When we tolerate
something we deliberately refrain from negating that thing. More abstractly,
toleration can be understood as a political practice aiming at neutrality,
objectivity, or fairness on the part of political agents. These ideas are
related in that the goal of political neutrality is deliberate restraint of the
power that political authorities have to negate the life activities of citizens
and subjects. Related to toleration is the virtue of tolerance, which can be
defined as a tendency toward toleration. Toleration is usually grounded upon
an assumption about the importance of the autonomy of individuals. This
assumption and the idea of toleration are central ideas in modern liberal
theory and practice. The present article will discuss toleration as found in
the works of John Locke, Baruch de Spinoza, Voltaire, Immanuel Kant, John
Stuart Mill, John Rawls and other contemporary philosophers.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Conceptual Analysis
The English words, 'tolerate',
'toleration', and ‘tolerance’ are derived from the Latin terms tolerare and
tolerantia, which imply enduring, suffering, bearing, and forbearance.
Ancient Greek terms, which may also have influenced philosophical thinking on
toleration, include: phoretos which means bearable, endurable, or phoreo,
literally 'to carry'; and anektikos meaning bearable, sufferable,
tolerable, from anexo, 'to hold up'.
Today, when we say that someone has
a 'high tolerance for pain,' we mean that he or she is able to endure pain.
This ordinary way of thinking is useful for understanding the idea of
toleration and the virtue of tolerance: it underscores the fact that toleration
is directed by an agent toward something perceived as negative. It would be
odd to say, for example, that someone has 'a high tolerance for pleasure'.
With this in mind, we can formulate
a general definition of toleration that involves three interrelated conditions.
When an agent tolerates
something:
(1) He holds a negative judgment about this thing;
(2) He has the power to negate this thing; and
(3) He deliberately refrains from negation.
The first condition requires a
negative judgment, which can be anything from disapproval to disgust. Judgment
here is meant to be a broad concept that can include emotions, dispositions,
tastes, and reasoned evaluations. This negative judgment inclines the agent
toward a negative action toward the thing in question. This broadly Stoic
conception of judgment is a common assumption in discussions of toleration.
Defenders of toleration assume that we can, to a certain extent, voluntarily
control the expression of our negative reactions by opposing them with
different, countervailing, judgments. Although judgments and emotions are both
thought to have motivating force, they can be resisted by some other judgment,
habit or virtue.
The entity toward which an agent
has a negative judgment can be an event, an object, or a person, although with
regard to tolerance as a moral and political disposition, the entity is usually
thought to be a person. Although we speak of tolerating pain, for example, the
moral and political emphasis is on tolerating some other person, a group of
people, or their activities.
The second condition states that
the agent has the power to negate the entity in question. Toleration is
concerned with resisting the temptation to actively negate the thing in
question. To distinguish toleration from cowardice or weakness of will the
agent must have some capacity to enact his negative judgment. Toleration
occurs when the agent could actively negate or destroy the person or object in
question, but chooses not to.
The word negate is used here in a
broad sense that allows for a variety of negative reactions. Negative actions
can include: expressions of condemnation, acts of avoidance, or violent
attacks. The continuum of negations is decidedly vague. It is not clear, for
example, whether condemnation and avoidance are negations of the same sort as
violent action. Despite the vagueness of the continuum of negative activities,
the focal point of the second criterion is the power to negate: toleration is
restraint of the power to negate.
The third condition states that the
agent deliberately refrains from exercising his power to negate. Tolerant
agents deliberately choose not to negate those things they view negatively.
The negative formulation, 'not negating,' is important because toleration is
not the same thing as positive evaluation, approbation, or approval.
Tolerant restraint of the negative
judgment is supposed to be free and deliberate: one refrains from negating the
thing because one has a reason not to negate it and is free to act. Good
reasons for toleration are plural. They include: respect for autonomy; a
general commitment to pacifism; concern for other virtues such as kindness and
generosity; pedagogical concerns; a desire for reciprocity; and a sense of
modesty about one's ability to judge the beliefs and actions of others. Each
of these provides us with a reason for thinking that it is good not to negate
the thing in question. As mentioned already, there also may be other
non-tolerant reasons for refraining from negation: fear, weakness of will,
profit motive, self-interest, arrogance, etc.
Although there are many reasons to
be tolerant, traditional discussions have emphasized respect for autonomy and
pedagogical concerns. Underlying both of these approaches is often a form of
self-conscious philosophical modesty that is linked to the value of respect for
autonomy. As John Stuart Mill and others have argued, individuals ought to be
left to pursue their own good in their own way in part because each individual
knows himself and his own needs and interests best. This view does, however,
leave us with a lingering problem as toleration can easily slip toward moral
skepticism and relativism. It is important to note then that toleration is a
positive value that is not based upon total moral skepticism. Proponents of
toleration think that toleration is good not because they are unsure of their
moral values but, rather, because toleration fits within a scheme of moral
values that includes values such as autonomy, peace, cooperation, and other values
that are thought to be good for human flourishing.
2. Historical Development
a. Early History
The spirit of tolerance is evident
in Socrates' dialogical method as a component of his search for truth.
