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Among the many topics explored by the philosophy of sexuality are procreation,
contraception, celibacy, marriage, adultery, casual sex, flirting, prostitution,
homosexuality, masturbation, seduction, rape, sexual harassment, sadomasochism,
pornography, bestiality, and pedophilia. What do all these things have
in common? All are related in various ways to the vast domain of human
sexuality. That is, they are related, on the one hand, to the human desires
and activities that involve the search for and attainment of sexual pleasure
or satisfaction and, on the other hand, to the human desires and activities
that involve the creation of new human beings. For it is a natural feature
of human beings that certain sorts of behaviors and certain bodily organs
are and can be employed either for pleasure or for reproduction, or for
both.
The philosophy of sexuality explores these topics both conceptually
and normatively. Conceptual analysis is carried out in the philosophy of
sexuality in order to clarify the fundamental notions of sexual desire
and sexual activity. Conceptual analysis is also carried out in attempting
to arrive at satisfactory definitions of adultery, prostitution, rape,
pornography, and so forth. Conceptual analysis (for example: what are the
distinctive features of a desire that make it sexual desire instead of
something else? In what ways does seduction differ from nonviolent rape?)
is often difficult and seemingly picky, but proves rewarding in unanticipated
and surprising ways.
Normative philosophy of sexuality inquires about the value of sexual
activity and sexual pleasure and of the various forms they take. Thus the
philosophy of sexuality is concerned with the perennial questions of sexual
morality and constitutes a large branch of applied
ethics . Normative philosophy of sexuality investigates what contribution
is made to the good or virtuous life by sexuality, and tries to determine
what moral obligations we have to refrain from performing certain sexual
acts and what moral permissions we have to engage in others.
Some philosophers of sexuality carry out conceptual analysis and the
study of sexual ethics separately. They believe that it is one thing to
define
a sexual phenomenon (such as rape or adultery) and quite another thing
to evaluate it. Other philosophers of sexuality believe that a robust
distinction between defining a sexual phenomenon and arriving at moral
evaluations of it cannot be made, that analyses of sexual concepts and
moral evaluations of sexual acts influence each other. Whether there actually
is a tidy distinction between values and morals, on the one hand,
and natural, social, or conceptual facts, on the other hand, is
one of those fascinating, endlessly debated issues in philosophy, and is
not limited to the philosophy of sexuality.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Metaphysics of Sexuality
Our moral evaluations of sexual activity are bound to be affected by
what we view the nature of the sexual impulse, or of sexual desire, to
be in human beings. In this regard there is a deep divide between those
philosophers that we might call the metaphysical sexual optimists and those
we might call the metaphysical sexual pessimists.
The pessimists in the philosophy of sexuality, such as St. Augustine
, Immanuel Kant, and, sometimes, Sigmund Freud
, perceive the sexual impulse and acting on it to be something nearly always,
if not necessarily, unbefitting the dignity of the human person; they see
the essence and the results of the drive to be incompatible with more significant
and lofty goals and aspirations of human existence; they fear that the
power and demands of the sexual impulse make it a danger to harmonious
civilized life; and they find in sexuality a severe threat not only to
our proper relations with, and our moral treatment of, other persons, but
also equally a threat to our own humanity.
On the other side of the divide are the metaphysical sexual optimists
(Plato, in some of his works, sometimes Sigmund Freud, Bertrand Russell,
and many contemporary philosophers) who perceive nothing especially obnoxious
in the sexual impulse. They view human sexuality as just another and mostly
innocuous dimension of our existence as embodied or animal-like creatures;
they judge that sexuality, which in some measure has been given to us by
evolution, cannot but be conducive to our well-being without detracting
from our intellectual propensities; and they praise rather than fear the
power of an impulse that can lift us to various high forms of happiness.
The particular sort of metaphysics of sex one believes will influence
one's subsequent judgments about the value and role of sexuality in the
good or virtuous life and about what sexual activities are morally wrong
and which ones are morally permissible. Let's explore some of these implications.
2. Metaphysical Sexual Pessimism
An extended version of metaphysical pessimism might make the following
claims: In virtue of the nature of sexual desire, a person who sexually
desires another person objectifies that other person, both before and during
sexual activity. Sex, says Kant, "makes of the loved person an Object of
appetite. . . . Taken by itself it is a degradation of human nature" (Lectures
on Ethics, p. 163). Certain types of manipulation and deception seem
required prior to engaging in sex with another person, or are so common
as to appear part of the nature of the sexual experience. As Bernard Baumrim
makes the point, "sexual interaction is essentially manipulative--physically,
psychologically, emotionally, and even intellectually" ("Sexual Immorality
Delineated," p. 300). We go out of our way, for example, to make ourselves
look more attractive and desirable to the other person than we really are,
and we go to great lengths to conceal our defects. And when one person
sexually desires another, the other person's body, his or her lips, thighs,
toes, and buttocks are desired as the arousing parts they are, distinct
from the person. The other's genitals, too, are the object of our attention:
"sexuality is not an inclination which one human being has for another
as such, but is an inclination for the sex of another. . . . [O]nly her
sex is the object of his desires" (Kant, Lectures, p. 164).
Further, the sexual act itself is peculiar, with its uncontrollable
arousal, involuntary jerkings, and its yearning to master and consume the
other person's body. During the act, a person both loses control of himself
and loses regard for the humanity of the other. Our sexuality is a threat
to the other's personhood; but the one who is in the grip of desire is
also on the verge of losing his or her personhood. The one who desires
depends on the whims of another person to gain satisfaction, and becomes
as a result a jellyfish, susceptible to the demands and manipulations of
the other: "In desire you are compromised in the eyes of the object of
desire, since you have displayed that you have designs which are vulnerable
to his intentions" (Roger Scruton, Sexual Desire, p. 82). A person
who proposes an irresistible sexual offer to another person may be exploiting
someone made weak by sexual desire (see Virginia Held, "Coercion and Coercive
Offers," p. 58).
Moreover, a person who gives in to another's sexual desire makes a tool
of himself or herself. "For the natural use that one sex makes of the other's
sexual organs is enjoyment, for which one gives oneself up to the
other. In this act a human being makes himself into a thing, which conflicts
with the right of humanity in his own person" (Kant, Metaphysics of
Morals, p. 62). Those engaged in sexual activity make themselves willingly
into objects for each other merely for the sake of sexual pleasure. Hence
both persons are reduced to the animal level. "If . . . a man wishes to
satisfy his desire, and a woman hers, they stimulate each other's desire;
their inclinations meet, but their object is not human nature but sex,
and each of them dishonours the human nature of the other. They make of
humanity an instrument for the satisfaction of their lusts and inclinations,
and dishonour it by placing it on a level with animal nature" (Kant, Lectures,
p. 164).
