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Rāmānuja (ācārya), the eleventh century South Indian philosopher, is
the chief proponent of Vishishtādvaita, which is one of the three main forms of
the Orthodox Hindu philosophical school, Vedānta. As the prime philosopher of
the Vishishtādvaita tradition, Rāmānuja is one of the Indian philosophical
tradition’s most important and influential figures. He was the first Indian
philosopher to provide a systematic theistic interpretation of the philosophy of
the Vedas, and is famous for arguing for the epistemic and soteriological
significance of bhakti, or devotion to a personal God. Unlike many of his
contemporaries, Rāmānuja defended the reality of a plurality of individual
persons, qualities, values and objects while affirming the substantial unity of
all. On some accounts, Rāmānuja’s influence on popular Hindu practice is so vast
that his system forms the basis for popular Hindu philosophy. His two main
philosophical writings (the Shrī Bhāshya and Vedārthasangraha) are
amongst the best examples of rigorous and energetic argumentation in any
philosophical tradition, and they are masterpieces of Indian scholastic
philosophy.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Ramanuja's Life and Works
On traditional accounts, Ramanuja lived the unusually long life of 120 years
(twice the average lifespan at the time), from 1017 to 1137 AD, though recent
scholarship places his life between 1077 to 1157 AD, with a life of 80 years
(Carman p.27). He was born in the Southern, Tamil speaking region of India, in
the small township of Shri Perumbudur on the outskirts of modern day Chennai
(Madras) into a family that hailed from a subclass of Brahmins (the Hindu
priestly caste) known for their scholarship and learning in the Vedas. His
family was likely bilingual, fluent in both the local vernacular (Tamil) and the
language of scholarship (Sanskrit). From a young age he is reputed to have
displayed a prodigious intellect and liberal attitudes towards caste. At this
time he became friendly with a local, saintly Sudra (member of the servile
caste) by the name of Kancipurna, whose occupation it was to perform services
for the local temple idol of the Hindu deity Vishnu. Ramanuja admired
Kancipurna's piety and devotion to Vishnu and sought Kancipurna as his guru-much
to the horror of Kancipurna who regarded Ramanuja's humility before him as an
affront to caste propriety.
Shortly after being married in his teenage years, and after his father passed
away, Ramanuja and his family moved to the neighboring city of Kancipuram. There
Ramanuja found his first formal teacher, Yadavaprakasha, who was an accomplished
professor of the form of the Vedanta philosophy that was in vogue at the time-a
form of Vedanta that has strong affinities to Shankara's Absolute Idealistic
Monism (Advaita Vedanta) but was also close to the Difference-and-non-difference
view (Bhedabheda Vedanta). ("Vedanta" means the 'end of the Vedas' and refers to
the philosophy expressed in the end portion of the Vedas, also known as the
Upanishads, and encoded in the cryptic summary by Badharayana called the
Vedanta Sutra or Brahma Sutra. The perennial questions of Vedanta
are: what is the nature of Brahman, or the Ultimate, and what is the
relationship between the multiplicity of individuals to this Ultimate. Vedanta
comprises one of the six orthodox schools of Hindu philosophy.)
At first Yadavaprakasha was thrilled to receive a talented and intelligent
student of the likes of Ramanuja. But disagreements between the two, on the
proper interpretation of the Upanishads, soon broke out. Yadavaprakasha favored
an amoral, impersonal, non-theistic interpretation of the Upanishads. Ramanuja,
in contrast, favored a theistic interpretation of the Upanishads that placed a
premium on the aesthetic and moral excellences of Brahman. Yadavaprakasha
found Ramanuja's skill at offering alternative interpretations threatening both
to his authority and the popularity of his philosophy. He thus hatched a plan,
with some of his other students, to murder Ramanuja while on a pilgrimage.
Ramanuja however got word of the plan from his classmate and cousin (Govinda)
and escaped from the pilgrimage with his life. Ramanuja (surprisingly) did not
make public his knowledge of the failed assassination attempt and resumed
classes with Yadavaprakasha when he returned to Kancipuram. Yadavaprakasha for
his part did not reveal his complicity in the plot to take Ramanuja's life, and
feigned happiness at continuing to be his teacher. Not too long afterwards,
however, Yadavaprakasha ordered Ramanuja to leave his school, after a final
disagreement on the interpretation of scripture occurred.
Without a teacher, Ramanuja returned dejected to his childhood mentor,
Kancipurna, who assured him that a teacher would come his way. For the time
being, Kancipurna instructed Ramanuja to help him in his manual service to the
temple idol of Vishnu.
At the same time Yamuna, the spiritual head of the fledgling Tamil Vaishnava
(Vishnu worshiping) community, was near the end of his life and in search of a
successor. This community, known as the Shri Vaishnava Sampradaya, was formed
around the memory of the Four Thousand Tamil Verses (Nalayira Divya
Prabhandam) of twelve Tamil Vaishnava saints (Alvars), renowned for
their devotional poetry on Vishnu. While it had a modest popular base, it lacked
a formal and legitimizing articulation in the Sanskrit academic community.
Though a competent and accomplished philosopher in his own right who authored
the impressive Siddhi Trayam, Yamuna came into the fold too late in his
life to fully articulate the philosophy of Shri Vaishnavas to the pan-Indian
academic community. He thus held out the hope that Ramanuja would, amongst other
things, take up the task of articulating the philosophical ethos of the
tradition that had been entrusted to him, in the form of a formal, Sanskrit
commentary on the Brahma Sutra (the cryptic summary of the philosophical
purport of the Upanishads). Upon finding out that Ramanuja had been freed from
ties to Yadavaprakasha, and had returned to the company of Kancipurna (himself a
member of Yamuna's Shri Vaishnava community) Yamuna was overjoyed and sent word
to Ramanuja to come and take up the post as his successor. Yamuna however died
just before Ramanuja could reach him, and once again Ramanuja found himself
without the teacher he had been searching for.
After Ramanuja had gained his composure, he made his way over to the crowd
centered on Yamuna's new corpse. He noted that three fingers of Yamuna’s were
curled. Yamuna's senior disciples explained to Ramanuja that they likely
represented three wishes of Yamuna, one of which being that a commentary on the
Brahma Sutra should be written. When Ramanuja pledged to try to fulfill
those wishes, the fingers uncurled. The crowd took this as a sign that Ramanuja
was the heir apparent of Yamuna. Ramanuja was however vexed at the local temple
idol of Vishnu for not even allowing him a brief meeting with Yamuna, and would
not formally join the community for nearly a year.
