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Prosentential theorists claim that sentences such as "That's true"
are prosentences that function analogously to their better
known cousins--pronouns. For example, just as we might use the
pronoun 'he' in place of 'James' to transform "James went to the
supermarket" into "He went to the supermarket," so we might use the
prosentence-forming operator 'is true' to transform "Snow is white"
into "'Snow is white' is true." According to the prosentential theory
of truth, whenever a referring expression (e.g., a definite
description or a quote-name) is joined to the truth predicate, the
resulting statement contains no more content than the sentence(s)
picked out by the referring expression. To assert that a sentence is
true is simply to assert or reassert that sentence; it is not to
ascribe the property of truth to that sentence. The prosentential
theory is one kind of deflationary theory of truth. Like all
deflationary theories, it provides an alternative to explanations of
truth that analyze truth in terms of reference, predicate
satisfaction or a correspondence relation. See truth.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. What is a prosentence?
The prosentential theory was first developed by Dorothy Grover,
Joseph Camp, Jr., and Nuel Belnap, Jr. (1975) and Grover (1992) and
has received renewed attention due to the work of Robert Brandom
(1994). The central claim of the prosentential theory is that ‘x
is true’ functions as a prosentence-forming operator rather than
a property-ascribing locution. Perhaps the best way to begin an
explication of the prosentential theory is by looking at the more
familiar ‘proforms’ found in ordinary English usage.
‘Proform’ is the generic name for the linguistic category
of expressions that ‘stand in’ for other
expressions—pronouns being the most familiar variety.
Most uses of pronouns are ‘lazy’—the antecedents of
the pronouns could have easily been used instead of the pronouns. For
example,
1) Mary wanted to buy a car, but she could only
afford a motorbike.
2) If she can afford it, Jane will go.
3) John visited us. It was a surprise.
4) Mary said that the moon is made of green cheese, but I
didn’t believe it.
‘She’ simply stands in for ‘Mary’ in (1), and
‘she’ stands in for ‘Jane’ in (2), even though
‘she’ appears before ‘Jane.’ In (3)
‘it’ refers to the event of John’s having visited us,
while in (4) ‘it’ refers to Mary’s statement. Lazy
uses of pronouns are convenient but perhaps not essential linguistic
conventions.
In addition to lazy uses of pronouns, there are also
‘quantificational uses,’ as in:
5) If any car overheats, don’t buy it.
6) Each positive integer is such that if it is even,
adding 1 to it yields an odd number.
In these cases, the pronouns do not pick up their referents from
their antecedents in the same straightforward way as pronouns of
laziness do. Replacing the ‘it’ in (5) by the apparent
antecedent ‘any car’ or the ‘it’ in (6) by
‘each positive integer’ yields the following.
5') If any car overheats, don’t buy any car.
6') Each positive integer is such that if each positive integer
is even, adding 1 to each positive integer yields an odd
number.
(5') and (6') obviously do not express the sense of the original
sentences. ‘Any car’ and ‘each positive integer’
cannot be construed as referring expressions; rather, they pick out
families of admissible expressions that can be substituted into the
claims. (5) and (6) should be represented as
5") (x)[(x is a car & x overheats) 
don’t buy x].
6") (x)[(x is a positive integer & x is even)
adding 1 to x yields an odd number].
More will be said about quantificational proforms below.
There are also many commonly used proforms that are not often
recognized as proforms. These include proverbs:
7) Dance as we do
8) Mary ran quickly, so Bill did too
proadjectives:
9) We must strive to make men happy and to keep them so
and proadverbs:
10) She twitched violently, and while so twitching,
expired.
Most importantly, defenders of the prosentential theory of truth
claim that English also contains prosentences. For
example,
11) Bill: There are people on Mars. Mary: That is
true.
12) John: Bill claims that there are people on Mars but I
don’t believe that it is true.
In these examples, ‘that is true’ and ‘it is
true’ serve as ‘prosentences of laziness.’ They
inherit their content from antecedent statements, just as pronouns
inherit their reference from antecedent singular terms. John’s
use of ‘it is true’ is lazy because he could have easily
repeated the content of Bill’s claim without using a
prosentence. John could have said the following.
12') John: Bill claims that there are people on Mars but
I don’t believe that there are people on Mars.
The relation between a proform and its antecedent is called a
relation of ‘anaphora.’ Defenders of the prosentential
theory claim that prosentences such as ‘it is true’ and
‘that is true’ do not have any content of their own.
Whatever content they have is inherited from their anaphoric
antecedents. Because prosentences simply stand in for other
sentences, prosentential theorists claim that utterances of
‘p’ and ‘p is true’ always have the same
content.
There are many more kinds of prosentences than ‘that is
true’ or ‘it is true.’ Each of the following
sentences, for example, is also a prosentence.
13) Goldbach’s conjecture is true.
14) ‘Snow is white’ is true.
15) The claim that grass is green is true.
According to the prosentential theory, sentences (13), (14) and
(15) say no more than sentences (16), (17) and (18),
respectively.
16) Every even number is the sum of two primes.
17) Snow is white.
18) Grass is green.
Each prosentence is formed by conjoining some expression that
refers to a sentence to the truth predicate.