Finally, due to the insistent nature of the sexual impulse, once things
get going it is often hard to stop them in their tracks, and as a result
we often end up doing things sexually that we had never planned or wanted
to do. Sexual desire is also powerfully inelastic, one of the passions
most likely to challenge reason, compelling us to seek satisfaction even
when doing so involves dark-alley gropings, microbiologically filthy acts,
slinking around the White House, or getting married impetuously.
Given such a pessimistic metaphysics of human sexuality, one might well
conclude that acting on the sexual impulse is always morally wrong. That
might, indeed, be precisely the right conclusion to draw, even if it implies
the end of Homo sapiens. (This doomsday result is also implied by
St. Paul's praising, in 1 Corinthians 7, sexual celibacy as the
ideal spiritual state.) More frequently, however, the pessimistic metaphysicians
of sexuality conclude that sexual activity is morally permissible only
within marriage (of the lifelong, monogamous, heterosexual sort) and only
for the purpose of procreation. Regarding the bodily activities that both
lead to procreation and produce sexual pleasure, it is their procreative
potential that is singularly significant and bestows value on these activities;
seeking pleasure is an impediment to morally virtuous sexuality, and is
something that should not be undertaken deliberately or for its own sake.
Sexual pleasure at most has instrumental value, in inducing us to engage
in an act that has procreation as its primary purpose. Such views are common
among Christian thinkers, for example, St. Augustine: "A man turns to good
use the evil of concupiscence, and is not overcome by it, when he bridles
and restrains its rage . . . and never relaxes his hold upon it except
when intent on offspring, and then controls and applies it to the carnal
generation of children . . . , not to the subjection of the spirit to the
flesh in a sordid servitude" (On Marriage and Concupiscence, bk.
1, ch. 9).
3. Metaphysical Sexual Optimism
Metaphysical sexual optimists suppose that sexuality is a bonding mechanism
that naturally and happily joins people together both sexually and nonsexually.
Sexual activity involves pleasing the self and the other at the same time,
and these exchanges of pleasure generate both gratitude and affection,
which in turn are bound to deepen human relationships and make them more
emotionally substantial. Further, and this is the most important point,
sexual pleasure is, for a metaphysical optimist, a valuable thing in its
own right, something to be cherished and promoted because it has intrinsic
and not merely instrumental value. Hence the pursuit of sexual pleasure
does not require much intricate justification; sexual activity surely need
not be confined to marriage or directed at procreation. The good and virtuous
life, while including much else, can also include a wide variety and extent
of sexual relations. (See Russell Vannoy's spirited defense of the value
of sexual activity for its own sake, in Sex Without Love.)
Irving Singer is a contemporary philosopher of sexuality who expresses
well one form of metaphysical optimism: "For though sexual interest resembles
an appetite in some respects, it differs from hunger or thirst in being
an interpersonal sensitivity, one that enables us to delight in
the mind and character of other persons as well as in their flesh. Though
at times people may be used as sexual objects and cast aside once their
utility has been exhausted, this is no[t] . . . definitive of sexual desire.
. . . By awakening us to the living presence of someone else, sexuality
can enable us to treat this other being as just the person he or she happens
to be. . . . There is nothing in the nature of sexuality as such that necessarily
. . . reduces persons to things. On the contrary, sex may be seen as an
instinctual agency by which persons respond to one another
through
their bodies" (The Nature of Love, vol. 2, p. 382. See also Jean
Hampton, "Defining Wrong and Defining Rape").
Pausanias, in Plato's Symposium
(181a-3, 183e, 184d), asserts that sexuality in itself is neither good
nor bad. He recognizes, as a result, that there can be morally bad and
morally good sexual activity, and proposes a corresponding distinction
between what he calls "vulgar" eros and "heavenly" eros. A person who has
vulgar eros is one who experiences promiscuous sexual desire, has a lust
that can be satisfied by any partner, and selfishly seeks only for himself
or herself the pleasures of sexual activity. By contrast, a person who
has heavenly eros experiences a sexual desire that attaches to a particular
person; he or she is as much interested in the other person's personality
and well-being as he or she is concerned to have physical contact with
and sexual satisfaction by means of the other person. A similar distinction
between sexuality per se and eros is described by C. S. Lewis in his The
Four Loves (chapter 5), and it is perhaps what Allan Bloom has in mind
when he writes, "Animals have sex and human beings have eros, and no accurate
science [or philosophy] is possible without making this distinction" (Love
and Friendship, p. 19).
The divide between metaphysical optimists and metaphysical pessimists
might, then, be put this way: metaphysical pessimists think that sexuality,
unless it is rigorously constrained by social norms that have become internalized,
will tend to be governed by vulgar eros, while metaphysical optimists think
that sexuality, by itself, does not lead to or become vulgar, that by its
nature it can easily be and often is heavenly. (See the entry, Philosophy
of Love.)
4. Moral Evaluations
Of course, we can and often do evaluate sexual activity morally:
we inquire whether a sexual act--either a particular occurrence of a sexual
act (the act we are doing or want to do right now) or a type of sexual
act (say, all instances of homosexual fellatio)--is morally good or morally
bad. More specifically, we evaluate, or judge, sexual acts to be morally
obligatory, morally permissible, morally supererogatory, or morally wrong.
For example: a spouse might have a
moral obligation to engage in
sex with the other spouse; it might be morally permissible for married
couples to employ contraception while engaging in coitus; one person's
agreeing to have sexual relations with another person when the former has
no sexual desire of his or her own but does want to please the latter might
be an act of supererogation; and rape and incest are commonly thought
to be morally wrong.
Note that if a specific type of sexual act is morally wrong (say, homosexual
fellatio), then every instance of that type of act will be morally wrong.
However, from the fact that the particular sexual act we are now doing
or contemplate doing is morally wrong, it does not follow that any specific
type of act is morally wrong; the sexual act that we are contemplating
might be wrong for lots of different reasons having nothing to do with
the type of sexual act that it is. For example, suppose we are engaging
in heterosexual coitus (or anything else), and that this particular act
is wrong because it is adulterous. The wrongfulness of our sexual activity
does not imply that heterosexual coitus in general (or anything else),
as a type of sexual act, is morally wrong. In some cases, of course, a
particular sexual act will be wrong for several reasons: not only is it
wrong because it is of a specific type (say, it is an instance of homosexual
fellatio), but it is also wrong because at least one of the participants
is married to someone else (it is wrong also because it is adulterous).
Nonmoral
Evaluations
We can also evaluate sexual activity (again, either a particular occurrence
of a sexual act or a specific type of sexual activity) nonmorally:
nonmorally "good" sex is sexual activity that provides pleasure to the
participants or is physically or emotionally satisfying, while nonmorally
"bad" sex is unexciting, tedious, boring, unenjoyable, or even unpleasant.
