62 BC: Defeat and death of Catiline. By this point in his career this former lieutenant of Sulla had become a living
plague upon Roman politics and a virtual byword for scandal, intrigue, conspiracy, demagoguery, and vain ambition.
Such was Rome from the rise of Sulla to the fall of Catiline, a period of seemingly endless bloodshed and civil unrest. With
such a background, it is little wonder that the precepts of Epicurus - with their emphasis on contemplative pursuits and quiet
pleasures and severe strictures against ambition, fame, and the world of politics - struck a responsive chord in the heart of a
young Roman poet. To a sensitive intellectual like Lucretius, the teachings of Epicurus must have had the force of a
philosophical revelation. In this respect, it is noteworthy (and ironic) that throughout De Rerum Natura whenever the
poet writes about Epicurus he praises him not simply as a great teacher and brilliant philosopher, but virtually as a kind of
oracle and even a god. Meanwhile, he seems to have viewed his own role as that of an Epicurean evangelist: he is a poetic
apostle dedicated to spreading the master's gospel of liberation from the bondage of superstition and error, of inner peace
attained through the study of philosophy and the enjoyment of modest pleasures.
b. Lucretius' Personality and Outlook
Unlike his hero Epicurus, who had a reputation for being gentle and self-effacing, Lucretius' excitable personality springs
vividly from his pages. Though naturally passionate and intellectually contentious, he also reveals himself as reflective and
prone to melancholy. Like his master, he detests war, strife, and social tumult and favors a life quietly devoted to sweet
friendship (suavis amicitia) and intellectual pleasures.
At the beginning of Book 2 of his poem, the poet compares the prospect of a person armed with the insights of Epicurus
to that of a secure spectator looking down upon a scene of strife:
Pleasant it is, when over the great sea the winds shake the waters,
To gaze down from shore on the trials of others;
Not because seeing other people struggle is sweet to us,
But because the fact that we ourselves are free from such ills strikes us as pleasant.
Pleasant it is also to behold great armies battling on a plain,
When we ourselves have no part in their peril.
But nothing is sweeter than to occupy a lofty sanctuary of the mind,
Well fortified with the teachings of the wise,
Where we may look down on others as they stumble along,
Vainly searching for the true path of life. . . . (2. 1-10)
This idea of philosophy as a private citadel or quiet refuge in a world of anxiety and turmoil, or of some form of
contemplation as the true path to enlightenment, has been a recurrent theme in world literature from the Buddha to Boethius,
from Socrates to Schopenhauer. The idea is a central component of Epicurean doctrine and a favorite theme and image of
Lucretius, whose characteristic vantage point throughout the poem is that of a critical observer above the fray. As narrator, he
stands aloof, a scornful yet at the same time sympathetic witness to mankind's dark strivings and tribulations:
Lo, see them: contending with their wits, fighting for precedence,
Struggling night and day with unending effort,<
Climbing, clawing their way up the pinnacles of wealth and power.
O miserable minds of men! O blind hearts!
In what darkness, among how many perils,
You pass your short lives! Do you not see
That our nature requires only this:
A body free from pain, and a mind, released from worry and fear,
Free to enjoy feelings of delight? (2. 11-19.)
Like his master, Lucretius obviously feels that the true purpose of moral philosophy is not merely to diagnose human
miseries; but to heal them.
2. Philosophy
a. Epicurus
From the very start of the poem, and especially in the opening lines of Book 3 (a ringing tribute to Epicurus), Lucretius
makes it clear that his main purpose is not so much to display his own talents as to render accurately in a suitably sublime
style the glorious philosophy of his master:
O you who out of the vast darkness were the first to raise
A shining light, illuminating the blessings of life,
O glory of the Grecian race, it is you I follow,
Tracing in your clearly marked footprints my own firm steps,
Not as a contending rival, but out of love, for I yearn to imitate you.
For why should the swallow vie with the swan?
Why should a young kid on spindly limbs
Dare to match strides with a mighty steed? (3. 1-8.)
The poetry, Lucretius keeps reminding his readers, is secondary, a sugar coating to sweeten Epicurus' healing medicine. The
Epicurean system is what is important, and the poet pledges all his skill to presenting it as clearly, as faithfully, and as
persuasively as possible. In his view nothing less than universal enlightenment and the liberation of mankind is at stake.