When Ramanuja did decide to formally join the Shri Vaishnava fold, Yamuna's
senior disciple, Mahapurna, supervised his initiation. For a matter of six
months, Ramanuja had found himself the teacher he was looking for in the form of
Mahapurna. Under Mahapurna, Ramanuja learned the verses of the Tamil Vaishnava
saints. However, his learning under Mahapurna came to an abrupt end when
Ramanuja's wife picked a fight with Mahapurna’s wife, on the premise that the
latter was a member of a lower Brahminic subcaste. Upon hearing this, the hurt
Mahapurna and his wife departed from Ramanuja's company without notice.
Ramanuja, once again lost his teacher. But this was not the first time that
Ramanuja's wife had interfered with his spiritual development.
At an earlier point, Ramanuja had invited his childhood mentor, Kancipurna,
for a meal. Ramanuja had hoped to partake of Kancipurna's leavings as a
sacrament. However, Kancipurna arrived early in absence of Ramanuja. Ramanuja's
wife fed Kancipurna, sent him off, and ritually purified the dining area, by,
amongst other things, discarding Kancipurna's leftovers.
Having lost the benefits of a teacher twice over as a result of his wife's
caste-pretensions, Ramanuja was incensed. He thus sent his wife back to her
natal home, and promptly became a renounciate (sannyasin). He earned the
title "king of ascetics (yatiraja) from the temple deity of Vishnu
speaking through Kancipurna at this point.
Ramanuja's separation from his wife and his initiation into the order of
ascetics marks the beginning of his career as an independent and self-assured
philosopher. He traveled around India and participated in public debates with
exponents of rival philosophies. Many of the philosophers that Ramanuja defeated
became prominent disciples in his fold. Ramanuja standardized and reformed
temple worship in those Vaishnava temples that he gained control over (often
through winning debates with the custodians of the temple). To this day his
instructions are the norm of Shri Vaishnava temple and home worship in India and
abroad.
The Shri Vaishnava tradition is unanimous in holding that Ramanuja authored
nine, and only nine, works: all in Sanskrit. While Ramanuja is reported by the
writings of his disciples to have lectured in Tamil on the verses of the Tamil
Vaishnava saints, he left no writings on their work, and no explicit mention of
them in his writings. At first glance, this seems remarkable, given that the
Divya Prabhandam is regarded by the Shri Vaishnava tradition, as the
Tamil equivalent of the Vedas. However, Ramanuja's silence on the Alvars
in his Sanskrit writings may have been a result of his aim as philosopher to not
preach to the converted, but to articulate his philosophy to the pan-Indian
academic community.
Ramanuja's first work was likely the Vedarthasangraha ('Summary of the
Meaning of the Vedas'). It sets out Ramanuja’s philosophy, which is theistic (it
affirms a morally perfect, omniscient and omnipotent God) and realistic (it
affirms the existence and reality of a plurality of qualities, persons and
objects). This work is referred to several times in Ramanuja's magnum
opus, his commentary on the Brahma Sutra, the Shri Bhashya
(also known as his Brahma Sutra Bhashya). This is the work that
Ramanuja is best known by outside of the Shri Vaishnava tradition. In addition
to this large commentary on the Brahma Sutra, Ramanuja apparently wrote
two more shorter commentaries: Vedantapida, and Vedantasara. Aside
from the Vedarthasangraha and Shri Bhashya, Ramanuja's most
important philosophic work is a commentary on the Bhagavad Gita
(Bhagavad Gita Bhashya). In addition to these philosophic works,
Ramanuja is held by tradition to have written three prose hymns called
collectively the Gadya Traya, which include the Sharanagati Gadya,
Shriranga Gadya and the Vaikuntha Gadya). The Sharanagati
Gadya is a dialogue between Ramanuja and the Hindu deities Shri (Lakshmi)
and Narayana (Vishnu) (which jointly comprise God, or Brahman, for
Ramanuja) in which Ramanuja surrenders himself before God and petitions Vishnu,
through Lakshmi, for his Grace. Vishnu and Lakshmi, for their part, respond
favorably to Ramanuja's act of surrender. The Shriranga Gadya is a prayer
of surrender to the feet of Ranganatha. (This is Vishnu in his repose on the
many headed serpent Adiœesa -'ancient servant,' ‘ancient residue,’ or ‘primeval
matter'- on the milk ocean.) The Vaikuntha Gadya describes in great
detail the eternal realm of Vishnu, called Vaikuntha, on which one should
meditate in order to gain liberation. Finally Ramanuja is held to have authored
a manual of daily worship called the Nityagrantha.
The authenticity of all but the three large works attributed to Ramanuja -
Shri Bhashya, Vedarthasangraha and the Bhagavad Gita
Bhashya - have come into question in recent times. The argument against
the authenticity of these texts appears to be a minority position amongst
scholars. With respect to the two smaller commentaries on the Brahma
Sutra, it has been argued that they must be inauthentic, because it seems
unlikely that Ramanuja would himself have bothered to take the time to abridge
his larger commentary, the Shri Bhashya (cf. Buitenen p.32). With respect
to the short religious works attributed to Ramanuja, it has been argued that
they present doctrines that go beyond those that are found in his major
commentaries (cf. Lester p.279).
2. Ramanuja's Cosmology and Metaphysics
a. Background
Subsequent tradition has applied the label "Vishishtadvaita" to the
philosophy of Ramanuja. It is meant to contrast his philosophy from leading
competing views, such as Advaita (Non-Dualist), Bhedabheda
(Difference-and-non-difference) and Dvaita (Dualist) Vedanta. The term
"Vishishtadvaita" is often translated as 'Qualified Non-Dualism.' An
alternative, and more informative, translation is "Non-duality of the qualified
whole," or perhaps 'Non-duality with qualifications.” The label attempts to mark
out Ramanuja's effort to affirm the unity of the many, without giving up on the
reality of distinct persons, qualities, universals, or aesthetic and moral
values.
Where all versions of Vedanta intersect is in their effort to provide a
consistent and defendable interpretation of the Brahma Sutra, on
philosophical and hermeneutic grounds. Given the common textual bases, there are
certain doctrinal invariances amongst the various sub-schools of Vedanta.
