The Liar Paradox is an argument that arrives at a contradiction
by reasoning about a Liar Sentence. The classical Liar Sentence
is the following self-referential sentence:
(1) This sentence is false.
Experts in the field of philosophical logic have never agreed
on the way out of the trouble despite 2,300 years of attention. Here
is the trouble--a sketch of the Liar Argument that reveals the
contradiction:
If (1) is true, then (1) is false. But we can also establish the converse, as follows. Assume (1) is false.
Because
the Liar Sentence is saying precisely that (namely that it is
false), the Liar Sentence is true, so (1) is true.
We've now shown that (1) is true if and only if it is false.
Since (1) is one or the other, it is both.
The argument depends upon a few more assumptions and steps, but
these appear to be as uncontroversial as those above.
The contradictory result apparently throws us into the lion's den of
semantic incoherence. This article explores the details of the principal attempts to resolve the paradox.
Most logical paradoxes are based on circular definitions or self-referential
statements, and the liar paradox is no exception. Many people, when first encountering the Liar Paradox, will react by saying that the Liar Sentence
must be meaningless. This popular solution does stop the argument of the paradox, but it isn't an adequate solution if
it answers the question, "Why is the Liar Sentence meaningless?" simply with the ad hoc remark, "Otherwise we get a paradox."
An adequate solution would offer
a more systematic treatment. For example, the sentence, "This sentence is in English," is very similar to the Liar Sentence. Is it meaningless, too? What ingredients of the Liar Sentence make it meaningless such that other sentences with those same ingredients will also be meaningless? Are disjunctions with the Liar Sentence also meaningless? The questions continue, and an adequate solution should address them systematically.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. History of the Paradox
The Liar Paradox has been discussed continually in philosophy
since the middle of the 4th century BCE. The most ancient attribution
is to Eubulides of Miletus who included it among a list of seven puzzles. He said, "A man says that he is lying. Is
what he says true or false?" Eubulides' commentary on his puzzle has not been found. An ancient gravestone on the Greek
Island of Cos was reported by Athenaeus to contain this poem about
the difficulty of solving the paradox:
O Stranger: Philetas of Cos am I,
'Twas the Liar who made me die,
And the bad nights caused thereby.
Theophrastus, Aristotle's successor, wrote three papyrus rolls
about the Liar Paradox, and the Stoic philosopher Chrysippus wrote
six, but their contents are lost in the sands of time. In the New
Testament of the Bible, Saint Paul warned, "One of themselves, even a
prophet of their own, said that the Cretans are always liars." Paul,
however, gave no indication he recognized anything paradoxical about
the Cretan's remark, but it would be paradoxical if no other Cretan utters a truth and if
"liar" means utterer only of falsehoods.
In the late medieval period in Europe, Buridan put the Liar Paradox to devious use with the
following proof of the existence of God. It uses the pair of
sentences:
God exists.
None of the sentences in this pair is true.
The only consistent way to assign truth values, that is, to
have these two sentence be either true or false, requires making "God
exists" be true. So, Buridan has "proved" that God does
exist.
There are many other versions of the Paradox. Some liar paradoxes begin with a chain
of sentences:
The following sentence is true.
The following sentence is true.
The following sentence is true.
The first sentence in this list is false.
The Strengthened Liar Paradox begins with the Strengthened Liar
Sentence
This sentence is not true.
This version is called "Strengthened" because some promising solutions to the classical liar paradox beginning with (1)
fail completely when faced with the Strengthened Liar. So, finding
one's way out of the Strengthened Liar is the acid test of a
successful solution. There are also Contingent Liars which depend
upon what occurs in the empirical world. Suppose that the last
sentence in today's edition of The New York Times newspaper
is:
The last sentence in tomorrow's edition of The New
York Times newspaper is true.
Was that sentence grammatical? Was it meaningful? Was it true
or false, even if we don't know which at the moment? The common sense
answers are "yes" to all these questions. Perhaps we should not
retain those intuitive answers tomorrow when the Times's
presses print a newspaper whose last sentence is
The last sentence in yesterday's edition of The New
York Times newspaper is not true.
If we adopt the metaphor of a paradox as being an argument
which starts from the home of seemingly true assumptions and which
travels down the garden path of seemingly valid steps into the den of
a contradiction, then a solution to the paradox has to find something
wrong with the home, find something wrong with the garden path, or
find a way to live within the den. Less metaphorically, the main
kinds of ways out of the Paradox are the following: (a) The Liar Sentence isn't grammatical.
