Objects of perception are the entities we attend to when we perceive the world.
Perception
lies at the root of all our empirical knowledge. We may have acquired much of
what we know about the world through testimony, but originally such knowledge
relies on the world having been perceived by others or ourselves using our five
senses: sight, hearing, touch, taste, and smell. Perception, then, is of great
epistemological importance. Also, a philosopher’s account of perception is
intimately related to his or her conception of the mind, so this article
focuses on issues in both epistemology and the philosophy of mind. The
fundamental question we shall consider concerns the objects of perception: what
is it we attend to when we perceive the world? We begin with five different
answers to the question, "On what does my attention focus when I look at the
yellow coffee cup in front of me?"
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Direct Realism
Perceptual realism is the common sense view that tables, chairs and
cups of coffee exist independently of perceivers. Direct realists also claim
that it is with such objects that we directly engage. The objects of
perception include such familiar items as paper clips, suns and olive oil
tins. It is these things themselves that we see, smell, touch, taste and
listen to. There are, however, two versions of direct realism: naïve direct
realism and scientific direct realism. They differ in the properties they
claim the objects of perception possess when they are not being perceived.
Naïve realism claims that such objects continue to have all the properties that
we usually perceive them to have, properties such as yellowness, warmth, and
mass. Scientific realism, however, claims that some of the properties
an object is perceived as having are dependent on the perceiver, and that
unperceived objects should not be conceived as retaining them. Such a stance
has a long history:
By convention sweet and by
convention bitter, by convention hot, by convention cold, by convention colour;
in reality atoms and void. [Democritus, c. 460-370 BCE, quoted by Sextus Empiricus
in Barnes, 1987, pp. 252-253.]
Scientific
direct realism is often discussed in terms of Locke’s distinction between
primary and secondary qualities. The Primary qualities of an object are those
whose existence is independent of the existence of a perceiver. Locke’s inventory
of primary qualities included shape, size, position, number, motion-or-rest and
solidity, and science claims to be completing this inventory by positing such
properties as charge, spin and mass. The secondary qualities of objects,
however, are those properties that do depend on the existence of a perceiver.
They can either be seen as properties that are not actually possessed by the
objects themselves, or, as dispositional properties, properties that objects
only have when considered in relation to their perceivers. On the former
interpretation, the cup itself is not yellow, but the physical composition of
its surface, and the particular way this surface reflects light rays into our
eyes, causes in us the experience of seeing yellow. And, on the latter
interpretation, for an object to be yellow is for it to be disposed to
produce experiences of yellow in perceivers. Locke is usually seen as being
committed to this latter type of account:
Such qualities which
in truth are nothing in the objects themselves, but powers to produce various
sensations in us by their primary qualities. [Locke, 1690, 2.8.10]
The secondary
qualities, then, comprise such properties as color, smell and felt texture. We have seen
that for the naïve realist, objects that are not actually being perceived
continue to have all the properties we normally perceive them as having. For
the scientific realist, however, only some of the properties we perceive
continue to be possessed by objects when there are no perceivers around, these
being their primary qualities. The distinction
between primary and secondary qualities is controversial in various ways, but
that need not concern us here. What we should be clear on, however, is that
the key feature of both naïve and scientific direct realism is that we directly
attend to objects whose existence is independent of perceivers, objects that
are out there in the world. The following section questions this whole
approach.
2. Indirect Realism
The indirect realist agrees
that the coffee cup exists independently of me. However, through perception I
do not directly engage with this cup; there is a perceptual intermediary that
comes between it and me. Ordinarily I see myself via an image in a mirror, or
a football match via an image on the TV screen. The indirect realist claim is
that all perception is mediated in something like this way. When looking at an
everyday object it is not that object that we directly see, but rather, a
perceptual intermediary. This intermediary has been given various names,
depending on the particular version of indirect realism in question, including
"sense datum, " "sensum," "idea," "sensibilium,"
"percept" and "appearance." We shall use the term "sense datum" and the plural
"sense data." Sense data are mental objects that possess the properties that we
take the objects in the world to have. They are usually considered to have two
rather than three dimensions. For the indirect realist, then, the coffee cup on
my desk causes in my mind the presence of a two-dimensional yellow sense datum,
and it is this object that I directly perceive. Consequently, I only indirectly
perceive the coffee cup, that is, I can be said to perceive it in virtue of the
awareness I have of the sense data that it has caused in my mind. These latter
entities, then, must be perceived with some kind of inner analog of vision. We shall
first look at some weak arguments for this stance. After dismissing these we
shall turn to the Argument From Illusion. This is a highly influential
argument that many see as persuasive. In addition to supporting indirect
realism, the other three theories of perception—phenomenalism, intentionalism
and disjunctivism can be seen as responses to
it. As well as
looking at my coffee cup, I can look out of my window and see the stars in the
night sky. However, it is a fact (one that can amaze on first discovery) that
the star at which I am currently looking may have ceased to exist. The
pinpoint of light that I see has taken years to reach me, and in that time the
star may have turned supernova. How can I, then, be directly attending to that
star when it is no longer there? What must be happening is that the light rays
that originated from that star have caused in me the presence of a perceptual
intermediary, an intermediary that is still present in my mind, and thus, an
intermediary to which I can still attend. This argument
can be applied not just to far distant objects, but to everything we perceive.