An analogy will clarify the difference between morally evaluating something
as good or bad and nonmorally evaluating it as good or bad. This radio
on my desk is a good radio, in the nonmoral sense, because it does for
me what I expect from a radio: it consistently provides clear tones. If,
instead, the radio hissed and cackled most of the time, it would be a bad
radio, nonmorally-speaking, and it would be senseless for me to blame the
radio for its faults and threaten it with a trip to hell if it did not
improve its behavior. Similarly, sexual activity can be nonmorally good
if it provides for us what we expect sexual activity to provide, which
is usually sexual pleasure, and this fact has no necessary moral implications..
It is not difficult to see that the fact that a sexual activity is perfectly
nonmorally good, by abundantly satisfying both persons, does not mean by
itself that the act is morally good: some adulterous sexual activity might
well be very pleasing to the participants, yet be morally wrong. Further,
the fact that a sexual activity is nonmorally bad, that is, does not produce
pleasure for the persons engaged in it, does not by itself mean that the
act is morally bad. Unpleasant sexual activity might occur between persons
who have little experience engaging in sexual activity (they do not yet
know how to do sexual things, or have not yet learned what their likes
and dislikes are), but their failure to provide pleasure for each other
does not mean by itself that they perform morally wrongful acts.
Thus the moral evaluation of sexual activity is a distinct enterprise
from the nonmoral evaluation of sexual activity, even if there do remain
important connections between them. For example, the fact that a sexual
act provides pleasure to both participants, and is thereby nonmorally good,
might be taken as a strong, but only prima facie good, reason for
thinking that the act is morally good or at least has some degree of moral
value. Indeed, utilitarians such as Jeremy
Bentham and even John
Stuart Mill might claim that, in general, the nonmoral goodness
of sexual activity goes a long way toward justifying it. Another example:
if one person never attempts to provide sexual pleasure to his or her partner,
but selfishly insists on experiencing only his or her own pleasure, then
that person's contribution to their sexual activity is morally suspicious
or objectionable. But that judgment rests not simply on the fact that he
or she did not provide pleasure for the other person, that is, on the fact
that the sexual activity was for the other person nonmorally bad. The moral
judgment rests, more precisely, on his or her motives for not providing
any pleasure, for not making the experience nonmorally good for the other
person.
It is one thing to point out that as evaluative categories, moral goodness/badness
is quite distinct from nonmoral goodness/badness. It is another thing to
wonder, nonetheless, about the emotional or psychological connections between
the moral quality of sexual activity and its nonmoral quality. Perhaps
morally good sexual activity tends also to be the most satisfying sexual
activity, in the nonmoral sense. Whether that is true likely depends on
what we mean by "morally good" sexuality and on certain features of human
moral psychology. What would our lives be like, if there were always a
neat correspondence between the moral quality of a sexual act and its nonmoral
quality? I am not sure what such a human sexual world would be like. But
examples that violate such a neat correspondence are at the present time,
in this world, easy to come by. A sexual act might be both morally and
nonmorally good: consider the exciting and joyful sexual activity of a
newly-married couple. But a sexual act might be morally good and nonmorally
bad: consider the routine sexual acts of this couple after they have been
married for ten years. A sexual act might be morally bad yet nonmorally
good: one spouse in that couple, married for ten years, commits adultery
with another married person and finds their sexual activity to be extraordinarily
satisfying. And, finally, a sexual act might be both morally and nonmorally
bad: the adulterous couple get tired of each other, eventually no longer
experiencing the excitement they once knew. A world in which there was
little or no discrepancy between the moral and the nonmoral quality of
sexual activity might be a better world than ours, or it might be worse.
I would refrain from making such a judgment unless I were pretty sure what
the moral goodness and badness of sexual activity amounted to in the first
place, and until I knew a lot more about human psychology. Sometimes that
a sexual activity is acknowledged to be morally wrong contributes all by
itself to its being nonmorally good.
5. The Dangers of Sex
Whether a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexual act provides
sexual pleasure is not the only factor in judging its nonmoral quality:
pragmatic and prudential considerations also figure into whether a sexual
act, all things considered, has a preponderance of nonmoral goodness. Many
sexual activities can be physically or psychologically risky, dangerous,
or harmful. Anal coitus, for example, whether carried out by a heterosexual
couple or by two gay males, can damage delicate tissues and is a mechanism
for the potential transmission of various HIV viruses (as is heterosexual
genital intercourse). Thus in evaluating whether a sexual act will be overall
nonmorally good or bad, not only its anticipated pleasure or satisfaction
must be counted, but also all sorts of negative (undesired) side effects:
whether the sexual act is likely to damage the body, as in some sadomasochistic
acts, or transmit any one of a number of venereal diseases, or result in
an unwanted pregnancy, or even whether one might feel regret, anger, or
guilt afterwards as a result of having engaged in a sexual act with this
person, or in this location, or under these conditions, or of a specific
type. Indeed, all these pragmatic and prudential factors also figure into
the moral evaluation of sexual activity: intentionally causing unwanted
pain or discomfort to one's partner, or not taking adequate precautions
against the possibility of pregnancy, or not informing one's partner of
a suspected case of genital infection (but see David Mayo's provocative
dissent, in "An Obligation to Warn of HIV Infection?"), can be morally
wrong. Thus, depending on what particular moral principles about sexuality
one embraces, the various ingredients that constitute the nonmoral quality
of sexual acts can influence one's moral judgments.
6. Sexual Perversion
In addition to inquiring about the moral and nonmoral quality of a given
sexual act or a type of sexual activity, we can also ask whether the act
or type is natural or unnatural (that is, perverted). Natural sexual acts,
to provide merely a broad definition, are those acts that either flow naturally
from human sexual nature, or at least do not frustrate or counteract sexual
tendencies that flow naturally from human sexual desire. An account of
what is natural in human sexual desire and activity is part of a philosophical
account of human nature in general, what we might call philosophical anthropology,
which is a rather large undertaking.
Note that evaluating a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexual
activity as being natural or unnatural can very well be distinct from evaluating
the act or type either as being morally good or bad or as being nonmorally
good or bad. Suppose we assume, for the sake of discussion only, that heterosexual
coitus is a natural human sexual activity and that homosexual fellatio
is unnatural, or a sexual perversion. Even so, it would not follow from
these judgments alone that all heterosexual coitus is morally good (some
of it might be adulterous, or rape) or that all homosexual fellatio is
morally wrong (some of it, engaged in by consenting adults in the privacy
of their homes, might be morally permissible). Further, from the fact that
heterosexual coitus is natural, it does not follow that acts of heterosexual
coitus will be nonmorally good, that is, pleasurable; nor does it follow
from the fact that homosexual fellatio is perverted that it does not or
cannot produce sexual pleasure for those people who engage in it. Of course,
both natural and unnatural sexual acts can be medically or psychologically
risky or dangerous. There is no reason to assume that natural sexual acts
are in general more safe than unnatural sexual acts; for example, unprotected
heterosexual intercourse is likely more dangerous, in several ways, than
mutual homosexual masturbation.
