|
Political realism is a theory of political
philosophy that attempts to explain, model, and prescribe political
relations. It takes as its assumption that power is (or ought to be)
the primary end of political action, whether in the domestic or
international arena. In the domestic arena, the theory asserts that
politicians do, or should, strive to maximize their power, whilst on
the international stage, nation states are seen as the primary agents
that maximize, or ought to maximize, their power. The theory is
therefore to be examined as either a prescription of what ought to be
the case, that is, nations and politicians ought to pursue power or
their own interests, or as a description of the ruling state of
affairs-that nations and politicians only pursue (and perhaps only can
pursue) power or self-interest.
Political
realism in essence reduces to the political-ethical principle that
might is right. The theory has a long history, being evident in
Thucydides' Pelopennesian War. It was expanded on by
Machiavelli in The Prince, and others such as Thomas Hobbes,
Spinoza, and Jean-Jacques Rousseau followed (the theory was given
great dramatical portrayed in Shakespeare's Richard III). In
the late nineteenth century it underwent a new incarnation in the form
of social darwinism, whose adherents explained social and hence
political growth in terms of a struggle in which only the fittest
(strongest) cultures or polities would survive. Political realism
assumes that interests are to be maintained through the exercise of
power, and that the world is characterised by competing power bases.
In international politics, most political theorists emphasise the
nation state as the relevant agent, whereas Marxists focus on classes.
Prior to the French Revolution in which nationalism as a political
doctrine truly entered the world's stage, political realism involved
the political jurisdictions of ruling dynasties, whilst in the
nineteenth century, nationalist sentiments focused realists'
attentions on the development of the nation-state, a policy that was
later extended to include imperialist ambitions on the part of the
major Western powers-Britain and France, and even Belgium, Germany and
the United States were influenced by imperialism. Nationalist
political realism later extended into geo-political theories, which
perceive the world to be divided into supra-national cultures, such as
East and West, North and South, Old World and New World, or focusing
on the pan-national continental aspirations of Africa, Asia, etc.
Whilst the social darwinist branch of political realism may claim that
some nations are born to rule over others (being 'fitter' for the
purpose, and echoing Aristotle's ruminations on slavery in Book 1 of
the The Politics), generally political realists focus on the
need or ethic of ensuring that the relevant agent (politician, nation,
culture) must ensure its own survival by securing its own needs and
interests before it looks to the needs of others.
To explore the various shades and implications of the
theory, its application to international affairs is examined.
Descriptive political realism commonly holds that the
international community is characterized by anarchy, since there is no
overriding world government that enforces a common code of rules.
Whilst this anarchy need not be chaotic, for various member states of
the international community may engage in treaties or in trading
patterns that generate an order of sorts, most theorists conclude that
law or morality does not apply beyond the nation's boundaries.
Arguably political realism supports Hobbes's view of the state of
nature, namely that the relations between self-seeking political
entities are necessarily a-moral. Hobbes asserts that without a
presiding government to legislate codes of conduct, no morality or
justice can exist: "Where there is no common Power, there is no
Law: where no Law, no Injustice¼ if
there be no Power erected, or not great enough for our security; every
man will and may lawfully rely on his own strength and art, for
caution against all other men." (Hobbes, Leviathan, Part
I, Ch.13 'Of Man', and Part II, Ch.17, 'Of Commonwealth') Accordingly,
without a supreme international power or tribunal, states view each
other with fear and hostility, and conflict, or the threat thereof, is
endemic to the system.
Another proposition is that a nation can only advance
its interests against the interests of other nations; this implies
that the international environment is inherently unstable. Whatever
order may exists breaks down when nations compete for the same
resources, for example, and war may follow. In such an environment,
the realists argue, a nation has only itself to depend on.
Either descriptive political realism is true or it is
false. If it is true, it does not follow, however, that morality ought
not to be applied to international affairs: what ought to be does not
always follow from what is. A strong form of descriptive political
realism maintains that nations are necessarily self-seeking, that they
can only form foreign policy in terms of what the nation can gain, and
cannot, by their very nature, cast aside their own interests. However,
if descriptive realism is held, it is as a closed theory, which means
that it can refute all counter-factual evidence on its own terms (for
example, evidence of a nation offering support to a neighbour as an
ostensible act of altruism, is refuted by pointing to some
self-serving motive the giving nation presumably has--it would
increase trade, it would gain an important ally, it would feel guilty
if it didn't, and so on), then any attempt to introduce morality into
international affairs would prove futile. Examining the soundness of
descriptive political realism depends on the possibility of knowing
political motives, which in turn means knowing the motives of the
various officers of the state and diplomats. The complexity of the
relationship between officers' actions, their motives, subterfuge, and
actual foreign policy makes this a difficult if not impossible task,
one for historians rather than philosophers. Logically, the closed
nature of descriptive realism implies that a contrary proposition that
nations serve no interests at all, or can only serve the interests of
others, could be just as valid. The logical validity of the three
resulting theories suggests that preferring one position to another is
an arbitrary decision-i.e., an assumption to be held, or not. This
negates the soundness of descriptive realism; it is not a true or
false description of international relations but is reduced to an
arbitrary assumption. Assumptions can be tested against the evidence,
but in themselves cannot be proved true or false. Finally, what is the
case need not be, nor need it ought to be.