In accordance with the Upanishads, the various schools of Vedanta hold that
there is an ultimate entity, called Brahman, which also is referred to by
scripture as "Atma" (“Self”). The Vedanta schools recognize, in
accordance with the Upanishads, that Brahman plays a key role in the
organization of the universe. Attainment of Brahman by an individual
constitutes its highest good: soteriological liberation or moksha.
The chief areas of disagreement amongst the various schools of Vedanta are on
the nature and ontological status of individual selves, objects of cognition and
Brahman, as well as the relevance and importance of ethics or duty
(dharma) to the good life.
Ramanuja's foils in the articulation of his philosophy are two forms of
Vedanta that were not clearly distinguished during his day: these are the
Bhedabheda view, and the Advaita philosophy. Both these views take a similar
stance on the relationship of an individual's subjectivity and Brahman:
on both accounts, the conscious principle of the individual is of a piece with
Brahman. In the case of Advaita Vedanta, the consciousness of an
individual is regarded as numerically identical with the consciousness of
Brahman. On this view, the psychological ego or sense of individuality is
something distinct from consciousness: it is its object. The Bhedabheda view
similarly asserts the numerical identity of an individual's consciousness and
Brahman, but it emphasizes that this identity is counteracted by a
separating off, or differentiating effort, on the part of Brahman to
compartmentalize itself and mysteriously constitute the world of plurality and
difference. On this view, the individual ego is constituted by Brahman.
According to the versions of Bhedabheda and Advaita that Ramanuja was acquainted
with, mere knowledge of one's identity with Brahman is sufficient to
bring about liberation; works, such as ritual and moral obligations, can at best
play a preparatory role in bringing an individual to the state of being desirous
for liberation, but they have no intrinsic value. Corollaries of these views are
the position that consciousness, and not plurality, is metaphysically
fundamental; that consciousness does not require objects for its existence; that
belief in plurality consists in the uncritical acceptance of ordinary
experience; and that dialectical reasoning can yield substantive knowledge with
practical import. On many fronts (on the reality of universals, particulars, and
moral values) both the Bhedabheda Advaita schools are classic forms of
anti-realism.
Students of Ramanuja's thought may wish to know whom Ramanuja is arguing
against. In all likely hood, it is his former teacher, Yadavaprakasha. However,
Ramanuja does not attribute the Advaita or Bhedabheda views to any particular
philosopher. Rather, these views are voiced by the opponent, or the ubiquitous
purvapaksin, everywhere in Indian philosophy, expressing the views to be
criticized.
Ramanuja's arguments that he presents against his opponent are of roughly
three varieties. Some are negative, and focus on philosophical problems of the
opponent's view. Some are positive, and concern arguing for theses that Ramanuja
wishes to defend. And some arguments are hermeneutic. This last category of
arguments combines criticism and positive philosophical argument, but it centers
on the proper interpretation of the Vedas.
b. Negative Philosophical Criticisms of Bhedabheda and Advaita Vedanta
i. Logical Criticism
Ramanuja criticizes many of the arguments of the Bhedabheda and Advaita views
on logical grounds. These schools employed dialectical arguments that conclude
on the basis of logical puzzles that arise in accounting for distinctions and
difference in perception that difference (which includes the idea of a distinct
quality) is an unintelligible notion. From such considerations, these
philosophers would typically conclude that only undifferentiated consciousness
is the real (Brahman). Ramanuja at many points in the Shri Bhashya
and the Vedarthasangraha attempts to argue against such views by an
argument ad absurdum. Particularly, Ramanuja argues that the arguments
presented by the Bhedabheda and Advaita Vedantins lead to intolerable
contradictions and further conclusions that go against common sense. At one
point he suggests that those who would make such arguments are "no better than a
man who would claim that his own mother never had any children" (Shri
Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta" p.44).
ii. Argument from Epistemology
Ramanuja argues that the epistemic considerations that his opponents adduce
for their positions undercut their own views. The philosophers that Ramanuja
takes aim at argue that all means of cognition involve error. Ramanuja argues
that if this is so, it follows that we could never know that all cognition
involves error, for such putative knowledge would itself involve an erroneous
cognition, and hence not qualify as genuine knowledge. If Ramanuja's opponents
view is correct, then it follows that some cognitions are not erroneous. But
this is exactly what the disputed conclusion rules out (Shri Bhashya,
I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta" pp.74-78).
c. Substantive Theses
i. Intentionality of Consciousness
While the previous two strategies that Ramanuja employs in his criticism of
the Bhedabheda and Advaita views are largely negative, and involve criticizing
these views on formal grounds, Ramanuja also defends philosophical theses that
these two schools rule out. The most important of these theses is the view that
consciousness is always consciousness of some object distinguished by a
characteristic (cf. Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta" p.53
and "Great Purvapaksa" p.32). This is the doctrine known as
"dharmabhutajnana" in the Vishishtadvaita tradition (Shrinivasadisa
VII.2). It implies the view that all epistemic states, be it consciousness or
perception, are intentional or object oriented. If it is the case that
even consciousness requires an object for its existence, it follows that there
can be no such thing as pure consciousness apart from difference (such as
qualities, properties and objects of consciousness). Thus, on this account, if
consciousness exists, it follows that difference and plurality does as well.
With this one thesis, and against the backdrop of Vedantic idealism, Ramanuja is
able to generate one limb of his organismic cosmology.
ii. Consciousness is a Property of Something
Another important substantive philosophical thesis that Ramanuja defends is
that consciousness is itself a property. To modern readers, this may seem to be
a trivial point. However, it is central to the project of Ramanuja's opponents
that Brahman is the only reality, and it is a reality devoid of
distinctions or qualities. Ramanuja's opponents are happy to affirm that certain
things can be said of Brahman, for instance, that it is (as affirmed in
the Taittitriya Upanishad II.i.1.) truth (satyam) knowledge
(jnanam) and infinite (anantam). However, they take the stand that
these are not properties of Brahman, but the very being of Brahman
(Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great Purvapaksa" p.29). Ramanuja, in
contrast, defends the view that such attributions bring attention to the reality
of Brahman's qualities (cf. Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great
Purvapaksa" p.28).
[##SSHEADER]2c.iii Individuals are Real[/SSHEADER##]
A third and important substantive thesis that Ramanuja defends is the reality
of the individual. According to Advaita Vedanta (and the Bhedabheda view to a
lesser extent), the individual person, in contradistinction to other persons, is
an illusion (maya) that comes about by nescience (avidya).
