Russell's paradox represents either of two
interrelated logical antinomies. The most commonly discussed form
is a contradiction arising in the logic of sets or classes. Some
classes (or sets) seem to be members of themselves, while some do
not. The class of all classes is itself a class, and so it
seems to be in itself. The null or empty class, however, must
not be a member of itself. However, suppose that we can
form a class of all classes (or sets) that, like the null
class, are not included in themselves. The paradox arises
from asking the question of whether this class is in
itself. It is if and only if it is not. The other form is a
contradiction involving properties. Some properties seem to apply
to themselves, while others do not. The property of being a
property is itself a property, while the property of being a
cat is not itself a cat. Consider the property that something
has just in case it is a property (like that of being a
cat) that does not apply to itself. Does this property
apply to itself? Once again, from either assumption, the opposite
follows. The paradox was named after Bertrand Russell, who
discovered it in 1901.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. History
Russell's discovery came while he was working on his
Principles of Mathematics. Although Russell discovered the
paradox independently, there is some evidence that other
mathematicians and set-theorists, including Ernst Zermelo and
David Hilbert, had already been aware of the first version of the
contradiction prior to Russell's discovery. Russell, however, was the
first to discuss the contradiction at length in his published works,
the first to attempt to formulate solutions and the first to
appreciate fully its importance. An entire chapter of the
Principles was dedicated to discussing the contradiction, and
an appendix was dedicated to the theory of types that Russell
suggested as a solution.
Russell discovered the contradiction from considering Cantor's
power class theorem: the mathematical result that the number of
entities in a certain domain is always smaller than the number of
subclasses of those entities. Certainly, there must be at
least as many subclasses of entities in the domain as there are
entities in the domain given that for each entity, one subclass will
be the class containing only that entity. However, Cantor proved that
there also cannot be the same number of entities as there are
subclasses. If there were the same number, there would have to be a
1-1 function f mapping entities in the domain on to subclasses
of entities in the domain. However, this can be proven to be
impossible. Some entities in the domain would be mapped by f
on to subclasses that contain them, whereas others may not.
However, consider the subclass of entities in the domain that are not
in the subclasses on to which f maps them. This is itself a
subclass of entities of the domain, and thus, f would have to
map it on to some particular entity in the domain. The problem is
that then the question arises as to whether this entity is in the
subclass on to which f maps it. Given the subclass in
question, it does just in case it does not. The Russell paradox of
classes can in effect be seen as an instance of this line of
reasoning, only simplified. Are there more classes or subclasses of
classes? It would seem that there would have to be more classes,
since all subclasses of classes are themselves classes. But if
Cantor's theorem is correct, there would have to be more subclasses.
Russell considered the simple mapping of classes onto themselves, and
invoked the Cantorian approach of considering the class of all those
entities that are not in the classes onto which they are mapped.
Given Russell's mapping, this becomes the class of all classes not in
themselves.
The paradox had profound ramifications for the historical
development of class or set theory. It made the notion of a universal
class, a class containing all classes, extremely problematic. It also
brought into considerable doubt the notion that for every specifiable
condition or predicate, one can assume there to exist a class of all
and only those things that satisfy that condition. The properties
version of the contradiction--a natural extension of the classes or
sets version--raised serious doubts about whether one can be
committed to objective existence of a property or universal
corresponding to every specifiable condition or predicate. Indeed,
contradictions and problems were soon found in the work of those
logicians, philosophers and mathematicians who made such assumptions.
In 1902, Russell discovered that a version the contradiction was
expressible in the logical system developed in Volume I of Gottlob
Frege's Grundgesetze der Arithmetik, one of the central works
in the late-19th and early-20th century revolution in logic. In
Frege's philosophy, a class is understood as the "extension" or
"value-range" of a concept. Concepts are the closest correlates to
properties in Frege's metaphysics. A concept is presumed to exist for
every specifiable condition or predicate. Thus, there is a concept of
being a class that does not fall under its defining concept. There
is also a class defined by this concept, and it falls under its
defining concept just in case it does not.
Russell wrote to Frege concerning the contradiction in June of
1902. This began one of the most interesting and discussed
correspondences in intellectual history. Frege immediately recognized
the disastrous consequences of the paradox. He did note, however,
that the properties version of the paradox was solved in his
philosophy by his distinction between levels of concepts. For him,
concepts are understood as functions from arguments to
truth-values. Some concepts, "first-level concepts", take objects as
arguments, some concepts, "second-level concepts" take these
functions as arguments, and so on. Thus, a concept can never take
itself as argument, and the properties version cannot be formulated.
However, classes, or extensions or concepts, were all understood by Frege to be
of the same logical type as all other objects. The question does arise, then,
for each class whether it falls under its defining concept.