(b) The Liar
Sentence isn't meaningful. (c) The Liar Sentence is grammatical and
meaningful but isn't true or false. (d) There is some other error in one
of the steps of the argument that leads to the contradiction. (e) The
Liar Sentence is both true and false. Two philosophers might take one
of these ways out but for very different reasons, and they might
offer different changes in our naive system of beliefs and concepts
in order to take this way out.
To put the Liar Paradox in perspective, it is essential to
appreciate why such an apparently trivial problem in fact is a deep
problem. Suppose we ask the larger question: What is truth? As a
question about what are the significant paths of life to be followed
or the significant things to know in order to have the best grasp on
reality, the question is just too difficult, and also too vague, to
be a center of attention for the analytical philosophers of the
present age. However, as a question asking simply for general
characteristics of all true sentences, the question is more amenable
to solution. Nevertheless, it is still a very difficult one. For
instance, in the attempt to generally characterize the grounds of
validity of a true sentence, that is, in the attempt to characterize
why a true sentence is true, philosophers have created several
ingenious, and alluring theories of truth:
the correspondence theory of truth,
the coherence theory of truth, and the pragmatic theory of truth,
among others. Yet none of these has produced any detailed theory. At
best, each is still at the stage of being a suggestive, but
uncompelling, metaphor.
[Tarski's
Semantic Theory is a detailed theory,
but it is not designed to characterize why a true sentence is true.]
More progress on answering the question "What is truth?" will
be had by concentrating not on why a sentence is true, but on what
other sentences are true when a sentence is true. By concentrating
this way on truth's logical liaisons, Aristotle offered what many
philosophers consider to be a partially correct answer to our
question about truth. Stripped of its overtones suggesting a
correspondence theory of truth, Aristotle proposed what is
essentially sentence (T):
(T) A declarative sentence is true if and only if what
it says is so.
If pairs of quotation marks serve to name a sentence, then (T)
requires that "It is snowing" be true just in case it is snowing.
Similarly, if the sentence about snow were named with the numeral 88
inside a pair of parentheses, then (88) would be true just in case it
is snowing. What could be less controversial? Unfortunately, this
seemingly correct, but trivial response to our question "What is truth?" is neither
obviously correct nor trivial; and the resolution of the difficulty
is still an open problem in philosophical logic.
Why is that? The brief answer is that (T) can be used to produce the Liar Paradox. The longer answer refers to Tarski's Undefinability
Theorem of 1936, as we shall see.
2. Possible Solutions
This article began with a mere sketch of the Liar
argument using sentence (1). To appreciate the various proposed solutions
to the paradox, and the central role of (T), we need to examine more than just a sketch of the argument. The argument actually
requires
the following assumptions in addition to (T):
(2) Any declarative sentence "S" says that S.
(3) The Liar Sentence, (1), is a legitimate declarative
sentence. That is, it is well formed.
(4) A legitimate declarative sentence is either true or else
false.
(5) The usual naming convention holds so that
the phrase "This sentence" in (1) refers to (1),
and
(1) = "This sentence is false".
 Tarski added precision to convention (T) and to these other
assumptions by focusing not on English directly but on a classical
formal language capable of expressing arithmetic. Here the
difficulties produced by the Liar argument became much clearer; and, very surprisingly, he was able
to prove that the assumptions lead to semantic incoherence. Tarski
pointed out that the crucial, unacceptable assumption is (3). Tarski reasoned
this way: For there to be a
legitimate Liar Sentence in the language, there must be a definable
notion of "is true" which holds for the true sentences and fails to
hold for the other sentences. If there were such a "global truth
predicate," then the predicate "is a false sentence" would also be
definable and [here is where we need the power of arithmetic]
a Liar Sentence would exist, namely
∃x(Qx & ~Tx), where T is the monadic, global truth predicate and Q is a monadic
predicate satisfied only by the name [Gödel number] of the
Liar sentence.
But if so, then from (T), (2), (3), (4)
and (5), one can deduce a
contradiction.