Throughout the early Platonic dialogues, Socrates tolerantly allows his
interlocutors to pursue the truth wherever this pursuit might lead. And he
encourages his interlocutors to offer refutations so that the truth might be
revealed. Sometimes Socrates' tolerance can appear to go too far. The Euthyrphro
concludes, for example, with Socrates allowing Euthyphro to proceed
in the prosecution of a questionable court case. And Socrates' relationship
with Alcibiades, as discussed in the Symposium, shows Socrates as
perhaps too tolerant toward this reckless Athenian youth. In the Gorgias (at
458a) Socrates describes himself in terms that establish a link between
philosophical method and a form of toleration. Socrates says, "And what kind
of man am I? One of those who would gladly be refuted if anything I say is not
true, and would gladly refute another who says what is not true, but would be
no less happy to be refuted myself than to refute, for I consider that a
greater benefit, inasmuch as it is a greater boon to be delivered from the
worst of evils oneself than to deliver another." The pursuit of truth is
linked to an open mind, although of course this form of dialogical toleration
is supposed to lead to a unitary vision of the truth.
One can see a more developed form
of tolerance celebrated in the Stoicism of Epictetus (55-135 C.E.) and Marcus
Aurelius (121-180 C.E.). The Stoic idea is that we should focus on those
things we can control—our own opinions and behaviors—while ignoring those
things we cannot control, especially the opinions and behaviors of others. The
Stoic idea is linked to resignation and apathy, as is clear in the case of Epictetus,
whose social position—raised as a Roman slave—might explain his advice about
bearing and forbearing. Of course, the problem here is that slavish forbearance
is not the same as tolerance: it seems clear that tolerance properly requires
the power to negate, which the slave does not possess. With the Emperor Marcus
Aurelius, however, tolerance is seen as a virtue of power. Tolerance might be
linked to other virtues of power such as mercy and benevolence, as suggested,
for example by Seneca. However, it is important to note that the Stoic
approach to tolerance was not explicitly linked to a general idea about
political respect for autonomy and freedom of conscience, as it is in the
modern liberal tradition. Moreover, Roman political life was not nearly as
tolerant as modern political life. For example, although Marcus' Meditations
contain many passages invoking the spirit of tolerance, Marcus was
responsible for continuing the persecution of Christians.
Religious traditions provide
further historical background for the idea of toleration. For example, the
spirit of tolerance can be discovered in the Christian Gospel's message of
loving enemies, forgiving others, and refraining from judging others.
Christian tolerance is linked to other virtues such as charity and
self-sacrifice. And it seems to go beyond tolerance toward a self-abnegating
type of love and acceptance. Christ's command to "love your enemies" is one
example of this attempt to go beyond tolerance. It should be noted that other
religious traditions also contain resources for developing toleration. For
example, Buddhist compassion can be linked to the idea of toleration. Indeed,
in the third century B.C.E., the Buddhist emperor of India, Ashoka, called for
official religious toleration. Likewise, in the 16th Century C.E.,
the Islamic emperor Akhbar made a similar attempt at establishing religious
toleration on the Indian subcontinent.
Despite these antecedents,
toleration does not become a serious subject of philosophical and political
concern in Europe until the 16th and 17th Centuries. During the Renaissance
and Reformation of the 15th and 16th Centuries, humanists such as Erasmus
(1466-1536), De Las Casas (1484-1566), and Montaigne (1533-1592) asserted the
autonomy of human reason against the dogmatism of the Church. Although
religious authorities reacted with the formation of the Inquisition and the
Index of Forbidden Books, by the 17th Century philosophers were
seriously considering the question of toleration.
b. The 17th Century
Following the divisions created by
the Lutheran Reformation and the Counter-Reformation, Europe was decimated by
war and violence fomented in the name of religion, which culminated in the
Thirty Years War (1618-1648). Through events such as these scholars became
acutely aware of the destructive power of intolerance and sought to limit this
destructive force by re-examining the biblical roots of toleration and by re-considering
the relation between religious belief and political power. Additional
influences on the cultural landscape of Europe during this time include the
struggle to define sovereignty and to "purify" religion in Britain during the
British Civil Wars (1640-1660), as well as increased information about cultural
differences with the beginning of global exploration. Among the thinkers of
this period who defended tolerance were Milton (1608-1674), Bayle (1647-1706),
Spinoza (1634-1677), and Locke (1632-1704).
One of the worries of the
humanist thinkers of the Reformation was whether it was possible to have
infallible knowledge of the Divine Will such that one could justify the
persecution of heretics. This concern with human fallibility lies at the heart
of what will be described subsequently as "epistemological toleration." When
recognition of human fallibility is combined with critique of political and
ecclesiastical power, more robust forms of political toleration develop.
In this vein, Spinoza concluded his
Theological-Political Treatise (1670) with an argument for freedom of
thought. It is not surprising that Spinoza should have written this treatise,
for he was himself a product of a tolerant society: he was a Portuguese Jew
living in Holland. Indeed, the 17th Century saw the rise of
toleration in practice in certain parts of Europe, perhaps as a result of
increased trade and social mobility. Spinoza's argument for toleration focuses
on three claims: first, he claims that it is impossible for the state to
effectively curtail liberty of thought; second, he claims that liberty of
thought can in fact be allowed without detriment to state power; and finally,
Spinoza argues that political authority should focus on controlling actions and
not on restricting thought. This emphasis on the difference between thought
and action is crucial for subsequent discussions of toleration in Locke, Mill,
and Kant.
Somewhat different versions of
Spinoza's basic insights can be found in Locke’s famous Letter Concerning
Toleration (1689), an essay that was written during Locke's exile in Holland.
