A major American pragmatist educated at Harvard, Lewis taught at the University of
California from 1911
to 1919 and at Harvard from 1920 until his retirement in 1953. Known as the father of
modern modal logic
and as a proponent of the given in epistemology, he also was an influential figure in
value theory and ethics.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Introduction
Lewis's philosophy as a whole reveals a systematic unity in which logic,
epistemology, value theory
and ethics all take their place as forms of rational conduct in its broadest sense of
self-directed agency. In his
first major work, Mind and the World Order (MWO), published in 1929, Lewis put
forward a position
he called 'conceptualistic pragmatism' according to which empirical knowledge depends
upon a sensuous
'given', the constructive activity of a mind and a set of a priori concepts which
the agent brings to,
and thereby interprets, the given. These concepts are the product of the agent's social
heritage and cognitive
interests, so they are not a priori in the sense of being given absolutely: they are
pragmatically a
priori. They admit of alternatives and the choice among them rests on pragmatic
considerations pertaining
to cognitive success.
His 1932 Symbolic Logic presented his system of strict implication and a
set of successively
stronger modal logics, the S systems. He showed that there are many alternative
systems of logic, each self-
evident in its own way, a fact which undermines the traditional rationalistic view of
metaphysical first
principles as being logically undeniable. As a result, he concluded that the choice of
first principles and of
deductive systems must be grounded in extra-logical or pragmatic considerations.
After the War his work played an important part in giving shape to academic
philosophy as a
profession. His 1946 Carus Lectures, An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation
(AKV) which
represents a refinement of the doctrines of MWO and their extension to a theory
of value, set the
issues of postwar epistemology. The thoroughness of his discussion, and the
technicalities of his writing were
important models for postwar analytic philosophy. A student of Josiah Royce, William
James and Ralph
Barton Perry, a contemporary of Reichenbach, Carnap and the logical empiricists of the
30's and 40's, and the
teacher of Quine, Frankena, Goodman, Chisholm, Firth and others, C.I. Lewis played a
pivotal role in shaping
the marriage between pragmatism and empiricism which has come to dominate much of
current analytic
philosophy.
After AKV, Lewis directed the final 20 years of his life to the foundation of
ethics, giving
numerous public lectures. He died in 1964 leaving a vast collection of unpublished
manuscripts on ethical
theory which are housed at the Stanford University Library.
2. The Early Years
Lewis was born on April 12, 1883, in relative poverty at Stoneham, Massachusetts.
He enrolled in
Harvard in 1902 , working part time as a tutor and a waiter, and received his B.A.
degree three years later,
taking an appointment to teach high school English in Quincy, Massachusetts. The
following year he was
appointed Instructor in English at the University of Colorado, moved to Boulder, and that
winter married his
high school sweetheart, Mabel Maxwell Graves. They stayed in Boulder for two years
and in 1908 he enrolled
in the PhD program, receiving his degree two years later in 1910, in part because
financial concerns precluded
a more leisurely pace. His thesis, The Place of Intuition in Knowledge prefigured
important themes
in his later work.
As an undergraduate, Lewis's principal influences were James and Royce.
When he returned to
Harvard as a graduate student, James had retired, and the absolute idealism of Royce
and Bradley was under
attack by the New Realism of Moore and Russell in Great Britain and of W.P. Montague
and Ralph Barton
Perry at Harvard. The debate between Royce and James over monism and pluralism
had been replaced by a
debate between Royce and Perry over realism and idealism. Lewis studied metaphysics
with Royce, and he
studied Kant and epistemology with Perry. The debate between Royce and Perry framed
Lewis's dissertation
and in it he attempted to forge a neo-Kantian middle road.
It is worth briefly discussing his dissertation because in many way it prefigures
his later views. In his
dissertation Lewis argued that the possibility of valid, justified, knowledge requires both
givenness (or
intuition) and the mind's legislative or constructive activity. Lewis used the egocentric
predicament in a
dialectical argument against both the realist and idealist solutions to the problem of
knowledge. Against
Perry's direct realism, he argued that what is known transcends what is present to the
mind in the act of
knowledge and that the real object is thus never given in consciousness; since
knowledge requires that what
is given to the mind be interpreted by our purposeful activity the real object of knowledge
is made instead of
given.
Against Royce, Lewis asserted the necessity of a given sensuous element that
is neither a product of
willing nor necessarily implicit in the cognitive aim of ideas. The mind's activity is not
constitutive of the
known object because it does not make the given. Its purpose is rather to
understand, or interpret, the
given by referring it to an object which is real in some category or another. To
be real is a matter of
classification and only future experience will confirm or disconfirm the correctness of our
classification, but
some classification of the given will necessarily be correct. Whatever is unreal is so only
relative to a certain
way of understanding it Relative to some other purpose of understanding it will be real;
the contents of a
dream, for example are unreal only relative to a misclassification of them as a veridical
perception. All
knowledge contains a given element which shapes possible interpretation but the object
known also transcends
present experience.
It is remarkable how many themes in his mature work are already mobilized in
his dissertation.
Lewis's solution to the problem of knowledge had both realist and idealist elements in an
unstable equilibrium
and his position would change several times over the next few years. Under the
influence of Royce and
Hume's skepticism, Lewis came to believe that no realist answer to the problem of
knowledge could work,
and only an idealist solution would suffice. "How could the given be intelligible to the
mind if it were
independent of its interpretive activity?" This is a question which Lewis would not solve
to his satisfaction
until much later when he read Peirce. There is no doubt, however, that Lewis saw that a
realist of Perry's sort
had no answer to it. At this point Lewis clearly had neither proof nor account of the
relation of knowledge
to independent reality. The synthesis of his dissertation had raised deep problems
which were only to be
answered by the mature system in MWO . "How can the given be intelligible if it
is independent of
the mind?" "If the mind does not shape or condition what is given to it how could valid
knowledge be
possible?" It seemed clear to Lewis that if justified knowledge were possible at all, then
realism must be
wrong. But idealism, as Lewis understood it, appealed to a necessary agreement
between human will and the
absolute in knowledge which was also unjustifiable.