Epicurus was born at Samos, an Athenian colony, in 341 BC. Reduced to its
simplest level, the goal of his teaching was to free humanity from needless cares and anxieties (especially the fear of death) .
By furnishing a complete explanation of the origin and structure of the universe, he sought to open men's eyes to a true
understanding of their condition and liberate them from ignorant fears and superstitions. Though by all accounts he was a
voluminous writer, only a tiny fraction of his original output has survived, with the result that Lucretius' poem has served as
one of the primary vehicles for conveying his thought.
b. Epicureanism
The Epicurean system consists of three linked components: Physics, Ethics, and Canonic. These three elements are designed to
be interdependent, each one supposedly uniting with and reinforcing the other two. (To cite just one example, Epicurus' physics
supposedly validates both the existence of free will and the fact that the soul disintegrates with the body, ideas that are
crucial to Epicurean ethics. The canonic claims to validate the authority and reliability of sensation, which in turn serves as
a basis for Epicurean physical theories and ethical views relating to pleasure and pain.) In actual fact, however, the three
components are quite separable, and it is certainly possible, for example, to accept Epicurus' ethical doctrines while entirely
denying his canonic teachings and physics.
i. Physics
One of the great achievements of the scientific imagination, the Epicurean cosmos is based on three fundamental principles:
materialism, mechanism, and atomism. According to Epicurus the universe covers an infinitude of space and consists entirely of
matter and void. For the most part the philosopher upholds Democritus'
theory that all matter is composed of imperishable atoms, tiny indivisible particles that can neither be created or destroyed.
He also shares Democritus' view that the atoms are infinite in number and homogenous in substance, while differing in shape and
size. However, whereas Democritus held that the number of atomic sizes and shapes is infinite, Epicurus argued that their
number, while large, is nevertheless finite. (As Lucretius notes, if atoms could be any size, some would be visible, and
possibly even immense.) As for atomic motion, Democritus had claimed that the atoms move in straight lines in all directions and
always in accordance with the iron laws of "necessity" (anangke). Epicurus, on the other hand, contends that
their natural motion is to travel straight downwards at a uniform high velocity. At random and unpredictable moments, moreover,
they deviate ever so slightly from their regular course, their resulting collisions thus occurring not by strict necessity but
always with some element of chance. This theory of atomic "swerve" or clinamen is a crucial feature of the
Epicurean world-view, providing (so Lucretius and other adherents believed) a firm physical foundation supporting the existence
of free will.
Armed with these basic principles, Epicurus is able to explain the universe as an ongoing cosmic event - a never-ending
binding and unbinding of atoms resulting in the gradual emergence of entire new worlds and the gradual disintegration of old
ones. Our world, our bodies, our minds are but atoms in motion. They did not occur because of some purpose or final cause. Nor
were they created by some god for our special use and benefit. They simply happened, more or less randomly and entirely
naturally, through the effective operation of immutable and eternal physical laws.
Here it should be noted that Epicurus is a materialist, not an atheist. Although he argues that not only our earth and all
its life forms, but also all human civilizations and arts came into being and evolved without any aid or sponsorship from the
gods, he does not deny their existence. He merely denies that they have any knowledge of or interest in human affairs. They live
on immune to destruction in their perfectly compounded material bodies in the serene and cloudless spaces between the worlds
(intermundia), perfectly oblivious of human anxieties and cares. Lucretius imagines that Epicurus rivaled them in their
divine tranquility.
ii. Canonic
The so-called canonic teachings of Epicurus (from the Greek kanon, "rule") include his epistemological
theories and especially his theories of sensation and perception. In certain respects, these theories represent Epicurus'
thought at its most original and prescient - and in one or two instances at its most fanciful and absurd.
The central principle of the canonic is that our sense data provide a true and accurate picture of external reality.
Sensation is the ultimate source and criterion of truth, and its testimony is incontrovertible. Epicurus considered the
reliability of the senses a bulwark of his philosophy, and Lucretius refers to trust in sensation as a "holdfast,"
describing it as the only thing preventing our slide into the abyss of skepticism (4. 502-512).
But if our sensory input is always true and dependable, how are we to account for hallucinations, fantasies, dreams,
delusions, and other forms of perceptual error? According to Epicurus, such errors are always due to some higher mental process.