Ramanuja argues that the very idea that something can be ignorant presumes that
there is an individual capable of being ignorant. For all Vedantins affirm that
Brahman is of the nature of consciousness and knowledge. Hence, to say
that Brahman is ignorant is absurd. If anything is subject to ignorance,
it must be an individual other than Brahman. However, if this is so, then
ignorance cannot be brought into explain the existence of individuals, for it
presumes the existence of an individual capable of being ignorant. Ramanuja's
positive view is thus that there are, indeed, distinct individuals, many who are
under the spell of ignorance. However, their individuality is ontologically and
logically prior to their ignorance (Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great
Siddhanta" p.103)
d. Hermeneutic Criticism
All Vedanta philosophies must turn to the Vedas, and particularly the
Upanishads, for scriptural grounding. Hence, in criticizing his fellow
Vedantins, Ramanuja makes use of arguments that concern the proper
interpretation of scripture.
i. Vedas as Doctrinally Unified Corpus
According to Ramanuja, his opponents have failed to arrive at an
interpretation of the Vedas based on all Vedic texts. Rather, they emphasize
some passages that support a monistic interpretation, and ignore those passages
that either presume or emphasize plurality. Ramanuja notes that his opponents
hold to the view that those Vedic texts that come later in the corpus are to be
emphasized (the fact that they come later is presumed, on this account, to show
that they contain the more advanced and esoteric teachings) (Shri
Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great Purvapaksa" p.27). These, more than other
portions of the Vedas, emphasize the oneness of reality with Brahman.
Ramanuja argues that even these portions of the Vedas presume and affirm
plurality. Even if it were not the case that these portions of the Vedas
mentioned plurality, we would have to take all the Vedas on par for Ramanuja.
According to Ramanuja, one cannot attempt to give interpretations of isolated
portions of the Vedas. Rather, one must take the Vedas as one unified corpus,
aiming at the expression of a single doctrine (cf. Shri Bhashya pp.92-3,
I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta"). Hence, any tenable interpretation of the
philosophy of the Vedas must not only affirm the reality of plurality, but also
the importance of ritual and moral obligations (dharma), for these are spoken
about at length in the earlier portions of the Vedas.
ii. "Tat tvam asi" and Co-ordinate Predication
Even if the Vedic corpus as a whole is taken to present a single doctrine,
Ramanuja is still left with the task of accounting for how the seemingly
monistic portions of the Upanishads are consistent with the reality of a
plurality of distinct individuals. To overcome this hermeneutic hurdle, Ramanuja
introduces the doctrine of samanadhikaranya, sometimes translated as
"co-ordinate predication" or “the principle of grammatical coordination” but
literally meaning 'several things in a common substrate.' The etymology of the
word suggests an ontological doctrine. However, Ramanuja means to employ it as a
semantic doctrine. According to Ramanuja, "The experts on such matters define it
thus: `The signification of an identical entity by several terms [shabda]
which are applied to that entity on different grounds is co-ordinate
predication" (Vedarthasangraha §24).
In both the Shri Bhashya and the Vedarthasangraha, Ramanuja
draws a distinction between the object denoted by a term, and the quality
that it can be identified in connection with. The possibility of using various
terms with the same denotation but with different qualitative content is what
Ramanuja calls "co-ordinate predication."
The doctrine that Ramanuja advances under the heading of co-ordinate
predication strikingly anticipates the Fregean distinction between sense and
reference. In the writings of Ramanuja, the doctrine is used to interpret
monistic passages of the Vedas in a manner that affirms both the unity of the
thing designated, via the coreferentiality of the various terms, while affirming
that the various terms bring to the sentence an emphasis on distinct properties
of the unitary thing so identified. With respect to the famous formula "that
thou art" (tat tvam asi) from the Chandyogai Upanishad
(which Advaitins quote as support for the absolute identity of the individual's
self with Brahman), Ramanuja understands the indexicals "that" and “thou”
as signifying an underlying unity, while containing distinct qualitative
content. Hence, "that" in this context, brings to fore the quality of the
underlying substantial unity of all individuals in Brahman, while "thou"
emphasize that we, as individuals, are qualities or distinctions in this
underlying unity (Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta"
pp.129-39).
iii. Brahman and Atman
Even if the doctrine of co-ordinate predication is granted, there is yet
another hermeneutic hurdle for Ramanuja to contend with: this is the Upanishadic
equation of Brahman (the Ultimate) with Atma (or Self). If the
Ultimate and the Self are one, then it would seem that there is no room for the
existence of a plurality of individual persons. The problem might be solved by
denying that "Atma" means self, but this would be to stipulate a meaning
for the word "Atma" that it does not have in Sanskrit or Vedic.
Ramanuja's solution to this problem is the cosmological doctrine of
sharira and shariri (body and soul), or shesha and
sheshin (dependant and dependant upon). According to Ramanuja,
Brahman is the Self of all. However, this is not because our individual
personhood is identical with the personhood of Brahman, but because we,
along with all individuals, constitute modes or qualities of the body of
Brahman. Thus, Brahman stands to all others as the soul or mind
stands to its body. The metaphysical model that Ramanuja thus argues for is at
once cosmological in nature, and organic. All individuals are Brahman by
virtue of constituting its body, but all individuals retain an identity in
contradistinction to other parts of Brahman, particularly the soul of
Brahman.
In accordance with much of the monism of Upanishadic passages, Ramanuja
maintains that there is a way in which the individual self (jiva, or
jivatma) is identical with the Ultimate Self (Atma or
Paramatma). This is in our natures. According to Ramanuja, each
jiva shares with Brahman an essential nature of being a knower.
However, due to beginningless past actions (karma) our true nature (as being
knowers and dependants upon Brahman) are obscured from us. Moreover, our
sharing this nature in no way implies that we have the same relationship to
other things (Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta" pp.99-102).
In other words, our likeness in one respect with Brahman does not imply
that we ourselves are either omnipotent, omniscient or all good.