Locke's argument focuses specifically on the conflict between political
authority and religious belief. He articulates a view of toleration based on
the epistemological claim that it is impossible for the state to coerce genuine
religious belief. He argues that the state should refrain from interfering in
the religious beliefs of its subjects, except when these religious beliefs lead
to behaviors or attitudes that run counter to the security of the state. This
exception allows him to conclude that the state need not tolerate Catholics who
were loyal to a foreign authority or atheists whose lack of religious
conviction left them entirely untrustworthy.
c. The 18th Century
In the 18th Century,
discussion of toleration was tied to the problem of skepticism and to a more
sustained critique of absolutism in politics. Voltaire (1694-1778), who
expressed his admiration for the development of religious tolerance in England
in his Philosophical Letters (1734), was extremely worried about the
tendency of religion to become violent and intolerant. Moreover, he suffered
under the intolerant hands of the French authorities: he was thrown in jail for
his views and his books were censored and publicly burned. Religious tolerance
forms the theme of his Treatise on Tolerance (1763), which argues
vigorously for tolerance even though it retains a bias toward Christianity. A
concise summary of Voltaire's argument for tolerance can be found in the entry
on Tolerance in his Philosophical Dictionary (1764). Voltaire's claim
is that toleration follows from human frailty and error. Since none of us has
perfect knowledge, and since we are all weak, inconsistent, liable to
fickleness and error, we should pardon one another for our failings. Voltaire's
approach focuses on tolerance at the level of personal interaction and risks
slipping toward moral skepticism and relativism: like his contemporary David
Hume (1711-1777), Voltaire presented a skeptical challenge to orthodox belief.
Immanuel Kant (1724-1804), in
response to skeptics such as Voltaire and Hume, tried to avoid skepticism while
focusing on the limits of human knowledge and the limits of political power.
In his essay, "What is Enlightenment?" (1784), Kant argues for an enlightened
form of political power that would allow subjects to argue among themselves, so
long as they remained obedient to authority. This position is further
clarified by Kant's claim in Perpetual Peace (1795) that philosophers
should be allowed and encouraged to speak publicly. Kant's point in this later
essay is that public debate and discussion lead to the truth, and that kings
should have nothing to fear from the truth. Kant's views on religious
toleration are clarified in his Religion within the Limits of Reason Alone (1793).
Here Kant argues against religious intolerance by pointing out that although we
are certain of our moral duties, human beings do not have apodictic certainty
of God's commands. Thus a religious belief that demands a contravention of
morality (such as the burning of a heretic) can never be justified.
Bridging the gap between the Old
World and the New World, the writings of Thomas Paine (1737-1809) and Thomas
Jefferson (1743-1826) express a theory of toleration that is tied directly to
political practice. Paine's and Jefferson’s ideas followed Locke’s. Not only
were they critical of unrestrained political power but they were also committed
to an ecumenical approach to religious belief known as deism. Paine makes it
clear in his Rights of Man (1791) that toleration for religious
diversity is essential because political and ecclesiastical authorities do not
have the capacity to adjudicate matters of conscience. "Mind thine own
concerns. If he believes not as thou believest, it is a proof that thou believest
not as he believeth, and there is no earthly power can determine between you."
At the end of the 18th Century, we
see tolerant ideas embodied in practice in the U.S. Constitution's Bill of
Rights—the first 10 Amendments to the Constitution (ratified in 1791).
Collectively these amendments serve to restrain political power. Specifically,
the First Amendment states that there can be no law, which prohibits freedom of
religion, freedom of speech, freedom of the press, freedom of assembly, and
freedom to petition to the government. Subsequent developments in U.S.
Constitutional law have led to a tradition of respect for citizens' freedom of
thought, speech, and action.
d. The 19th Century
In the 19th Century, the idea of
toleration was developed further in line with the liberal, enlightenment idea
that moral autonomy is essential to human flourishing. The most famous
argument for toleration in the 19th Century was made by John Stuart
Mill in On Liberty (1859). Mill argues here that the only proper limit
of liberty is harm: one is entitled to be as free as possible, except where
one's liberty poses a threat to the well-being of someone else: "the only
purpose for which power can rightfully be exercised over any member of a
civilized community, against his will, is to prevent harm to others."
Mill expands the notion of privacy
that was implicit in Locke and Kant to argue that political power should have
no authority to regulate those activities and interests of individuals that are
purely private and have no secondary effects on others. Mill also vigorously
argues that freedom of thought is essential for the development of knowledge.
Mill's general approach is utilitarian: he claims that individuals will be
happier if their private differences are tolerated and that society in general
will be better off if individuals are left to pursue their own good in their
own way.
In the 19th Century and into the
early 20th Century, religious toleration was also a subject of consideration
for thinkers such as Soren Kierkegaard (1813-1855), Ralph Waldo Emerson
(1803-1882), and William James (1842-1910), who emphasized the subjective
nature of religious faith. For example, in his Varieties of Religious
Experience (1902), James argued that religious experience was diverse and
not subject to a definitive interpretation. Although this fits with James's
larger metaphysical commitment to pluralism, his point is that religious
commitment is personal—a matter of what he calls in another essay, "the will to
believe." It is up to each individual to decide for himself what he will
believe: if we properly understand the nature of religious belief, we should
respect the religious liberty of others and learn to tolerate our differences.
e. The 20th Century
In the 20th Century, toleration has
become an important component of what is now known as liberal theory. The
bloody history of the 20th Century has led many to believe that toleration is
needed to end political and religious violence. Toleration has been defended
by liberal philosophers and political theorists such as John Dewey, Isaiah Berlin,
Karl Popper, Michael Walzer, Ronald Dworkin, and John Rawls. It has been
criticized by Herbert Marcuse and others such as Iris Young who worry that
toleration and its ideal of state neutrality is merely another hegemonic
Western ideology. Toleration has been the explicit subject of many recent
works in political philosophy by Susan Mendus, John Horton, Preston King, and
Bernard Williams. Much of the current discussion focuses on responding to John
Rawls, whose theory of "political liberalism" conceives of toleration as a
pragmatic response to the fact of diversity (see "Political Toleration"
below). A recurring question in the current debate is whether there can be a
more substantive commitment to toleration that does not lead to the paradoxical
consequence that the tolerant must tolerate those who are intolerant.