Although the semantic content of prosentences and their
antecedents is the same, prosentences often differ in pragmatic
respects from their antecedents. Consider the difference between the
following cases:
11) Bill: There are people on Mars. Mary: That is
true.
11') Bill: There are people on Mars. Mary: There are people on
Mars.
Although Mary’s utterance in (11') asserts no more than her
utterance in (11), her utterance in (11') does not acknowledge that
Bill has said anything. By acknowledging Bill’s previous
statement, Mary’s utterance of ‘that is true’ avoids a
kind of assertional plagiarism and has the effect of expressing
agreement. Mary could have uttered her statement in (11') without
ever having heard Bill say anything and without, therefore,
expressing any kind of agreement. Thus, the prosentential theory
takes up the point emphasized by F. P. Ramsey’s redundancy
theory of truth that assertions of truth do not assert anything new.
Unlike redundancy theories, however, the prosentential theory does
not take the truth predicate to be always eliminable without loss.
What would be lost in (11') is Mary’s acknowledgment that Bill
had said something.
One of the prosentential theory’s most important claims about
the truth predicate is that it is not used to ascribe a
substantive property to propositions. Grover (1992, p. 221)
writes,
Many other truth theories assume that a sentence
containing a truth predication, e.g., ‘That is true,’ is
about its antecedent sentence (‘Chicago is large’) or an
antecedent proposition. By contrast, the prosentential account is
that ‘That is true’ does not say anything about its
antecedent sentence (e.g., ‘Chicago is large’) but says
something about an extralinguistic subject (e.g., Chicago).
The truth predicate is not used to say something about sentences
or propositions. It is used to say something about the world. As
Grover (1992, p. 221) puts it, prosentences function “at the
level of the object language.” Even when someone makes an
utterance such as “John’s last claim is
true”—which uses a referring expression that explicitly
mentions an antecedent utterance token—the prosentential theory
still denies that it is the utterance that is being talked about. The
person uttering this sentence “expresses an opinion about
whatever (extralinguistic thing) it was that John expressed an
opinion about” (Grover, 1992, p. 19). W. V. Quine (1970, pp.
10-11) makes a similar claim, stating that the truth predicate serves
“to point through the sentence to reality; it serves as a
reminder that though sentences are mentioned, reality is still the
whole point.” The prosentential theory uses the notion of the
anaphoric inheritance of content to explain how reality remains the
focus in such cases.
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2. Quantificational prosentences
In addition to lazy uses of prosentences, there are also
‘quantificational’ uses. For example,
19) Everything John said is true
is a quantificational prosentence. A first attempt to translate
(19) into a language containing bound propositional variables might
read
20) (p)(If John said that p, then p is true).
A natural language paraphrase of (20) which exhibits ‘it is
true’ as a quantificationally dependent prosentence would be
21) For anything one can say, if John said it, then it is
true. (Grover, 1992, p. 130)
Since, according to the prosentential theory, the statement
‘p is true’ says no more than the statement ‘p,’
the truth predicate in (20) can be dropped to yield
20') (p)(If John said that p, then p).
If the variable ‘p’ ranges over objects and take names
of objects as its substitution instances—i.e., if
‘(p)’ and ‘p’ are given their ordinary
interpretations—then the consequent of the conditional inside
(20') will not be a grammatical expression. The antecedents and
consequents of conditionals must be complete sentences. In order for
(20') to be a grammatical expression, two modifications in the
standard interpretation of variables and quantifiers must be made.
First, the variable ‘p’ must be understood to be a
propositional variable, taking entire propositions instead of
names of propositions as its substitution instances. Secondly,
the universal quantifier ‘(p)’ must be understood
substitutionally, since the traditional, objectual interpretation of
the quantifiers does not square well with the use of propositional
variables. A statement using the particular (or existential)
substitutional quantifier is true just in case the open sentence
following the quantifier has at least one true substitution instance;
while a statement using the universal substitutional quantifier is
true in case every substitution instance is true (cf. David, 1994, p.
85). In order to avoid confusion between the objectual and
substitutional interpretations of the quantifiers, I shall use
‘ p’
to designate the universal substitutional quantifier. (20'), then,
should read
20") p(If
John said that p, then p).
If, however, we interpret the conditional in (20") as a material
conditional, (20") will still misrepresent the content of (19).
To see why this is so, consider the fact that universally
quantified statements can be understood as conjunctions of all their
possible substitution instances. For example, (20") is equivalent
to
22) (If John said that p1, then p1
is true) & (If John said that p2, then
p2 is true) & (If John said that p3,
then p3 is true) & … & (If John said that
pn, then pn is true).
How many conjuncts make up the content of (22) will depend upon
the size of the domain of discourse in question. That is, it will
depend upon how many possible values of p there are. If the
domain of the variable ‘p’ is the set of all things
that can be said, then (22) will consist of an indefinitely large
conjunction of substitution instances. Most of the conjuncts will be
vacuously true by virtue of having false antecedents—i.e., there
will be indefinitely many things that John did not say. This means
that each of the indefinitely many conditionals formed from things
that John did not say is just as much part of the content of (19) as
each of the conditionals formed from things John did say. That seems
counterintuitive and contrary to the meaning of (19). Suppose that
John made only the following three statements on the occasion in
question.