3. Logical Investigations
Lewis received his PhD in 1910 but there were no jobs. This was a bitter
disappointment for Lewis,
who with a wife and small child, had hoped the financial difficulties of the past two years
would be over.
After a summer at his uncle's farm the Lewises returned to Cambridge where Lewis
spent the year tutoring
and serving as an assistant in Royce's logic class. Royce was one of America's premier
logicians during the
time that Lewis was studying at Harvard and he introduced Lewis to Volume 1 of Russell
and Whitehead's
Principia Mathematica which had just been published.
In the fall of 1911, Lewis went to the University of California at Berkeley as an
instructor where, except
for a stint in the army during World War I, he was to stay until his return to Harvard in
1920. During this
period, Lewis worked primarily on epistemology and logic and, finding no logic texts
available, was soon at
work on a text on symbolic logic. This work would appear at the end of the war in 1918
as A Survey of
Symbolic Logic the first history of the subject in English -- and would form the
basis of his better
known Symbolic Logic , written together with C. H. Langford and published in
1932. Lewis's work
on logic was dictated in part by the need for a good text book and in part by objections
to the paradoxes of
material implication in Principia Mathematica and his desire to develop an
account of inference more
reflective of human reasoning. However, Lewis was still exercised by the problem of
knowledge from his
dissertation and was increasingly unhappy with the quasi-idealist solution he had
explored there. In fact,
Lewis's study of logic during this period was at least in part directed towards examining
important idealist
assumptions about logic, which he would come to reject.
To solve the problem of knowledge the idealist needed logical truth to be
absolute, for if the categorial
form of our constructive will could vary then we would have no reason to take our
interpretations to be true
of the world. Lewis would attack the idealist assumptions in four related ways. First, he
would argue that the
coherence of a system of propositions depends upon the consistency of the propositions
with each other and
not on their dependence upon a set of absolute or self-evident truths. Secondly, he
argued that a system rich
enough to capture the notion of a world, or system of facts, is necessarily pluralistic in
the sense that it must
contain elements which are logically independent of each other. Thirdly, he argued that
the existence of
alternative deductive systems completely undermines the rationalistic view that
metaphysical first principles
can be shown to be logically necessary through the argument of 'reaffirmation through
denial' (where in the
attempt to deny a logical principle we necessarily presuppose its truth). Finally, he
concluded that given the
existence of alternative systems of logic, the choice of first principles and of deductive
systems must be
grounded in extra-logical, pragmatic considerations.
Lewis's work in logic was also guided in part by concerns about Russell's choice
of material
implication as a paradigm of logical deduction. Lewis constructed his own logical
calculus based on relations
in intention and strict implication, which he saw as a more adequate model of actual
inference. Material
implication has the property that a false proposition implies everything and so argued
Lewis it is useless as
a model of real inference. What we want to know is what would follow from a proposition
if it were true and
for Lewis this amounts to saying that the real basis of the inference is the strict
implication where 'A strictly
implies B' means that 'The truth of A is inconsistent with the falsity of B.' Lewis saw his
account of strict
implication to have important consequences for metaphysics and for the normative in
general. He argued that
the line dividing propositions corroborated or refuted by logic alone (necessary or
logically impossible
propositions) from the class of empirical truths or falsehood was of first importance of
the theory of
knowledge. The categories of possible and impossible, contingent and necessary,
consistent and inconsistent
are all independent of material truth and are founded on logic itself.
In 1920 Lewis was invited to return to Harvard to take up a one year position as
Lecturer in
Philosophy and was to remain for over 30 years until his retirement in 1953. There
Lewis was reintroduced
to Peirce and the last piece of his account of knowledge would fall into place,
THE PRAGMATIC a priori. After Peirce's death Royce had arranged for the Peirce manuscripts to be
brought to Harvard, and at
the time of Lewis's appointment the department was concerned that the manuscript
remains, consisting of
thousands of pages of apparently unorganized material, be catalogued. Lewis was
given the job and although
the task of arranging and cataloguing the papers ultimately passed to others, the two
years he spent on that task
gave Lewis the final building blocks for his mature epistemological position which he
would call
conceptualistic pragmatism. Lewis would find in Peirce's "conceptual pragmatism," with
its emphasis upon
the instrumental and empirical significance of concepts rather than upon any
non-absolute character of truth,
a resonance with his logical investigations.
Lewis in effect would turn the idealist thesis that mind determined the structure of
reality on its head
without giving up the idealist view of the legislative power of the mind. The mind
interprets the given by way
of concepts: the real, ultimately, becomes a matter of criterial commitment. The mind
does not thereby
manufacture what is given to it, but meets the independent given with interpretive
structures which it brings
to the encounter. In his dissertation Lewis had argued that the possibility of valid,
justified, knowledge
requires both givenness and the mind's legislative or constructive activity. The
epistemological view Lewis
would now develop retained this basic structure but embedded it in a richer,
psycho-biological model of
inquiry and a more adequate account of the role of a priori concepts in
knowledge. In the early 20's
Lewis would publish two seminal articles, "A Pragmatic Conception of The a
priori," and "The
Pragmatic Element in Knowledge." These two papers laid out the core of Lewis's
pragmatic theory of
knowledge, which would be developed more richly in Mind and the World Order
(MWO).
In "A Pragmatic Conception of the a priori," Lewis rejected traditional
concepts of the a
priori arguing that, "The thought which both rationalism and empiricism have missed
is that there are
principles, representing the initiative of mind, which impose upon experience no
limitations whatever, but that
such conceptions are still subject to alternation on pragmatic grounds when the
expanding boundaries of
experience reveal their felicity as intellectual instruments." What is important about an
hypothesis is that it
is a "concept" -- a purely logical meaning -- which can be brought to bear on experience.
The concepts we
formulate are in part determined by our pragmatic interests and in part by the nature of
experience.