Since there are no necessary connections between, on the one hand, evaluating
a particular sexual act or a specific type of sexual activity as being
natural or unnatural and, on the other hand, evaluating its moral and nonmoral
quality, why would we wonder whether a sexual act or a type of sex was
natural or perverted? One reason is simply that understanding what is natural
and unnatural in human sexuality helps complete our picture of human nature
in general, and allows us to understand our species more fully. With such
deliberations, the self-reflection about humanity and the human condition
that is the heart of philosophy becomes more complete. A second reason
is that an account of the difference between the natural and the perverted
in human sexuality might be useful for psychology, especially if we assume
that a desire or tendency to engage in perverted sexual activities is a
sign or symptom of an underlying mental or psychological pathology.
7. Sexual Perversion and Morality
Finally (a third reason), even though natural sexual activity is not
on that score alone morally good and unnatural sexual activity is not necessarily
morally wrong, it is still possible to argue that whether a particular
sexual act or a specific type of sexuality is natural or unnatural does
influence, to a greater or lesser extent, whether the act is morally good
or morally bad. Just as whether a sexual act is nonmorally good, that is,
produces pleasure for the participants, may be a factor, sometimes an important
one, in our evaluating the act morally, whether a sexual act or type of
sexual expression is natural or unnatural may also play a role, sometimes
a large one, in deciding whether the act is morally good or bad.
A comparison between the sexual philosophy of the medieval Catholic
theologian St. Thomas Aquinas
and that of the contemporary secular philosophy Thomas Nagel is in this
regard instructive. Both Aquinas and Nagel can be understood as assuming
that what is unnatural in human sexuality is perverted, and that what is
unnatural or perverted in human sexuality is simply that which does not
conform with or is inconsistent with natural human sexuality. But beyond
these general areas of agreement, there are deep differences between Aquinas
and Nagel.
8. Aquinas's Natural Law
Based upon a comparison of the sexuality of humans and the sexuality
of lower animals (mammals, in particular), Aquinas concludes that what
is natural in human sexuality is the impulse to engage in heterosexual
coitus. Heterosexual coitus is the mechanism designed by the Christian
God to insure the preservation of animal species, including humans, and
hence engaging in this activity is the primary natural expression of human
sexual nature. Further, this God designed each of the parts of the human
body to carry out specific functions, and on Aquinas's view God designed
the male penis to implant sperm into the female's vagina for the purpose
of effecting procreation. It follows, for Aquinas, that depositing the
sperm elsewhere than inside a human female's vagina is unnatural: it is
a violation of God's design, contrary to the nature of things as established
by God. For this reason alone, on Aquinas's view, such activities are immoral,
a grave offense to the sagacious plan of the Almighty.
Sexual intercourse with lower animals (bestiality), sexual activity
with members of one's own sex (homosexuality), and masturbation, for Aquinas,
are unnatural sexual acts and are immoral exactly for that reason. If they
are committed intentionally, according to one's will, they deliberately
disrupt the natural order of the world as created by God and which God
commanded to be respected. (See Summa Theologiae, vol. 43, 2a2ae,
qq. 153-154.) In none of these activities is there any possibility of procreation,
and the sexual and other organs are used, or misused, for purposes other
than that for which they were designed. Although Aquinas does not say so
explicitly, but only hints in this direction, it follows from his philosophy
of sexuality that fellatio, even when engaged in by heterosexuals, is also
perverted and morally wrong. At least in those cases in which orgasm occurs
by means of this act, the sperm is not being placed where it should be
placed and procreation is therefore not possible. If the penis entering
the vagina is the paradigmatic natural act, then any other combination
of anatomical connections will be unnatural and hence immoral; for example,
the penis, mouth, or fingers entering the anus. Note that Aquinas's criterion
of the natural, that the sexual act must be procreative in form, and hence
must involve a penis inserted into a vagina, makes no mention of human
psychology. Aquinas's line of thought yields an anatomical criterion of
natural and perverted sex that refers only to bodily organs and what they
might accomplish physiologically and to where they are, or are not, put
in relation to each other.
9. Nagel's Secular Philosophy
Thomas Nagel denies Aquinas's central presupposition, that in order
to discover what is natural in human sexuality we should emphasize what
humans and lower animals have in common. Applying this formula, Aquinas
concluded that the purpose of sexual activity and the sexual organs in
humans was procreation, as it is in the lower animals. Everything else
in Aquinas's sexual philosophy follows more-or-less logically from this.
Nagel, by contrast, argues that to discover what is distinctive about the
natural human sexuality, and hence derivatively what is unnatural or perverted,
we should focus, instead, on what humans and lower animals do not
have in common. We should emphasize the ways in which humans are different
from animals, the ways in which humans and their sexuality are special.
Thus Nagel argues that sexual perversion in humans should be understood
as a psychological phenomenon rather than, as in Aquinas's treatment, in
anatomical and physiological terms. For it is human psychology that makes
us quite different from other animals, and hence an account of natural
human sexuality must acknowledge the uniqueness of human psychology.
Nagel proposes that sexual interactions in which each person responds
with sexual arousal to noticing the sexual arousal of the other person
exhibit the psychology that is natural to human sexuality. In such an encounter,
each person becomes aware of himself or herself and the other person as
both the subject and the object of their joint sexual experiences. Perverted
sexual encounters or events would be those in which this mutual recognition
of arousal is absent, and in which a person remains fully a subject of
the sexual experience or fully an object. Perversion, then, is a departure
from or a truncation of a psychologically "complete" pattern of arousal
and consciousness. (See Nagel's "Sexual Perversion," pp. 15-17.) Nothing
in Nagel's psychological account of the natural and the perverted refers
to bodily organs or physiological processes. That is, for a sexual encounter
to be natural, it need not be procreative in form, as long as the requisite
psychology of mutual recognition is present. Whether a sexual activity
is natural or perverted does not depend, on Nagel's view, on what organs
are used or where they are put, but only on the character of the psychology
of the sexual encounter. Thus Nagel disagrees with Aquinas that homosexual
activities, as a specific type of sexual act, are unnatural or perverted,
for homosexual fellatio and anal intercourse may very well be accompanied
by the mutual recognition of and response to the other's sexual arousal.