Further recent discussion, by David
Heyd, Glenn Newey, and others, has attempted to re-establish the link between
tolerance and virtue. These writers wonder whether tolerance is in fact a
virtue and if so, what sort of a virtue it is. A concern for racial equality,
gender neutrality, an end of prejudice, respect for cultural and ethnic
difference, and a general commitment to multiculturalism has fueled ongoing
debates about the nature of toleration in our age of globalization and
homogenization. Finally, in the U.S., First Amendment Law has developed to
allow for a broad idea of freedom of speech, freedom of the press, and freedom
of religion. And under the influence of an interpretation of the equal
protection clause of the 14th Amendment, mechanisms to ensure equality have
given support to those minority groups who were once the victims of political
intolerance.
3. Epistemological Toleration
An epistemological argument for
toleration can be traced to Socrates. However, this ideal becomes explicit in
the thinking of Milton, Locke, and Mill. The epistemological claim is that one
should tolerate the opinions and beliefs of the other because it is either
impossible to coerce belief or because such coercion is not the most useful
pedagogical approach. This idea can be developed into a claim about the
importance of diversity, dialogue, and debate for the establishment of truth.
Finally, this approach might lead to a form of relativism or skepticism that
puts the idea of toleration itself at risk.
a. Socrates
Socratic tolerance is discovered if
we take seriously Socrates' claims to ignorance. Socratic ignorance is linked
to virtues, such as sophrosyne (self-control), modesty and tolerance.
These virtues are essential components in the formation of the philosophical
community and the pursuit of philosophical truth. Throughout Plato's
dialogues, Socrates restrains himself deliberately—he modestly claims ignorance
and allows others to develop their own positions and make their own
mistakes—out of recognition that this is the best, perhaps the only, way to
proceed in the communal pursuit of truth. Socrates' main goal is to discover
the truth through open-minded debate. But there would be no dialogue and
indeed no education without tolerance. Socrates' commitment to tolerance is
part of his epistemological faith in the autonomy of reason. We each must
discover the truth for ourselves by way of disciplined, modest, and tolerant
dialogue.
b. Milton
Centuries later, John Milton's Areopagitica
(1644) offers a similar defense of the truth. Milton vigorously defended
freedom of speech in response to a censorship decree of the English
parliament. His argument relies upon the epistemological claim that open
dialogue supported by a tolerant government fosters the development of truth. Milton's
basic assumption is that the truth is able to defend itself in a free debate.
"Let truth and falsehood grapple; who ever knew truth put to the worse, in a
free and open encounter?" Milton further argues that outward conformity to
orthodoxy is not the same as genuine belief.
c. Locke
These ideas were developed further
by Locke in his Letter Concerning Toleration. Locke argues that the
civil and ecclesiastical authorities ought to tolerate diversity of belief
because one cannot force another human being to have faith. In a claim that is
reminiscent of Milton, Locke claims "the truth certainly would do well enough
if she were left to shift for herself… She is not taught by laws, nor has she
any need of force to procure her entrance into the minds of men." This is so
because the authority of judgment resides within the free individual. It is
impossible to force someone to believe something for external reasons. Rather,
truth must be arrived at and believed for internal reasons.
This epistemological claim is the
focal point of Jeremy Waldron's recent critique of Locke’s account. Waldron
claims that Locke's argument is weak because it relies upon the false
assumption that beliefs cannot be coerced. The point is that we often believe
things quite sincerely without any good reason whatsoever. Moreover, Waldron
argues that the epistemological argument is too weak to provide a moral
limitation on coercion. Even though coercion cannot produce genuine belief, an
intolerant regime may not be interested in producing genuine belief. It may
simply be interested in guaranteeing conformity. Waldron's point is important:
the epistemological critique is useful only if one is committed to the claim
that genuine belief in the truth is an important political or moral value. An
epistemological argument for toleration must claim not only that it is
impractical or impossible to impose belief upon others, but also that we ought
to value genuine commitment over mere conformity.
d. Mill
Mill's epistemological argument is
quite similar to Locke's, although Mill goes farther in advocating freedom of
speech as essential for the discovery of truth. Mill's epistemological
argument begins with the assumption that individuals know best what is good for
them. This claim runs counter to the traditional Platonic claim that often individuals
do not know what is in their own best interest. Mill supports his claim by
pointing out that the individual always has the best access to his/her own
interests and desires: others do not have access to the kinds of internal
evidence that would allow them to judge for the individual. It is important to
note that Mill does not equate this access problem with relativism. Indeed, in
his essay Utilitarianism (1863), he famously defends a hierarchy of
goods based on the fact that those who have experienced both "lower" and
"higher" goods will prefer the higher ones (e.g., “it is better to be Socrates
dissatisfied than a fool satisfied"). The epistemological point remains the
same here, however: it is up to the individual to judge for himself about what
is good for him.
Mill's general argument for freedom
of thought is based upon a recognition of human fallibility and on the need for
dialogue and debate. Mill's argument for freedom of thought in On Liberty contains
the following claims. (1) Silenced opinions may be true. To assume they are
not is to assume that we are infallible. (2) Even false opinions may contain
valid points of contention and parts of the truth. To know the whole of truth
we might have to weave together parts of truth from different sources. (3) To
claim to know the truth means that we are able to defend it against all
vigorous opposition. Thus we need to be able to hear and respond to false
opinions in order to know all of the arguments for a proposition. (4) Truth
that is not continuously and vigorously contested becomes mere superstition.