Fundamental scientific laws are a priori because they order experience so that it
can be investigated.
The same is true of our more fundamental categorial notions. The given contains both
the real and illusion,
dream and fantasy. Our categorial concepts allow us to sort experience so that it can be
interrogated. Thus
the fact that we must fix our meanings before we can apply them productively in
experience, is entirely
compatible with their historical alteration or even abandonment.
In "The Pragmatic Element in Knowledge", Lewis extended his pragmatism about
the a
priori to the theory of knowledge. Here, following Peirce and Royce, he identifies
three elements in
knowledge which are separable only by analysis: the element of experience which is
given to an agent, the
structure of concepts with which the agent interprets what is given, and the agent's act
of interpreting what is
given by means of those concepts. The distinctively pragmatic character of this theory
lies both in the fact
that knowledge is activity or interpretation and that the concepts with which the mind
interrogates experience
reflect fallible and revisable commitments to future experiential consequences.
Knowledge is an interpretation
of the experiential significance for an agent with certain interests of what is given in
experience; a significance
testable by its consequences for action.
A priori truth is independent of experience because it is purely analytic of
our concepts and
can dictate nothing to the given. The formal sciences depend on nothing which is
empirically given, depending
purely on logical analysis for their content. So a priori truth is not assertive of
fact but is instead
definitive. There is logical order arising from our definitions in all knowledge. Ordinarily
we do not separate
out this logical order, but it is always possible to do so, and it is this element which
minds must have in
common if they are to understand each other. As Lewis puts it, "At the end of an hour
which feels very long
to you and short to me, we can meet by agreement, because our common
understanding of that hour is not a
feeling of tedium or vivacity, but means sixty minutes, one round of the clock...". In
short, shared concepts
do not depend upon the identity of sense feeling, but in their objective significance for
action.
The concept, the purely logical pattern of meaning, is an abstraction from the
richness of actual
experience. It represents what the mind brings to experience in the act of
interpretation. The other
element, that which the mind finds , or what is independent of thought, is the
given. The given is also
an abstraction, but it cannot be expressed in language because language implies
concepts and because the
given is that aspect of experience which concepts do not convey. Knowledge is the
significance which
experience has for possible action and the further experience to which such action
would lead.
4. Mind and the World Order
Lewis first major book, Mind and the World Order (MWO) develops these
results in three
principal theses: first, a priori truth is definitive and offers criteria by means of
which experience can
be discriminated; second, the application of concepts to any particular experience is
hypothetical and the
choice of conceptual system meets pragmatic needs; and third, the susceptibility of
experience to conceptual
interpretation requires no particular metaphysical assumption about the conformity of
experience to the mind
or its categories. These principles allow Lewis to present the traditional problem of
knowledge as resting on
a mistake. There is no contradiction between the relativity of knowledge to the knowing
mind and the
independence of its object. The assumption that there is, is the product of Cartesian
representationalism, the
'copy theory' of thought, in which knowledge of an object is taken to be qualitative
coincidence between the
idea in the mind and the external real object. For Lewis knowledge does not copy
anything but concerns the
relation between this experience and other possible experiences of which this
experience is a sign. Knowledge
is expressible not because we share the same data of sense but because we share
concepts and categorial
commitments.
All knowledge is conceptual; the given, having no conceptual structure of its
own, is not even a
possible object of knowledge. Foundationalism of the classical empiricist sort is thus
directly precluded.
Lewis's task for MWO is in effect a pragmatic solution to Hume's problem of
induction: an account
of the order we bring to experience which renders knowledge possible but makes no
appeal to anything lying
outside of experience. Prefiguring contemporary externalist accounts of representation,
Lewis argues that both
representative realism and phenomenalism are incoherent. Knowledge as correct
interpretation is independent
of whether the phenomenal character of experience is a "likeness" of the real object
known, because the
phenomenal character of experience only receives its function as a sign from its
conceptual interpretation, that
is, from its significance for future experience and action. The question of the validity of
knowledge claims
is thus for Lewis fundamentally the question of the normative significance of our
empirical assessments for
action.
Lewis argued that our spontaneous interpretation of experience by way of
concepts that have
objective significance for future experience constitutes a kind of diagnosis of
appearance . If we
could not recognize a sensuous content in our classification of it with qualitatively similar
ones which have
acquired predictive significance in the past, interpretation would be impossible. Despite
the fact that such
recognition is spontaneous and unconsidered it has the logical character of a
generalization. To recognize an
object -- "this is a round penny" -- is to make a fallible empirical claim, but to recognize
the appearance is
to classify it with other qualitatively similar appearances. The basis of the empirical
judgment lies in the fact
that past instances of such classification have been successful. Our empirical
knowledge claims are dependent
for their justification upon this body of conceptual interpretations in two ways. First, the
world, in the form
of future events implicitly predicted (or not) by our empirical judgments, will confirm or
disconfirm those
judgments: all empirical knowledge is thus merely probable. But secondly, the
classification of immediate
apprehensions by way of concepts justifying particular empirical judgments is itself
generalization even when
those concepts have come to function as a criterion of sense meaning. Concepts
become criteria of
classification because they allow us to make empirically valid judgments, and because
they fit usefully in the
larger structure of our concepts.
This structure, looked at apart from experience is an a priori system of
concepts. The
application of one of its constituent concepts to any particular is a matter of probability
but the question of
applying the system in general is a matter of the choice of an abstract system and can
only be determined by
pragmatic considerations. The implications of a concept within a system become criteria
of its applicability
in that system. If later experience does not accord with the logical implications of our
application of a concept
to a particular, we will withdraw the application of the concept. Persistent failure of
individual concepts to
apply fruitfully to experience will lead us to readjust the system as a whole. Our
conceptual interpretations
form a hierarchy in which some are more fundamental than others; abandoning them will
have more radical
consequences than abandoning others. Lewis's account of inquiry offers both a
non-metaphysical account of
induction and an early version of the so called 'theory-ladenness of observation terms'.