3. Ramanuja's Theism
In contrast to preceding commentators on the Brahma Sutra, Ramanuja's
version of Vedanta is explicitly theistic. Brahman as Atman (the
Highest Self of all) is the union of two deities: Vishnu, or Narayana, and His
Consort Shri, or Lakshmi. (In Hinduism, Vishnu is the God who upholds and
preserves all things, while Lakshmi is the Goddess of prosperity.) The unity of
both the father (Vishnu) and mother (Lakshmi) element in Brahman is
essential to Ramanuja. It is a consequence of the view that Brahman is
ubhayalingam, or having both sexes: this accounts for Brahman's
creative potency. According to Ramanuja, Brahman (considered as the
Atman) is antagonistic to all evil lacks all faults (papam,
heya, mala or dosha), and is comprised of innumerable
auspicious qualities (kalyanaguna): these auspicious qualities are both
moral and aesthetic (Vedarthasangraha §§ 2, 6, 9, 19, 92, 112, 147, 161,
163, 198, 234, Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. pp.5, 80, 89, 92, 94, 125, 132, 133,
136, 144, I.i.2. p. 157, I.i.4. p.201, Bhagavad Gita Bhashya I.
Intro, IX.34, to name just a few references-Ramanuja never tires or speaking of
God's excellences.).
The highest Self (Atma) stands to all other persons as their parent,
on Ramanuja's account. However, Ramanuja, like many Vedantins, does not
subscribe to the Medieval Christian doctrine of creation ex nihilo:
Brahman does not create individual persons, or basic, non-relational
qualities for that matter, for these are eternal features of its Body.
Brahman does engage in a form of creation, which consists in granting
individual persons the fruits of their desires (whatever they are). The result
of this dispensation is the organization of the elements comprising
Brahman's body into the cosmos (Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Great
Siddhanta" p.124)
4. Ramanuja's Soteriology
On Ramanuja's account, our greatest good consists of being ever aware of our
true nature (as modes of Brahman) and of being aware of the nature of
Brahman. When all impediments to this awareness are removed, the
individual attains moksha (liberation). Knowledge of Brahman
consists in liberation, for Ramanuja, mainly because of the character of
Brahman. He writes:
Entities other than Brahman can be objects of such
cognitions of the nature of joy only to a finite extent and for limited
duration. But Brahman is such that cognizing of him is an infinite and
abiding joy. It is for this reason that the shruti [scripture] says,
`Brahman is bliss' (Taittitriya Upanishad II.6.) Since the form
of cognition as joy is determined by its object, Brahman itself is joy.
(Vedarthasangraha §241)
Ramanuja is explicit in holding that theoretical knowledge of
Brahman's nature will not suffice to procure liberation (Shri
Bhashya, I.i.1. "Small Siddhanta" pp.13-14). Our embodied state
places psychological constraints upon us that must be nullified. The remedy to
be employed, for Ramanuja, is what he calls, after the Bhagavad Gita,
bhakti yoga, or the discipline of devotion or worship. This type of yoga
is comprised of two essential elements: (a) an attendance to one's duties with a
deontological sense that they are the things that ought to be done for their own
sake, and not for their consequences (also known as karma yoga), and (b)
the constant worship of Brahman, particularly in the form of offering all
of the fruits of one's labor to Brahman. These features of bhakti
yoga serve two complimentary purposes. First, they counteract past undesirable
actions (karmas) whose residual effects impede a full appreciation of reality.
Secondly, they inculcate subservience before Brahman. This is valuable
for Ramanuja, for service to God, on his account, is constitutive of an unbroken
appreciation of Brahman's nature.
5. Ramanuja's Epistemology
Epistemic concerns figure centrally in Ramanuja's arguments, and his
diagnosis of the state of bondage (samsara), or non-liberation. Like many
Indian philosophers, Ramanuja holds that liberation comes about by the cessation
of nescience (Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Small Siddhanta" p.12).
However, unlike many of his contemporaries, Ramanuja does not believe that
reason is an independent means of knowledge, capable of dispelling ignorance.
a. Perception
Ramanuja holds a position that is similar to naïve empiricism. According to
naïve empiricism, the only knowledge that one can have is knowledge that one has
gained by one's own experience. Ramanuja’s view is like naïve empiricism, in so
far as his intentional account of the nature of all epistemic states
(dharmabhutajnana) leads him to the view that all genuine or first-rate
knowledge (jnana) consists in a perceptual relationship between a knower
and an object of knowledge-knowledge de re-and not between a believer and
a sentence or proposition-knowledge de dicto. Unlike some proponents of
naïve empiricism, Ramanuja does not think that it suffices to intermittently
have an acquaintance with objects of knowledge. Knowledge (jnana) only
occurs when there is direct perception of an object. Unlike proper empiricists,
Ramanuja does not restrict knowledge to that which can be gathered from the
senses. The individual self (jiva) on Ramanuja's account is also capable
of having a direct vision of transcendent entities, like Brahman. Yet,
the character of the epistemic state in which one is acquainted with
Brahman is a type of perception for Ramanuja.
b. Scripture
Because of Ramanuja's perceptual conception of knowledge, he does not regard
acquaintance with scripture (shruti) as anything more than knowledge of
the sentence meaning of scripture (cf. Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Small
Siddhanta" pp.13-14). Yet, like many of his fellow Vedantins, Ramanuja
regards scripture (shruti) as a pramana, or a means of
knowledge. shruti, or the revealed literature, consists of a very
specific corpus of texts: the Vedas. (If Ramanuja believed that the Divya
Prabhandam authored by the Tamil Vaishnava saints is the Tamil equivalent of
the Vedas, then he would have held these to also be within the purview of
shruti). Scripture is an important source of knowledge, for Ramanuja, for
it is the only place that we can learn of our moral obligations (dharma) and
what our liberation consists in (moksha). On the basis of the validity of
scripture, several texts gain a derivative authority. These texts are
smriti (remembered) texts, which include the law books
(dharmashastras) of eminent figures, and seemingly sacred texts like the
Bhagavad Gita. On the question of the justification of taking scripture
seriously, Ramanuja holds that none can be given. Scripture is self-justifying.
Scripture, for its part, can lead people to have cognitions of independent
entities, such as Brahman, after providing them directions to perceive
Brahman: without it one would never know what to look for. However,
sensuous perception cannot vouch for the veracity of its contents, nor can
reason independently provide a rational proof of its veracity. Having followed
scripture's dictates, one will eventually have proof of its validity (Shri
Bhashya I.i.4. p.175) (direct perceptual contact with objects such as
Brahman). However, prior to embarking on the journey outlined in
scripture, it must be taken on faith alone. Thus, on the position of the
validity of scripture, Ramanuja is a fideist (see Shri Bhashya I.i.3. for
Ramanuja's classic criticism of natural theology pp.162-74). (Some critics are
apt to think that Ramanuja is correct on the ungroundability of the validity of
scripture on either sensuous perception or reason, but that this impossibility
makes Ramanuja's whole philosophy implausible.)
