The Russell-Myhill Antinomy, also known as the
Principles of Mathematics Appendix B Paradox, is a
contradiction that arises in the logical treatment of classes and
"propositions", where "propositions" are understood as
mind-independent and language-independent logical objects. If
propositions are treated as objectively existing objects, then
they can be members of classes. But propositions can also be
about classes, including classes of propositions. Indeed,
for each class of propositions, there is a proposition stating
that all propositions in that class are true. Propositions of this
form are said to "assert the logical product" of their associated
classes. Some such propositions are themselves in the class whose
logical product they assert. For example, the proposition
asserting that
all-propositions-in-the-class-of-all-propositions-are-true
is itself a proposition, and therefore it itself is in the class
whose logical product it asserts. However, the proposition stating
that all-propositions-in-the-null-class-are-true is not
itself in the null class. Now consider the class w,
consisting of all propositions that state the logical product of
some class m in which they are not included. This
w is itself a class of propositions, and so there is a
proposition r, stating its logical product. The
contradiction arises from asking the question of whether r
is in the class w. It seems that r is in w
just in case it is not. This antinomy was discovered by Bertrand
Russell in 1902, a year after discovering a simpler paradox
usually called "Russell's
paradox". It was discussed informally in Appendix B of
his 1903 Principles of Mathematics. In 1958, the antinomy
was independently rediscovered by John Myhill, who found it to
plague the "Logic of Sense and Denotation" developed by Alonzo
Church.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. History and Historical Importance
In his early work (prior to 1907) Russell held an ontology of
propositions understood as being mind independent entities
corresponding to possible states of affairs. The proposition
corresponding to the English sentence "Socrates is wise" would be
thought to contain both Socrates the person and wisdom (understood as
a Platonic universal) as constituent entities. These entities are the
meanings of declarative sentences.
After discovering "Russell's paradox" in 1901 while working on
his Principles of Mathematics, Russell began searching for a
solution. He soon came upon the Theory of Types, which he describes
in Appendix B of the Principles. This early form of the theory
of types was a version of what has later come to be known as the
"simple theory of types" (as opposed to ramified type theory). The
simple theory of types was successful in solving the simpler paradox.
However, Russell soon asked himself whether there were other
contradictions similar to Russell's paradox that the simple theory of
types could not solve. In 1902, he discovered such a contradiction.
Like the simpler paradox, Russell discovered this paradox by
considering Cantor's power class theorem: the mathematical result
that the number of classes of entities in a certain domain is always
greater than the number in the domain itself. However, there seems to
be a 1-1 correspondence between the number of classes of propositions
and the number of propositions themselves. A different proposition
can seemingly be generated for each class of propositions, for
instance, the proposition stating that all propositions in the class
are true. This would mean that the number of propositions is as great
as the number of classes of propositions, in violation of Cantor's
theorem.
Unlike Russell's paradox, this paradox cannot be blocked by the
simple theory of types. The simple theory of types divides entities
into individuals, properties of individuals, properties of properties
of individuals, and so forth. The question of whether a certain
property applies to itself does not arise, because properties never
apply to entities of their own type. Thus there is no question as to
whether the property that a property has just in case it does not
apply to itself applies to itself. Classes can only have entities of
a certain type: the type to which the property defining the class
applies. There can be classes of individuals, classes of classes of
individuals, and classes of classes of classes of individuals, etc.,
but never classes that contain members of different types. Thus,
there is no such thing as the class of all classes that are not in
themselves. However, on the simple theory of types, propositions are
not properties of anything, and thus, they are all in the type of
individuals. However, they can include classes or properties as
constituents. But consider the property a proposition has just in
case it states the logical product of a class it is not in. This
property defines a class. This class will be a class of individuals;
for any individual, the question arises whether that individual is in
the class. However, the proposition stating the logical product of
this class is also an individual. Thus, the problematic question is
not avoided by the simple theory of types.
Some authors have speculated that this antinomy was the first
hint Russell found that what was needed to solve the paradoxes was
something more than the simple theory of types. If so, then this
antinomy is of considerable importance, as it might represent the
first motivation for the ramified theory of types adopted by Russell
and Whitehead in Principia Mathematica.