Light also takes time to travel from the cup to my eyes. Therefore, I am now
perceiving the cup as it was a fraction of a millisecond ago. The steam I see
rising from it is actually further from the cup than it now appears to me. So
again, it cannot be the steam that I directly see since I am not seeing it in
the state that it is now in. It must, therefore, be a perceptual intermediary
that I perceive. This, however, is not a
persuasive line of argument. One should reject the assumption that the object
of perception has to exist at the moment we become perceptually aware of that
object. Perception is a causally mediated process, and causation takes time.
Because of this, at the time when perceptual processing is complete, the
properties of perceived objects may be distinct from those possessed by the
object at the time when their causal engagement with our perceptual apparatus
began. As said, in extreme cases the objects of perception may no longer exist
at the moment when the causal process of perception is complete. One should,
therefore, accept that all the events we perceive are to some extent in the
past. The fact that perception is a
complex causal process motivates some to offer another weak argument for the
indirect realist position. There are many neurophysiological features and
physiological entities such as retinal images that are involved in perception.
Some conclude that I do not directly see the cup; I see it via such entities,
and the indirect realist should take these to be his perceptual
intermediaries. The correct response here is to agree (as one must) that such
physiological items are indeed intermediaries in the process of perception.
They are, however, intermediaries in a different sense. The indirect realist
claims that we perceive his intermediaries --
we attend to them -- just as we do to our image in
the mirror. His intermediaries are perceptually accessible. This, however, is
plainly not true of the physiological components of the perceptual process.
They are not, therefore, perceptual intermediaries in the correct sense. They
are simply part of the causal mechanism that enables us to perceptually engage
with objects, both those around us, and those in the far distance. So far,
then, we do not have any reason to give up direct realism. Many, however, have
seen the following argument as providing such a reason.
a. The Argument from Illusion
Illusions occur
when the world is not how we perceive it to be. When a stick is partially
submerged in water, it looks bent when in fact it is straight. From most
angles plates look oval rather than round. (We still, of course, believe
that the plate is circular and that the stick is straight because of what we
know about perspective and refraction; but these objects can still look bent
and elliptical if we resist interpreting what we see with respect to such
knowledge.) As well as being prey to illusions, we can also have
hallucinations in which there is nothing actually there to perceive at all. It
is both of these phenomena that are seen to drive the following key argument for
indirect realism. I’ll partly submerge a pencil
in my glass of water (the one that is next to my yellow coffee cup). The
pencil appears bent. There is, then, a bent shape in my visual field. I know,
however, that the pencil is not really bent. (Or, if this were a case of
hallucination rather than illusion, there would not be a pencil there at all.)
The bent shape of which I am aware, therefore, cannot be the real pencil in the
world. Perhaps, then, it is a physical object on the surface of my cornea, or
one floating inside my eyeball (it is possible to see such objects). Empirical
evidence, however, has shown that there are no such objects that correlate with
our perceptual experiences. So, if the bent shape is not a physical object, it
must be something mental. As we have seen, these mental items have been coined
“sense data”, and it must be these that we attend to in cases of illusion and
hallucination. Let us now turn to the
veridical case. Cases of veridical perception are qualitatively identical to
those of illusion or hallucination, and so there must be something in common
between the normal case and these non-veridical ones. (This is a key
assumption to which we shall return.) The conclusion we should draw, then, is
that the common factor between the veridical and the non-veridical cases of
perception is the presence of a sense datum. Therefore, in cases of veridical
perception it is also sense data with which we perceptually engage. According
to the orthodox interpretation, Locke can be seen as holding such a theory:
“The mind…perceives nothing but its own ideas” [Locke, 1690, 4.4.3].
(Ideas, of course, being mental components akin to sense data.) And, this kind
of theory has continued to have a distinguished following, its adherents
include Bertrand Russell, Alfred J. Ayer and Frank Jackson (the latter,
however, has recently abandoned this view). There are various problems
with this argument and we shall look at some of these in the following section.