There is no need for
synthetic a priori or metaphysical truths to bridge the gap between abstract
concepts in the mind and
the reality presented in experience. Lewis offers a kind of 'Kantian deduction of the
categories' providing
a pragmatic vindication of induction but without Kant's assumption that experience is
limited by the modes
of intuition and fixed forms of thought. Without a system of conceptual interpretation, no
experience is
possible, but which system of interpretation we use is a matter of choice and
what we experience is
given to us by reality. The importance of the given in this story is its independence
. Our conceptual
system can at best specify a system of possible worlds; within it the actual is not to be
deduced but
acknowledged. In short, Lewis's theory of knowledge in MWO is a pragmatic
theory of inquiry which
combines rationalist and naturalistic elements to make knowledge of the real both fallible
and progressive
without recourse to transcendental guarantees.
5. The Conversation with Positivism
MWO was published in 1929 during a time of tragedy for Lewis and his
family.
MWO was very well received and Lewis's career was now secure; he was
elected to the American
Academy of Arts and Sciences in May of 1929 and made a full professor at Harvard in
1930. But his daughter
died that year after two years of a mysterious ailment and a few years later Lewis
suffered a heart attack due
to overwork. Despite life's trials, the period between MWO and AKV was
a period of
intellectual expansion for Lewis. Lewis began to explore the consequences of his views
for value theory and
ethics. At the same time his logical interests shifted. While technical issues continued
to occupy his attention
for the next few years, largely in the form of replies to responses to his work in
Symbolic Logic , his
thinking shifted decisively away from technicalities and towards the experiential structure
of meaning and its
relation to value and knowledge. There were several reasons for this.
The period was a time of decisive change in philosophy in America generally.
The influx of British
and German philosophy into the United States during the thirties and the increasing
professionalization of the
universities, posed deep and ambiguous problems for American philosophers with a
naturalistic or pragmatic
orientation, and for Lewis in particular. Logical empiricism, with its emphasis on
scientific models of
knowledge and on the logical analysis of meaning claims was emerging as the most
pervasive tendency in
American philosophy in the thirties and forties, and Lewis was strongly identified with
that movement. But
Lewis was never completely comfortable in this company. For Lewis, experience was
always at the center
of the cognitive enterprise. The rapid abandonment of experiential analysis in favor of
physicalism by the
major positivists and their rejection of value as lacking cognitive significance both struck
him as particularly
unfortunate. Indeed his own deepening conversation with the pragmatic tradition led
him in the opposite
direction. It is only within experience that anything could have significance for anything,
and Lewis came to
see that rather than lacking cognitive significance, value is one way of representing the
significance which
knowledge has for future conduct. Attempting to work out these convictions led him to
reflect on the
differences between pragmatism and positivism, and to begin to investigate the
cognitive structure of value
experiences.
The pragmatist, Lewis holds, is committed to the Peircean pragmatic test of
significance. But, as he
notes in his 1930 essay, "Pragmatism and Current Thought," this dictum can be taken in
either of two
directions. On the one hand, its emphasis on experience could be developed in a
psychologistic direction and
promote a form of subjectivism. On the other, the fact that the Peircean test limits
meaning to that which
makes a verifiable difference in experience takes it in the direction which he developed
in MWO, to
a view of concepts as abstractions in which "the immediate is precisely that element
which must be left out."
But this claim must be correctly understood. An operational account of concepts empties
them only of what
is ineffable in experience. "If your hours are felt as twice as long as mine, your pounds
twice as heavy, that
makes no difference, which can be tested, in our assignment of physical properties to
things." A concept is
thus merely a relational pattern. But it does not follow from this that the world as it is
experienced is thrown
out the window. "In one sense that of connotation a concept strictly comprises
nothing but an abstract
configuration of relations. In another sense its denotation or empirical application this
meaning is vested
in a process which characteristically begins with something given and ends with
something done in the
operation which translates a presented datum into an instrument of prediction and
control." Knowledge is a
matter of two moments, beginning and ending in experience although it does not end in
the same experience
in which it begins. Knowledge of something requires that the experience which is
anticipated or envisaged
as verifying it is actually met with. Thus, the appeal to an operational definition or test of
verifiability as the
empirical meaning of a statement is, for the pragmatist, the requirement that the speaker
know how to apply
or refuse to apply the statement in question and to trace its consequences in the case of
presented or imagined
situations.
In his 1933 presidential address to the American Philosophical Association,
"Experience and
Meaning", Lewis dealt with the question of verifiable significance in a very general way
emphasizing both
the points of agreement and difference between pragmatism and logical positivism.
Lewis framed the
discussion of meaning in terms of the distinction between immediacy and
transcendence, sketching arguments
against both phenomenalism and representational realism. What remains, the third
way, is a view of meaning
common to absolute idealism, logical positivism and pragmatism. Meaning is a relation
of verifiability or
signification between present and possible future experience.
In "Logical Positivism and Pragmatism", Lewis compared his pragmatic
conception of empirical
meaning with the verificationism of logical positivism in a sharply critical way. Both
movements, he argued,
are forms of empiricism and hold conceptions of empirical meaning as verifiable
ultimately by reference to
empirical eventualities. The pragmatic conception of meaning looks superficially very
much like the logical-
positivist theory of verification despite its different formulation and its focus on action.
But, argues Lewis,
there is a deep difference. Whereas the pragmatic account rests meaning ultimately
upon conceivable
experience, the positivist account logicizes the relation. Lewis's complaint is that this
results in a conception
of meaning which omits precisely what a pragmatist would count as the empirical
meaning. Specifying which
observation sentences are consequences of a given sentence helps us know the
empirical meaning of a
sentences only if the observation sentences themselves have an already understood
empirical meaning in terms
of the specific qualities of experience to which the observations predicates of the
statement apply. Thus for
Lewis the logical positivist fails to distinguish between linguistic meaning, which
concerns logical relations
with other terms, and empirical meaning, which concerns the relation expressions have
to what may be given
in experience, and as a result, leaves out precisely the thing which actually confirms a
statement, namely the
content of experience.