Such dogmatically held superstitions may thus crumble before even weak
opposition and will not be heartily believed or defended.
e. The Problem of Relativism
Like Socrates, Mill and Locke both arrive at the
notion of toleration from a non-relativistic understanding of belief and
truth. However, under the general rubric of epistemological toleration we
might also include the sort of toleration that follows from skepticism or
relativism. For the relativist or skeptic, since we cannot know the truth or
since all truths are relative, we ought to be tolerant of those who hold
different points of view. Contemporary American philosopher, Richard Rorty has
articulated an argument something like this. The problem with this approach is
the same problem with all sorts of skepticism and relativism: either the claim
self-referentially undermines itself or it provides us with no compelling
reason to believe it. If we are skeptical about knowledge, then we have no way
of knowing that toleration is good. Likewise, if truth is relative to a system
of thought, then the claim that toleration is required is itself merely a
relatively justified claim. The form of epistemological toleration espoused by
Mill, at least, attempts to avoid these problems by appealing to a form of fallibilism
that is not completely skeptical or relativistic. Mill's point is not that
there is no truth but, rather, that toleration is required for us to come to
know the truth.
4. Moral Toleration
We have seen that epistemological
concerns can lead us to toleration. Moral concerns can also bring us to
toleration. Tolerance as a moral virtue might be linked to other moral virtues
such as modesty and self-control. However, the most common moral value that is
thought to ground toleration is a concern for autonomy. We ought to refrain
from negating the other when concern for the other's autonomy provides us with
a good reason not to act. Toleration that follows from a commitment to autonomy
should not be confused with moral relativism. Moral relativism holds that
values are relative to culture or context. A commitment to autonomy, in
opposition to this, holds that autonomy is good in a non-relative sense. A
commitment to autonomy might require that I allow the other to do something
that I find abhorrent, not because I believe that values are relative, but
because I believe that autonomy is so important that it requires me to refrain
from negating the autonomous action of the other. Of course, there are limits
here. Autonomous action that violates the autonomy of another cannot be
tolerated.
Mill's account of the principle of
liberty is helpful for understanding this idea of toleration. Mill tells us
that we should be given as much liberty as possible, as long as our liberty
does not harm others. This is in fact a recipe for toleration. Mill's argument
follows from certain basic assumptions about individuals.
1. Each individual has a will of his own.
2. Each individual is better off when not compelled to "do better."
3. Each individual knows best what is good for him.
4. Each individual is motivated to attain his own good and to avoid actions that are contrary to his self-interest.
5. Self-regarding thought and activity can be distinguished from its effects upon others.
Some of these claims (for example,
#3) are linked to epistemological toleration. However, the point here is not
only that individuals know what is in their own self-interest but also that it
is good for individuals to be able to pursue their own good in their own way.
Such an approach makes several important metaphysical assumptions about the
nature of human being: that autonomy is possible and important, that
individuals do know their own good, that there is a distinction between
self-regarding action and actions that effects others. Moral toleration
follows from these sorts of claims about human being.
a. The Paradox of Toleration
Of course, toleration and respect for autonomy
are not simple ideas. Much has been made about the so-called "paradox of
toleration": the fact that toleration seems to ask us to tolerate those things
we find intolerable. Toleration does require that we refrain from enacting the
negative consequences of our negative judgments. This becomes paradoxical when
we find ourselves confronting persons, attitudes, or behaviors, which we
vigorously reject: we then must, paradoxically, tolerate that which we find
intolerable. This becomes especially difficult when the other who is to be
tolerated expresses views or activities that are themselves intolerant.
One way of resolving this paradox
is to recognize that there is a distinction between first-order judgments and
second-order moral commitments. First-order judgments include emotional
reactions and other practical judgments that focus on concrete and particular
attitudes and behaviors. Second-order moral commitments include more
complicated judgments that aim beyond emotion and particularity toward rational
universal principles. With regard to the paradox of toleration there is a
conflict between a first-order reaction against something and a second-order
commitment to the principle of respecting autonomy or to the virtues of modesty
or self-control. The paradox is resolved by recognizing that this second-order
commitment trumps the first-order reaction: principle is supposed to outweigh
emotion. Thus we might have good reasons (based upon our second-order
commitments) to refrain from following through on the normal consequences of
negative first-order judgments. However, when there is a genuine conflict of
second-order commitments, i.e., when the tolerant commitment to autonomy runs
up against an intolerant rejection of autonomy, then there is no need to
tolerate. In other words the paradox is resolved when we realize that
toleration is not a commitment to relativism but, rather, that it is a
commitment to the value of autonomy and to the distinction between first-order
judgments and second-order moral commitments.
b. Tolerance vs. Indifference
Of course, the ideal of toleration
is a difficult one to enact. This difficulty is related to the tension between
first-order reactions and second-order commitments that is found within the
spiritual economy of an individual. This is why the idea of tolerance as a
virtue is important. Virtues are tendencies or habits toward good action. In
the case of the virtue of tolerance, the tendency is toward respect for the
autonomy of others and toward the self-discipline necessary for deliberately
restraining first-order reactions. Virtues are usually thought to be
integrated into a system of virtues. Tolerance is no exception. The virtue of
tolerance is closely related to other virtues such as self-control, modesty,
generosity, kindness, mercy, and forgiveness. One must be careful, however,
not to conclude that the virtue of tolerance is a tendency toward indifference
or apathy. Tolerance demands that we moderate and control our passions in
light of some larger good, whether that good be respect for autonomy or an
interest in self-control; tolerance does not demand that we completely refrain
from judging the other.