This deduction of Tarski's is a formal analog of the informal Liar
Argument. The contradictory result tells us that the argument began
with a false assumption. Because (T), (2), (4), and (5) are essential
to what we call a "classical formal language," the mistaken
assumption is (3), and the only possible problem here is the
assumption that the global truth predicate "is a true sentence" can
be defined. So, Tarski has proved that truth is not definable in a
classical language--thus the name "Undefinability Theorem." Tarski's
theorem establishes that classically interpreted languages capable of
expressing arithmetic cannot contain a global truth predicate. A
language containing its own global truth predicate is said to be
semantically closed. Tarski's Theorem implies that classical formal
languages with the power to express arithmetic cannot be semantically
closed. This suggests that English itself may not be semantically
closed, or, if English is closed, then it is
self-contradictory. This shocking result indicates to some that our
thought about our thoughts is incoherent. That's the conclusion
Tarski himself reached, so he quit trying to find the coherent
structure underlying natural languages and concentrated on developing
systems of formal languages that did not allow the deduction of the
contradiction. Many other philosophers of logic have not drawn
Tarski's pessimistic conclusion from his theorem.
For these optimists, there are four, main, detailed and coherent
ways out.
(1) The Liar Sentence is meaningless, so the Liar
argument can't even get started because its main assumption (that
the Liar Sentence exists or is meaningful) is faulty. Natural
language is incoherent, and its underlying sensible structure is
that of an infinite hierarchy of levels. Because the Liar Sentence
would have to reside on more than one level simultaneously, it's
not really a meaningful sentence. This way out of the paradox is
taken by Russell in his ramified theory of types and, following
Tarski, by Quine in his hierarchy of meta-languages. For Russell,
the referential phrase "This sentence" in (1) is the culprit
because the phrase is not allowed to refer to the sentence in
which the phrase itself occurs. For Quine, instead, the culprit is
the phrase "is false" in (1) because the phrase must be satisfied
by sentences in a language lower in the hierarchy and not by the
very sentence in which the phrase occurs.
(2) Kripke, on the other hand,
retains the intuition that the Liar Sentence is meaningful,
but argues that it is neither true nor false. It lacks a classical truth
value as does the odd sentence "The present king of France is
bald." Kripke trades infinite syntactic complexity for infinite semantic complexity.
He rejects the infinite hierarchy of meta-languages
underlying English in favor of one formal object language having an infinite
hierarchy of partial interpretations. The truth predicate is the formal language's only basic partially-interpreted predicate.
Each step in the semantic hierarchy is an interpretation of the language, and in these interpretations all the basic predicates except one must have their interpretations already fixed in the base level from which the first step is taken.
This one exceptional predicate is intended to be the truth predicate for the previous level. It becomes a truth predicate for its own level when the inductive interpretation building reaches the so-called 'fixed point'. Each step uses all the sentences which had their truth values fixed at the lower steps in order to help fix the truth values of semantically more complex sentences,
for example, to fix the truth value of sentences with even longer chains of nested truth predicates. The Liar sentence, even up at the infinite
semantic height of the lowest fixed point, still isn't true or false. But at the fixed point,
the language satisfies Tarski's
Convention (T).
(3) The third way out says the Liar Sentence is meaningful
and is true or else false, but one step of the argument in the
Liar Paradox is incorrect (such as the move from the falsehood of the Liar
Sentence to its truth). Prior, following the informal suggestions
of Buridan and Peirce, takes this way out and concludes that the
Liar Sentence is simply false. So do Barwise and Etchemendy. They
accuse the Liar argument of equivocating by not paying careful attention to
the ambiguity of the Liar sentence, namely that it can be interpreted as
being the negation of itself or the denial of itself. If it is the
negation of itself, then it is simply false, and the Liar argument cannot
successfully show that it is true. If it is the denial of itself, then
it is simply true. Neither interpretation allows an argument to
conclude that the sentence is both true and false.
(4) A fourth and more radical way out of the paradox is to
argue that semantic incoherence is not necessarily caused by
letting the Liar Sentence be both true and false. This solution
embraces the contradiction, then tries to limit the damage that is
ordinarily a consequence of that embrace. This way out of the
paradox uses a paraconsistent logic.