The emphasis on the experience of the knower points to a yet larger contrast
between positivism and
pragmatism regarding the difference between judgments of value and judgments of fact.
Lewis was entirely
opposed to the positivist conception of value statements as devoid of cognitive content,
as merely expressive.
For the pragmatist all judgments are, implicitly, judgments of value. Lewis would
develop both the
conception of sense meaning and the thesis that valuation is a form of empirical
cognition in AKV .
6. Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation
In 1946 The Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation (AKV) was published,
and Lewis was
awarded the Edgar Pierce Professorship at Harvard, the chair which had been held by
Perry and would be held
by Quine after Lewis. AKV was the most widely discussed book of its day.
The pragmatic psycho-biological model of inquiry which Lewis adopted from
Peirce and James is
even more visibly a part of AKV than it was in MWO. Knowledge, action
and evaluation
are essentially connected animal adaptive responses. Cognition, as a vital function, is a
response to the
significance which items in an organism's experiential environment have for that
organism. Any
psychological attitude which carries cognitive significance as a response will exhibit
some value character of
utility or disutility which can ground the correctness or incorrectness of that response as
knowledge.
Cognitively guided behavior is a kind of adaptive response, and the correctness of
behavior guiding
experience, to the extent that it carries cognitive significance, depends simply on
whether the expectations
lodged in it come about as the result of action. Meaning, in this sense is anticipation of
further experience
associated with present content and the truth of it concerns the verifiability of expected
consequences of
action. It is because of this that sense-apprehension is basic and underlies other forms
of empirical cognition.
Perceptual cognition involves a sign-function connecting present experience and
possible future eventualities
grounded in some mode of action which, pervading the experience in its immediacy,
gives it its cognitive
content.
The signifying character of the expectancies lodged in immediate experience is
enormously expanded
by the web of concepts we inherit as language users. Lewis did not, however, identify
meaning with linguistic
signs. Linguistic signs are secondary to something more basic in our experience which
we share with animals
generally and which occurs when something within our experience stands for something
else as a sign. When
the cat comes running because she hears you opening a can and takes it as a sign of
dinner, she is responding
to the meaning of her experience. While this meaning is independent of whether or not
you are opening a can
of cat food her expectation will be confirmed if the can contains cat food and
disconfirmed if it doesn't.
Meaning in this sense of empirical significance could only be available to a
creature who can act in
anticipation of events to be realized or avoided. Accordingly, the possible is
epistemologically prior to the
actual. Only an agent, for whom experience could have anticipatory significance, could
have a concept of
objective reality as that which is possible to verify or change. In addition to meaning as
empirical significance
Lewis distinguished the kind of meaning involved in the apprehension of our concepts. A
definition represents
a mode of classification, and although alternative modes of classification can be more or
less useful,
classification cannot be determined by that which is to be classified. Knowledge of
meanings in this sense
is analytic.
In AKV, Lewis distinguishes between four modes of meaning: (1) the
denotation or extension
of a term is the class of actual things to which the terms applies; (2) the comprehension
of a term is the class
of all possible things to which the term would correctly apply; (3) the signification of a
term is the character
of things the presence or absence of which determines the comprehension of the term;
(4) the intension of
a term is the conjunction of all the other terms which must be correctly applicable to
anything to which the
term correctly applies. A proposition is a term capable of signifying a state of affairs; it
comprehends any
possible world which would contain the state of affairs it signifies. The intension of a
proposition includes
whatever the proposition entails and thus comprises whatever must be true of any
possible world for that
proposition to be true of it.
Intentional and denotational modes of meaning are two aspects of cognitive
apprehension in general,
the denotational being that aspect of apprehension which, given our classifications, is
dependent upon how
experience turns out, and the intentional being that aspect of apprehension which
reflects the classifications
or definitions we have made and is thus independent of experience. Our choice of
classification is essentially
pragmatic, however, so what may count as an empirical matter in one context may count
legislatively in
another, generalizations may be corrected by future experience and our definitions
replaced on the grounds
of inadequacy. The analytic element in knowledge is indispensable because unless our
intensions are fixed
our terms have no denotation, but nothing determines how we shall fix our intensions
save the superior utility
of one set of terms over others.
While intensional meaning is primary for him, Lewis distinguishes between two
different ways in
which we can think of it. First, linguistic meaning is intension as constituted by the
pattern of definitions of
our terms. Secondly, sense meaning is intension as the criterion in terms of sense by
which the application
of terms to experience is determined. Sense meaning is more fundamental. Learning
involves the extension
of generalizations to unobserved cases and correlatively recognizing in new experiences
the correct
applicability of our terms. The sense meaning of a term is our criterion for applying the
term correctly. In
a thought experiment anticipating Searle's "Chinese Room," Lewis imagines a person
who somehow learns
Arabic using only an Arabic dictionary thus learning all the linguistic patterns in the
language. This person
would grasp the linguistic meanings of all the terms in Arabic but might nonetheless not
know the meaning
of any of the terms in the sense of knowing their application to the world. The language
would remain a
meaningless and arbitrary system of syntactic relationships. Linguistic meaning is
nonetheless central in
communication because what can be shared is conceptual structure. Understanding
between two minds
depends not on postulated identity of imagery or sensation but on shared definitions and
concepts.
The validation of empirical knowledge has two dimensions, its verification and its
justification.
Verification is predictive and formulates our expectations for verification or falsification.
Justification looks
to the rational credibility of those expectations prior to their verification. In the
acquisition of knowledge
these dimensions support each other. The warrant which our present beliefs have is
shaped by the history of
past verifications of similar beliefs. Reflection on the warranted expectancies in our
present beliefs leads us
to formulate new generalizations and normative principles we can subject to tests. The
common stock of
concepts in our language embeds such principles and empirical generalizations in the
intensions of terms. As
a result our use of terms decisively shapes what is warranted and verifiable for us.