10. Fetishism
It is illuminating to compare what the views of Aquinas and Nagel imply
about fetishism, that is, the usually male practice of masturbating while
fondling women's shoes or undergarments. Aquinas and Nagel agree that such
activities are unnatural and perverted, but they disagree about the grounds
of that evaluation. For Aquinas, masturbating while fondling shoes or undergarments
is unnatural because the sperm is not deposited where it should be, and
the act thereby has no procreative potential. For Nagel, masturbatory fetishism
is perverted for a quite different reason: in this activity, there is no
possibility of one persons' noticing and being aroused by the arousal of
another person. The arousal of the fetishist is, from the perspective of
natural human psychology, defective. Note, in this example, one more difference
between Aquinas and Nagel: Aquinas would judge the sexual activity of the
fetishist to be immoral precisely because it is perverted (it violates
a natural pattern established by God), while Nagel would not conclude that
it must be morally wrong--after all, a fetishistic sexual act might be
carried out quite harmlessly--even if it does indicate that something is
suspicious about the fetishist's psychology. The move historically and
socially away from a Thomistic moralistic account of sexual perversion
toward an amoral psychological account such as Nagel's is representative
of a more widespread trend: the gradual replacement of moral or religious
judgments, about all sorts of deviant behavior, by medical or psychiatric
judgments and interventions. (See Alan Soble, Sexual Investigations,
chapter 4.)
11. Female Sexuality and Natural Law
A different kind of disagreement with Aquinas is registered by Christine
Gudorf, a Christian theologian who otherwise has a lot in common with Aquinas.
Gudorf agrees that the study of human anatomy and physiology yields insights
into God's plan and design, and that human sexual behavior should conform
with God's creative intentions. That is, Gudorf's philosophy is squarely
within the Thomistic Natural
Law tradition. But Gudorf argues that if we take a careful look
at the anatomy and physiology of the female sexual organs, and especially
the clitoris, instead of focusing exclusively on the male's penis (which
is what Aquinas did), quite different conclusions about God's plan and
design emerge and hence Christian sexual ethics turns out to be less restrictive.
In particular, Gudorf claims that the female's clitoris is an organ whose
only purpose is the production of sexual pleasure and, unlike the mixed
or dual functionality of the penis, has no connection with procreation.
Gudorf concludes that the existence of the clitoris in the female body
suggests that God intended that the purpose of sexual activity was as much
for sexual pleasure for its own sake as it was for procreation. Therefore,
according to Gudorf, pleasurable sexual activity apart from procreation
does not violate God's design, is not unnatural, and hence is not necessarily
morally wrong, as long as it occurs in the context of a monogamous marriage
(Sex, Body, and Pleasure, p. 65). Today we are not as confident
as Aquinas was that God's plan can be discovered by a straightforward examination
of human and animal bodies; but such healthy skepticism about our ability
to discern the intentions of God from facts of the natural world would
seem to apply to Gudorf's proposal as well.
12. Debates in Sexual Ethics
The ethics of sexual behavior, as a branch of applied ethics, is no
more and no less contentious than the ethics of anything else that is usually
included within the area of applied ethics. Think, for example, of the
notorious debates over euthanasia, capital punishment, abortion, and our
treatment of lower animals for food, clothing, entertainment, and in medical
research. So it should come as no surprise than even though a discussion
of sexual ethics might well result in the removal of some confusions and
a clarification of the issues, no final answers to questions about the
morality of sexual activity are likely to be forthcoming from the philosophy
of sexuality. As far as I can tell by surveying the literature on sexual
ethics, there are at least three major topics that have received much discussion
by philosophers of sexuality and which provide arenas for continual debate.
13. Natural Law vs. Liberal Ethics
We have already encountered one debate: the dispute between a Thomistic
Natural Law approach to sexual morality and a more liberal, secular outlook
that denies that there is a tight connection between what is unnatural
in human sexuality and what is immoral. The secular liberal philosopher
emphasizes the values of autonomous choice, self-determination, and pleasure
in arriving at moral judgments about sexual behavior, in contrast to the
Thomistic tradition that justifies a more restrictive sexual ethics by
invoking a divinely imposed scheme to which human action must conform.
For a secular liberal philosopher of sexuality, the paradigmatically morally
wrong sexual act is rape, in which one person forces himself or herself
upon another or uses threats to coerce the other to engage in sexual activity.
By contrast, for the liberal, anything done voluntarily between two or
more people is generally morally permissible. For the secular liberal,
then, a sexual act would be morally wrong if it were dishonest, coercive,
or manipulative, and Natural Law theory would agree, except to add that
the act's merely being unnatural is another, independent reason for condemning
it morally. Kant, for example, held that "Onanism . . . is abuse of the
sexual faculty. . . . By it man sets aside his person and degrades himself
below the level of animals. . . . Intercourse between sexus homogenii
. . . too is contrary to the ends of humanity"(Lectures, p. 170).
The sexual liberal, however, usually finds nothing morally wrong or nonmorally
bad about either masturbation or homosexual sexual activity. These activities
might be unnatural, and perhaps in some ways prudentially unwise, but in
many if not most cases they can be carried out without harm being done
either to the participants or to anyone else.
Natural Law is alive and well today among philosophers of sex, even
if the details do not match Aquinas's original version. For example, the
contemporary philosopher John Finnis argues that there are morally worthless
sexual acts in which "one's body is treated as instrumental for the securing
of the experiential satisfaction of the conscious self" (see "Is Homosexual
Conduct Wrong?"). For example, in masturbating or in being anally sodomized,
the body is just a tool of sexual satisfaction and, as a result, the person
undergoes "disintegration." "One's choosing self [becomes] the quasi-slave
of the experiencing self which is demanding gratification." The worthlessness
and disintegration attaching to masturbation and sodomy actually attach,
for Finnis, to "all extramarital sexual gratification." This is because
only in married, heterosexual coitus do the persons' "reproductive organs
. . . make them a biological . . . unit." Finnis begins his argument with
the metaphysically pessimistic intuition that sexual activity involves
treating human bodies and persons instrumentally, and he concludes with
the thought that sexual activity in marriage--in particular, genital intercourse--avoids
disintegrity because only in this case, as intended by God's plan, does
the couple attain a state of genuine unity: "the orgasmic union of the
reproductive organs of husband and wife really unites them biologically."
(See also Finnis's essay "Law, Morality, and 'Sexual Orientation'.")
14. Consent Is Not Sufficient
Another debate is about whether, when there is no harm done to third
parties to be concerned about, the fact that two people engage in a sexual
act voluntarily, with their own free and informed consent, is sufficient
for satisfying the demands of sexual morality. Of course, those in the
Natural Law tradition deny that consent is sufficient, since on their view
willingly engaging in unnatural sexual acts is morally wrong, but they
are not alone in reducing the moral significance of consent. Sexual activity
between two persons might be harmful to one or both participants, and a
moral paternalist or perfectionist would claim that it is wrong for one
person to harm another person, or for the latter to allow the former to
engage in this harmful behavior, even when both persons provide free and
informed consent to their joint activity. Consent in this case is not sufficient,
and as a result some forms of sadomasochistic sexuality turn out to be
morally wrong. The denial of the sufficiency of consent is also frequently
presupposed by those philosophers who claim that only in a committed relationship
is sexual activity between two people morally permissible. The free and
informed consent of both parties may be a necessary condition for the morality
of their sexual activity, but without the presence of some other ingredient
(love, marriage, devotion, and the like) their sexual activity remains
mere mutual use or objectification and hence morally objectionable.