However, whether or not the argument is successful, there is no doubt that it
has been highly influential. The theories of perception covered in the rest of
this article are in part driven by the argument from illusion. Phenomenalism
(section 3) accepts the existence of sense data, but denies that they play the
role of perceptual intermediaries between the world and us. There is no world on the other side
of our sense data; or, we should conceive of the material
world as a construction of our sense data. Intentionalism (section 4) agrees
that there is indeed something in common between the veridical and the
non-veridical cases. However, this common factor should not be seen as an
object, but rather, as intentional content. And finally, disjunctivism (section
5) undercuts the argument from illusion by rejecting the assumption that there
must be something in common between the veridical and non-veridical cases. We
will discuss these theories below, but first we shall consider the problems
with the very idea of sense data, and with the argument from
illusion itself.
b. Problems for Indirect Realism
i. Dualism
Many see a
problem with respect to the metaphysics of sense data. Sense data are seen as
inner objects, objects that among other things are colored. Such entities,
however, are incompatible with a materialist view of the mind. When I look at
the coffee cup there is not a material candidate for the yellow object at which
I am looking. Crudely: there is nothing in the brain that is yellow. Sense data,
then, do not seem to be acceptable on a materialist account of the mind, and
thus, the yellow object that I am now perceiving must be located not in the
material world but in the immaterial mind. Indirect realism is committed to a
dualist picture within which there is an ontology of non-physical objects
alongside that of the physical. There are, however,
two major difficulties with dualism. These difficulties are outlined
below. The first and greatest problem for the dualist concerns explaining the
interaction between mind and body. Remember, the indirect realist accepts that
there is a world independent of our experience, and, in veridical cases of
perception it is this world that somehow causes sense data to be manifest in
our minds. How, though, can causal interactions with the world bring about the
existence of such non-physical items, and how can such items be involved in
causing physical actions, as they appear to be? If I have a desire for
caffeine, then my perception of the coffee cup causes me to reach out for that
cup. A non-physical sense datum causes the physical movement of my arm. Such
causal relations seem to be counter to the laws of physics. The physical view
of nature aims to be complete and closed: for every physical event there is a
physical cause. Here, though, the cause of my reaching out for the cup is in
part non-physical, and thus, the closure of physics is threatened. The only way
to maintain both physical closure and
the causal efficacy of the mental is
to claim that there is overdetermination, i.e. that my reaching for the cup has
two causes, one involving sense data, and one involving purely physical
phenomena, either of which is in itself sufficient to bring about that action.
This line, however, is difficult to accept since according to such an account
my perception of the cup is incidental to my action: I would have reached for
the cup even if I was not consciously aware that it was there. There are,
then, problems in reconciling a non-physical conception of sense data with
certain widely held views concerning causation. A dualistically
conceived mind appears to be paradoxical in the same way as fictional ghosts
are: ghosts can pass through walls, yet they do not fall through the floor;
they can wield axes yet swords pass straight through them. Similarly, the mind
is conceived as both distinct from the physical world, and also causally
efficacious within it, and it is not clear how the mind can coherently possess
both features. Descartes himself admitted that he was stumped by the problem
of how to account for the interaction between physical entities and the mental
realm: It
does not seem to me that the human mind is capable of conceiving quite
distinctly and at the same time both the distinction between mind and body, and
their union; because to do so, it is necessary to conceive them as a single
thing, and at the same time to conceive them as two things, which is
self-contradictory. [Descartes, 1970, 142] A second problem
associated with the non-physical nature of sense data is that concerning their
spatial location. Our perception presents objects as lying in spatial
relations with respect to each other. According to the indirect realist, the
objects of perception are sense data, and thus, our perceptual experience
presents one sense datum as being in front of another, and that green one to
the left of that red one: “The relative positions of physical objects in
physical space must more or less correspond to the relative positions of sense
data in our private spaces” [Russell, 1912, p. 15]. But how can this be so?
On the Cartesian conception of dualism, the non-physical does not have spatial
dimensions, and so how can one component of this realm be seen as in front of
another? And, how can such non-physical entities be describable in the spatial
way we describe physical bodies? How can a non-physical sense datum be round or
square? The non-physical nature of sense data seems to threaten the coherence
of an indirect realist description of sensory experience. We can say that we
see the round green object as just to the left of the square red one if we are
talking about spatially located objects in the world, but not if we are talking
about non-physical mental items, items for which the idea of spatial location
has no application.
ii. Adverbialism
Some see the
argument from illusion as begging the question. It is simply assumed, without
argument, that in the non-veridical case I am aware of some thing that
has the property that the stick appears to me to have. It is assumed that some
object must be bent. One can, however, reject this assumption: I only seem to
see a bent pencil; there is nothing there in the world or in my mind
that is actually bent. Only if you already countenance such entities as sense
data will you take the step from something appears F to you to there
is an object that really is F. Such an objection to indirect realism is
forwarded by adverbialists. We can illustrate their claim by turning to other
everyday linguistic constructions, examples in which such ontological
assumptions are not made. “David Beckham has a beautiful free kick” does not
imply that he is the possessor of a certain kind of object -- a kick -- something that he could perhaps give away or sell in the way that he can his
beautiful car. Rather, we take this to mean that he takes free kicks
beautifully. When one gives a mean-eye, one looks meanly at somebody else; one
does not offer them an actual eye of some kind. Similarly, then, when one
perceives yellow one is sensing in a yellow manner, or yellowly. Our
perception should be described in terms of adverbial modifications of the
various verbs characteristic of perception, rather than in terms of objects to
which our perceptual acts are directed. As I sip my drink, I see brownly and
smell bitterly; I do not attend to brown and bitter objects, the inner
analogues of the properties of the cheap coffee below my nose. As Wittgenstein
often took great pains to point out, many philosophical problems are simply the
result of grammatical confusion, or, as Lowe puts it, “an inconvenient legacy
of Indo-European languages” [Lowe, 1995, p. 45]. In describing our perceptual
experiences we are not describing the visual and olfactory properties of mental
items; but rather, we are talking about the manner in which we experience the
external world. Thus, if one can give an account of what it is to experience
in a brown and bitter manner, then one can account for perception without
relying upon sense data. This, we shall see below, the intentionalist and the disjunctivist
attempt to do.