23) Gas prices are too high.
24) Taxes are too high.
25) Professional baseball players’ salaries are too
high.
It is plausible to think that (19) says something about (23), (24)
and (25) but not about (26), (27) and (28)—statements John never
made.
26) Gas prices are too low.
27) Taxes are too low.
28) Professional baseball players’ salaries are too
low.
Yet if the quantification in (20") remains unrestricted, then its
content consists of a conjunction of conditionals having (26), (27),
(28) and countless other statements John did not say in their
antecedents.
If quantificational prosentences such as ‘Everything John
said is true’ are to refer to only finite classes of claims,
their quantifiers must be restricted in some way. One way to trim
down the domain of ‘p’ in (20") is to limit the universe of
discourse to the set of all statements made by John. Let
‘UJ’ represent some particular universe of
discourse, and let ‘{p|Øp}’ mean ‘the set of
all propositions such that ‘Øp’ is true.’ If we
limit the universe of discourse to all and only the things that John
said, then we have
29) p(If
John said that p, then p). UJ = {p|John said p}
‘p(If
John said that p, then p)’ will then consist of a finite
conjunction of true conditionals, one for each thing said by John on
the occasion in question. This arrangement, however, has the unusual
feature that, for every grammatical subject of such a universally
quantified sentence, there will be a different universe of discourse.
For every x, there will be a unique universe of discourse for each
statement of the form
30) p(If
x said that p, then p). Ux = {p|x said p}
Other quantificational prosentences that would be instances of
(30) include
31) Everything the Pope says about theological doctrine
is true.
32) Everything Henry Kissinger says about foreign policy is
true.
Following the current suggestion, (31) could be symbolized as
either
33) p(If
the Pope said that p, then p). UP = {p|the Pope said p
& p is a matter of theological doctrine}
or
33') p(If
the Pope said that p & p is a matter of theological doctrine,
then p). UP = {p|the Pope said p}
The symbolization for (32) would be analogous. It is not clear
that we will be able to capture what is common to all of these cases
if each quantificational prosentence is tied to a distinct universe
of discourse. Perhaps there is another way to limit the domain of
‘p’ in (20").
Nuel Belnap, Jr. (1973), one of the founders of the prosentential
theory of truth, introduced the notion of ‘conditional
assertion’ to solve the problem of restricted
quantification—i.e., where one wants to quantify over only a
limited domain. All prosentential theorists now rely upon
Belnap’s model to explicate the logical structure of
quantificational prosentences. Belnap introduced the notation
‘(A/B)’ to stand for conditional assertion. Conditional
assertion occurs when someone does not assert the conditional
‘If A then B’ as much as conditionally assert B—that
is, assert B on the condition that A. Belnap formulates the following
principle to capture this idea:
B1) If A is true, then what (A/B) asserts is what B
asserts. If A is false, then (A/B) is nonassertive. (Belnap, 1973,
p. 50)
Quantifying into conditional assertions yields a restricted form
of quantification, regarding which Belnap offers the following
principle.
B2) Part 1. (x)(Cx/Bx) is assertive just in case
 xCx
is true. Part 2. (x)(Cx/Bx) is the conjunction of all the
propositions (Bt) such that Ct is true. (ibid., p. 66)
Applying Belnap’s conditional assertion notation to (20")
yields
34) p(John
said that p/p).
The content of (34), then, is a finite conjunction of claims. But
notice that it is not a conjunction of conditionals of the form
‘If John said that p, then p,’ each with a true antecedent.
Rather, it is a conjunction of claims p1,
p2,…, pn, each of which satisfies the
condition that John said it. The focus of such a claim is on what
John said and only derivatively on the fact that it was John who did
the saying. If the only statements John made were (23), (24) and
(25), then the content of an assertion of (34) is exhausted by the
conjunction of (23), (24) and (25). As a result, Belnap’s
principle of restricted quantification solves the problem of how to
interpret ‘Everything John said is true.’ Applying
Belnap’s principles to (31) and (32) yields
35) p(the
Pope said that p & p is a matter of theological doctrine/p).
36) p(Kissinger
said that p & p is a matter of foreign policy/p).
Following Belnap’s interpretation of conditional assertion
and restricted quantification, prosentential theorists can explain
how quantificational prosentences have as their content finite
conjunctions of claims rather than infinite conjunctions of
conditionals, most of which are trivially true. Prosentential
theorists thereby show that quantificational prosentences contain no
more content than the anaphoric antecedents of those prosentences.
Although quantificational prosentences may contain no more
explicit content than their anaphoric antecedents, they can
also be used as implicit attributions of reliability, where
such attributions do not clearly appear in their antecedents. Cf.
Beebe (forthcoming).
3. Why the prosentential theory is deflationary
The prosentential theory of truth counts as a
‘deflationary’ theory because it denies that any analysis
of truth of the form
37) (x)(x is true iff x is F)
can be given, where ‘x is F’ expresses a property that
is conceptually or explanatorily more fundamental than ‘x is
true.’ An analysis of truth would be appropriate if the truth
predicate were a property-ascribing locution and the property that is
ascribed could be broken down into more fundamental properties.