2. Formulation and Derivation
In 1902, when he discovered this paradox, Russell's logical
notation was borrowed mostly from Peano. However, translating into
more contemporary notation, the class w of all propositions
stating the logical product of a class
they are not in, and r, the proposition stating its logical
product, are written as follows:
w = {p: ( m)[(p
= ( q)(q
 m  q))
& ~(p m)]}
r = (q)(q
w
q)
Because propositions are entities, variables for them in
Russell's logic can be bound by quantifiers and can flank the
identity sign. Indeed, Russell also allows complete sentences or
formulae to flank the identity sign. If 
is some complex formula, then "p = "
is to be understood as asserting that p is the proposition
that "". Thus,
w
is defined as the class of propositions p such that there is a
class of m for which p is the proposition that all
propositions q in m are true, and such that p is
not in m. The proposition r is then defined as the
proposition stating that all propositions in w are
true.
The derivation of the contradiction requires certain principles
involving the identity conditions of propositions understood as
entities. These principles were never explicitly formulated by
Russell, but are informally stated in his discussion of the antinomy
in the Principles. However, other writers have sought to make
these principles explicit, and even to develop a fully formulated
intensional logic of propositions based on Russell's views. The
principles relevant for the derivation of the contradiction are the
following:
Principle 1: (p)(q)(r)(s)[((p
q) =
(r
s)) ((p =
r) & (q = s))]
Principle 2: [(x)A(x)
= (x)B(x)]
(y)[A(y)
= B(y)]
The first principle states that identical conditional
propositions have identical antecedent and consequent component
propositions. The second states that if the universal proposition
that everything satisfies open formula A(x) is the same as the
universal proposition that everything satisfies open formula
B(x), then for any particular entity y, the proposition
that A(y) is identical to the proposition that
B(y).
Then, from either the assumption that r w or the assumption ~(r w), the opposite follows.
Assume:
1. r w
From (1), by class abstraction and the definition of w:
2. (m)[(r
= (q)(q
m
q))
& ~(r m)]
(2) allows us to consider some m such that:
3. (r = (q)(q
m
q))
& ~(r m)
From the first conjunct of (3) definition of r we arrive
at:
4. (q)(q
w
q) =
(q)(q
m
q)
By (4) and principle 2, then:
5. (q)[(q
w
q) =
(q m
q)]
Instantiating (5) to r, we conclude:
6. (r w
r) =
(r m
r)
By (6), and principle 1, then:
7. (r w) = (r m)
This, with the second disjunct of (3), yields:
8. ~(r m)
By (7) and (8) and substitution of identicals, we get:
9. ~(r w)
This contradicts our assumption. However, assume instead:
10. ~(r w)
By (10) and class abstraction:
11. ~(m)[(r
= (q)(q
m
q))
& ~(r m)]
By the rules of the quantifiers and propositional logic, (11)
becomes:
12. (m)[(r
= (q)(q
m
q))
(r
m)]
Instantiating (12) to w:
13. (r = (q)(q
w
q))
(r
w)
By (13), the definition of r, and modus ponens:
14. r w
Thus, from either assumption the opposite follows.
3. Frege's Response
Soon after discovering this antinomy, in September of 1902,
Russell related his discovery to Gottlob Frege. Although Frege was
clearly devastated by the simpler "Russell's paradox", which Russell
had related to Frege three months prior, Frege was not similarly
impressed by the Russell-Myhill antinomy. Russell had formulated the
antinomy in Peano's logical notation, and Frege charged that the
apparent paradox derived from defects of Peano's symbolism.
In Frege's own way of speaking, a "proposition" is understood
simply as a declarative sentence, a bit of language. Frege certainly
did not ascribe to propositions the sort of ontology Russell did.
However, he thought propositions had both senses and references (see
sense/reference distinction
). He called the senses of propositions "thoughts" and
believed that their references were truth-values, either the True or
the False. An expression written in his logical language was thought
to stand for its reference (though express a thought). When
propositions flank the identity sign, e.g. "p = q" this
is taken as expressing that the two propositions have the same
truth-value, not that they express the same thought.
Thus, Frege was unsatisfied with Russell's formulation of the
antinomy. In Russell's definition "w = {p:
(m)[(p =
(q)(q
m
q))
& ~(p m)]}", the part "p =
(q)(q
m
q)"
seems to mean not an identity of truth-values, but thoughts. However,
if this is the case, then "(q)(q
m
q)" must
be understood as referring to, rather than simply expressing, a
thought. However, on Frege's view, this would mean that the
expressions that occur in it have indirect reference, i.e. they refer
to the thoughts they customarily express. However, in indirect
reference, the variable "m" in that context must be understood
not as standing for a class, but as standing for a sense picking out
a class. However, the second occurrence of "m" later on in the
definition of w must be understood as referring to a class,
not a sense picking out a class. However, if the two occurrences of
"m" do not refer to the same thing, it is extremely
problematic that they be bound by the same quantifier. Moreover,
Russell's derivation of the contradiction requires treating the two
occurrences of "m" as referring to the same thing. Thus, Frege
himself concluded that the antinomy was due to unclarities in the
symbolism Russell used to formulate the paradox. He suggests that the
antinomy can only be derived in a system that conflates or
assimilates sense and reference.