There are many suggestions for how to deal with the
Liar Paradox, but most are never developed to the point of giving a
formal, symbolic theory. Some give philosophical arguments for why
this or that conceptual reform is plausible as a way out of paradox,
but then don't show that their ideas can be carried through in a
rigorous way. Usually it appears that a formal treatment won't be
successful. Other attempts at solutions will take the formal route and then require changes in
standard formalisms so
that a formal analog of the Liar Paradox's argument
fails, but then the attempted solution offers no philosophical argument to back up these
formal changes. A decent theory of truth showing the way out of the
Liar Paradox requires both a coherent formalism (or at least a
systematic theory of some sort) and a philosophical justification
backing it up. The point of the philosophical justification is an
unveiling of some hitherto unnoticed or unaccepted rule of language
for all sentences of some category which has been violated by the
argument of the paradox. It is to the credit of Russell, Quine, Kripke,
Barwise and Etchemendy (among others) that they provide a philosophical justification for their
solutions while also providing a formal treatment in symbolic logic
that shows in detail both the character and implications of their
proposed solution. Kripke's elegant and careful treatment of (1)
stumbles on the Strengthened Liar and reveals why that argument deserves its
name. The theories of Russell-Tarski-Quine do "solve" the
Strengthened Liar, but at the cost of assigning "levels" to the relevant
sentences. Barwise and Etchemendy avoid these problems but require
accepting the idea that no sentence can be used to say anything about the whole
world. In the formal, symbolic tradition, other important
researchers in the last quarter of the 20th century were Burge, Gupta, Herzberger, McGee, Routley, Skyrms, van
Fraassen, and Yablo. Martin and Woodruff created the same solution as
Kripke, though a few months earlier. Dowden and Priest first showed
how to embrace contradiction, although Priest provided the most systematic
development of this way out.
Leading solutions to the Liar Paradox all have a common
approach, the "systematic approach." The solutions agree that the
Liar Paradox represents a serious challenge to our understanding the
logic of natural language, and they agree that we must go back and
systematically reform or clarify some of our original beliefs
in order to solve the paradox. The solution must be presented
systematically and be backed up by an argument about the general
character of our language. In short, there must be both systematic
evasion and systematic explanation. Also, when it comes to developing
this systematic approach, the goal of establishing a logical basis
for a consistent semantics of natural language is much more important
than the goal of explaining the naive way most speakers use the terms
"true" and "not true." As Vann McGee expresses this point, "The
problem of giving voice to our pre-analytic intuitions about truth is
comparatively less important, just as understanding popular
misconceptions about space and time is comparatively less important
than understanding the actual geometry of space-time."
This "systematic approach" has been seriously challenged by
Wittgenstein. He says one should try to overcome ''the superstitious
fear and dread of mathematicians in the face of a contradiction." The
proper way to respond to any paradox is by an ad hoc reaction and not
by any systematic treatment designed to cure both it and any future
ills. Symptomatic relief is sufficient. It may appear legitimate, at
first, to admit that the Liar Sentence is meaningful and also that it
is true or false, but the Liar Paradox shows that one should retract
this admission and either just not use the Liar Sentence in any
arguments, or say it is not really a sentence, or at least say it is
not one that is either true or false. Wittgenstein is not
particularly concerned with which choice is made. And, whichever
choice is made, it needn't be backed up by any theory that shows how
to systematically incorporate the choice. He treats the whole
situation cavalierly and unsystematically. After all, he says, the
language can't really be incoherent because we've been
successfully using it all along, so why all this "fear and
dread"?
Most logicians want systematic removal of the paradox, but Wittgenstein is content to say that we may need to live with this paradox and to agree never to utter the Liar sentence, especially if it seems that removal of the contradiction could have worse consequences.
Influenced by Wittgenstein, P. F. Strawson has argued that the proper way out of the Liar
Paradox is to re-examine how the term "truth" is really used by
speakers. When we say some proposition is true, we aren't making a
statement about the proposition. We are not ascribing a property to
the proposition--such as the property of correspondence, or
coherence, or usefulness. When we call a proposition "true" we are
approving it, or praising it, or admitting it, or condoning it. We
are performing an action. Similarly, when we say to our sister, "I
promise to pay you fifty dollars," we aren't ascribing some property
to the proposition, "I pay you fifty dollars." Rather, we are
performing the act of promising. For Strawson, when speakers utter
the Liar Sentence, they aren't saying something true or false;
they are attempting to praise something that isn't
there, as if they were saying "Ditto" when no one has spoken. The
person who utters the Liar Sentence is making a pointless utterance.
The Liar Sentence is grammatical, but it isn't being used to express a proposition and so is not
something from which a contradiction can be derived.
3. Overview of the Solutions
Some of the solutions to the Liar Paradox require a revision in
classical logic, the formal logic in which sentences of a formal
language have exactly two possible truth values (TRUE, FALSE), and in
which the usual rules of inference allow one to deduce anything from
an inconsistent set of assumptions. Kripke's revision uses a 3-valued
logic with the truth values TRUE, FALSE and NEITHER. Some logicians
argue that classical logic is not the incumbent which must remain in
office unless an opponent can dislodge it, although this is gospel
for other philosophers of logic (probably because of the remarkable
success of two-valued logic in expressing most of modern mathematical
inference). Instead, the office has always been vacant for natural
language.