That
the present international arena of states is characterized by the lack
of an overarching power is an acceptable description. Evidentially,
war has been common enough to give support to political realism-there
have been over 200 wars and conflicts since the signing of the Treaty
of Westphalia in 1648. The seemingly anarchic state of affairs has led
some thinkers to make comparisons with domestic anarchy, when a
government does not exist to rule or control a nation. Without a world
power, they may reason, war, conflict, tension, and insecurity have
been the regular state of affairs; they may then conclude that just as
a domestic government removes internal strife and punishes local
crime, so too ought a world government control the activities of
individual states-overseeing the legality of their affairs and
punishing those nations that break the laws, and thereby calming the
insecure atmosphere nations find themselves in. However, the 'domestic
analogy' makes the presumption that relations between individuals and
relations between states are the same. Christian Wolff, for example,
holds that "since states are regarded as individual free persons
living in a state of nature, nations must also be regarded in relation
to each other as individual free persons living in a state of nature."
(Jus Gentium Methodo Scientifica Pertractatum Trans. Joseph
Drake. Clarendon Press: Oxford, 1934, §2, p.9). Such an argument
involves the collectivization of individuals and/or the
personification of states: realism may describe nations as individuals
acting upon the world stage to further their own interests, but behind
the concept of 'France' or 'South Africa' exist millions of unique
individuals, who may or may not agree with the claims for improving
the national interest. Some (e.g., Gordon Graham, Ethics and
International Relations, 1997) claim that the relationships
between states and their civilians are much more different than those
between nation states, since individuals can hold beliefs and can
suffer whereas states cannot. If the domestic analogy does not hold,
arguably a different theory must be proposed to explain the state of
international affairs, which either means revising political realism
to take into account the more complex relationship between a
collective and individual entities, or moving to a alternative theory
of international relations.
Beyond the
descriptive propositions of political realism, prescriptive political
realism argues that whatever the actual state of international
affairs, nations should pursue their own interests. This theory
resolves into various shades depending on what the standard of the
national interest is claimed to be and the moral permissibility of
employing various means to desired ends. Several definitions may be
offered as to what ought to comprise the national interest: more often
than not the claims invoke the need to be economically and politically
self-sufficient, thereby reducing dependency on untrustworthy nations.
The argument in supporting the primacy of
self-sufficiency as forming the national interest has a long history:
Plato and Aristotle both argued in favour of economic self-sufficiency
on grounds of securing a nation's power-nations, they both reasoned,
should only import non-necessary commodities. The power of this
economic doctrine has been often been used to support political
realism: in the eighteenth century especially, political theorists and
mercantilists maintained that political power could only be sustained
and increased through reducing a nation's imports and increasing its
exports. The common denominator between the two positions is the
proposition that a nation can only grow rich at the expense of others.
If England's wealth increases, France's must concomitantly decrease.
This influential tier supporting political realism is, however,
unsound. Trade is not necessarily exclusively beneficial to one party:
it is often mutually beneficial. The economists Adam Smith and David
Ricardo explained the advantages to be gained by both parties from
free, unfettered trade. Nonetheless, the realist may admit this and
retort that despite the gains from trade, nations should not rely on
others for their sustenance, or that free trade ought not to be
supported since it often implies undesired cultural changes. In that
respect, the nation's interests are defined as lying over and above
any material benefits to be gained from international collaboration
and co-operation. The right to a separate cultural identity is a
separate
Political realists are often
characterised as a-moralists, that any means should be used to uphold
the national interest, but a poignant criticism is that the definition
of morality is being twisted to assume that acting in one's own or
one's nation's interests is immoral or amoral at best. This is an
unfair claim against serving one's national interest, just as claiming
that any self-serving action is necessarily immoral on the personal
level. The discussion invokes the ethics of impartiality; those who
believe in a universal code of ethics argue that a self-serving action
that cannot be universalized is immoral. However, universalism is not
the only standard of ethical actions. Partiality, it can be claimed,
should play a role in ethical decisions; partialists deem it absurd
that state officials should not give their own nation greater moral
weight over other nations, just as it would be absurd for parents to
give equal consideration to their children and others' children. But
if morality is employed in the sense of being altruistic, or at least
universalistic, then political realists would rightly admit that
attempting to be moral will be detrimental to the national interest or
for the world as a whole, and therefore morality ought to be ignored.
But, if morality accepts the validity of at least some self-serving
actions, then ipso facto political realism may be a moral
political doctrine.
|