iii. The Veil of Perception
Indirect realism
invokes the veil of perception.
All we actually perceive is the veil that
covers the world, a veil that consists of our sense data. What, then, justifies
our belief that there is a world beyond that veil? In drawing the focus of our
perception away from the world and onto inner items, we are threatened by
wholesale skepticism. Since we can only directly perceive our sense data, all
our beliefs about the external world beyond may be false. There may not
actually be any coffee cups or olive oil tins in the world, merely sense data
in my mind. However, for this to be a strong objection to indirect realism, it
would have to be the case that direct realism was in a better position with
respect to skepticism, but it is not clear that this is so. The direct realist
does not claim that his perceptions are immune to error, simply that when one
correctly perceives the world, one does so directly and not via an
intermediary. Thus, things may not always be the way that they appear to be,
and therefore, there is (arguably) room for the sceptic to question one-by-one
the veracity of all our perceptual beliefs.
3. Phenomenalism
Some have
embraced the skepticism suggested by indirect realism and accepted the
anti-realist position that there is no world independent of the perceiver. Two
strategies that take this line are idealism and phenomenalism. Berkeley (1710)
is an idealist. For him, physical objects consist in collections of ideas or,
what have later come to be called, "sense data." It is only objects conceived
of in this way of which we can have knowledge. Sense data, however, cannot
exist if they are not being perceived, and so, ‘physical’ objects conceived of
in this way are also dependent on perceivers. For Berkeley, therefore, the
universe simply consists in minds and the sense data that they perceive. There
is only immaterial substance.
A consequence of
such an account would seem to be that when we do not perceive the world it does
not exist; there are gaps in the existence of objects. Berkeley, however,
attempts to avoid this conclusion by claiming that God "fills the gaps." God
perceives the objects that are not perceived by us, and thus, sustains their
existence; an existence, though, that subsists merely in the realm of ideas or
sense data.
[A]ll
the furniture of the earth….have not any subsistence without a mind…their being
is to be perceived or known,….consequently, so long as they are not actually
perceived by me or do not exist in my mind or that of any other created spirit,
they must either have no existence at all or else subsist in the mind of some
external spirit....
it being perfectly unintelligible….to attribute to any single part
of them an existence independent of a spirit. [Berkeley, 1710, part 1, para. 6]
Such a position
is of course highly problematic, but perhaps surprisingly, some of its
idealistic elements were widely adopted in the early twentieth century by a
group of philosophers called ‘phenomenalists.’
Idealists
conceive of the world in terms of our actual experiences (and, for
Berkeley, those of God). Phenomenalists hold a related position: for them,
propositions about the physical world should be seen as propositions about our possible
experiences. Or, as Mill (1867) claims, material objects are nothing but
“permanent possibilities of sensation.” Phenomenalism is classically taken as
a conceptual thesis: statements about physical objects have the same meaning as
statements describing our sense data.
The
meaning of any statement which refers to a material thing may be fully conveyed
in statements which refer solely to sense-data or the sensible appearance of
things. [Chisholm, 1948, p. 152. Note, however, that this is not Chisholm’s
own view]
Phenomenalism,
therefore, avoids the problem of gaps in a distinct way. Physical objects
can exist unperceived since there is the continued possibility of
experience. To say that the paper clip is in my drawer is to say that I would
see it on opening that drawer. The world, then, is described in terms of our
current sense data, and in terms of conditionals that detail which sense data
we would encounter in counterfactual and future situations. We must, however,
be careful to note the crucial difference between the realist and anti-realist
readings of such conditionals. Realism, be it direct or indirect, has an
account of why such a conditional holds: I will have the experience of perceiving a
paper clip since there exists independent of my mind a real paper clip in the
drawer. Phenomenalists, however, do not ground their conditionals in this way
since there is no world independent of our (possible) experiences. To say that
the paper clip is in my drawer, is simply to say that the flux of sense data
characteristic of the experience of opening a drawer will be followed by the
experience of perceiving the silvery-colored sense data that constitutes a
perception of a paper clip. There is no mention here of an independent world; such
conditionals are only described in terms of the content of one’s experiences.