In casual sex, for example, two persons are merely using each other
for their own sexual pleasure; even when genuinely consensual, these mutual
sexual uses do not yield a virtuous sexual act. Kant and Karol Wojtyla
(Pope John Paul II) take this position: willingly allowing oneself to be
used sexually by another makes an object of oneself. For Kant, sexual activity
avoids treating a person merely as a means only in marriage, since here
both persons have surrendered their bodies and souls to each other and
have achieved a subtle metaphysical unity (Lectures, p. 167). For
Wojtyla, "only love can preclude the use of one person by another" (Love
and Responsibility, p. 30), since love is a unification of persons
resulting from a mutual gift of their selves. Note, however, that the thought
that a unifying love is the ingredient that justifies sexual activity (beyond
consent) has an interesting and ironic implication: gay and lesbian sexual
relations would seem to be permissible if they occur within loving, monogamous
homosexual marriages (a position defended by the theologians Patricia Jung
and Ralph Smith, in
Heterosexism). At this point in the argument,
defenders of the view that sexual activity is justifiable only in marriage
commonly appeal to Natural Law to rule out homosexual marriage.
15. Consent Is Sufficient
On another view of these matters, the fact that sexual activity is carried
out voluntarily by all persons involved means, assuming that no harm to
third parties exists, that the sexual activity is morally permissible.
In defending such a view of the sufficiency of consent, Thomas Mappes writes
that "respect for persons entails that each of us recognize the rightful
authority of other persons (as rational beings) to conduct their individual
lives as they see fit" ("Sexual Morality and the Concept of Using Another
Person," p. 204). Allowing the other person's consent to control when the
other may engage in sexual activity with me is to respect that person by
taking his or her autonomy, his or her ability to reason and make choices,
seriously, while not to allow the other to make the decision about when
to engage in sexual activity with me is disrespectfully paternalistic.
If the other person's consent is taken as sufficient, that shows that I
respect his or her choice of ends, or that even if I do not approve of
his or her particular choice of ends, at least I show respect for his or
her ends-making capability. According to such a view of the power of consent,
there can be no moral objection in principle to casual sexual activity,
to sexual activity with strangers, or to promiscuity, as long as the persons
involved in the activity genuinely agree to engage in their chosen sexual
activities.
If Mappes's free and informed consent criterion of the morality of sexual
activity is correct, we would still have to address several difficult questions.
How specific must consent be? When one person agrees vaguely, and in the
heat of the moment, with another person, "yes, let's have sex," the speaker
has not necessarily consented to every type of sexual caress or coital
position the second person might have in mind. And how explicit must consent
be? Can consent be reliably implied by involuntarily behavior (moans, for
example), and do nonverbal cues (erection, lubrication) decisively show
that another person has consented to sex? Some philosophers insist that
consent must be exceedingly specific as to the sexual acts to be carried
out, and some would permit only explicit verbal consent, denying that body
language by itself can do an adequate job of expressing the participant's
desires and intentions. (See Alan Soble, "Antioch's 'Sexual Offense Policy'.")
Note also that not all philosophers agree with Mappes and others that
fully voluntary consent is always necessary for sexual activity to be morally
permissible. Jeffrie Murphy, for example, has raised some doubts ("Some
Ruminations on Women, Violence, and the Criminal Law," p. 218):
"Have sex with me or I will find another girlfriend" strikes me (assuming
normal circumstances) as a morally permissible threat, and "Have sex with
me and I will marry you" strikes me (assuming the offer is genuine) as
a morally permissible offer. . . . We negotiate our way through most of
life with schemes of threats and offers . . . and I see no reason why the
realm of sexuality should be utterly insulated from this very normal way
of being human.
Murphy implies that some threats are coercive and thereby undermine
the voluntary nature of the participation in sexual activity of one of
the persons, but, he adds, these types of threats are not always morally
wrong. Alternatively, we might say that in the cases Murphy describes,
the threats and offers do not constitute coercion at all and that they
present no obstacle to fully voluntary participation. (See Alan Wertheimer,
"Consent and Sexual Relations.") If so, Murphy's cases do not establish
that voluntary consent is not always required for sexual activity to be
morally right.
16. What Is "Voluntary"?
As suggested by Murphy's examples, another debate concerns the meaning
and application of the concept "voluntary." Whether consent is only necessary
for the morality of sexual activity, or also sufficient, any moral principle
that relies on consent to make moral distinctions among sexual events presupposes
a clear understanding of the "voluntary" aspect of consent. It is safe
to say that participation in sexual activity ought not to be physically
forced upon one person by another. But this obvious truth leaves matters
wide open. Onora O'Neill, for example, thinks that casual sex is morally
wrong because the consent it purportedly involves is not likely to be sufficiently
voluntary, in light of subtle pressures people commonly put on each other
to engage in sexual activity (see "Between Consenting Adults").
One moral ideal is that genuinely consensual participation in sexual
activity requires not a hint of coercion or pressure of any sort. Because
engaging in sexual activity can be risky or dangerous in many ways, physically,
psychologically, and metaphysically, we would like to be sure, according
to this moral ideal, that anyone who engages in sexual activity does so
perfectly voluntarily. Some philosophers have argued that this ideal can
be realized only when there is substantial economic and social equality
between the persons involved in a given sexual encounter. For example,
a society that exhibits disparities in the incomes or wealth of its various
members is one in which some people will be exposed to economic coercion.
If some groups of people (women and members of ethnic minorities, in particular)
have less economic and social power than others, members of these groups
will be therefore exposed to sexual coercion in particular, among other
kinds. One immediate application of this thought is that prostitution,
which to many sexual liberals is a business bargain made by a provider
of sexual services and a client and is largely characterized by adequately
free and informed consent, may be morally wrong, if the economic situation
of the prostitute acts as a kind of pressure that negates the voluntary
nature of his or her participation. Further, women with children who are
economically dependent on their husbands may find themselves in the position
of having to engage in sexual activity whether they want to or not, for
fear of being abandoned; these women, too, may not be engaging in sexual
activity fully voluntarily. The woman who allows herself to be nagged into
sex by her husband worries that if she says "no" too often, she will suffer
economically, if not also physically and psychologically.