They arise, for example, when we apply judgment or reasoning or some confused product of memory to the actual data presented to
us by sensation. As Lucretius remarks, we deceive ourselves because we tend to "see some things with our mind that have not
been seen by the senses":
For nothing is harder than to distinguish the real things of sense
From those doubtful versions of them that the mind readily supplies. (4. 466-468.)
Epicurus' theory of sensory perception is consistent with and follows from his materialism and atomism. Like Democritus, he
postulates that external objects send off emanations or "idols" (eidola) of themselves that travel through the
air and impinge upon our senses. In effect, these subtle atomic images or films imprint themselves on the senses, leaving behind
trace versions of the external world (auditory and olfactory as well as visual) that can be apprehended and stored in memory.
Once again, perceptual errors can occur in this process, but not because of any inherent problem with sensation itself. Instead,
mistakes arise due either to the contamination of the "idols" by other atoms or because of the "false
opinions" that we ourselves, through defects in our higher mental operations, introduce.
In short, unless it is distorted by some form of external "noise" or by some processing error attributable to
reason, all information conveyed through the senses is true. This is Epicurus' core canonic teaching. Unfortunately, this belief
in the infallibility of sense perception and the unreliability of logic and reason led him and his followers (including
Lucretius) into a number of strange conclusions - such as the absurd claim that the sun, moon, and stars are exactly the
size and shape that they appear to be to our naked eye. Thus (as strict Epicurean doctrine would have it) the moon truly
is a small, silver disc, the sun is a slightly larger golden fire, and the stars are but tiny points of light.
iii. Ethics
Epicurus' ethics represents the true goal and raison d’etre of his philosophical mission, the capstone atop the
impressive (though hardly flawless) pillars of his physics and epistemology. Like Socrates, he considered moral questions (What
is virtue? What is happiness?) rather than cosmological speculations to be the ultimate concerns of philosophical inquiry.
As mentioned earlier, it is possible to accept one component of the Epicurean system without necessarily subscribing to the
others. But from Epicurus' (and Lucretius’) point of view, it is the ethical component that is of vital importance.
As many commentators have noted, the term "Epicure" (in the sense of a self-indulgent bon vivant or luxurious
pleasure-seeker) is entirely out of place when applied to Epicureanism in general and to its founder in particular. By all
accounts, Epicurus' own living habits were virtually Spartan, and it is said that he attracted many of his disciples more by his
solid character and agreeable temper than by his philosophical arguments. His moral philosophy is a form of hedonism,
meaning that it is a system based on the pursuit of pleasure (Gr. 'ēdonewhich it identifies as the greatest good. But Epicurean hedonism is hardly
synonymous with sensual extravagance; nor is it a matter (in St. Paul's disparaging terms) of "let us eat and drink; for
tomorrow we die." It is instead a system that requires severe self-denial and moral discipline. For Epicurus places a much
greater emphasis on the avoidance of pain than on the pursuit of pleasure, and he favors intellectual pleasures (which are
long-lasting and never cloying) over physical ones (which are short-lived and lead to excess). As for self-indulgence, he argued
that it is better to abstain from coarse or trivial pleasures if they prevent our enjoyment of richer, more satisfying ones.
In Epicurean ethics physical pain is the great enemy of happiness and is to be avoided in almost all cases. Mental anguish is
even more threatening and potentially debilitating. It follows that the fear of death - and especially the superstitious belief
in an after-life of eternal torment - can be particularly devastating source of anxiety and take a terrible toll on humanity,
which is why Epicurus sets out so determinedly to crush it.
c. The Design of the Poem
De Rerum Natura is an epic in six books and is expertly organized to provide both expository clarity as well as
powerful narrative and lyric effects. In one respect, the poem represents the unfolding of a complex philosophical argument, and
in many places the poet is challenged to explain abstract and often extremely prosaic technical material in a lucid and lively
way. (At times during the poem he complains about the relative poverty of Latin as a philosophical medium compared to the
technical richness of Greek.) At the same time, he must be careful not to overwhelm or upstage his philosophical presentation
with a surplus of brilliant literary devices and gaudy stylistic displays. The basic organization is as follows:
Book 1: The poem begins with a justly famous invocation to Venus (the poet's symbol for the forces of cohesion, integration,
and creative energy in the universe). Presented as a kind of life principle, the Lucretian Venus is associated with the figure
of Love (Gr. philia, the unifying or binding force in the philosophy of Empedocles, and also identified with her mythical role as Venus Genetrix, the
patron goddess and mother of the Roman people. In the remainder of the book the poet begins the work of explaining the Epicurean
system and refuting the systems of other philosophers. He starts by setting forth the major principles of Epicurean physics and
cosmology, including atomism, the infinity of the universe, and the existence of matter and void.
