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Theophrastus was a Greek philosopher of the Peripatetic school,
and immediate successor of
Aristotle
in leadership of the Lyceum. He was
a native of Eresus in Lesbos, and studied
philosophy at Athens, first under Plato and afterwards under Aristotle. He
became the favorite
pupil of Aristotle,
who named Theophrastus his successor, and bequeathed to him his
library and
manuscripts of his own writings. Theophrastus sustained the
Aristotelian character of the Lyceum.
He is said to have had 2,000 disciples, among them the comic poet
Menander. He was esteemed by
the kings Philippus, Cassander, and Ptolemy. He was tried for
impiety, but acquitted by the
Athenian jury. He died in 287 BCE, having presided over the Lyceum
about thirty-five years.
His age is sometimes put at 85, and 107 by others. He is said to have
closed his life with the
complaint about the short duration of human life, that it ended just
when the insight into its
problems was beginning.
Although Theophrastus generally followed Aristotle's
lead in philosophy, he was no mere slavish imitator, and he continued
important empirical and philosophical investigations of his own. Very
little of his work survives, but he seems in general to have
emphasized the empiricist side of Aristotle's
thought and downplayed remaining Platonist elements, a trend that was
further continued by Theophrastus' successor as head of the Lyceum, Strato.
Theophrastus criticized some of Aristotle's arguments for the
existence of a Prime Mover, and he expressed dissatisfaction with
Aristotle's universal application of teleological (that is,
goal-directed) explanations. Theophrastus also composed a large
compendium of the doctrines of previous philosophers, which itself is
lost, but which probably formed the basis for much of the later
doxography which is our main source of information on the pre-Socratic
philosophers.
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