The view that the presence of any kind of pressure at all is coercive,
negates the voluntary nature of participation in sexual activity, and hence
is morally objectionable has been expressed by Charlene Muehlenhard and
Jennifer Schrag (see their "Nonviolent Sexual Coercion"). They list, among
other things, "status coercion" (when women are coerced into sexual activity
or marriage by a man's occupation) and "discrimination against lesbians"
(which discrimination compels women into having sexual relationships only
with men) as forms of coercion that undermine the voluntary nature of participation
by women in sexual activity with men. But depending on the kind of case
we have in mind, it might be more accurate to say either that some pressures
are not coercive and do not appreciably undermine voluntariness, or that
some pressures are coercive but are nevertheless not morally objectionable.
Is it always true that the presence of any kind of pressure put on one
person by another amounts to coercion that negates the voluntary nature
of consent, so that subsequent sexual activity is morally wrong?
17. Conceptual Analysis
Conceptual philosophy of sexuality is concerned to analyze and to clarify
concepts that are central in this area of philosophy: sexual activity,
sexual desire, sexual sensation, sexual perversion, and others. It also
attempts to define less abstract concepts, such as prostitution, pornography,
and rape. I would like to illustrate the conceptual philosophy of sexuality
by focusing on one particular concept, that of "sexual activity," and explore
in what ways it is related to another central concept, that of "sexual
pleasure." One lesson to be learned here is that conceptual philosophy
of sexuality can be just as difficult and contentious as normative philosophy
of sexuality, and that as a result firm conceptual conclusions are hard
to come by.
18. Sexual Activity vs. "Having Sex"
According to a notorious study published in 1999 in the Journal of
the American Medical Association ("Would You Say You 'Had Sex' If .
. . ?" by Stephanie Sanders and June Reinisch), a large percent of undergraduate
college students, about 60%, do not think that engaging in oral sex (fellatio
and cunnilingus) is "having sex." This finding is at first glance very
surprising, but it is not difficult to comprehend sympathetically. To be
sure, as philosophers we easily conclude that oral sex is a specific type
of sexual activity. But "sexual activity" is a technical concept, while
"having sex" is an ordinary language concept, which refers primarily to
heterosexual intercourse. Thus when Monica Lewinsky told her confidant
Linda Tripp that she did not "have sex" with William Jefferson Clinton,
she was not necessarily self-deceived, lying, or pulling a fast one. She
was merely relying on the ordinary language definition or criterion of
"having sex," which is not identical to the philosopher's concept of "sexual
activity," does not always include oral sex, and usually requires genital
intercourse.
Another conclusion might be drawn from the JAMA survey. If we
assume that heterosexual coitus by and large, or in many cases, produces
more pleasure for the participants than does oral sex, or at least that
in heterosexual intercourse there is greater mutuality of sexual pleasure
than in one-directional oral sex, and this is why ordinary thought tends
to discount the ontological significance of oral sex, then perhaps we can
use this to fashion a philosophical account of "sexual activity" that is
at once consistent with ordinary thought.
19. Sexual Activity and Sexual Pleasure
In common thought, whether a sexual act is nonmorally good or bad is
often associated with whether it is judged to be a sexual act at all. Sometimes
we derive little or no pleasure from a sexual act (say, we are primarily
giving pleasure to another person, or we are even selling it to the other
person), and we think that even though the other person had a sexual experience,
we didn't. Or the other person did try to provide us with sexual pleasure
but failed miserably, whether from ignorance of technique or sheer sexual
crudity. In such a case it would not be implausible to say that we did
not undergo a sexual experience and so did not engage in a sexual act.
If Ms. Lewinsky's performing oral sex on President Clinton was done only
for his sake, for his sexual pleasure, and she did it out of consideration
for his needs and not hers, then perhaps she did not herself, after all,
engage in a sexual act.
Robert Gray is one philosopher who has taken up this line of ordinary
thought and has argued that "sexual activity" should be analyzed in terms
of the production of sexual pleasure. He asserts that "any activity might
become a sexual activity" if sexual pleasure is derived from it, and "no
activity is a sexual activity unless sexual pleasure is derived from it"
("Sex and Sexual Perversion," p. 61). Perhaps Gray is right, since we tend
to think that holding hands is a sexual activity when sexual pleasure is
produced by doing so, but otherwise holding hands is not very sexual. A
handshake is normally not a sexual act, and usually does not yield sexual
pleasure; but two lovers caressing each other's fingers is both a sexual
act and produces sexual pleasure for them.
There is another reason for taking seriously the idea that sexual activities
are exactly those that produce sexual pleasure. What is it about a sexually
perverted activity that makes it sexual? The act is unnatural, we
might say, because it has no connection with one common purpose of sexual
activity, that is, procreation. But the only thing that would seem to make
the act a sexual perversion is that it does, on a fairly reliable
basis, nonetheless produce sexual pleasure. Undergarment fetishism is a
sexual perversion, and not merely, say, a "fabric" perversion, because
it involves sexual pleasure. Similarly, what is it about homosexual sexual
activities that makes them sexual? All such acts are nonprocreative, yet
they share something very important in common with procreative heterosexual
activities: they produce sexual pleasure, and the same sort of sexual pleasure.
Sexual Activity Without Pleasure
Suppose I were to ask you, "How many sexual partners have you had during
the last five years"? If you were on your toes, you would ask me, before
answering, "What counts as a sexual partner?" (Maybe you are suspicious
of my question because you had read Greta Christina's essay on this topic,
"Are We Having Sex Now or What?") At this point I should give you an adequate
analysis of "sexual activity," and tell you to count anyone with whom you
engaged in sexual activity according to this definition. What I should
definitely not do is to tell you to count only those people with
whom you had a pleasing or satisfactory sexual experience, forgetting about,
and hence not counting, those partners with whom you had nonmorally bad
sex. But if we accept Gray's analysis of sexual activity, that sexual acts
are exactly those and only those that produce sexual pleasure, I should
of course urge you not to count, over those five years, anyone with whom
you had a nonmorally bad sexual experience. You will end up reporting to
me fewer sexual partners than you in fact had. Maybe that will make you
feel better.
The general point is this. If "sexual activity" is logically dependent
on "sexual pleasure," if sexual pleasure is thereby the criterion of sexual
activity itself, then sexual pleasure cannot be the gauge of the nonmoral
quality of sexual activities. That is, this analysis of "sexual activity"
in terms of "sexual pleasure" conflates what it is for an act to be a sexual
activity with what it is for an act to be a nonmorally good sexual activity.
On such an analysis, procreative sexual activities, when the penis is placed
into the vagina, would be sexual activities only when they produce sexual
pleasure, and not when they are as sensually boring as a handshake. Further,
the victim of a rape, who has not experienced nonmorally good sex, cannot
claim that he or she was forced to engage in sexual activity, even
if the act compelled on him or her was intercourse or fellatio.