Book 2. This book begins with a lyric passage celebrating the "serene sanctuaries" of philosophy and lamenting the
condition of those poor human beings who struggle vainly outside its protective walls. The poet explains atomic motion and
shapes and argues that the atoms do not have secondary qualities (color, smell, heat, moisture, etc.).
Book 3. After a glowing opening apostrophe to Epicurus ("O glory of the Greeks!"), the poet proceeds with an
extended explanation and proof of the materiality - and mortality – of the mind and soul. This explanation culminates in the
climactic declaration, "Nil igitur mors est ad nos. . ." ("Therefore death is nothing to us."), a
stark, simple statement which effectively epitomizes the main message and central doctrine of Epicureanism.
Book 4. Following introductory verses on the art of didactic poetry, this book begins with a full account of Epicurus' theory
of vision and sensation. It concludes with one of Lucretius' greatest passages of verse, his famous (and caustic) analysis of
the biology and psychology of sexual love.
Book 5. Lucretius begins this book with another tribute to the genius of Epicurus, whose heroic intellectual achievements, it
is argued, exceed even the twelve labors of Hercules. The remainder of the book is devoted to a full account of Epicurean
cosmology and sociology, with the poet explaining the stages of life on earth and the origin and development of civilization.
This book includes the remarkable passage (837-886) in which the poet offers his own evolutionary hypothesis on the
proliferation and extinction of life forms.
Book 6. Though partly unfinished, this book contains some of Lucretius' greatest poetry, with effective technical
explanations of meteorological and geologic phenomena and vivid descriptions of thunderstorms, lightning, and volcanic
eruptions. The poem closes with a horrifying account of the great plague of Athens (430 BC), a grim reminder of universal
mortality.
d. Lucretius as a Philosopher
Critics universally recognize Lucretius as a major poet and the author of one of the great classics of world literature.
But in part because of his accepted role as a spokesperson for Epicureanism rather than an originator, it has been more
difficult to assess his merit as a philosopher.
In this respect, it is noteworthy that at least two important philosophers have voiced strong support for Lucretius' status
as a philosophical innovator and original thinker. In 1884, while still a young faculty member at the Blaise Pascal Lycee in
Paris, the French philosopher Henri Bergson (1859-1941) published an edition of De Rerum Natura with notes, commentary,
and an accompanying critical essay. Throughout this work, Bergson commends Lucretius not only as a poet of genius, but also as
an inspired and "singularly original" thinker. In particular, he points out that in his view the poet's instinctive
grasp of the physical operations of nature and his comprehensive, truly scientific world-view exceed anything found in the
theories of Democritus and Epicurus.
The Spanish poet and Harvard philosopher George Santayana (1863-1952) held a similarly high opinion of Lucretius' power as a
scientific thinker. Democritus and Epicurus, he argues, are mere sketch artists who offer no more than bare hints and vague
outlines of a thoroughly imagined and truly scientifically conceived universe. It thus remained for the deeper, more visionary
poet not just to flesh out their rough drafts in fine words, but in essence to actually create and give body to the entire
Epicurean system. In Santayana's view, Epicurus was but a supplier of half-baked ideas; it was Lucretius who was the true
creator of scientific materialism and the real founder of Epicureanism.
Hyperbole aside, what both Bergson and Santayana are pointing to is the frequently underrated and misunderstood role of
imagination in the production of almost all major systems of philosophy. Great philosophers from Plato and Aristotle to Kant and
Nietzsche (and Bergson himself) have never been simply logic mills or thinking machines, but bold thinkers with an imaginative
"feel" for abstract reality. In this respect, even if we dismiss the assessments of Bergson and Santayana as
extravagant, we can still accept Lucretius as a bona fide philosopher and not just as a poetical embellisher and
interpreter.
Every philosopher has strengths and weaknesses; those of Lucretius are conspicuous. In addition to his powerful imagination,
his main strength (not surprisingly) is his verbal skill and force of expression. He is one of the most quotable of
philosophers, with a flair for striking images and tightly packed statements. A few samples:
On superstition:
"So powerful is religion at persuading to evil." 1. 101.