When he received Russell's first letter, the second volume of
Frege's Grundgesetze was already in the latter stages of the
publication process. Frege was forced to quickly prepare an appendix
in response to the paradox. Frege considers a number of possible
solutions. The conclusion he settles on, however, is to weaken the
class abstraction principle in the logical system. In the original
system, one could conclude that an object is in a class if and only
if the object falls under the concept defining the class. In the
revised system, one can conclude only that an object is in a class if
and only if the object falls under the concept defining the class
and the object is not identical to the class in question. This
blocks the class version of the paradox. However, Frege was not
entirely happy even with this solution. And this was for good reason.
Some years later the revised system was found to lead to a more
complicated form of the contradiction. Even before this result was
discovered, Frege abandoned it and seems to have concluded that his
earlier approach to the logic of classes was simply unworkable, and
that logicians would have to make do entirely without commitment to
classes or sets.
However, other logicians and mathematicians have proposed
other, relatively more successful, alternative solutions. These are
discussed below.
2. Possible Solutions to the Paradox of Properties
The Theory of Types. It was noted above that Frege did
have an adequate response to the contradiction when formulated as a
paradox of properties. Frege's response was in effect a precursor to
what one of the most commonly discussed and articulated proposed
solutions to this form of the paradox. This is to insist that
properties fall into different types, and that the type of a property
is never the same as the entities to which it applies. Thus, the
question never even arises as to whether a property applies to
itself. A logical language that divides entities into such a
hierarchy is said to employ the theory of types. Though hinted
at already in Frege, the theory of types was first fully explained
and defended by Russell in Appendix B of the Principles.
Russell's theory of types was more comprehensive than Frege's
distinction of levels; it divided not only properties into different
logical types, but classes as well. The use of the theory of types to
solve the other form of Russell's paradox is described below.
To be philosophically adequate, the adoption of the theory of
types for properties requires developing an account of the nature of
properties such that one would be able to explain why they cannot
apply to themselves. After all, at first blush, it would seem to make
sense to predicate a property of itself. The property of being
self-identical would seem to be self-identical. The property of being
nice seems to be nice. Similarly, it seems false, not
nonsensical, to say that the property of being a cat is a cat.
However, different thinkers explain the justification for the
type-division in different ways. Russell even gave different
explanations at different parts of his career. For his part, the
justification for Frege's division of different levels of concepts
derived from his theory of the unsaturatedness of concepts.
Concepts, as functions, are essentially incomplete. They require an
argument in order to yield a value. One cannot simply predicate one
concept of a concept of the same type, because the argument concept
still requires its own argument. For example, while it is possible to
take the square root of the square root of some number, one cannot
simply apply the function square root to the function square root and
arrive at a value.
Conservatism about Properties. Another possible solution
to the paradox of properties would involve denying that a property
exists corresponding to any specifiable conditions or well-formed
predicate. Of course, if one eschews metaphysical commitment to
properties as objective and independent entities altogether, that is,
if one adopts nominalism, then the paradoxical question is avoided
entirely. However, one does not need to be quite so extreme in order
to solve the antinomy. The higher-order logical systems developed by
Frege and Russell contained what is called the comprehension
principle, the principle that for every open formula, no matter how
complex, there exists as entity a property or concept exemplified by
all and only those things that satisfy the formula. In effect, they
were committed to attributes or properties for any conceivable set of
conditions or predicates, no matter how complex. However, one could
instead adopt a more austere metaphysics of properties, only granting
objective existence to simple properties, perhaps including
redness, solidity and goodness, etc. One
might even allow that such properties can possibly apply to
themselves, e.g. that goodness is good. However, on this
approach one would deny the same status to complex attributes, e.g.
the so-called "properties" as having-seventeen-heads,
being-a-cheese-made-England,
having-been-written-underwater, etc. It is simply not the case
that any specifiable condition corresponds to a property, understood
as an independently existing entity that has properties of its own.
Thus, one might deny that there is a simple property
being-a-property-that-does-not-apply-to-itself. If so, one can
avoid the paradox simply by adopting a more conservative metaphysics
of properties.
3. Possible Solutions to the Paradox of Classes or Sets
It was mentioned above that late in his life, Frege gave up
entirely on the feasibility of the logic of classes or sets. This is
of course one ready solution to the antinomy in the class or set
form: simply deny the existence of such entities altogether. Short of
this, however, the following solutions have enjoyed the greatest
popularity:
The Theory of Types for Classes: It was mentioned
earlier that Russell advocated a more comprehensive theory of types
than Frege's distinction of levels, one that divided not only
properties or concepts into various types, but classes as well.
Russell divided classes into classes of individuals, classes of
classes of individuals, and so on. Classes were not taken to be
individuals, and classes of classes of individuals were not taken to
be classes of individuals. A class is never of the right type to have
itself as member. Therefore, there is no such thing as the class of
all classes that are not members of themselves, because for any
class, the question of whether it is in itself is a violation of
type. Once again, here the challenge is to explain the metaphysics of
classes or sets in order to explain the philosophical grounds of the
type-division.