Moral toleration asks us to
restrain some of our most powerful first-order reactions: negative reactions to
persons, attitudes, and behaviors which we find repugnant. Without the tension
between first-order reactions and second-order commitment, toleration is merely
indifference. Indifference usually indicates a failure at the level of
first-order judgment: when we are indifferent, we do not have any reaction,
negative or positive, to the other. Such a state of indifference is not
virtuous. Indeed, it would be vicious and wrong not to react strongly against
injustice or violations of autonomy.
We often confuse indifference with
toleration. However, indifference is flawed as a human response for two
reasons. First, it rejects the truth of first-order reactions. First-order
reactions should not be ignored. Our emotional responses are important ways in
which we connect with the world around us. When we react negatively to
something, this emotional reaction provides important information about the
world and ourselves. Tolerance does not ask us to deaden our emotional
responses to others; rather it asks us to restrain the negative consequences of
our negative emotional responses out of deference to a more universal set of
commitments. Second, indifference is often closely related to general
skepticism about moral judgment. The moral skeptic claims that no set of
values is true. From this perspective, both first-order reactions and
second-order commitments are mere tastes or preferences without any final moral
significance. From this skepticism, indifference with regard to any moral
evaluation is cultivated because all of our moral values are thought to be
equally groundless. The difficulty here is that moral skepticism cannot lead
to the conclusion that it is good to be tolerant, since the skeptic holds that
no moral value can be justified. If we claim that toleration is good and that
tolerance is a virtue, toleration cannot be the same thing as indifference.
This distinction between tolerance
and indifference is important for explaining the spiritual disruption that
occurs when we strive to become tolerant. Indeed, the difficulty of toleration
can be understood in terms of the difficulty of the middle path between
indifference and dogmatism. Indifference is easy and satisfying because it
sets us free, as it were, from the difficult human task of judging. Likewise,
dogmatism is easy and satisfying because it follows from a seamless synthesis
of first-order reaction and second-order commitment. Toleration is the middle
path in which there is a conflict between first-order reaction and second-order
commitment. Toleration thus requires self-consciousness and self-control in
order to coordinate conflicting parts of the spiritual economy. The discipline
required for toleration is part of any idea of education: we must learn to
distance ourselves from first-order reactions in order to move toward universal
principles. First-order reactions are often wrong or incomplete, as are
immediate sense perceptions. And yet, education does not ask us to give up on
first-order reactions or sense perceptions. Rather, it asks us to be
disciplined and self-critical, so that we might control first-order reactions
in order to uphold more important principles.
5. Political Toleration
Moral toleration emphasizes a moral
commitment to the value of autonomy. Although it is linked, by Mill, for
example to a political idea about restraint of state power, moral toleration is
ultimately concerned with clarifying the second-order principle that is
supposed to lead to toleration.
While moral toleration is about
relations between agents, political toleration is about restraint of political
power. The modern liberal state is usually not thought to be a moral agent.
Rather, the state is supposed to be something like a third party referee: it is
not thought to be one of the parties engaged directly in the process of judgment
and negation. Political toleration is thus an ideal that holds that the
political referee should be impartial and unbiased. The term toleration has
been used, since Locke, in this political context to describe a principle of
state neutrality. The connection between moral and political toleration can be
understood in terms of the history of the pre-modern era when the state was an
agent—a monarch, for example—who had particular judgments and the power to
negate. As the idea of the state has evolved since the 17th Century toward
liberal democratic notions of self-government and civil rights, the notion of
political toleration has evolved to mean something like state indifference.
Political toleration is now thought to entail respect for privacy, separation
of church and state, and a general respect for human rights.
a. John Rawls
In the 20th Century, the idea of
political toleration has developed, especially under the influence of John
Rawls (1921-2002) and his books, Theory of Justice (1971) and Political
Liberalism (1995). Rawls' approach attempts to be neutral about moral
values in order to establish political principles of toleration. Rawls argues
for toleration in a pragmatic fashion as that which works best to achieve
political unity and an idea of justice among diverse individuals. Although the
idea of political toleration has been most vigorously defended by Rawls, it
also forms the basis of other pragmatic and political accounts of toleration,
including those of John Dewey, Jürgen Habermas, Michael Walzer, and Richard Rorty.
The danger with this approach is that it tends toward relativism by
self-consciously limiting itself from articulating a metaphysical defense of
autonomy and toleration. The difficulty is that the idea of state neutrality
can become paradoxical: a state that is neutral about everything will undermine
its own existence.
The idea of political toleration
begins from the claim that diverse individuals will come to tolerate one
another by developing what Rawls calls "overlapping consensus": individuals and
groups with diverse metaphysical views or "comprehensive schemes" will find
reasons to agree about certain principles of justice that will include
principles of toleration. This is in part an empirical or historical argument
about the way in which diverse individuals or groups eventually resolve their
differences by way of a pragmatic commitment to toleration as a modus vivendi,
or means of life. One could trace this idea back to Hobbes' idea of the social
contract as a peace treaty. Diverse individuals in the state of nature will,
according to Hobbes's argument in The Leviathan (1651), engage in the
war of all against all. This war is ultimately unsatisfying and so individuals
relinquish their warring power and create the social contract. The problem is
that this pragmatic account leaves us without a metaphysical justification of
the principles of toleration. Rather it comes to toleration from the pragmatic
assumption that diverse individuals motivated by self-interest will agree to
support the neutral state, which is then supposed to act as a referee in their
disputes. Of course, Hobbes' account of the absolute sovereignty of the
Leviathan calls into question the idea that a social contract view will always
lead to a tolerant liberal state.