However, it is not clear that Frege's response is adequate.
Frege criticizes only the syntactic formulation of the antinomy in a
logical language, not the violation of Cantor's theorem lying behind
the paradox. Frege does not have an ontology of propositions, but he
does have an ontology of thoughts. Thoughts, as objectively existing
entities, can be members of classes. Moreover, it seems that there
will be as many thoughts as there are classes of thoughts. One can
generate a different thought for every class, i.e. the thought that
everything is in the class or that all thoughts in the class are
true. We now consider the class of all thoughts that state the
logical product of a class they are not in, and a thought stating the
logical product of this class, and arrive at the same contradiction.
Frege's metaphysics seems to have similar difficulties.
It is true that the antinomy cannot be formulated in Frege's
own logical systems. However, this is only because those systems are
entirely extensional. In them, it is impossible to refer to
thoughts (as opposed to simply express them) and assert their
identity--one can only refer to truth-values and assert their
identity. However, it appears that if Frege's logical systems were
expanded to include commitment to the realm of sense, to make it
possible to refer not only to truth-values and classes, but thoughts
and other senses, a version of the antinomy would be provable. In
1951, Alonzo Church developed an expanded logical system based
loosely on Frege's views, which he called "the Logic of Sense and
Denotation". In 1958, John Myhill discovered that the antinomy
considered here was formulable in Church's system. Myhill seems to
have rediscovered the paradox independently of Russell. Hence the
term, "Russell-Myhill Antinomy."
4. Possible Solutions
The antinomy results from the following commitments
(A) The commitment to classes, defined for every
property,
(B) The commitment to propositions as intensional entities
(or to similar entities, such as Frege's thoughts),
(C) An understanding of propositions such that there must
exist as many propositions as there are classes of propositions;
i.e. a different proposition can be generated for every
class,
(D) An understanding of propositions and classes such that
for every proposition and every class of propositions, the
question arises as to whether the proposition falls in the
class.
One might hope to solve the antinomy by abandoning any one of
these commitments. Let us examine them in turn.
Abandoning (A), the commitment to classes, is very tempting,
especially given the other paradoxes of class theory. However, in
this context, this option may be not be as fruitful as it might
appear. Russell himself worked on a "no classes" theory from 1905
though 1907. However, he soon discovered a classless version of the
same paradox. Here, rather than considering a class w
consisting of propositions, we consider a property W that a
proposition p has just in case there is some property F
for which p states that all propositions with F are
true but which p does not itself have. Thus:
(p)[Wp
 (F)[(p
= (q)(Fq
q))
&
~Fp]]
We then define proposition r as the proposition that all
propositions with property W are true:
r =
(q)(Wq
q)
Then, via a similar deduction to that given above, from the
assumption of Wr one can prove ~Wr and vice versa. Thus
it does not do to simply abandon classes. One would also have to
abandon a robust ontology of properties; perhaps eschewing all of
higher-order logic.
One might simply want to abandon (B), the commitment to
propositions or Fregean thoughts understood as logical entities. The
commitment to logical entities in a Platonic realm has grown less and
less popular, especially given the widespread view that logic ought
to be without ontological commitment. The challenge would be to
abandon such intensional entities while maintaining a plausible
account of meaning and intentionality.
However, one might hope to maintain commitment to propositions
or thoughts, but attempt to reduce the number posited. This would
likely involve denying (C). The Cantorian construction lying at the
heart of the antinomy involves the claim that one can generate a
different proposition for every class. In the construction
given above, this claim is justified by showing that for each class,
one can generate a proposition stating its logical product, and
showing that, for each class, the class so generated is
different. To deny this, one could either deny that one can
generate such a proposition for each class, or instead, deny that the
proposition so generated is different for every class. The
first strategy is difficult to justify if one understands
propositions and classes as objectively existing entities,
independent of mind and language. If a proposition exists for every
possible state of affairs, then one such proposition will exist for
every class.