While according scripture great weight, Ramanuja shows his preference for
common sense by tempering his interpretations of scripture in light of ordinary,
sensuous experience. Contrary to the dialectically minded philosophers of his
day, Ramanuja presumes in his defense of Vishishtadvaita in the Shri
Bhashya (I.i.1.) that scriptural interpretation must accord with ordinary
experience.
c. Bhakti
Ramanuja's unique contribution to Indian epistemology is the view that
bhakti, or devotion, is itself an epistemic state. We have noted that,
for Ramanuja, knowledge of Brahman consists in directly perceiving it.
When bhakti takes firm root in an individual, it turns into
parabhakti, which is the highest order of bhakti. In all
cases, however, bhakti is a direct awareness of Brahman's nature,
and thus constitutes a type of knowledge (jnana) (Vedarthasangraha
§238). The perceptual character of bhakti is sometimes obscured by
Ramanuja's synonyms for this state. He sometimes calls it meditation or worship
(upasana). However, he also insists that it is a kind of seeing, which
has the character of direct perception (pratyakshata or
sakshatkara) (cf. Shri Bhashya, I.i.1. "Small Purvapaksha"
pp.15-7).
d. Error
Ramanuja's object oriented account of knowledge has the problem of accounting
for error. If knowledge corresponds to objects, what do false beliefs correspond
to: mental objects? His response anticipates Bertrand Russell's account of error
in On Denoting, which does away with ersatz objects in the explanation of
error. According to Ramanuja, erroneous experiences, like dream states, are
real, and they can be genuine objects of knowledge (as in the statement 'I
dreamt last night' or 'I am dreaming’). However, the objects that the experience
claims to be about are absent in false cognitions. This absence of the proper
objects of knowledge explains the erroneousness of beliefs in them (Shri
Bhashya I.i.1. "Great Siddhanta" p.78). Thus, on Ramanuja's account,
mistaking mother of pearl for a piece of silver does not consist in mistakenly
seeing something silver in color, but in the mistaken cognition that the object
perceived is a piece of silver.
6. Ramanuja's Ethics
Ramanuja's ethics divides into his views on substantive matters, and
metaethical issues.
a. Substantive Ethics
Ramanuja's substantive ethics in turn has two sources. Like other orthodox
Hindu thinkers, Ramanuja holds that the primary source of moral knowledge is the
Vedas. This is particularly true of the earlier portion of the Vedas, which sets
forth prescribed and optional works (karmas) that constitute dharma. The
importance of dharma, derived from the Vedas, is stressed in all three of
Ramanuja's major works. Like other orthodox Hindu thinkers, Ramanuja also holds
that the venerable tradition, or smriti literature, supplements the Vedic
texts' account of dharma. The most important of the smriti texts, for
Ramanuja, is the Bhagavad Gita.
The Gita emphasizes the importance of adopting a deontological
attitude (concern for duty for duty's sake and not for its consequences) in
order to perfect the execution of prescribed duties, particular to one's place
in society. But the Gita also emphasizes the importance of certain
virtues. The Gita praises being a friend (mitra) and showing
compassion (karuna) to all creatures (Bhagavad Gita XII.13), and
enumerates ahimsa, or non-injury, as one of the virtues essential to
having jnana, or gnosis (Bhagavad Gita XIII.7-11).
On what is to be done when the requirements of virtues conflict with
prescribed duties, Ramanuja is uncompromising. For Ramanuja, dharma, as set
forth in the Vedas, is inviolable. This puts Ramanuja in the awkward position of
having to defend the propriety of animal sacrifices, sanctioned and prescribed
in the earlier portion of the Vedas. Shri Vaishnava Brahmins, as a rule, are
vegetarians. Ramanuja was, in all likelihood, himself a vegetarian. However, his
general inclination to positively endorse the Bhagavad Gita's disavowal
of animal cruelty did not stop him from affirming the propriety of animal
sacrifices. In this respect, Ramanuja agrees with his Advaitin predecessor,
Shankara, who held that while violence in general is evil, ritual slaughter is
not any ordinary act of violence: because it is sanctioned by the Vedas, it
cannot be evil (Shankara, Brahma Sutra Bhashya, III.i.25).
Ramanuja however goes further and argues that ritual slaughter is not only not
evil; it is also not really a form of violence. Rather, it is a healing act like
a physician's procedure, which causes temporary pain but is ultimately to the
benefit of the patient. The sacrificed animal, on Ramanuja's account, is more
than compensated in the next life for being ritually slaughtered (Shri
Bhashya, III.i.25. pp.599-600).
b. Foundations of Ethics
Ramanuja's metaethical comments concern the ground and validity of morality.
Ramanuja seems to have always presumed that morality is intrinsically valuable.
The intrinsic merit of God Himself, on Ramanuja's account, is tied to His moral
excellences. Given that God has nothing to gain by being moral, the value of
morality, at least in God's case, cannot be instrumental. However, for all other
creatures, morality, or dharma, has an instrumental value: it helps counteract
consequences of past karmas. Importantly, it is also the easy way to propitiate
God. Ramanuja notes that, in theory, it is possible to achieve liberation
through mental efforts alone. However, this is only a theoretical possibility,
and is in reality impossible for creatures like us. jnana yoga, or mental
disciplines geared towards achieving liberation by solely meditating upon the
Self (and not availing oneself of ancillary aids, like attendance to one's
duties) is difficult and likely to lead to error. Karma yoga, or attendance to
one's duties, on the other hand, is easy for our duties are those obligations
suited to our capacities and nature (Ramanuja Gita Bhashya,
XVIII.47 p.583). Morality, on Ramanuja's account, has both intrinsic and
instrumental value. This account of the instrumental value of our obligations
also contains, within it, the seeds of an account of the validity of our
obligations: our obligations are those appropriate acts that are suited to us to
perform. Thus, morality is not simply a law imposed from outside, on Ramanuja's
account, but the best mode of action, given our personal natures. However,
because of our context, we are unable to determine what is best for us,
independently of scripture. Hence, our reliance on scripture to tell us our
duties leads to the appearance that dharma is a law imposed on us from outside.