Rawls' idea of "justice as fairness" attempts to
set limits to political power without trying to evaluate the relative merits of
different conceptions of the good. Rawls clarifies his approach by insisting
that the principles of justice are political and not moral principles. They are
based upon what he calls "reasonable pluralism." What he means by this is that
the principles of toleration will be agreed to by individuals from diverse
perspectives because these principles will appear reasonable to each individual
despite their differences. The idea of toleration results from a political
consensus that is developed by way of the ideal social contract that Rawls
describes at length in Theory of Justice. Like Mill, Rawls theory of
justice claims that the first principle of justice is the liberty principle:
"Each person has an equal right to a fully adequate scheme of equal basic
liberties which is compatible with a similar scheme of liberties for all."
These basic civil liberties form the basis for political toleration.
b. Risks and Benefits
Political liberalism focuses on the
problem of diversity without appealing to a larger metaphysical theory. This
problem is exacerbated when political liberalism takes up the question of
international human rights and the problem of intolerant groups or individual
who demand to be tolerated. Political liberalism aims at the creation of a
global human rights regime that is supposed to support politically tolerant
states and that is sensitive to the issue of group rights. From the
perspective of political liberalism, human rights—basic defenses against the
intolerant expansion of state power—are thought to be the result of overlapping
political consensus. From this perspective, human rights, such as the right to
autonomy that forms the basis of moral toleration, are thought to be, not
metaphysical givens, but the conditions for the possibility of political
consensus building.
The idea of a developing
"overlapping consensus" in international affairs was articulated in the 1950's
by Jacques Maritain and was developed in practice by international agencies
such as the United Nations. More recently Jürgen Habermas' approach links
principles of toleration to the very nature of political argument: for us to
have a political argument, we must agree to certain principles of fair
argumentation. The difficultly here is that diversity is even more of a
problem on the international scene, where discussions of human rights are
essential. At the local or national level, the point of liberalism is that the
neutral state ought not interfere or comment on the quality of individual lives
unless the lives and actions of private individuals become a menace to the
rights and privacy of other individuals. Internationally, Rawls follows Kant
in specifying "the Law of Peoples" that is supposed to maintain order among
diverse mutually tolerant nations.
A further complication arises at the level of
group rights (both within national and international politics), where groups
and their members claim the right to be tolerated by larger political
organizations. Here the idea of tolerating the practices and identities of
groups may paradoxically result in toleration for intolerant groups. This is
the case for example, when tolerant governments consider groups who advocate
violence, discrimination, and other intolerant practices. Such groups can be
intolerant toward their own members, toward the tolerant liberal societies in
which they subside, and indeed toward those international organizations who
support toleration throughout the globe.
The risk of political liberalism is
that it hovers uneasily between pluralism and relativism, while seeking to
avoid metaphysical dogmatism or political imperialism. The basic pluralism of
political liberalism supports political toleration by recognizing that
conflicting comprehensive doctrines can each be justified as reasonable
according to the standards internal to them. This leaves us with the conflicts
of reasonable pluralism: each of the conflicting comprehensive doctrines is
reasonable on its own terms and to the extent that it recognizes the
reasonableness of other comprehensive doctrines. Thus, for Rawls, cooperation
between reasonable comprehensive doctrines is a practical political task. The
state should refrain from entering into a discussion of which comprehensive
doctrine is better morally, epistemologically, or metaphysically quite simply
because such a discussion would be unjust for a neutral state confronted with
the fact of diversity. By defining his account of state neutrality as
political, Rawls wants to distance his account of reasonable pluralism from a
more robust form of philosophical skepticism. This is reminiscent of Locke's
approach to epistemological toleration: since we cannot in practice force
individuals to agree about moral or metaphysical truths, we should tolerate
diversity at the political level.
Rawls does, however, hold that
there is a best political arrangement, even if the truth about the best
political arrangement is arrived at by way of pragmatic concerns for what works
politically in light of the fact of diversity. And thus his idea of political
consensus tries to avoid the slide toward skepticism and relativism. It seems that
for political toleration, there is at least one non-relative value—that of
toleration and peaceful coexistence—even if this is merely pragmatically
justified by the concrete historical need for peaceful coexistence among those
who cannot arrive at consensus about their views of the good.
The approach of political
liberalism has appeared to succeed in practice. One could argue that the idea
of the neutral state and of political consensus about the need for toleration
has been gradually developing in Constitutional Law in the U.S. and in
international law by way of the U.N.'s Declaration of Human Rights. Article 26
of the U.N. Declaration states explicitly that education is a universal right
and that education should aim to "promote understanding, tolerance and
friendship among all nations, racial or religious groups." We are still far
from actualizing the idea of a tolerant international community. However, it
is fairly clear that in the last several decades the idea of political
toleration has succeeded in the United States and in other Western countries.
Despite this success, critics such
as Michael Sandel, in his Democracy's Discontent (1998), have argued
that the tolerant attitude of what he calls "the procedural republic" must be
grounded in a more comprehensive moral theory. Without such a ground, Sandel
worries that the tolerant neutral state will ultimately lose its connection
with the moral lives of individuals. Sandel claims in his arguments against
Rawls and against certain developments in Constitutional Law that the approach
of political liberalism cannot ultimately take account of the depth of
commitment that most individuals have to their own comprehensive doctrines.
Rawls admits that for his idea of overlapping consensus to work, he must assume
a weakening of private faith in comprehensive doctrines. The problem here is
that it argues for toleration by underestimating the power of those forms of
private faith that must be tolerated.
