of consciousness that Kojève presented to
his French students (Lacan amongst them) in the Hegel lectures.
Kojève also profoundly influenced the likes of Georges
Bataille and Raymond Queneau, both through the lectures they attended, and
through the friendships he maintained with them for many years after. Queneau
is often associated with Andre Breton and the surrealists (with whom he broke
in 1929), but his novels present a vision of the world that is profoundly
indebted to Kojève. Many of his most famous books depict life at the end of
history; there is no more historical movement, progress or transformation to
come, and his characters live in a kind of 'eternal present' attending to the
activities of everyday enjoyment. History recurs as something that can only be
enjoyed as a tourist attraction, or as a reverie of the past, viewed from the
vantage point of its demise. Bataille (anthropologist, philosopher and
pornographer, a doyen of recent postmodern aestheticism and
anti-rationalism) was perhaps the most powerful articulator of Kojève's
pessimism in the face of the 'death of man'. The victory of reason was, for
Bataille, a curse; its inevitable triumph in the unstoppable march of modernity
brought with it homogeneity, order, and disenchantment. The triumph of reason as history meant the
twilight and death of man, as the excessive and destructive power of negativity
was displaced by harmonious, reciprocal equilibrium. Bataille's response, a
liberatory struggle against these forces through the evocation of perverse
desires, madness, and anguish, takes Kojève's prognosis at its word, and stages
a heroic resistance against the tide of historical forces.
The influence of Kojève outside France has probably been
most pronounced in the United States. His ideas achieved a new salience and
exposure with the publication of Francis Fukayama's The End of History and
the Last Man (1992), in the wake of the Cold War. Fukayama was a student of
Allan Bloom's, who in turn was a 'disciple' of the 'esoteric' émigré political
philosopher Leo Strauss. It was Strauss who introduced a generation of his
students to Kojève's thought, and in Bloom’s case, arranged for him to study
with Kojève in Paris in the 1960s. The book, an international bestseller,
presents nothing less than a triumphal vindication of Kojève's supposedly
prescient thesis that history has found its end in the global triumph of
capitalism and liberal democracy. With the final demise of Soviet Marxism, and
the global hegemony of capitalism, we have finally reached the end of history.
There are no more battles to be fought, no more experiments in social
engineering to be attempted; the world has arrived at a homogenised state in
which the combination of capitalism and liberal democracy will reign supreme,
and all other cultural and ideological systems will be consigned irretrievably
to the past. Fukayama follows Kojève in tying the triumph of capitalism to the
satisfaction of material human needs. Moreover, he sees it as the primary
mechanism for the provision of recognition and value. Consumerism and the
commodity form, for Fukayama, present the means by which recognition is
mediated. Humans desire to be valued by others, and the means of appropriating
that valuation is the appropriation of the things that others themselves value;
hence lifestyle and fashion become the mechanisms of mutual esteem in a post-historical world governed by the
logic of capitalist individualism.
7. References and Further Reading
Butler, Judith: Subjects of Desire: Hegelian Reflections in Twentieth Century France.
New York, Columbia University Press, 1999
Descombes, Vincent: Modern French Philosophy. Cambridge, Cambridge University
Press, 1980
Drury, Shadia B: Alexandre Kojève: The Roots of Postmodern Politics. Basingstoke,
Macmillan, 1994
Fukuyama, Francis: The End of History and the Last Man. Harmondsworth, Penguin,
1992
Hegel, G.W.F: Phenomenology of Spirit. Oxford, Oxford
University Press, 1977
Heidegger, Martin: Being and Time. Oxford, Blackwell,
1962
Kojève, Alexander: Introduction to the Reading of Hegel.
New York, Basic Books, 1969
Kojève, Alexander: Kant. Paris, Gallimard, 1973
Kojève, Alexander: Le Concept, le Temps et le Discours.
Paris, Gallimard, 1991
Kojève, Alexander: Outline of a Phenomenology of Right.
London, Rowman & Littlefield, 2000
Lacan, Jacques: Ecrits: A Selection. London,
Tavistock, 1977
Poster, Mark: Existential Marxism in Postwar France: From
Sartre to Althusser. Princeton, Princeton University Press, 1975
Roth, Michael S: Knowing and History: Appropriations of
Hegel in Twentieth Century France. Ithaca and London, Cornell University
Press, 1988
Sartre, Jean-Paul: Being and Nothingness: An Essay on
Phenomenological Ontology. London, Routledge , 1989
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