To make the phenomenalist
claim clear, it is useful to look at the distinction between dispositional and
categorical properties. Conditionals can be used to describe dispositional properties
such as solubility: that lump of sugar is soluble since it will dissolve if
I put it in my cup of coffee. Dispositional properties, however, usually have
a categorical grounding. Sugar is soluble because of its chemical structure. The
conditionals of the phenomenalist, however, should be taken as describing
dispositions that do not have such a grounding. The regularities in our
experience that they pick out do not have a categorical basis, unlike the
psychological regularities of the realist that are grounded in our engagement
with the existent external world. The experiential regularities of the phenomenalist
are brute; nothing further can be said about why they hold.
a. Problems for Phenomenalism
For many, the idealistic nature of phenomenalism is unpalatable. A consequence
of phenomenalism would seem to be that if there were no minds then there would
be no world. This is so since ‘physical’ objects are simply constructs of our
(possible) experience. Let us also consider the thoughts of others. I seem to be
able to interpret what you are thinking by considering your behavior, by
watching your actions and listening to your utterances. Your behavior, however,
like the rest of the material world, simply consists of my sense data and the
counterfactual relations of these mental items. Thus, phenomenalism invokes a
solipsistic picture in which it is my sense data alone that constitute the
world. A phenomenalist sitting here reading this article from the screen must
claim that the computer monitor simply consists in the possibility of sensations that their own physical body (also a part of the material world)
also has this nature, and that the people which can be seen in the street
outside are similarly constructs of the phenomenalist’s own sense data. Phenomenalism
is a very radical stance to take.
Also, even for those who do not have qualms about adopting such an idealistic
and solipsistic stance, there are arguments which suggest that phenomenalism
cannot complete the project it sets itself. A key argument against phenomenalism
is the argument from perceptual relativity. Chisholm (1948) argues that one
cannot provide translations of statements about physical objects in terms of
statements about sense data. For a phenomenalist, the statement that there is an
old green olive oil tin to my right means that the experience of reaching to the
right would, on encountering the jagged rim, be followed by a sharp sensation; and that the sensation of turning my head would be followed by the
presence of green sense data in my visual field. However, such fluxes of
experience need not occur in this way. With gloves on, I would not feel such a
sharp sensation; and, I may be color blind or the lights may be out and thus I
may not experience green sense data. The sensations I have depend on various
facts about me (the perceiver) and my environment. There are no lawlike
conditional statements that describe the relation between sensations considered
in isolation from physical aspects of the perceiver and of the world. To
calculate the appearances with complete success, it is necessary to know both
the thing perceived and the (subjective and objective) observation conditions,
for it is the thing perceived and the observation conditions working jointly
which determine what is to appear. [Chisholm, 1948, p. 513] A phenomenalist
cannot account for such observation conditions since he is not permitted to
talk of the physical states of the perceiver or those of the environment. He
can only talk of sense data and the relations between them. Therefore,
according to Chisholm, there are no phenomenalist translations to be had, and
thus, phenomenalism fails.
4. The Intentional Theory of Perception
The last two positions
at which we shall look deny that sense data are involved in perception. To do
this they must find alternative responses to the argument from illusion, and
they must provide a story that explains how we are in direct contact with the
world. Intentionalists
emphasize parallels between perceptions and beliefs. Beliefs represent the
world: I now have a belief about the pencil tin (the one that used to
contain olive oil), and this belief represents that particular part of the
world as being green. Beliefs, then, possess aboutness or what
philosophers of mind call “intentionality.” Intentionality is considered to be
an essential feature of the mind, and it describes the property that certain
mental states have of representing -- or, being about -- certain aspects of the
world. The aspects of the world that a belief is about can be specified in
terms of its intentional content. The intentional content of my current
belief is that tin is green. The intentionalist claim is that
perceptions are also representational states (intentionalism is sometimes
called representationalism). I can, then, believe that that tin is
green, and I can also perceive that it is. You are about to perceive that the
first word of the next paragraph is “Let.” Your perception is intentional: it
is about a word on the screen; and, its content is that the next word is
“Let.” Let us see how the intentionalist
reacts to the argument from illusion. The key claim will be that
representational states can be in error. I can have false beliefs: I can
believe that my cup is full when it is not; and I can have beliefs about
non-existent entities: I can believe that the Tooth Fairy visited me last
night. Such beliefs are analogous to the non-veridical perceptual cases of
illusion and hallucination. In both belief and perception, the world is
represented to be a certain way that it is not. And, crucially, the intentionalist
has an account of what such veridical and non-veridical cases have in common:
their intentional content. My perception has the representational content, there
is a bent pencil there, whether or not there really is such a pencil in the
world (I might have been duped and an actual bent pencil placed in the glass).
In the veridical case this content correctly represents the world; in the
non-veridical case it does not. Intentionalists, therefore, agree with sense
datum theorists that there is an aspect of perception that is shared by the
veridical and the non-veridical cases. This shared component, however, is not
the presence of a perceptual object, but rather, that of a certain intentional
content. Therefore, both intentionalists and sense datum theorists can be seen
as providing representational accounts of perception: intentional content and
the sense data of the indirect realist represent the state of the independent
external world. Intentionalists, however, have representation without an
ontological commitment to mental objects. Intentionalism is driven
by current themes in the philosophy of mind. Many in that field are optimistic
about providing a broadly scientific, causal account of representation and intentionality.