Dharma (duty or morality) is of the utmost importance for Ramanuja. It thus
might seem ironic that the Bhagavad Gita itself advises us to give up our
dharmas. At the very end of the work, after the importance and benefits of
living the virtuous life are extolled, Krishna (the incarnation of Vishnu
delivering a sermon in the Bhagavad Gita) advises us to 'give up all
dharmas' and seek refuge in Him alone (Bhagavad Gita XVIII.66). Ramanuja
offers two interpretations of this verse: (1) it can be taken as implying that
we are to abandon the sense of agency that is incompatible with our cosmological
dependence upon God, or (2), it can be taken as implying that we ought to give
up recourse to expiatory rituals (sometime called "dharmas") to nullify
the effects of past actions. Neither interpretation allows for abandoning our
prescribed obligations (Ramanuja, Bhagavad Gita Bhashya XVIII.66,
p.599). Ramanuja's views contrast sharply with the views of the Advaita Vedantin
Shankara, who argues that morality (dharma) for the seeker of liberation
(moksha) is an evil, for it ensnares a person in things of the world
(Shankara, Bhagavad Gita Bhashya, IV:21 pp.202-203).
7. Interpreting Ramanuja: the Northern and Southern Schools and the Authenticity of the Gadyas
Within two centuries after Ramanuja, the Shri Vaishnava tradition split into
two separate sub-traditions. Both schools claim to have the authority of
Ramanuja in support of their views. These traditions are the Northern or
Vadakalai school, and the Southern or Tenkalai school. The respective founding
figures of these schools are Vedanta Deshika and Manavalamamuni, two of many
eminent Shri Vaishnava scholars to follow Ramanuja. One manner in which the
Northern and Southern schools differ is with respect to the importance that the
Vedas are to play in the devotees life: the Northern school holds that Vedic
observances are essential to proper Shri Vaishnava practices, while the Southern
school emphasises the importance of emulating the examples of the twelve Alvars.
Most importantly, the two schools differ on the relationship between divine
grace and individual effort. Both schools agree that Grace is necessary for
liberation, but they disagree as to the conditions under which Grace is
dispensed. According to the Northern school, Grace is conditional on the effort
of the individual. Liberation, on this view, is a cooperative effort between God
and the aspirant. According to the Southern school, Grace is dispensed freely.
Liberation, on this view, is the sole responsibility of God. (On some accounts,
the two schools can also be defined with respect to eighteen points of
difference. See Govindacarya for one of the few but regrettably unbalanced
accounts of this controversy).
Both schools agree that the intercession of Grace is tied to the devotee
performing the spiritual act of sharanagati or prapatti-surrender
before God. The act of prapatti, or the formal surrender to God, with the
understanding that one has no other refuge, is central to Shri Vaishnava cultic
life. However, Northern and Southern schools differ with respect to what is to
follow. For the Southern school, a one-time act of prapatti is
sufficient. Subsequent lapses in devotion or attitude do not alter God's
disposition to save the individual. However, for the Northern school, lapses on
the part of the devotee require a fresh commitment on the part of the individual
to surrender before God, in addition to constant effort on the part of the
individual to attend to their moral duties in the spirit of bhakti yoga.
The controversy between the two schools could be circumvented if it could be
shown that the very doctrine of sharanagati or prapatti is foreign
to the thought of Ramanuja. This is what some recent scholars have attempted to
show. Robert C. Lester, following the arguments of the Vadakalai Shri Vaishnava
scholar, Agnihothram Ramanuja Thatachariar of Kumbakonam, argues that the
doctrine of sharanagati or prapatti, at the heart of latter day
Shri Vaishnava controversy, is only found in the Sharanagati Gadya and
the Shriranga Gadya, and are absent from Ramanuja's main philosophic
works. On this basis, Lester argues that the Gadyas (specifically the
Sharanagati Gadya and Shriranga Gadya) and the doctrine of
sharanagati or prapatti are spurious.
According to this argument, the Gadyas present, for the first time,
the view that surrendering to God constitutes a unique means of gaining
liberation. And, moreover, Lester argues that this idea is foreign to the
arguments that Ramanuja presents in the Shri Bhashya, the
Vedarthasangraha and the Gita Bhashya. These works are
unanimous in stressing the role of bhakti as both the beginning and end
of liberation.
In defence of the authenticity of the Gadyas, one might argue that the
very idea of bhakti contains with in it the notion of
sharanagati-that to love or be devoted to God is to surrender oneself to
God. However, Lester argues that the notion of bhakti promulgated in the
three main works of Ramanuja is distinct from the notion of prapatti or
sharanagati in the Gadyas. First, the Sharanagati Gadya
makes it clear that the devotee is seeking God, not out of love, but out of
desperation, with the request that God grant the devotee bhakti, and the
favour of being eternally in His service. Sharanagati or prapatti
thus constitutes an act that is logically distinct from what is involved in
bhakti, which is the steady remembrance of God, and attendance to one's
duties in a spirit of sacrifice. Secondly, the Gadyas have suggested to
many that the act of surrendering to God is sufficient to procure
liberation. The critic persuaded by Lester's view holds that such a view is
nowhere to be found in Ramanuja's three main works.
In response to Lester's arguments, one might take a holistic stance: the
import of the Gadyas and Ramanuja's larger works must be assessed
together. This is the stand that has been traditionally adopted by Shri
Vaishnavas of both schools. If this approach is adopted, one is likely to read
Ramanuja's account of bhakti as implying an implicit understanding of our
dependence and helplessness before God (a view shared by both the Northern and
Southern schools), and one may also regard the Gadyas as not putting
forth the radical notion that the act of surrender is sufficient for liberation
(this, however, is what the Southern school appears to be committed to). With
respect to Ramanuja's main works, there is clear textual evidence that he
regarded individuals as impotent, apart from God (cf. Shri Bhashya,
II.i.34. pp.478-9). As noted, on Ramanuja's account, God’s role as creator is to
grant us the fruits of our desires. Without God actually acting on our behalf to
simulate a world in which it seems as if we are doers, we would be
nothing but isolated persons with many desires, and largely incorrect beliefs,
cut off from our peers, with no way to work through our predilections. God's
creative role, on this account, serves the purpose of bridging the gap between
ourselves and the rest of reality. On this picture of the human condition, it is
quite clear that we as individuals are literally helpless, but for the creative
dispensation of God.