However, prosentential theorists deny that uses of the truth
predicate ascribe any property to sentences or propositions.
A common anti-deflationist approach to truth analyzes truth in
terms of reference and predicate satisfaction. Stephen Stich (1990,
ch. 5), for example, takes the proper analysis of truth to be
38) ‘a is F’ is true iff there exists an object
x such that ‘a’ refers to x and ‘F’ is
satisfied by x.
Instead of denying the truth of statements such as (38),
deflationists merely deny that they constitute analyses of truth
(cf., e.g., Horwich, 1998, p. 10). Deflationists claim that the most
fundamental facts about truth are the instances of the various truth
schemata used by deflationary theorists. Consider the equivalence
schemata employed by Quine’s (1970) disquotationalism:
D) ‘p’ is true iff p
and Paul Horwich’s (1998) minimalism:
MT) The proposition that p is true iff p.
Nominalizations of descriptive items are substituted on the
left-hand sides of each biconditional schema, while the right-hand
sides contain either descriptive items themselves or appropriate
translations of them. Each of these theorists
claims that there is no more to truth than what is expressed by the
substitution instances of these equivalence schemata. Truth is not
analyzed as a relation and the instances of the equivalence schemata
are taken to be the most fundamental facts about truth. The
prosentential theory claims that each of the favored examples of
these deflationary theorists is simply a special case of the more
general phenomenon of anaphora. Regardless of the points of
disagreement among deflationary theorists, they all agree that
instances of the truth schemata represent facts about truth that are
more fundamental vis-à-vis truth than any fact given in an
analysis such as (38).
Some theories, such as the correspondence theory of truth, take
truth to be a relation between propositions and the world. Where
‘C’ expresses the correspondence relation, ‘y’
ranges over segments of reality, and ‘x’ is used—for
the sake of convenience—as a placeholder for both descriptive
items and the contents of descriptive items, we can represent a
common version of the correspondence theory as
39) (x)[x is true iff (y)(Cxy)].
(39) should read ‘For any (descriptive item) x, x is true if
and only if there is a (segment of reality) y such that x corresponds
to y.’ If truth cannot be analyzed at all, then it obviously
cannot be analyzed as a relation. If, however, truth can be analyzed,
then perhaps it would be appropriate to analyze it as a relation
between descriptive items and segments of the world. How should one
go about deciding between the correspondence theory and the
prosentential theory?
Prosentential theorists respond by inviting readers to consider
the following facts. The correspondence theory claims that
snow’s being white is necessary but not sufficient for the truth
of ‘snow is white.’ In addition to snow’s being white,
the proposition that snow is white must stand in a relation of
correspondence to the fact that snow is white. The prosentential
theory, by contrast, claims that snow’s being white is both
necessary and sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white.’
As Alston (1996, p. 209) puts it, “Nothing more is required for
its being true that p than just the fact that p; and nothing less
will suffice.” One of the hallmarks of deflationism is the claim
that the truth of a descriptive item depends only upon the meaning or
content expressed by that item and how things actually stand in the
world. Prosentential theorists and other deflationists hope that
their readers will see that further constraints on truth are
unnecessary.
The prosentential theorist’s claim that no analysis of truth
can be given should not be confused with the claim that no
explanation of truth can be given. The prosentential theory explains
the function of the truth predicate by showing how ‘x is
true’ functions as a prosentence-forming operator. (Because the
prosentential explanation of truth makes the story about truth depend
upon a story about how we use words and concepts, the prosentential
explanation of the function of “true” generally leads
theorists to adopt a version of the ‘use theory of
meaning.’)
Deflationary theorists also claim that truth never performs any
real explanatory work. Suppose, for example, that Smith successfully
performs the action of attending a concert on Friday and that his
action was in part based upon his belief that the concert is on
Friday. If Smith succeeds in arriving at the concert on Friday, what
best explains the success of his action? The non-deflationist answers
that it is the truth of Smith’s belief that explains his
success. His action succeeds because his belief is true. In other
words, there is an important property of his belief (or perhaps a
property of the proposition expressed by his belief)—viz.,
truth—that is central to any adequate explanation of
Smith’s successful action. Deflationists disagree. They reply
that the reason that Smith succeeded in performing an action based
upon the belief that the concert is on Friday is that the concert is
on Friday. There is no need to implicate a special truth property in
this explanation. Why do actions based upon the belief that oxygen is
necessary for combustion generally succeed (other things being
equal)? Because oxygen is necessary for combustion. And so on.
Because prosentences never have any content of their own, whatever
explanatory burden one may wish for them to shoulder will always fall
to their anaphoric antecedents.
4. The prosentential theory and the recognition-transcendence of truth
Unlike some alternatives to the correspondence theory (e.g.,
the epistemic theories of truth of C. S. Peirce, Hilary Putnam, and
Michael Dummett), the prosentential theory accepts that truth can be
recognition-transcendent. Epistemic theories of truth always have
epistemic operators (e.g., ‘justifiably believes
that…,’ ‘warrantedly asserts that…’) of some
sort on the right-hand side of their analyses of truth. For
example,
CSP) p is true iff the unlimited communication community
in the long run would believe that p.
HP) p is true iff one would be warranted in asserting that p in
ideal epistemic circumstances.