If one could provide such an account then a naturalistically acceptable theory
of perception should be seen to drop out of this research. To explain
perception one does not have to posit non-physical sense data; rather, one
could simply use one’s naturalistic account of intentional content, since,
according to intentionalists, the important features of perception are captured
by this notion.
a. Clarification of the Intentional Theory of Perception
i. Non-Conceptual Content
There is a debate
concerning the nature of the representational content relevant to perception.
We are talking of content, so all are agreed that such content is evaluable
as correct or incorrect. The question of whether the world is as it is
represented to be is always pertinent. The debate, however, concerns whether
all such representational content must be conceptually structured (see
McDowell, 1994, lecture 3); or, whether some of the representational content
involved in perception is non-conceptual (see Peacocke, 1992, chapter 3). (A
concept is a constituent of thought that is apt for being the content of a
judgment or a belief.) Two arguments that suggest the existence of
non-conceptual content are those concerning the fine-grain of experience and
the experience of animals. It seems implausible
that I have a distinct concept for every shade of brown that I perceive in the
pair of battered old corduroy trousers that I am now wearing, or concepts
corresponding to all the nuances of my neighbor’s distorted music that I am
currently hearing through my study wall. Our experience appears to be more
finely grained than our conceptual repertoire. If one is an intentionalist,
then one could invoke representational content that is not conceptual to
account for the richness of one’s experience. Also, many are unwilling to
ascribe conceptual capacities to animals (at least if one goes far enough down
the phylogenetic ladder). However, those same people are often less
restrictive with their ascription of experiential properties. They would like
to allow animals to have experiences and perception without a conceptual
framework within which to structure them. If one is an intentionalist, then
non-conceptual content could also be invoked to account for animal perception.
ii. Phenomenology
There are problems associated with accounting for the phenomenological features
of perception. My experience consists in more than simply representing that the
world is a certain way; it is also the case that the way I acquire
representations strikes my consciousness distinctively. Right now there is a faint sound of a road
drill syncopating with the reverse warning beep of a supermarket delivery
truck; the yellow cup in front of me is slowly fading to brown as a cloud
passes overhead; and the smell of coffee is struggling to get past my
persistent cold and the pungency of my throat lozenges. All of this is part of
my perceptual experience, and for the intentionalist, this experience consists
in such representational content as, the truck is emitting a beep, and, my
throat lozenge is pungent. There is also, however, something “it is like”
to be having such representations (see Nagel, 1974). Our experience has a
phenomenological dimension, a dimension that you are probably currently
imagining. The shrill beep goes right though me, and the lozenge is so
strong that although it pervades my consciousness, I somehow also feel sharper,
clearer, more finely tuned to the quality of the air that I am breathing. The intentionalist,
therefore, must also account for these phenomenological properties of
perception. I shall look at two responses here, one that develops the intentionalist
line in order to account for these features of perception, and one that takes
such considerations to show that a pure intentionalist account is untenable. One route that the intentionalist
could take is to identify the phenomenological aspects of our experience with
the representational. Naturalistically minded philosophers attempt to provide
a causal account that explains how our mental states, experiences and
perceptions have the intentional content that they do. One could, then, claim
that the causal processes that ground intentional content also have a
phenomenological aspect. It is the very same state that has both
representational content and phenomenological features. There are, however,
problems associated with such a claim. Some see an unbridgeable gap between
physical and phenomenological phenomena (see Levine, 1983). Any account
couched in terms of the broadly physical properties of the brain cannot hope to
capture the conscious, phenomenological dimension of thought and perception. [There is] the
feeling of an unbridgeable gulf between consciousness and brain process…This
idea of a difference in kind is accompanied by slight giddiness. (Wittgenstein,
1953, § 412) Others, however, see this explanatory gap as illusory (see Tye, 2002). Here, though, is not the
place to pursue this debate. The second broad
response to the phenomenology of experience is to claim that representational
properties alone cannot account for perception, and thus, one should reject the
intentionalist project. If one is to account for what it is like to perceive
the world, then one also requires sensational properties (properties distinct
from those relevant to representation). Peacocke (1988) supports this line. He
suggests examples in which there are aspects of our experience that have the
same representational content, yet which differ in their phenomenological
character. He therefore claims that representational content alone cannot
account for phenomenology. Ahead of you on the motorway are two trucks, one
just ahead and one near the horizon. You represent them as being of the same
size and as moving at the same speed. There is, however, a sense in which the
nearer one seems bigger to you -- it takes up more of your visual field -- and, it
moves across your visual field at a faster rate. These features of your
experience, then, are not captured in terms of representational content. Peacocke’s
claim, therefore, is that “concepts of sensation are indispensable to the
description of the nature of any experience” [Peacocke, 1983, p. 4]. Advocates of Peacocke’s
line often favor the existence of qualia (singular: quale). These are seen
(by some) as the non-representational, phenomenological properties of
experience. One must, however, be very careful when reading the literature
concerning qualia since the term is sometimes used in other ways. Others
see it as merely referring to the phenomenological aspects of our experience
(whether or not these can be captured in representational terms). In this
sense, qualia are uncontroversial; they merely commit one to the claim that our
experience is conscious. Others, notably Dennett (1991, chapter 12), take qualia
to be essentially private, and our knowledge of them to be incorrigible.