Another response to Lester's argument is to invoke Ramanuja’s own doctrine of
co-ordinate predication, while defending the view that Ramanuja in his main
works holds that prapatti is sufficient for liberation. Ramanuja in the
Vedarthasangraha writes:
The heart of the whole shastra [body of authoritative
texts] is this: The individual selves are essentially of the nature of pure
knowledge, devoid of restriction and limitation. They get covered up by
nescience in the shape of karma. The consequence is that the scope and breadth
of their knowledge is curtailed in accordance with their karma. They get
embodied in the multifarious varieties of bodies from [the deity] Brahma down
to, the lowest species. Their knowledge is limited in accordance with their
specific embodiment. They are deluded into identification with their bodies.
In accordance with them they become subject to joys and sorrows, which, in
essence constitute what is termed "the river of transmigratory existence"
[samsara]. For these individual selves, so lost in samsara,
there is no way of emancipation, other than surrender to the supreme
Lord [bhagavatprapattimanthrena]. For the purpose of
inculcating that sole way of emancipation, the first truth to be taught by the
shastra is that the individual souls are not intrinsically divided into
several kinds, like gods, men, etc., and that they are fundamentally alike and
are equal in having knowledge as their essential nature. The essential nature
of the individual self is such that it is wholly subservient and instrumental
to God and therefore God is its inner self. The nature of the supreme Being is
unique, on, account of his absolute perfection and absolute antithesis to
everything that is evil. God is the ocean of countless, infinitely excellent
attributes. The shastras further assert that all sentient and non
sentient entities are sustained and operated by the supreme Being. Therefore,
the Supreme is the ultimate self of all. They teach meditation along with
its accessory conditions as the means for attaining him.
(Vedarthasangraha §99, my italics)
It is noteworthy that while Ramanuja avails himself of the notion that
surrendering to God is the only way to emancipation, he is also clear to
emphasise that disciplines such as "meditation" and accessory conditions
are essential to attaining liberation. One might argue, thus, that Ramanuja did
hold that prapatti or sharanagati are the "only" way to
liberation, but this way is not substantially distinct from the way of
bhakti yoga. Rather, "bhakti" and “prapatti” are distinct
qualities that qualify one path. On this interpretation, Ramanuja is assuming
that the reader will appreciate the phenomenon of co-ordinate predication, which
is the putative semantic phenomenon that Ramanuja appeals to elsewhere to argue
that all individuals are Brahman, while being essentially distinct modes
or attributes of Brahman, and not identical to the totality of
Brahman. In this way, prapatti and bhakti both denote the
same path, but they emphasize different points along the path.
8. Conclusion: Ramanuja's Place in the History of Indian Philosophy
Ramanuja stands in the Indian philosophical tradition as one of its most
important figures. He is the first thinker in this tradition to provide a
systematic theistic interpretation of the import of the Vedas. His
uncompromising stand on the side of common sense and moral realism stands as a
striking contrast to stereotyped accounts of Indian philosophical thought as
otherworldly and amoral. And while his significance in the history of Indian
philosophy may be under appreciated, his greater influence on the character and
form of popular Hinduism may also be under-recognized, despite the fact that he
is regarded as a saint in many parts of Southern India. According to Karl
Potter, "…Ramanuja's tradition can be said to represent one of the main arteries
through which philosophy reached down to the masses, and it may be that
Vishishtadvaita is today the most powerful philosophy in India in terms of
numbers of adherents, whether they know themselves by that label or not" (Potter
p.253). Whether Potter is correct or not, Ramanuja is an Indian philosopher who
defended the symbiosis of the spiritual, moral and practically earnest life.
9. References and Further Readings
PRIMARY SOURCES
(Page number references for Ramanuja's Shri Bhashya are to the English
translation.)
Ramanuja (acarya) (11th Century). Shri Bhashyam (Critical
Edition). Melkote: Academy of Sanskrit Research, 1985.
---. Shri Ramanuja Gita Bhashya (Bhagavad Gita Bhashya.) Trans.
and Ed. Svami Adidevananda. Madras: Sri Ramakrishna Math, 1991.
---. Shrimad Bhagavad Ramanuja Granthamala. (Complete works.) Ed.
Prativadi Bhayankara Annangaracharya. Kancheepuram: available at Granthamala
Karyalaya, 1974.
---. Vedanta Sutras with the Commentary of Ramanuja (Shri
Bhashya). Trans. (English) George Thibaut. Sacred Books of the East. Vol.
48. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1996.
---.Vedarthasamgraha (Vedarthasangraha). Trans. and Ed. S.S.
Ragavachar. Mysore: Shri RamaKrishna Ashrama, 1968.
Russell, Bertrand (20th Century). "On Denoting." Mind 14.56 (1905):
479-93.
Shankara (acarya) (9th Century). Bhagavadgita with the Commentary
of Shankaracarya (Bhagavad Gita Bhashya). Trans. and Ed. Swami
Gambhirananda. Calcutta: Advaita Ashrama, 1991.
---. Brahma Sutra Bhashya. Trans. Swami Gambhirananda. Calcutta:
Advaita Ashrama, 1983.
Shrinivasadasa (17th Century). Yatidramatadipika. Trans. Svami
Adidevananda. Madras: Sri Ramakrishna Math, 1978.
Yamuna (acarya) (11th Century). Sri Yamunacharya's Siddhi
Trayam. Trans. K. Shrinivasacharya. Ed. R. Ramanujachari: N.p., 1970.
SECONDARY SOURCES ON RAMANUJA
Buitenen, J. A. B. van. "Introduction." Trans. J. A. B. van Buitenen.
Ramanuja's Vedarthasangraha. Ed. J. A. B. van Buitenen. 1st , reprint.
ed. Pune: Deccan College Postgraduate and Research Institute, 1956. viii, 316.
Carman, John B. The Theology of Ramanuja; an Essay in Interreligious
Understanding. Yale Publications in Religion, 18. New Haven: Yale University
Press, 1974.
Govindacarya, A. "The Astadasa-Bedas, or the Eighteen Points of Doctrinal
Differences Between the Tengalais (Southerners) and the Vadagalais (Northerners)
of the Vishishtadvaita Vaishnava School, South India." Journal of the Royal
Asiatic Society of Great Britain and Ireland (1910): 1103-12.
Lester, Robert C. "Ramanuja and Shri Vaishnavism: the Concept of
Prapatti or Sharanagati." History of Religion 5.2 (1966):
266-82.
Potter, Karl H. Presuppositions of India's Philosophies. Prentice-Hall
Philosophy Series. Englewood Cliffs, N.J.: Prentice-Hall, 1963.
Tapasyananda. Bhakti Schools of Vedanta. Madras: Ramakrishna Math,
1990.
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