I would prefer to say that the couple who have lost sexual interest
in each other, and who engage in routine sexual activities from which they
derive no pleasure, are still performing a sexual act. But we are forbidden,
by Gray's proposed analysis, from saying that they engage in nonmorally
bad sexual activity, for on his view they have not engaged in any sexual
activity at all. Rather, we could say at most that they tried to engage
in sexual activity but failed to do so. It may be a sad fact about our
sexual world that we can engage in sexual activity and not derive any or
much pleasure from it, but that fact should not give us reason for refusing
to call these unsatisfactory events "sexual."
20. References and Suggested Readings
Aquinas, St. Thomas. Summa Theologiae. Cambridge, Eng.: Blackfriars,
1964-76.
Augustine, St. (Aurelius). On Marriage and Concupiscence, in
The
Works of Aurelius Augustine, Bishop of Hippo, vol. 12, ed. Marcus Dods.
Edinburgh, Scot.: T. & T. Clark, 1874.
Baker, Robert, Kathleen Wininger, and Frederick Elliston, eds. Philosophy
and Sex, 3rd edition. Amherst, N.Y.: Prometheus, 1998.
Baumrin, Bernard. "Sexual Immorality Delineated," in Robert Baker and
Frederick Elliston, eds.,
Philosophy and Sex, 2nd edition. Buffalo,
N.Y.: Prometheus, 1984, pp. 300-11.
Bloom, Allan. Love and Friendship. New York: Simon and Schuster,
1993.
Christina, Greta. "Are We Having Sex Now or What?" in Alan Soble, ed.,
The
Philosophy of Sex, 3rd edition. Lanham, Md.: Rowman and Littlefield,
1997, pp. 3-8.
Finnis, John. "Law, Morality, and 'Sexual Orientation'," Notre Dame
Law Review 69:5 (1994), pp. 1049-76.
Finnis, John and Martha Nussbaum. "Is Homosexual Conduct Wrong? A Philosophical
Exchange," in Alan Soble, ed., The Philosophy of Sex, 3rd edition.
Lanham, Md.: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997, pp. 89-94.
Gray, Robert. "Sex and Sexual Perversion," in Alan Soble, ed., The
Philosophy of Sex, 3rd edition. Lanham, Md.: Rowman and Littlefield,
1997, pp. 57-66.
Grisez, Germain. The Way of the Lord Jesus. Quincy, Ill.: Franciscan
Press, 1993.
Gudorf, Christine. Sex, Body, and Pleasure: Reconstructing Christian
Sexual Ethics. Cleveland, Ohio: Pilgrim Press, 1994.
Hampton, Jean. "Defining Wrong and Defining Rape," in Keith Burgess-Jackson,
ed., A Most Detestable Crime: New Philosophical Essays on Rape.
New York: Oxford University Press, 1999, pp. 118-56.
Held, Virginia. "Coercion and Coercive Offers," in J. Roland Pennock
and John W. Chapman, eds., Coercion: Nomos VIX. Chicago, Ill.: Aldine,
1972, pp. 49-62.
Jung, Patricia, and Ralph Smith. Heterosexism: An Ethical Challenge.
Albany, N.Y.: State University of New York Press, 1993.
Kant, Immanuel. Lectures on Ethics. Translated by Louis Infield.
New York: Harper and Row, 1963.
-----. The Metaphysics of Morals . Translated by Mary Gregor.
Cambridge, Eng.: Cambridge University Press, 1996.
Lewis, C. S. The Four Loves. New York: Harcourt Brace Jovanovich,
1960.
Mappes, Thomas. "Sexual Morality and the Concept of Using Another Person,"
in Thomas Mappes and Jane Zembaty, eds., Social Ethics, 4th edition.
New York: McGraw-Hill, 1992, pp. 203-26.
Mayo, David. "An Obligation to Warn of HIV Infection?" in Alan Soble,
ed., Sex, Love and Friendship. Amsterdam. Hol.: Editions Rodopi,
1997, pp. 447-53.
Muehlenhard, Charlene, and Jennifer Schrag. "Nonviolent Sexual Coercion,"
in A. Parrot and L. Bechhofer, eds, Acquaintance Rape. The Hidden Crime.
New York: John Wiley, 1991, pp. 115-28.
Murphy, Jeffrie. "Some Ruminations on Women, Violence, and the Criminal
Law," in Jules Coleman and Allen Buchanan, eds., In Harm's Way: Essays
in Honor of Joel Feinberg. Cambridge, Eng.: Cambridge University Press,
1994, pp. 209-30.
Nagel, Thomas. "Sexual Perversion," in Alan Soble, ed., The Philosophy
of Sex, 3st edition. Lanham, Md.: Rowman and Littlefield, 1997, pp.
9-20.
O'Neill, Onora. "Between Consenting Adults," Philosophy and Public
Affairs 14:3 (1985), pp. 252-77.
Plato. Symposium. Translated by Michael Joyce, in E. Hamilton
and H. Cairns, eds., The Collected Dialogues of Plato. Princeton,
N.J.: Princeton University Press, 1961, pp. 526-74.
Posner, Richard. Sex and Reason. Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University
Press, 1992.
Sanders, Stephanie, and June Reinisch. "Would You Say You 'Had Sex'
If . . . ?" Journal of the American Medical Association 281:3 (January
20, 1999), pp. 275-77.
Scruton, Roger. Sexual Desire: A Moral Philosophy of the Erotic.
New York: Free Press, 1986.
Singer, Irving. The Nature of Love, vol. 2: Courtly and Romantic.
Chicago, Ill.: University of Chicago Press, 1984.
Soble, Alan. "Antioch's 'Sexual Offense Policy': A Philosophical Exploration,"
Journal
of Social Philosophy 28:1 (1997), pp. 22-36.
-----. The Philosophy of Sex and Love: An Introduction. St. Paul,
Minn.: Paragon House, 1998.
-----. Sexual Investigations. New York: New York University Press,1996.
-----, ed. Eros, Agape and Philia. New York: Paragon House, 1989.
-----, ed. The Philosophy of Sex, 3rd edition. Lanham, Md.: Rowman
and Littlefield, 1997.
-----, ed. Sex, Love and Friendship. Amsterdam, Hol.: Editions
Rodopi, 1996.
Solomon, Robert, and Kathleen Higgins, eds. The Philosophy of (Erotic)
Love. Lawrence. Kan.: University Press of Kansas, 1991.
Stewart, Robert M., ed. Philosophical Perspectives on Sex and Love.
New York: Oxford University Press, 1995.
Vannoy, Russell. Sex Without Love: A Philosophical Exploration.
Buffalo, N.Y.: Prometheus, 1980.
Verene, Donald, ed. Sexual Love and Western Morality, 2nd edition.
Boston, Mass.: Jones and Bartlett, 1995.
Wertheimer, Alan. "Consent and Sexual Relations," Legal Theory
2:2 (1996), pp. 89-112.
Wojtyla, Karol [Pope John Paul II]. Love and Responsibility.
New York: Farrar, Straus and Giroux, 1981.
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