Lewis distinguishes between three classes of empirical statements. First, there
are what he calls
expressive statements which attempt to express what is presently given in experience.
An ordinary perceptual
judgment, say seeing my cat by the fridge, outstrips what is presently evident. This
added content is carried
by the intensions of the concepts in the judgment insofar as they convey the
expectancies found in the
experience. These expectancies, although partly a function of past learning and
knowledge of the intension
of terms, are simply given in the experience, they are the part we do not invent and
cannot change but merely
find. Lewis suggests that we can use language expressively to capture this
presentational content by stripping
our meaning of its ordinary implication of objective content. Secondly, there are
statements which formulate
predictions. The judgment that if I do action A the outcome will include E, where E
indicates an aspect of
experience expressively characterized, is one which can be completely verified by
putting it to the test. Upon
acting the content E will either be given or it will not. Lewis calls empirical judgments of
this sort terminating
judgments. Finally, there are judgments which assert the actuality of some state of
affairs. Although they can
be rendered increasingly probable by tests, no set of eventualities envisioned can
exhaust their significance.
Lewis calls these judgments non-terminating because there are indefinitely many further
tests which could,
theoretically speaking, falsify the prediction and any actual verification can be no more
than partial.
The ground of empirical judgments is past experience of like cases. At bottom
those experiences have
a warrant-producing character for a particular response because of the directly
apprehended qualitative
character of the signal combined with the expectations due to similar experiences in the
past. In short, an
empirical judgment is justified by its relation to past experiences of like cases. The
warrant producing
character of those experiences for a particular judgment depends upon the recognition
of the presentation as
classifiable with other qualitatively similar appearances as significant of future
experience, and the character
of the passages of experience attending past instances of the judgment. Epistemic
warrant at its bottom level
is the animal's recognition of future objectivity lodged in present experience; present
experience is a sign of
experience to come. A multi-storied interpretive structure of concepts is built upon this
adaptive
responsiveness. Concepts become criteria of classification because they allow us to
make empirically valid
judgments, and because they fit usefully in the larger structure of our concepts. The
structure, viewed apart
from experience, is an a priori system of concepts, but looked at in terms of
experience it is a network
of sense meanings. The concept of probability plays a more prominent role in
AKV than it does in
MWO, but it is not a role of a different kind.
Perceptual knowledge has two aspects: the givenness of the experience and the
objective interpretation
which, in light of past experience, we put on it. But these are both abstractions and only
distinguishable by
analysis. What is given in experience as spontaneously arising expectancies is already
conceptually structured,
to recognize the given is to classify it with qualitatively similar cases and that
recognition, although
spontaneous, has the logical character as a generalization. The system of concepts
within which our judgments
are formulated and the pyramidal structure of empirical beliefs which intend a set of
possible worlds of which
ours is but one, by themselves suggest a coherence theory of justification. But here, as
in MWO,
Lewis resists this idealist alternative. Lewis takes the given to be essential for a series
of interrelated reasons.
Mere coherence of a system of statements does not even give meaning; the student of
Arabic mentioned earlier
does not know what any of the terms mean and cannot even use a statement to express
a judgment. The given
thus plays the role of fixing what beliefs mean because it lodges the actual world among
the various possible
worlds which are compatible with my knowledge: whichever world I am in it is this one.
A merely
hypothetical system of congruent and consistent statements could be fabricated out of
whole cloth, as a
novelist does, but however richly developed, the congruence and coherence of the
system would be no
evidence of fact at all. Independently given facts are indispensable and they are the
actually given
expectancies whose objective intent we then can evaluate for their mutual congruence
and coherence.
Lewis's emphasis on the given has been taken by many contemporary
philosophers to be an instance
of classical foundationalism. As we saw in the discussion of MWO Lewis
considered the very idea
of sense data to be incoherent. There is, however, a debate about whether his views
changed between that
book and AKV. Christopher Gowans (in "Two Concepts of the Given in C.I.
Lewis, Realism and
Foundationalism") has argued that Lewis had two different conceptions of the given but
failed to recognize
the difference between them. On this view, while Lewis was an anti-foundationalist in
MWO he
embraced foundationalism in AKV and his later thinking. Determining Lewis's
position is, of course,
a matter of interpretation. I think that a non-foundationalist position is dictated by the
larger structure of his
thought. He was certainly not a foundationalist in the British empiricist sense of the
word.
7. Valuation and Rightness
Lewis rejected the "scandal" of emotivism and noncognitivism and directed much
of his late thinking
to two tasks: demonstrating that valuation is a species of empirical knowledge and
establishing that there are
valid nonrepudiable imperatives or principles of rightness. Lewis's acceptance of the
psycho-biological model
of inquiry and it's emphasis on the evolutionary and biological ground of cognition in
animal adaptive
response, committed him to the ineliminability of value in knowledge. Inquiry directed
towards epistemic
goals is, he argued, no less a species of conduct than practical and moral inquiry.
Conduct of any sort will
be directed towards ends appropriate to it and in light of which both its success can be
measured and its aim
be critiqued as reasonable or unreasonable. Lewis argued that evaluations are a form of
empirical knowledge
no different fundamentally from other forms of empirical knowledge regarding the
determination of their truth
or falsity, or of their validity or justification.
Much of Lewis's discussion takes the form of an analysis of the concepts
surrounding rational
agency. Purposeful activity intrinsically involves rational cognitive appraisal. Action is
behavior which is
deliberate in the sense of being subject to critique and alterable upon reflection. It is
behavior for the sake of
realizing something to which a positive value is ascribed. He characterizes an action as
sensible just
in case the result or its intent, is ascribed comparative value. The purpose of an act, by
which he means that
part of the intent of an act for the sake of which it is adopted, can also be said to be
sensible because what is
purposed is something to which comparative value is ascribed. An act is successful
in the
circumstance that it is adopted for a sensible purpose which is realized in the result.