IJC) p is true iff it would be justifiable to believe that p in
a situation in which all relevant evidence (reasons,
considerations) is readily available. (due to Alston, 1996, p.
194)
Unlike correspondence and prosentential theories, epistemic
theories always mention the knowledge, assertions or justified
beliefs of particular people. Subjects and their beliefs do not
figure into correspondence and prosentential theories in any way.
Truth theories such as (CSP), (HP) and (IJC) have the implication
that there could not be any true propositions “such that nothing
that tells for or against their truth is cognitively
[in]accessible to human beings, even in principle”
(Alston, 1996, p. 200). Summarizing a common thread of epistemic
theories of truth, Alston (1996, pp. 189-190) writes,
The truth of a truth bearer consists not in its relation
to some “transcendent” state of affairs, but in the
epistemic virtues the former displays within our thought,
experience, and discourse. Truth value is a matter of whether, or
the extent to which, a belief is justified, warranted,
rational, well grounded, or the like.
According to prosentential theorists, truth theories like (CSP),
(HP) and (IJC) that focus on epistemic virtues are incompatible with
the various truth schemata used by deflationists to explicate the
concept of truth. Schemata such as
40) p is true iff p
represent facts about truth that are so fundamental and obvious
that the uninitiated often have difficulty seeing beyond their
triviality to the significance of the deflationary thesis.
According to (IJC), snow’s being white is neither necessary
nor sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white’ or the
proposition that snow is white. If it is possible for all relevant
evidence to be readily available and yet for this evidence to be
unable to make a belief that snow is white justifiable, then
‘snow is white’ will not be true—even if snow is, in
fact, white. Since this seems clearly possible, snow’s being
white is not sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white.’
Moreover, if it is possible for all relevant evidence to be readily
available and for this evidence to make the belief that snow is white
justifiable even when snow is not white, then (since this seems
clearly possible) snow’s being white is not necessary for the
truth of ‘snow is white’ either. Similar considerations
apply to (CSP) and (HP). Prosentential theorists claim that any
theory which makes snow’s being white neither necessary nor
sufficient for the truth of ‘snow is white’ is inadequate.
The equivalence schemata simply do not allow any room for the
epistemic status of a proposition (or a belief or statement) being
both necessary and sufficient for that proposition’s truth. In
the eyes of prosentential theorists, epistemic theories of truth are
incompatible with the equivalence schemata and their instances.
By contrast, the prosentential theory embraces the
recognition-transcendence of truth. Truth schemata such as
40) p is true iff p
do not require that anyone be able to tell whether p is the case
in order for p to be true. In order for p to be true, nothing more is
required than p. No one has to be able to verify or warrantedly
assert it. The right-hand side of (40), then, does not limit truth to
what falls within our thought, experience and discourse. As a result,
the prosentential theory of truth is compatible with (though it
neither entails nor is entailed by) a robustly realist metaphysics.
It is a mistake to think that the correspondence theory is the only
truth theory a metaphysical realist can buy into and that any critic
of the correspondence theory will be an antirealist.
5. A prosentential theory of falsity
The prosentential theory of truth can be extended to account
for uses of the predicate ‘x is false.’ The prosentential
theory of falsity will be strongly analogous to the prosentential
theory of truth. The prosentential theorist can claim that, just as
the predicate ‘x is true’ functions as a
prosentence-forming operator, so does ‘x is false.’ When an
expression referring to an antecedent utterance is substituted for
‘x’ in ‘x is true,’ the resulting claim will have
the same content as its anaphoric antecedent. By parity, when a
referring expression that denotes some antecedent utterance is
substituted for ‘x’ in ‘x is false,’ the
resulting claim will have the same content as the denial of
its anaphoric antecedent. Consider the following example.
41) Joe: The sky is cloudy. Jane: That’s true. Mark:
That’s false.
Jane’s utterance has the same content as Joe’s, viz.,
that the sky is cloudy. Mark’s utterance, on the other hand, has
the same content as the denial of Joe’s utterance, viz.,
42) The sky is not cloudy.
Mark’s utterance inherits part of its content from its
anaphoric antecedent (i.e., Joe’s utterance), but his utterance
includes an extra bit of content not found in that antecedent:
negation. Instances of the prosentence-forming operator ‘x is
false,’ then, will have the same content as the negations of
their antecedents.
6. The liar paradox
The prosentential theory of truth implies a solution to the
liar
paradox. Consider the following sentence.
43) This sentence is false.
Is (43) true or false? If (43) says something true,
then—since it says that (43) itself is false—it says
something false. However, if (43) says something false,
then—since it says that (43) is false—it says something
true, viz., that (43) is false. We are thus confronted with a
paradox.
Some attempts to solve the liar paradox involve extreme measures.
Tarski, for example, thought that the paradox could be avoided only
by eschewing ‘semantically closed languages’—i.e.,
languages which contain semantic terms that are applicable to
sentences of that same language. He maintained that a theory of truth
for a language should not be formulated within that same language.