Stratification: In 1937, W. V. Quine suggested an
alternative solution in some ways similar to type-theory. His
suggestion was rather than actually divide entities into individuals,
classes of individuals, etc., such that the proposition that some
class is in itself is always ill-formed or nonsensical, we can
instead put certain restrictions on what classes are supposed to
exist. Classes are only supposed to exist if their defining
conditions are so as to not involve what would, in type theory, be a
violation of types. Thus, for Quine, while "x is not a member
of x" is a meaningful assertion, we do not suppose there to
exist a class of all entities x that satisfy this statement.
In Quine's system, a class is only supposed to exist for some open
formula A if and only if the formula A is
stratified, that is, if there is some assignment of natural
numbers to the variables in A such that for each occurrence of
the class membership sign, the variable preceding the membership sign
is given an assignment one lower than the variable following it. This
blocks Russell's paradox, because the formula used to define the
problematic class has the same variable both before and after the
membership sign, obviously making it unstratified. However, it has
yet to be determined whether or not the resulting system, which Quine
called "New Foundations for Mathematical Logic" or NF for short, is
consistent or inconsistent.
Aussonderung: A quite different approach is taken in
Zermelo-Fraenkel (ZF) set theory. Here too, a restriction is placed
on what sets are supposed to exist. Rather than taking the "top-down"
approach of Russell and Frege, who originally believed that for any
concept, property or condition, one can suppose there to exist a
class of all those things in existence with that property or
satisfying that condition, in ZF set theory, one begins from the
"bottom up". One begins with individual entities, and the empty set,
and puts such entities together to form sets. Thus, unlike the early
systems of Russell and Frege, ZF is not committed to a universal set,
a set including all entities or even all sets. ZF puts tight
restrictions on what sets exist. Only those sets that are explicitly
postulated to exist, or which can be put together from such sets by
means of iterative processes, etc., can be concluded to exist. Then,
rather than having a naive class abstraction principle that states
that an entity is in a certain class if and only if it meets its
defining condition, ZF has a principle of separation, selection, or
as in the original German, "Aussonderung". Rather than
supposing there to exist a set of all entities that meet some
condition simpliciter, for each set already known to exist,
Aussonderung tells us that there is a subset of that set of
all those entities in the original set that satisfy the condition.
The class abstraction principle then becomes: if set A exists, then
for all entities x in A, x is in the subset of A that
satisfies condition C if and only if x satisfies condition C.
This approach solves Russell's paradox, because we cannot simply
assume that there is a set of all sets that are not members of
themselves. Given a set of sets, we can separate or divide it into
those sets within it that are in themselves and those that are not,
but since there is no universal set, we are not committed to the set
of all such sets. Without the supposition of Russell's problematic
class, the contradiction cannot be proven.
There have been subsequent expansions or modifications made
on
all these solutions, such as the ramified type-theory of
Principia Mathematica, Quine's later expanded system of his
Mathematical Logic, and the later developments in set-theory
made by Bernays, Gödel and von Neumann. The question of what is
the correct solution to Russell's paradox is still a matter of
debate.
See also the Russell-Myhill Paradox article in this encyclopedia.
4. References and Further Reading
Coffa, Alberto. "The Humble Origins of Russell's Paradox."
Russell 33 (1979): 31-7.
Frege, Gottlob. The Basic Laws of Arithmetic: Exposition
of the System. Edited and translated by Montgomery Furth.
Berkeley: University of California Press, 1964.
Frege, Gottlob. Correspondence with Russell. In Philosophical
and Mathematical Correspondence. Translated by Hans Kaal.
Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1980.
Geach, Peter T. "On Frege’s Way Out." Mind 65
(1956): 408-9.
Grattan-Guinness, Ivor. "How Bertrand Russell Discovered
His Paradox." Historica Mathematica 5 (1978):
127-37.
Hatcher, William S. Logical Foundations of
Mathematics. New York: Pergamon Press, 1982.
Quine, W. V. O. "New Foundations for Mathematical Logic."
In From a Logical Point of View. 2d rev. ed. Cambridge, MA:
Harvard University Press, 1980. (First published in
1937.)
Quine, W. V. O. "On Frege’s Way Out." Mind 64
(1955): 145-59.
Russell, Bertrand. Correspondence with Frege. In
Philosophical and Mathematical Correspondence, by Gottlob
Frege. Translated by Hans Kaal. Chicago: University of Chicago
Press, 1980.
Russell, Bertrand. The Principles of Mathematics. 2d. ed.
Reprint, New York: W. W. Norton & Company, 1996. (First
published in 1902.)
Zermelo, Ernst. "Investigations in the Foundations of Set
Theory I." In From Frege to Gödel, ed. by Jean van
Heijenoort. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1967. (First
published in 1908.)
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