On luxuries:
"Hot fevers do not depart your body more quickly
If you toss about on pictured tapestries or rich purple coverlets
Than if you lie sick under a poor man's blanket." 2. 34-36.
On life without philosophy:
"All life is a struggle in the dark." 2. 54.
"After a while the life of a fool is hell on earth." 3. 1023.
On new truths:
"No fact is so obvious that it does not at first produce wonder,
Nor so wonderful that it does not eventually yield to belief." 2. 1026-27.
On reason:
"Such is the power of reason to overcome inborn vices
That nothing prevents our living a life worthy of gods." 3. 321-22.
On the language of love:
"We say a foul, dirty woman is 'sweetly disordered,'
If she is green-eyed, we call her 'my little Pallas';
If she's flighty and tightly strung, she’s 'a gazelle’;
A squat, dumpy dwarf is 'a little sprite,'
While a hulking giantess is 'divinely statuesque.'
If she stutters or lisps, she speaks 'musically.'
If she's dumb, she’s 'modest’; and if she’s hot-tempered
And a chatterbox, she's 'a ball of fire.’
When she's too skinny to live, she’s 'svelte,’
And she's 'delicate’ when she’s dying of consumption. . .
It would be wearisome to run through the whole list." 4. 1159-1171.
Of all Lucretius' intellectual strengths, perhaps none is more characteristic or stands out more impressively than his hard,
clear commitment to naturalism. Throughout the poem he consistently attacks supernatural explanations of phenomena and resists
the temptation to give in to some form of natural religion or "scientific" supernaturalism. The world, he argues, was
not created by divine intelligence, nor is it imbued with any form of mind or purpose. Instead, it must be understood as
an entirely natural phenomenon, the outcome of a random (though statistically inevitable and lawful) process. In short, whatever
happens in the universe is not the product of design, but part of an ongoing sequence of purely physical events.
Lucretius' principal philosophical shortcoming is that not only will he occasionally follow Epicurean doctrine to the point
of absurdity (e.g., the supposedly tiny size of the sun and moon) but he will also introduce logical fallacies or scientific
errors of his own (such as his claim that the atoms travel faster than light - 2. 144ff.). As Bergson points out, these howlers
can usually be attributed to the defective method of ancient science, which, because it did not require that hypotheses be
confirmed by experimentation, allowed even the wildest conjectures to pass as plausible truths. One further problem is that, for
all his reliance on naturalistic explanations and his attempted reduction of metaphysics to physics, Lucretius at times seems to
back away, if only ever so slightly, from a purely materialist world view. Indeed in his effusive descriptions of the creative
power of nature, effectively symbolized by the figure of Venus, he seems almost (like Bergson) to postulate an immaterial
life-force surging through the universe and operating above or beyond raw nature. To read this romantic streak into him is
clearly a mistake. Lucretius remains a thorough-going naturalist. Yet when his verse is in high gear, one almost gets the
impression that somewhere inside this staunchly scientific, fiercely anti-religious poet there is a romantic nature-worshipper
screaming to get out.
e. Influence and Legacy
Lucretius' literary influence has been long-lasting and widespread, especially among poets with epic ambitions or
cosmological interests, from Virgil and Milton to Whitman and Wordsworth. Not surprisingly, as one of the main proponents and
principal sources of Epicurean thought, his philosophical influence has also been considerable. The extent of his communication
with and influence on his contemporaries, including other Epicurean writers, is not known. What is known is that by the end of
the first century A.D. De Rerum Natura was hardly read and its author had already begun a long, slow descent into
philosophical oblivion. It was not until the Renaissance, with the recovery of lost Lucretian manuscripts, that a true revival
of the poet became possible.
It is probably an exaggeration to say that the restoration and study of Lucretius' poem was crucial to the rise of
Renaissance "new philosophy" and the birth of modern science. On the other hand, one must not ignore its importance as
a spur to innovative sixteenth- and seventeenth-century scientific thought and cosmological speculation. Greek atomism and
Lucretius' account of the universe as an infinite, lawfully integrated whole provided an important background stimulus not only
for Newtonian science, but also (if only in a negative or contrary way) for Spinoza's pantheism and Leibniz’s monadology.