So, a theory of truth-in-L1 must be formulated in some
meta-language, L2. If we allow the predicate ‘x is
true-in-L1’ to be part of L1, paradoxes
will result. The predicate ‘x is true-in-L1,’
then, must be part of the meta-language, L2. Since no
well-formed sentence of L1 can be used to talk about the
truth value of any sentence in L1, there is no chance for
the liar paradox to arise because the basic liar sentence makes a
claim about its own truth value. Tarski succeeds in avoiding the
basic form of the liar paradox—but only at a very high price. He
must content himself with providing an account of
‘true-in-Li’ rather than an account of truth.
And, since natural languages like English are semantically closed,
Tarski’s theory also has the weakness of applying only to
artificial languages.
Defenders of the prosentential theory claim that they can provide
a solution to the liar paradox that is more natural and comes with a
significantly lower price tag. According to the prosentential theory,
(43) is neither true nor false because it fails to pick up an
anaphoric antecedent. Just as I cannot inherit my own wealth, a
prosentence cannot inherit its content from itself. Anaphoric
inheritance is a non-reflexive relation that holds between two
distinct things. A prosentence has content only when content has been
passed to it from a content-bearing antecedent. Consequently, (43)
will have content only if its anaphoric antecedent does. But if (43)
is its own antecedent, (43) will have content only if (43) does.
Since prosentences do not have their own independent content, (43)
fails to have any content. Since it does not succeed in expressing a
proposition, the liar sentence is neither true nor false and the
paradox is avoided.
7. Objections
Philosophical objections to the prosentential theory of
truth can be divided into two main groups. One set of objections is
directed against Grover, Camp and Belnap’s (1975) original
version of the theory; the other is directed against Brandom’s
(1994) updated version. Originally, Grover, Camp and Belnap claimed
that each prosentence—e.g., ‘it is true’ or ‘that
is true’—referred as a whole to an antecedent sentence
token. Each occurrence of ‘it’ or ‘that’ in a
prosentence, they claimed, should not be interpreted as a referring
expression. In fact, ‘it,’ ‘that’ and
‘…is true’ should not be treated as having independent
meanings at all. Grover, Camp and Belnap were trying to undermine the
idea that the truth predicate is a property-ascribing locution. They
thought that if ‘it’ and ‘that’ were taken to be
referring expressions, it would seem only too natural to conclude
that ‘…is true’ ascribed a predicate to their
referents.
One consequence of Grover, Camp and Belnap’s commitment to
the non-composite nature of prosentences is that they are forced to
find non-composite prosentences in places where there do not seem to
be any. Consider, for example,
13) Goldbach’s conjecture is true
and
14) ‘Snow is white’ is true.
Grover, Camp and Belnap must argue that, despite appearances, (13)
and (14) are not really composed of the referring expressions
‘Goldbach’s conjecture’ and ‘’Snow is
white’’ conjoined to the predicate ‘…is
true.’ According to the original version of the prosentential
theory, the logical form of (13) is actually something like
13') For any sentence, if it is Goldbach’s
conjecture, then it is true
or
13") There is a unique sentence, such that Goldbach
conjectured that it is true, and it is true.
The logical form of (14) would be either
14') For any sentence, if it is ‘Snow is
white,’ then it is true
or
14") Consider: snow is white. That is true. (Grover, Camp
and Belnap, p. 103)
(Each of these interpretations has been suggested by some
prosentential theorist.) In three of the four interpretations,
quantifiers are introduced so that the prosentence ‘it is
true’ can remain an unbroken unit. Universal quantifiers are
used in (13() and (14(), and an existential quantifier is used in
(13").
An obvious objection to Grover, Camp and Belnap’s strategy is
that it seems quite unlikely that (13') and (14') or (13") and (14")
reveal the true logical structure of (13) and (14). There is no good
reason to suppose that the surface structure of (13) and (14) hides
genuine quantifiers below the surface. Furthermore, there are simply
too many uses of the truth predicate outside of the phrases ‘it
is true’ and ‘that is true’ for Grover, Camp and
Belnap’s interpretation to be plausible. (Cf. Brandom (1994, pp.
303-305) and Kirkham (1992, pp. 325-329) for more critical discussion
of Grover, Camp and Belnap’s early version of the prosentential
theory.)
Brandom (1994, pp. 303-305) has argued that prosentential
theorists do not need to treat ‘it is true’ and ‘that
is true’ as non-composite units. Instead, he claims that
‘…is true’ should be treated as a
prosentence-forming operator. When it is conjoined to any kind
of referring expression, the resulting expression will have the same
content as the antecedent sentence or utterance denoted by the
referring expression. (This is the version of the prosentential
theory that I have been assuming throughout.) However, a different
set of problems confronts this version of the prosentential theory.
Consider the following example inspired by Wilson’s (1990)
criticisms of the prosentential theory.
44) Steve: Boudreaux won the mayoral election. Kate: What
that conniving, good-for-nothing bum said was true.
If Brandom’s version of the prosentential theory is correct,
Kate’s utterance should have no more content than Steve’s.
Clearly, however, Kate’s remark does more than simply reassert
the content of Steve’s remark. It casts aspersions on
Steve’s character. According to Brandom’s seemingly more
defensible version of the prosentential theory, a referring
expression used at the head of a prosentence serves only to pick out
an antecedent from which the prosentence can inherit its content. But
referring expressions can be naughty or nice, informative or dull.