However, if one adopts looser identity conditions for
propositions or thoughts, one might attempt to take the second
approach to denying (C). That is, one would allow that the
proposition stating the logical product of one class might be the
same proposition as the proposition stating the logical product of a
different class. This is perhaps not an easy approach to
justify. In the Russellian deduction given above, principles 1 and 2
guarantee that the proposition stating the logical product of one
class is always different from the proposition stating the logical
product of another class. These principles seem justified by the
understanding of propositions as composite entities with a certain
fixed structure. Consider principle 1. It states that identical
conditional propositions have identical propositions in their
antecedent and consequent positions. However, this might be denied if
one were adopt looser identity conditions for propositions. One
might, for example, adopt logical equivalence as being a
sufficient condition for propositions to be identical. If so, then
principle 1 would be unjustified. For example p
q
and
~q
~p
are logically equivalent, however, they obviously need not have
the same antecedent propositions. However, this approach may lead to
other difficulties. Often, part of the motivation for intensional
entities such as propositions or Fregean thoughts is in order to view
them as relata in belief and other intentional states. If one adopts
logical equivalence as sufficient for propositions to be identical,
this is extremely problematic. The simple proposition p is
logically equivalent to the proposition ~(p & ~q)
~(q
~p). If we take
these
two be the same proposition, then if propositions are relata in
belief states, we seemingly must conclude that anyone who believes
p also believes ~(p & ~q)
~(q
~p). This does
not
seem to be true.
W. V. Quine is famous
for
suggesting that intensional entities are "creatures of darkness",
having obscure identity conditions. Here it appears that if the
identity conditions of intensions are taken to be too loose, then
intensions cannot do many of the things we want of them. If the
identity conditions of intensions are too stringent, however, it is
difficult to avoid positing so many of them that inconsistency with
Cantor's theorem is a genuine threat.
Lastly, one could maintain commitment to a great number of
propositions or thoughts as entities, but block the paradox by
suggesting that these entities fall into different logical types.
That is, one could deny (D), and suggest instead that the question
does not always arise for every proposition and class of propositions
whether that proposition is in that class. This is in effect the
approach taken with ramified type-theory. In ramified type theory,
the type of a formula
depends not only on whether
stands for an individual, a property of an individual, or a property
of a property of an individual, etc., but also on what sort of
quantification
involves.
The core notion is that
cannot involve quantification over, or classes including, entities
within a domain that includes the thing that
itself stands for. Consider the proposition r from the
antinomy. Recall that r was defined as (q)(q
m
q).
Thus, r involves quantification over propositions. In ramified
type theory, we would disallow r to fall within the range of
the quantifier involved in the definition of r. If a certain
proposition involves quantification over a range of propositions, it
cannot be included in that range. Thus, we divide the type of
propositions into orders. Propositions of the lowest order
include mundane propositions such as the proposition that Socrates is
bald or the proposition that Hypatia is wise. Propositions of the
next highest order involve quantification over, or classes of,
propositions of this order, such as the proposition that all such
propositions are true, or the proposition that if such a proposition
is true, then God believes it, etc. Here, the challenge is to justify
the ramified hierarchy as something more than a simple ad hoc
dodge of the antinomies, to provide it with solid philosophical
foundations. Poincaré's Vicious Circle Principle is perhaps
one way of providing such justification.
Antinomies such as the Russell-Myhill antinomy must be a
concern for anyone with a robust ontology of intensional entities.
Nevertheless, there may be solutions to the antinomy short of
eschewing intensions altogether.
5. Suggested Readings
- Anderson, C. A. "Semantic Antinomies in the Logic of Sense
and Denotation." Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic 28
(1987): 99-114.
- ______. "Some New Axioms for the Logic of Sense and
Denotation: Alternative (0)." Noûs 14 (1980):
217-34.
- Church, Alonzo. "A Formulation of the Logic of Sense and
Denotation." In Structure, Method and Meaning: Essays in Honor
of Henry M. Sheffer, edited by P. Henle, H. Kallen and S.
Langer. New York: Liberal Arts Press, 1951.
- ______. "Russell’s Theory of Identity of
Propositions." Philosophia Naturalis 21 (1984):
513-22.
- Frege, Gottlob. Correspondence with Russell. In
Philosophical and Mathematical Correspondence. Translated
by Hans Kaal. Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1980.
- Klement, Kevin C. Frege and the Logic of Sense and Reference,
New York: Routledge, 2002.
- Myhill, John. "Problems Arising in the Formalization of
Intensional Logic." Logique et Analyse 1 (1958):
78-83.
- Russell, Bertrand. Correspondence with Frege. In
Philosophical and Mathematical Correspondence, by Gottlob
Frege. Translated by Hans Kaal. Chicago: University of Chicago
Press, 1980.
- ______. The Principles of Mathematics. 1902. 2d. ed.
Reprint, New York: W. W. Norton & Company, 1996, especially
§500.
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