Conceived thus, he denies that there are such entities. We have, then, been
considering whether the phenomenological aspects of perception can be
integrated into an intentionalist account. In summary, one can either identify these phenomenological features with
the causal processes that are constitutive of the representational content of
perception, or one can take such features to demand that an account of
perception must include properties other than those that are representational.
5. Disjunctive Accounts of Perception
Finally
we have a rather different approach. Disjunctivism denies the key assumption
that there must be something in common between veridical and non-veridical
cases of perception, an assumption that is accepted by all the positions above,
and an assumption that drives the argument from illusion. For the disjunctivist,
these cases certainly seem to be the same, but they are, however,
distinct. This is because in veridical perception the world is
presented to us. The world is not just represented as being a certain way, as
for the intentionalist; but rather, the world partly constitutes one’s
perceptual state. Thus, one’s perceptual state when hallucinating is entirely
distinct from one’s perceptual state when actually attending to the world. To
be in the state that I am in when I veridically perceive a green tin, there
really has to be something there that is green. This, remember, is also one of
the commitments of the sense datum theorist; but for the disjunctivist, the
green item is in the world, it is not an internal mental object. This position is
called “disjunctivism” because when I seem to see a green tin, I am either perceiving
a green tin or it is as if there is a green tin in front of me (a
disjunction of perceptual states). I am not in a perceptual state that is
common to both types of experience. Of
facts to the effect that things seem thus and so to one, we might say, some
are cases of things being thus and so within the reach of one’s subjective
access to the external world, whereas others are mere appearances. [McDowell,
1986, p. 241] Disjunctivism
can avoid the argument from illusion since it does not accept that veridical
and non-veridical perceptual states are in any way the same (they only seem to
be). We do not, therefore, have to posit a common factor, either in the form
of a sense datum, or an intentional content. There is, then, a key difference
between the strategies of the intentionalist and the disjunctivist: intentionalists
answer the argument from illusion by claiming that veridical and non-veridical
perceptions have a type of representational state in common, whereas disjunctivists
undercut the argument by claiming that there is no need to posit such a common
factor. Proponents of disjunctivism
see their position as upholding certain common sense assumptions about the
nature of perception. It is claimed that both sense datum theorists and intentionalists
do not account for the idea that it is the qualities of the tin in front of me
of which I am directly conscious. This is because for the former it is the
qualities of a mental sense datum that are the focus of my consciousness; and
for both, the content of one’s experience could be just the same even if there
was not a tin there and one was hallucinating. Such accounts, then, do not
capture the intuition that the nature of my current experience is constituted
by my consciousness of the properties of the tin at which I am looking. However, in any
particular case the disjunctivist must accept that he cannot tell which disjunct
holds. When prey to illusion or hallucination, it can seem to you as if you
are really perceiving the actual state of the world, and thus, it seems to you
that you are in the same perceptual state that you would be in if the world was
really how you perceive it to be. A consequence of disjunctivism, then, is
that one can be not only deluded about the state of the world, but also about
the state of one’s own mind. When one is unknowingly prey to illusion or
hallucination, one is in fact in an entirely distinct perceptual state from the
state that one takes oneself to be in. This is an anti-Cartesian position
since:
In
a fully Cartesian picture, the inner life takes place in an autonomous realm,
transparent to the introspective awareness of its subject. [McDowell, 1986,
p.236][The
mind is] a realm of reality in which samenesses and differences are
exhaustively determined by how things seem to the subject, and hence which are
knowable through and through by exercising one’s capacity to know how things seem
to one. [Ibid. P.249]
a. Disjunctivism and Cognitive Externalism
A consequence of
disjunctivism is that two physically identical brains can be in distinct
perceptual states. Imagine there is a demon or a very clever scientist who
uses his supernatural powers or hi-tech wizardry to simultaneously remove the
green tin from existence, while stimulating my brain in the way that it would
have continued to be stimulated if the green tin had remained there on my
desk. If this were so, experientially everything would appear to me to be the
same as it is now, and, ex hypothesi, the flux of my brain states would
also be the same as that which is currently occurring as I now look at the
tin. According to the disjunctivist, however, such demonic intervention will induce
in me an entirely distinct perceptual state, that of a hallucinatory rather
than a veridical perception. Many cannot accept this consequence of disjunctivism.