A further problem of the political
approach is that it struggles to define the nature of privacy. Moral
toleration claims that there are certain private activities which are only of
concern to the individual and that the state would be unjustified in
interfering with these private activities. A merely political approach to
toleration is however unable to draw the line dividing public and private in a
metaphysical fashion. Rather, the sphere of privacy is itself defined only as
a result of the process of building political consensus. Thus the worry is that
the principles of political liberalism are not clearly defined and that
toleration, as a mere modus vivendi, could be violated if the political
consensus were to shift. In other words, if there is no metaphysical basis for
a sphere of privacy, then it is not exactly clear what the politically grounded
idea of liberal toleration is supposed to tolerate.
6. References and Further Reading
Beiner,
Ronald. What's the Matter with Liberalism (Berkeley: University of
California Press, 1992).
Berlin,
Isaiah. "Two Concepts of Liberty" in Four Essays on Liberty (Oxford:
Oxford University Press, 1969).
Cook, John
W. Morality and Cultural Differences (Oxford: Oxford University Press,
1999).
Dworkin,
Ronald. Sovereign Virtue (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press,
2000).
Dworkin,
Ronald. Taking Rights Seriously (Cambridge: Harvard, 1977).
Fiala,
Andrew. "Toleration and Pragmatism" in Journal of Speculative Philosophy,
16: 2, (2002), 103-116.
Habermas, Jürgen.
Moral Consciousness and Communicative Action (Cambridge, Mass.: MIT
Press, 1990).
Heyd, David, ed.
Toleration: An Elusive Virtue (Princeton: Princeton University Press,
1996).
Horton, John
and Peter Nicholson, eds. Toleration: Philosophy and Practice (London: Ashgate
Publishing, 1992).
King, Preston.
Toleration (London: Frank Cass, 1998).
Kymlicka,
Will. Liberalism, Community, and Culture (Oxford: Clarendon Press,
1989).
Laursen, John
Christian. "Spinoza on Toleration" in Difference and Dissent: Theories of
Tolerance in Medieval and Early Modern Europe, edited by Nederman and Laursen
(Lanham, Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield, 1996).
Locke, John. Letter
Concerning Toleration in Steven M. Cahn ed. Classics of Modern Political
Theory (New York: Oxford University Press, 1997).
Mara, Gerald
M. "Socrates and Liberal Toleration" in Political Theory, 16:3 (1988).
Marcuse,
Herbert. "Repressive Tolerance" in Wolff, Moore, and Marcuse, eds., A
Critique of Pure Tolerance (Boston: Beacon Press, 1969).
Maritain,
Jacques. Man and the State (Chicago: University of Chicago Press,
1951).
Mendus, Susan
and David Edwards, eds. On Toleration (Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1987).
Mendus,
Susan. "Locke: Toleration, Morality, and Rationality" in John Horton and Susan
Mendus, eds., John Locke: A Letter Concerning Toleration in Focus (London:
Routledge, 1991).
Mendus,
Susan. Toleration and the Limits of Liberalism (Atlantic Highlands, NJ:
Humanities Press International, 1989).
Mill, John
Stuart. On Liberty and Other Essays (Oxford: Oxford World
Classics, 1998).
Milton,
John. Aereopogatica in Encyclopedia Britannica's Great Books of the
Western World, vol. 29 (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1991).
Newey, Glen.
Virtue, Reason, and Toleration (Edinburgh: University of Edinburgh
Press, 1999).
Oberdiek,
Hans. Tolerance: Between Forbearance and Acceptance (Lanham, MD: Rowman
and Littlefield, 2001).
Paine,
Thomas. The Complete Writings of Thomas Paine ed. by Philip Foner (New
York: The Citadel Press, 1945).
Popper, Karl.
The Open Society and its Enemies (Princeton: Princeton University Press,
1971).
Rawls, John.
A Theory of Justice (Cambridge, Mass.: Harvard University Press, 1971).
Rawls, John.
Justice as Fairness: A Restatement (Cambridge: Harvard University Press,
2001).
Rawls, John.
Political Liberalism (New York: Columbia University Press, 1995).
Rawls, John.
The Law of Peoples (Cambridge: Harvard University Press, 2001).
Razavi, Mehdi
Amin and David Ambuel, eds. Philosophy, Religion, and the Question of Intolerance
(Albany: State University of New York Press, 1997).
Ricoeur,
Paul, ed. Tolerance Between Intolerance and the Intolerable (an edition
of Diogenes, No. 176, Vol. 44/4, Winter 1996).
Rorty,
Richard. Contingency, Irony, Solidarity (Cambridge: Cambridge
University Press, 1989).
Rosenthal,
Michael A. "Tolerance as a Virtue in Spinoza's Ethics" in Journal of the
History of Philosophy 39:4 (2001), 535-557.
Sandel,
Michael. Democracy's Discontent (Cambridge: Harvard, 1998).
Sandel,
Michael. Liberalism and the Limits of Justice (Cambridge: Cambridge
University Press, 1982).
Sen, Amartya.
"Human Rights and Asian Values" in The New Republic 217: 2-3 (1997),
33-40.
Spinoza,
Baruch. Theological-Political Treatise and Political Treatise (New
York: Dover Publications, 1951).
Tan, Kok-Chor.
Toleration, Diversity, and Global Justice (University Park, PA: Pennsylvania
State University Press, 2000).
Voltaire. Philosophical
Dictionary (Cleveland: World Publishing Co., 1943).
Waldron,
Jeremy. "Locke: Toleration and the Rationality of Persecution" in John Horton
and Susan Mendus eds., John Locke: A Letter Concerning Toleration in Focus (London:
Routledge, 1991).
Walzer,
Michael. On Toleration (New Haven: Yale University Press, 1997).
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