The verification of success will depend upon the purpose for which the act is
done. The success of
an action aimed at an enjoyable experience can be decisively verified if that experience
is attained, but
typically the purpose of an act will be to bring about a state of affairs whose
value-consequences extend into
the future and will thus be affected by other states of affairs, and so the success of the
act may never be fully
verified. In addition, an act may fail of its purpose in two ways: the expected result may
fail to follow or it
may be realized but fail to have the value ascribed to it.
Just as there are two aspects to the validation of empirical belief, verification and
justification, Lewis
distinguishes the success (or verification) of an action from its practical justification,
which is the character
belonging to a belief just in case its intent is an expectation which is a warranted
empirical belief. Given these
distinctions, Lewis argues that unless values were truth-apt in the sense of being
genuine empirical cognitions
capable of confirmation or disconfirmation, no intention or purpose could be serious and
hence no action
could be justified or attain success. The enterprise of human life can only prosper, he
says, if there are value
judgments which are true. Those who deny it fall into a kind of practical contradiction
similar to that of
Epimenides the Cretan who said that all Cretans are liars. Making a judgment, framing
an argument, and
deciding to take an action, are all activities which involve bringing to bear cognitive
criteria of classification,
inference and cogency on the matter at hand. Thinking is an activity which presupposes
selective and
intelligent choice concerning the path of thought. Repudiation of the rational
imperativeness of so selectively
choosing is thus nothing less than a repudiation of the cognitive aim of thinking. All the
different forms of
imperatives, the epistemic and logical imperatives, the technical, prudential and moral
imperatives, are of a
piece: they are principles of right intellectual conduct, in short, principles of intelligent
practice. The notions
of correctness, conduct, objectivity and reality are all forged within the system of
communal practices which
give these concepts ground. Our conceptual framework is not merely a set of common
concepts but also a
set of communal norms regulating our conduct. We can reject these norms only by
repudiating our conceptual
framework, but there is no other ground of rational choice which could provide a warrant
for an act of
repudiation, so that the act of repudiating norms tacitly presupposes the warrant which
norms provide. The
skeptic's own claims constitute a reductio ad absurdum against his position.
As we saw, Lewis distinguished between three classes of empirical statement,
expressive, terminating
and non-terminating statements. Since valuation is a species of empirical knowledge
Lewis distinguishes
between three kinds of value-predications. First, there are expressive statements of
found value quality as
directly experienced. Such predications require no verification as they make no claim
which could be
subjected to test. Secondly, there are terminating evaluations which predict the
success of an action
aimed at some value experience as result. These can be put to test by so acting and
thus are directly verifiable.
Finally there are non-terminating evaluations which ascribe an objective value
property to an object
or state of affairs. Like any other judgment of objective empirical fact such claims are
always fallible though
some may attain practical certainty.
Since the aim of sensible action is the realization of some positive value in
experience, only what is
immediately valuable can be valuable for its own sake or intrinsically valuable.
Extrinsic values
divide into values which are instrumental for some thing else and values found to
be inherent in
objects, situations or states of affairs. Value, Lewis argues, is not a kind of quality but a
dimension-like
orientational mode pervading all experience. To live and to act is necessarily to be
subject to imperatives, to
recognize the validity of norms. The good which we seek in action is not this or that
presently given value
experience but a life which is good on the whole. That is something which cannot be
immediately disclosed
in present experience but can only be comprehended by some imaginative or synthetic
envisagement of its on-
the-whole quality. We are subject to imperatives because future possibilities are
present in our experience
only as signs of the significance which that experience has for the future if we decide to
act one way rather
than another. Since we are free to act or not we must move ourselves in accordance
with the directive import
of our experience to realize future goods. Life is not an aggregate of separate moments
but a synthetic whole
in which no single experience momentarily given says the last word about itself: each
moment has its own
fixed and unalterable character but the significance of that character for the whole, like
the significance of a
note within a piece of music, depends upon the character of other experiences to which
it stands in relation.
The value assessment of experiential wholes can never be directly certain nor decisively
verified in any
experience because what is to be assessed is a whole of experiences as it is
experienced, and there is no
moment in which this experiential whole is present. The value of experiential wholes
thus essentially involves
memory and narrative interpretation.
8. The Late Ethics
A discussion of Lewis's philosophy would not be complete without a discussion of
his late work in
ethics. Lewis's ethics, toward which the whole of his mature philosophical work aimed, is
a richly developed
foundation for a common sense reflective morality, broadly within the American
pragmatic naturalistic
tradition. No one can cogently repudiate the ethical task and it is not the special
mission of any discipline.
At the center of Lewis's theory of practical reason is the rational imperative. While a
naturalist with respect
to values, he held practical thinking in all its forms to rest for its cogency on categorically
valid principles of
right. Ethics, epistemology and logic are all inquiries into species of right conduct. They
are kinds of thinking,
subject to our deliberate self-government and thus to normative critique, and as a
consequence they are all
forms of practical reason.
Under the influence of Kant, he held that imperatives are rational constraints put
on our thinking by
our nature as rational beings. He offered several arguments including a pragmatic
'Kantian deduction' of the
principles of practice, arguing that without universally valid principles of practice, our
experience of ourselves
as agents would be impossible. He also offered a reductio ad absurdum against
the skeptic. The
denial of moral imperatives is pragmatically incoherent because it in effect attempts to
mount a valid argument
to the conclusion that there is no such thing as validity in argument; the skeptic's attempt
to deny the universal
validity of such imperatives involves him in what Lewis called a pragmatic contradiction
and leads by a
reductio ad absurdum to the confirmation of their validity. By implicitly asking us
to weigh and
consider his reasons, the skeptic appeals to reasons and argument as things which
should constrain us in our
beliefs and decisions, whether we like it or not and thus acknowledges their force in his
practice. Imperatives
are not arbitrary commands or recommendations to the self; they are directly and
cognitively present in the
agent's experience.