They claim that the mind must supervene on the brain, i.e. that if the physical
states of two brains are identical, then so too must be the thoughts,
experiences, and perceptions manifest in those brains. However, the disjunctivist
conclusion can be embraced by those who accept cognitive externalism. For such
externalists, the world plays a constitutive role in determining the content of
our mental states: “Cognitive space incorporates the relevant portion of the
‘external’ world” [McDowell, 1986, p. 258]. The contents of the brain alone do
not determine the nature of our thoughts and experiences. There is, however,
some notion of supervenience maintained in that the mind supervenes on the
brain together with its causal links to the environment: if there are two
identical brains causally connected to the same features of their environment,
then the mental states manifest in those brains must also be identical. Various
arguments have been forwarded for this externalist position; most notable is
Putnam’s Twin Earth thought experiment (1975). We can imagine two physically
identical characters, Oscar and Toscar; Oscar lives here and Toscar lives on
Twin Earth, a superficially identical planet over the other side of the
universe. Oscar and Toscar are molecule for molecule alike, right down to the
structure of their brains; and, they both have beliefs about the clear stuff
that lies in puddles and rains from the sky. On Twin Earth, however, this
clear refreshing liquid is in fact XYZ and not H20. Toscar, then,
is thinking about different stuff to Oscar, and therefore, the thoughts of
Oscar and Toscar have different content, even though we have specified that
everything inside their heads is the same. The externalist stance can be
summarized thus: “Thought content ain’t in the head” (to hijack Putnam’s
phrase). Disjunctivists hold a parallel claim: since it is the state of the
world that determines the content of one’s perceptual state, hallucinations
have nothing perceptually in common with veridical perceptions even though all
could be the same inside one’s head. Therefore, one must accept such
externalist thinking if one is to take on the disjunctivist position. We have, then,
come to the end of our survey and we have found that perception is the focus of
rich philosophical debate. We have seen that it is the point at which the
philosophy of mind, epistemology and metaphysics meet. Therefore, one’s
account of the objects of perception will be characteristic, not only of one’s views on how we
acquire knowledge about the world, but also, of one’s philosophical perspective
on such wider issues as those concerning the constitution of the mind, the
constitution of the world, and crucially, how the former engages with the
latter.
6. References and Further Reading
Barnes, J., Early
Greek Philosophy, Penguin, London, 1987.
Dennett, D., Consciousness
Explained, Little, Brown and Company, New York, 1991.
Descartes,
R., Descartes: Philosophical
Letters, Trans.
/ ed. A. Kenny, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1970.
Levine,
J., "Materialism and Qualia: The Explanatory Gap" in Pacific Philosophical Quarterly, 64, pp. 354-361, 1983.
Locke, J., An Essay Concerning Human
Understanding, ed. P. H. Nidditch, 1975, Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1690.
Lowe, E. J., Locke on Human Understanding, Routledge,
London, 1995.
McDowell,
J., "Singular Thought and the Extent of Inner Space" in Mind, Knowledge and Reality (1998)
Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., pp. 228-259, 1986.
McDowell, J., Mind and World, Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1994.
Nagel, T., "What it is like to be a Bat" in Philosophical Review,
83, pp. 435-56, 1974.
Peacocke, C., Sense and Content, Oxford University Press,
Oxford, 1983.
Peacocke, C., A Study of Concepts, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1992.
Putnam, H., "The Meaning of Meaning" in Philosophical
Papers, Volume 2, Cambridge University Press, Cambridge, 1975.
Tye, M., Consciousness, Color, and
Content, A Bradford Book, MIT Press, Cambridge,
Mass., 2002.
Wittgenstein, L., Philosophical
Investigations, tr. G. E. M. Anscombe, Blackwell,
Oxford, 1953.
Suggestions for Further
Reading
For indirect realism see:
Ayer, A. J., The
Foundations of Empirical Knowledge, MacMillan, London, 1947.
Russell, B., The
Problems of Philosophy, Oxford University Press, Oxford, 1912.
Grice, H. P., "The
Causal Theory of Perception" in Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Supplementary
Volume, 35, pp. 121-52, 1961.
Jackson,
F., Perception: A Representative Theory, Cambridge University Press,
Cambridge, 1977.
For phenomenalism see:Mill, J.,
An Examination of Sir William Hamilton’s Philosophy, Longmans
Green, London, 1867.
Berkeley, G., A Treatise Concerning the Principles of Human
Knowledge, in Berkeley: Philosophical Works, ed. M. R. Ayers (1975)
Dent, London, 1710.
Chisholm, R., "The Problem of Empiricism" in Journal of
Philosophy, 45, pp. 512-517, 1948.
For intentionalism see:
Tye, M., Ten Problems of Consciousness, A
Bradford Book, MIT Press, Cambridge, Mass., 1995.
For disjunctivism see:
Hinton, J. M., Experiences,
Clarendon Press, Oxford, 1973.
McDowell, J., ‘Criteria, Defeasibility and Knowledge’ in Mind,
Knowledge and Reality (1998) Harvard University Press, Cambridge, Mass.,
1982.
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