Once Brandom opens the door for prosentences to be formed by
conjoining any referring expression to the prosentence-forming
operator ‘…is true,’ it seems that he can no longer
maintain that prosentences never have any more content than their
anaphoric antecedents. Referring expressions are not all like proper
names. Very often they bring with them a great deal more content than
is strictly necessary for them to succeed in referring. A proper
interpretation of prosentences cannot ignore this extra content. (Cf.
Wilson (1990) for more criticisms that apply to both versions of the
prosentential theory.)
8. Comparison
of the prosentential theory with other deflationary theories
According to F. P. Ramsey’s redundancy theory,
one of the earliest deflationary theories, sentences such as
45) The earth is round
and
46) It is true that the earth is round
say exactly the same thing. The phrase “It is true” is a
superfluous addition. Ramsey did not, however, explain why phrases
like “It is true that...” or “...is true” exist
at all if they serve no real purpose. The prosentential theory
incorporates Ramsey’s claim about redundancy of content in its
account of the function of prosentences. Since prosentences inherit
their content from their anaphoric antecedents, they will say the
same thing as their antecedents. However, the prosentential theory
goes beyond the redundancy theory by providing an explanation of why
we have the truth predicate in our language. Prosentences of laziness
(e.g., “That’s true” spoken after someone utters
“It’s very humid in Louisiana”), it is argued, give us
a way of expressing agreement without having to repeat what has been
said while at the same time acknowledging that an assertion has been
made. Also, quantificational prosentences (e.g., “Everything
Henry Kissinger says is true”) enable us to state
generalizations when we might be unable to state each individual
instance of any such generalization.
The prosentential theory also tries to incorporates some of the
central claims of P. F. Strawson’s performative theory of
truth. According to Strawson, statements such as “That’s
true” (uttered after someone says that the sun is bright) or
“It is true that the sun is bright” are nonassertoric
performative utterances. An utterance is nonassertoric if it does not
make an assertion. Commands (e.g., “Clean your room”) are
examples of nonassertoric utterances because they do not purport to
state or describe any facts. Similarly, according to Strawson,
“It is true” (uttered after someone says that the sun is
bright) and “It is true that the sun is bright” do not
assert that some sentence or proposition has the property of being
true. Rather, these are performative utterances, which do not so much
say something as do something. In these cases the truth predicate is
being used to express agreement or to endorse some claim.
The prosentential theory follows Strawson’s performative
theory in denying that the truth predicate ascribes a truth property
to propositions or statements. However, the prosentential theory does
not deny that prosentences—while they may very well be used to
express agreement—also assert something in the act of expressing
this agreement. In addition, the prosentential theory can accommodate
one type of case that causes trouble for the performative theory.
Many embedded uses of the truth predicate do not seem to be
expressions of agreement, as in “If what he said is true,
we’ll be out of this building before winter.” Such a use of
the truth predicate may very well not express agreement. The speaker
may be unsure whether he should endorse the claim and may be merely
thinking hypothetically. The prosentential theory does not require
that every use of the truth predicate be an expression of
agreement—although they can be used to do so. It explains that
prosentences—even those that are embedded in the antecedents of
conditionals (e.g., “what he said is true”)—inherit
their content from their anaphoric antecedents.
W. V. Quine’s (1970) disquotational theory of truth
views the truth predicate as a convenient device of ‘semantic
ascent.’ When, for example,
we want to generalize on ‘Tom is mortal or Tom is
not mortal,’ ‘Snow is white or snow is not white,’
and so on, we ascend to talk of truth and of sentences, saying
‘Every sentence of the form ‘p or not p’ is
true,’ or ‘Every alternation of a sentence with its
negation is true.’ What prompts this semantic ascent is not
that ‘Tom is mortal or Tom is not mortal’ is somehow
about sentences while ‘Tom is mortal’ and ‘Tom is
Tom’ are about Tom. All three are about Tom. We ascend only
because of the oblique way in which the instances over which we
are generalizing are related to one another. (Quine, 1970, p. 11)
The truth predicate, then, exists because it enables us to form
certain generalizations that would otherwise quite difficult to state
without some such device of semantic ascent. When, however, the truth
predicate is used with single sentences (e.g., “‘Snow is
white’ is true”), it is superfluous.
Defenders of the prosentential theory agree with Quine (1970, p.
12) that, “despite a technical ascent to talk of sentences, our
eye is on the world” when we use the truth predicate. In other
words, both Quine’s disquotationalism and the prosentential
theory deny that the truth predicate is used to ascribe a property to
propositions. The truth predicate, they claim, is used to say
something about the world. The prosentential theory also acknowledges
the important role the truth predicate plays in forming
generalizations that might otherwise be difficult or impossible to
state (cf. the discussion of quantificational prosentences above).
Furthermore, both theories explain truth by explaining the role of
certain linguistic items (e.g., devices of semantic ascent,
prosentences) rather than focusing on language-independent
propositions and properties.