Rational imperatives must underlie all forms of rational self-regulation, of which
ethics proper is only
one department. Arguing, concluding, believing are also forms of self-governed conduct
and it is to these
forms that his argument first turns. Experience itself is for Lewis dynamically shaped by
our classifications
and judgments; as a temporal process its present moments are pervaded by implicit
judgments, expectations
and valuations, grounded in past expectations and confirmations. Permeated with value
and active assessment,
experience is a weave of givenness and conduct, of doing and suffering. Value qualities
are verifiably found
in experience; objective valuations are both fallible and corrigible. They are judgments
which reflect the
justified expectation of good (or unfavorable) consequences on the assumption of
actions envisaged.
Accordingly, the evaluative ought the rational imperative is at the heart of human
experience. At the
beginning his 1954 Woodbridge Lectures, as The Ground and Nature of the Right
, he argues "To
say that a thing is right is simply to characterize it as representing the desiderated
commitment of choice in
any situation calling for deliberate decision. What is right is thus the question of all
questions; and the
distinction of right and wrong extends to every topic or reflection and to all that human
self-determination of
act or attitude may affect."
Despite the critical priority of the right it is in the service of the good; and Lewis's
account of both
reflects a single commitment to the pragmatic structure of inquiry. Ethics grows out of
the fact that human
beings are active creatures who enter into the process of reality in order to change it.
We are also social
creatures whose experience and needs are taken up thematically in the categories and
organized practices
which make up our social inheritance. For Lewis both what is judged justifiably to be
good and what ways
of achieving it are validly imperative are fallibly grounded in human experience;
skepticism about either the
right or the good is ultimately a failure to acknowledge that fact. Since we are endowed
with the capacity to
do by choosing we are obligated to exercise it. We must decide even if we
choose to do nothing, and
the world will be different depending on how we decide
To say that human beings are self-conscious and self-governing creatures
means, for Lewis, that they
perceive their environment in terms of predictively hypothetical imperatives between
which they are able to
choose. Beliefs and imperatives are thus only modally distinct; they contain the same
information. What
Lewis calls the "Law of Objectivity" is governing oneself by the advice of cognition, in
contravention if
necessary to our impulses and inclination. Directives of doing, determined by the good
or bad results of
conforming to them, fall into various modes, principally the technical, the prudential and
the moral and the
logical. The imperative force of technical rules presumes as antecedently determined
some class of ends; they
justify actions only on the assumption of the justification of those ends. The rules of
technique are thus
hypothetical imperatives. By contrast, the rules of the critique of consistence and
cogency, of prudence and
of the moral are non-repudiable; they are categorical.
In his final years Lewis worked on a book on the foundations of ethics. It is clear
from his manuscripts
and letters that the ethics book occupied Lewis's attention in the early forties and for the
rest of his life. While
it is difficult to understand why Lewis was unable to work the material into a form which
satisfied him, I think
that it had come to have an importance in his mind, a finality, which combined with his
declining health,
prevented a final satisfactory version being written for he continued to work on his ethics
book writing almost
daily until his death in February of 1964.
9. Major Works by Lewis
Lewis, C.I., 1929. Mind and The World Order: an Outline of a Theory of Knowledge
.
Charles Scribner's Sons, New York, 1929, reprinted in paperback by Dover
Publications, Inc.
New York, 1956.
Lewis, C.I., 1932a. Symbolic Logic (with C.H. Langford). New York: The
Appleton-Century
Company, 1932 pp. xii +506, reprinted in paperback by New York: Dover
Publications,
1951.
Lewis,C. I., 1946. An Analysis of Knowledge and Valuation , (The Paul
Carus Lectures,
Series 8, 1946) Open Court, La Salle, 1946.
Lewis, C.I., 1955a. The Ground and Nature of the Right , The Woodbridge
Lectures, V,
delivered at Columbia University in November 1954, New York, Columbia University
Press,
1955.
Lewis, C.I., 1957a. Our Social Inheritance , Mahlon Powell Lectures at
University of
Indiana, 1956, Bloomington, Indiana, Indiana University Press, 1957.
Collected Papers of Clarence Irving Lewis , ed. John D. Goheen and John L.
Mothershead,
Jr., Stanford University Press, Stanford, 1970. (Includes most of Lewis's most
important
articles.)
Values and Imperatives, Studies in Ethics , ed. John Lange, Stanford
University Press,
Stanford, California, 1969. (Includes a number of Lewis's late, unpublished talks on
ethics)
10. Secondary Sources
Dayton, Eric. AC I Lewis And The Given@, Transactions of the Charles S .
Peirce Society ,
31(2), Spr 1995, pp. 254-284.
Flower, Elizabeth and Murphey, Murray G. A History of Philosophy in
America , New York,
G.P. Putnam's Sons, 1977, Chapter 15. pp.892-958.
Gowans, Christopher W. ATwo Concepts Of The Given In C I Lewis: Realism And
Foundationalism@. The Journal of the History of Philosophy , 27(4), 1989,
pp.
573-590.
Haack, Susan. "C I Lewis" In American Philosophy , Singer, Marcus G
(Ed), Cambridge,
Cambridge University Press, 1986, pp. 215-238.
Hill, Thomas English. Contemporary Theories of Knowledge , The Ronald
Press Co., New
York, 1961, chapter 12, pp. 362-387.
Kuklick, Bruce. The Rise of American Philosophy, New Haven, Yale
University Press, 1977,
chapter 28, pp. 533-562.
Reck, Andrew J. The New American Philosophers , Louisiana State
University Press, Baton
Rouge, 1968, pp. 3-43.
Rosenthal, Sandra B. The Pragmatic a priori: Study In The Epistemology
Of C I Lewis
. St Louis, Green, 1976.
Schilpp, Paul Arthur (Ed). The Philosophy Of C I Lewis . La Salle Il Open
Court, 1968.
Thayer, H S. Meaning And Action: A Critical History Of Pragmatism. Indianapolis
Bobbs-merrill,
1968, chapter 4, pp.205-231.
|