Lucretius' influence on early modern thought is most directly visible in the work of the French scientist and neo-Epicurean
philosopher Pierre Gassendi (1592-1655). In 1649 Gassendi published his Syntagma Philosophiae Epicuri, a theoretical
refinement and elaboration of Epicurean science. A Catholic priest with a remarkably independent mind, Gassendi seemingly had no
problem reconciling his personal philosophical commitment to atomism and materialism with his Christian beliefs in the
immortality of the soul and the doctrine of divine providence.
Every modern reader of De Rerum Natura has been struck by the extent to which Lucretius seems to have anticipated
modern evolutionary theories in the fields of geology, biology, and sociology. However, to acknowledge this connection is not to
say that the poet deserves accredited status as some kind of scientific "evolutionist" or pre-Darwinian precursor. It
is merely to point out that, however we choose to define and evaluate its influence, De Rerum Natura was from the
17th century onward a massive cultural presence and hence a ready source of evolutionary ideas. The poem formed part
of the cultural heritage and intellectual background of virtually every evolutionary theorist in Europe from Lamarck to Herbert Spencer (whose hedonistic ethics also owed a debt to the poet) -
including (though he claimed never to have read Lucretius' epic) Darwin himself.
Bergson's early study of Lucretius obviously played an important role in the foundation and development of his own
philosophy. In 1907 Bergson published Creative Evolution, outlining his bold, new vitalistic theory of evolution, in
opposition to both the earlier vitalism of Lamarck and the naturalism of Darwin, and Spencer. It is hard not to see in the
French philosophers' concept of the élan vital a powerful life force akin to and strongly influenced by the
immortal Venus of his great Latin predecessor. Bergson's evolutionary philosophy influenced the later "process"
philosophy of Alfred North Whitehead (1861-1947) and the teleological scientific theories of Pierre Teilhard de Chardin
(1881-1955), with the interesting result that it is possible to trace out a fairly direct, if unlikely, line of descent from
Greek atomism through the pagan anti-spiritualist Lucretius to the Catholic naturalist Gassendi and then on, via the
Jewish-Catholic Bergson, to the highly abstract theism of Whitehead and the "spiritualized" evolutionism of Father
Teilhard. That Lucretius' ideas wound up two thousand years after his death influencing those of a godly British mathematical
theorist and a highly original and even eccentric French scientist-priest is remarkable testimony to their durability,
adaptability, and persuasive power.
f. Conclusion
In conclusion, it seems fair to say that, far from being a mere conduit for earlier Greek thought, the poet Titus Lucretius
Carus was a bold innovator and original thinker who fully deserves the appellation of philosopher. While his literary fame
clearly (and properly) comes first, and although his philosophical reputation is based largely (and again properly) on his role
as one of the principle sources and prime exponents of Epicureanism, his own ideas, especially his evolutionary theories and his
entirely naturalistic explanation of all universal phenomena, have exerted a long and important influence on western science and
philosophy and should not be underestimated.
3. Bibliography
The most authoritative manuscripts of De Rerum Natura are the so-called O and Q codices in Leiden. Both date from the
9th century. Recently, however, scholars have deciphered a much older and previously illegible manuscript, consisting of papyri
discovered in Herculaneum and possibly dating from as early as the first century AD. All other Lucretian manuscripts date from
the 15th and 16th century and are based on the one (no longer extant) discovered in a monastery by the Italian humanist Poggio
Bracciolini in 1417.
Texts:
Lucretius: On the Nature of Things. W.H.D. Rouse, trans. Revised and edited by Martin F. Smith. Cambridge, MA: Harvard
University Press, 1992.
Bailey, C. ed. De Rerum Natura. 3 volumes with commentary. Oxford, 1947.
English translations:
Munro, H.A.J. (prose). Cambridge, 1864.
Latham, R.E. (prose). Harmondsworth, UK: Penguin, 1951.
Humphries, Rolphe. (verse). Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1968.
Copley, Frank O. (verse). New York: Norton, 1977.
Critical and scholarly studies:
Bergson, Henri. Philosophy of Poetry: The Genius of Lucretius. Wade Baskin, trans. New York: Philosophical Library, 1959.
Clay, D. Lucretius and Epicurus. Ithaca, NY, 1983.
Jones, H. The Epicurean Tradition. London: 1989.
Kenney, E. J. Lucretius. Oxford, 1977.
Santayana, George. Three Philosophical Poets. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
Sikes, E.E. Lucretius: Poet and Philosopher. Cambridge, 1936.