However, unlike disquotationalism, the prosentential theory
recognizes that there are many uses of the truth predicate in which
there is nothing to disquote. For example, in the sentence
“Goldbach’s conjecture is true,” there are no
quotation marks to be removed. Instead of being used in connection
with an entire sentence, here the truth predicate is joined to an
expression (‘Goldbach’s conjecture’) referring to an
antecedent sentence. It is not clear how the disquotational theory
might be extended to cover this kind of case. The prosentential
theory explains that any referring expression (e.g., a name, definite
description, etc.) inherits its content from its anaphoric
antecedent(s) and, when such an expression is conjoined to the truth
predicate, a prosentence with the same content as the antecedent(s)
results.
Paul Horwich’s minimalist theory of truth
(1998)—unlike the prosentential theory and some other
deflationary theories—takes the primary bearers of truth to be
propositions rather than sentences or utterances. Horwich claims that
the conjunction of all the instances of the schema
MT) The proposition that p is true iff p
yields an implicit definition of truth. Each instance is an axiom
of his theory. How many instances are there? There’s one for
every possible proposition, including propositions no human being
understands and maybe even a few that no human being could ever
understand. In other words, there are infinitely many. Horwich claims
that there is nothing more to our concept of truth than our
disposition to assent to each of the instances of (MT).
Horwich and defenders of the prosentential theory agree in
thinking that no analysis of truth can be given. Horwich, however,
thinks that the truth predicate does expresses a property, since he
believes that all predicates express properties in some minimal
sense. Although the prosentential theory is typically described as
denying that “true” expresses a property of any sort (see,
for example, Lynch, 2001, p. 4), the writings of Dorothy Grover
(1992)—the primary defender of the prosentential theory—are
far from clear on the issue of predicates and properties. Grover
claims that the truth predicate is not used to ascribe a property to
propositions, but this is compatible with the truth predicate
expressing a property in a minimal sense (à la Horwich)
nonetheless. The fact that a certain Rolex is not used as a
paperweight does not mean that it lacks the property of being able to
weigh down papers. Grover also claims that truth is not a substantive
or naturalistic property, but this claim is compatible with truth
being an insubstantial or nonnaturalistic property (also à la
Horwich). Since Grover does not sufficiently explain her remarks
about substantive or naturalistic properties, it is difficult to tell
how close her prosentential theory actually is to Horwich on this
issue. Brandom’s (1994, ch. 5) discussion of the prosentential
theory does not even broach the issue.
What is clear is that Horwich and defenders of the prosentential
theory disagree about the virtues of the substitution interpretation
of the quantifiers. Horwich recognizes that if he used substitutional
quantifiers, his theory would be finitely statable. He explains,
however, that substitutional quantifiers would be too costly an
addition to our language: “The advantage of the truth predicate
is that it allows us to say what we want without having to employ any
new linguistic apparatus of this sort” (Horwich, 1998, p. 4, n.
1). Horwich also harbors doubts about whether we can spell out the
notion of substitutional quantification without circularly relying
upon the notion of truth (Horwich, 1998, pp. 25-26). In making this
last remark, Horwich is thinking of Grover, Camp and Belnap’s
unusual thesis that every use of a prosentence—even
“‘Snow is white’ is true”—implicitly
contains a quantifier. (Cf. section VII for more discussion of this
point.) Since substitutional quantifiers must be brought in to
explain every use of a prosentence, Grover, Camp and Belnap cannot
explain substitutional quantification in terms of truth. However,
Brandom’s (1994) version of the prosentential theory does not
use substitutional quantification to explain the function of the
truth predicate. He argues that, although quantificational
prosentences employ substitutional quantification, lazy uses of
prosentences—which are more fundamental than their
quantificational cousins—do not (cf. section II above). Brandom,
thus, avoids the problem of circularity.
9. References and Further Reading
Alston, W. P. (1996). A realistic conception of truth.
Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
Beebe, J. R. (forthcoming). Attributive uses of prosentences.
Ratio.
Belnap, Jr., N. D. (1973). Restricted quantification and
conditional assertion. In H. Leblanc (Ed.), Truth, syntax and
modality (pp. 48-75). Amsterdam: North Holland Publishing Co.
Brandom, R. B. (1994). Making it explicit: Reasoning,
representing, and discursive commitment. Cambridge, Mass.:
Harvard University Press.
David, M. (1994). Correspondence and disquotation. New
York: Oxford University Press.
Grover, D. (1992). A prosentential theory of truth.
Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
Grover, D., Camp, Jr., J., & Belnap, Jr., N. D. (1975). A
prosentential theory of truth. Philosophical Studies, 27,
73-124.
Horwich, P. (1998). Truth (2nd ed.). New York: Oxford
University Press.
Kirkham, R. L. (1992). Theories of truth: A critical
introduction. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Lynch, M. P. (2001). Introduction: The mystery of truth. In M. P.
Lynch (Ed.), The nature of truth: Classic and contemporary
perspectives (pp. 1-6). Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
Quine, W. V. (1970). Philosophy of logic. Englewood Cliffs,
NJ: Prentice-Hall.
Stich, S. P. (1990). The fragmentation of reason: Preface to a
pragmatic theory of cognitive evaluation. Cambridge, MA: MIT
Press.
Wilson, W. K. (1990). Some reflections on the prosentential theory
of truth. In J. M. Dunn & A. Gupta (Eds.), Truth or
consequences (pp. 19-32). Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic
Publishers.
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