Other philosophers object to revising classical logic merely to
find a way out of the Paradox. They say that philosophers shouldn't
build their theories by attending to the queer cases. There are more
pressing problems in the philosophy of logic and language than
finding a solution to the Paradox, so any treatment of it should wait
until these problems have a solution. From the future resulting
theory which solves those problems, one could hope to deduce a
solution to the Liar Paradox. However, for those who believe the
Paradox is not a minor problem but one deserving of immediate
attention, there can be no waiting around until the other problems of
language are solved. Perhaps the investigation of the
Liar Paradox will even affect the solutions to these other
problems.
4. References and Further Reading
For further reading on the Liar Paradox that provides more of an
introduction to the area while not presupposing a strong background
in symbolic logic, the author recommends the article below by
Mates, plus the first chapter of the Barwise-Etchemendy book, and then
chapter 9 of the Kirkham book. The rest of this bibliography is a
list of contributions to research on the Liar Paradox, and nearly all
require the reader to have significant familiarity with the
techniques of symbolic logic.
Barwise, Jon and Etchemendy, John. The Liar: An Essay in
Truth and Circularity, Oxford University Press, 1987. For a brief
overview of their original solution to the Liar, see Kirkham, 1992, pp. 298-306.
Burge, Tyler. "Semantical Paradox," Journal of Philosophy,
76 (1979), 169-198.
Dowden, Bradley. A Theory of Truth: The Liar Paradox and
Tarski's Undefinability Theorem, Ph.D. Dissertation, Stanford
University, 1979.
Dowden, Bradley. "Accepting Inconsistencies from the Paradoxes,"
Journal of Philosophical Logic, 13 (1984), 125-130.
Gupta, Anil. "Truth and Paradox," Journal of Philosophical
Logic, 11 (1982), 1-60. Reprinted in Martin (1984),
175-236.
Herzberger, Hans. "Paradoxes of Grounding in Semantics,"
Journal of Philosophy, 68 (1970), 145-167.
Kirkham, Richard. Theories of Truth: A Critical
Introduction, MIT Press, 1992.
Kripke, Saul. "Outline of a Theory of Truth," Journal
of Philosophy, 72 (1975), 690-716. Reprinted in Martin
(1984).
Martin, Robert. The Paradox of the Liar, Yale University
Press, Ridgeview Press, 1970. 2nd ed. 1978.
Martin, Robert. Recent Essays on Truth and the Liar
Paradox, Oxford University Press, 1984.
Martin, Robert. and Woodruff, Peter. "On Representing
'True-in-L' in L," Philosophia, 5 (1975), 217-221.
Mates, Benson. "Two Antinomies," in Skeptical Essays,
The University of Chicago Press, 1981, 15-57.
McGee, Vann. Truth, Vagueness, and Paradox: An Essay on the
Logic of Truth, Hackett Publishing, 1991.
Priest, Graham. "The Logic of Paradox," Journal of
Philosophical Logic, 8 (1979), 219-241; and "Logic of Paradox
Revisited," Journal of Philosophical Logic, 13 (1984),
153-179.
Priest, Graham, Routley, Richard and Norman, J. (eds.),
Paraconsistent Logic: Essays on the Inconsistent,
Philosophia-Verlag, 1989.
Prior, Arthur. "Epimenides the Cretan," Journal of
Symbolic Logic, 23 (1958), 261-266; and "On a Family of
Paradoxes," Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic, 2 (1961),
16-32.
Quine, W. V. "The Ways of Paradox," in his The Ways of
Paradox and Other Essays, rev. ed., Harvard University Press,
1976.
Russell, Bertrand. "Mathematical Logic as Based on the Theory
of Types," American Journal of Mathematics, 30 (1908),
222.
Skyrms, Brian. "Return of the Liar: Three-valued Logic and the
Concept of Truth," American Philosophical Quarterly, 7 (1970),
153-161.
Strawson, P. F. "Truth," in Analysis, 9, (1949).
Tarski, Alfred. "The Concept of Truth in Formalized Languages,"
in Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics, pp. 152-278, Clarendon
Press, 1956.
Van Fraassen, Bas. "Truth and Paradoxical Consequences," in
Martin (1970).
Woodruff, Peter. "Paradox, Truth and Logic Part 1: Paradox and
Truth," Journal of Philosophical Logic, 13 (1984),
213-231.
Wittgenstein, Ludwig. Remarks on the Foundations of
Mathematics, Basil Blackwell, 3rd edition, 1978.
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