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A deductive argument is said to be valid if and only if it
takes a form that makes it impossible for the premises to be true
and the conclusion nevertheless to be false. Otherwise, a deductive
argument is said to be invalid.
A deductive argument is sound if and only if it is
both valid, and all of its premises are actually true. Otherwise, a
deductive argument is unsound.
According to the definition of a deductive argument (see the
entry on Deduction and Induction), the author of
a deductive argument always intends that the premises
provide the sort of justification for the conclusion whereby
if the premises are true, the conclusion is guaranteed to be
true as well. Loosely speaking, if the author's process of
reasoning is a good one, if the premises actually do provide this
sort of justification for the conclusion, then the argument
is valid.
In effect, an argument is valid if the truth of the
premises logically guarantees the truth of the conclusion. The
following argument is valid, because it is impossible for the
premises to be true and the conclusion to nevertheless be false:
Either Elizabeth owns a Honda or she owns a Saturn.
Elizabeth does not own a Honda.
Therefore, Elizabeth owns a Saturn.
It is important to stress that the premises of an argument
do not have actually to be true in order for the
argument to be valid. An argument is valid if the premises
and conclusion are related to each other in the right way
so that if the premises were true, then the conclusion
would have to be true as well. We can recognize in the above
case that even if one of the premises is
actually false, that if they had been true
the conclusion would have been true as well. Consider,
then an argument such as the following:
All toasters are items made of gold.
All items made of gold are time-travel devices.
Therefore, all toasters are time-travel devices.
Obviously, the premises in this argument are not true. It
may be hard to imagine these premises being true, but it
is not hard to see that if they were true, their truth
would logically guarantee the conclusion's truth.
It is easy to see that the previous example is not an
example of a completely good argument. A valid argument
may still have a false conclusion. When we construct our
arguments, we must aim to construct one that is not only
valid, but sound. A sound argument is one that is
not only valid, but begins with premises that
are actually true. The example given about
toasters is valid, but not sound. However, the following
argument is both valid and sound:
No felons are eligible voters.
Some professional athletes are felons.
Therefore, some professional athletes are not eligible voters.
Here, not only do the premises provide the right sort of
support for the conclusion, but the premises are actually
true. Therefore, so is the conclusion. Although it is not
part of the definition of a sound argument, because
sound arguments both start out with true premises and
have a form that guarantees that the conclusion must
be true if the premises are, sound arguments always
end with true conclusions.
It should be noted that both invalid, as well as
valid but unsound, arguments can nevertheless have
true conclusions. One cannot reject the conclusion
of an argument simply by discovering a given
argument for that conclusion to be flawed.
Whether or not the premises of an argument are true
depends on their specific content. However,
according to the dominant understanding among
logicians, the
validity or invalidity of an argument is determined
entirely by its logical form. The logical form of
an argument is that which remains of it when one abstracts
away from the specific content of the premises and
the conclusion, i.e., words naming things, their
properties and relations, leaving only those elements
that are common to discourse and reasoning about any
subject matter, i.e., words such as "all", "and", "not",
"some", etc. One can represent the logical form of
an argument by replacing the specific content words
with letters used as place-holders or variables.
For example, consider these two arguments:
All tigers are mammals.
No mammals are creatures with scales.
Therefore, no tigers are creatures with scales.
All spider monkeys are elephants.
No elephants are animals.
Therefore, no spider monkeys are animals.
These arguments share the same form:
All A are B;
No B are C;
Therefore, No A are C.
All arguments
with this form are valid. Because they have this form, the examples above are
valid. However, the first example is sound while the
second is unsound, because its premises are false. Now consider:
All basketballs are round.
The Earth is round.
Therefore, the Earth is a basketball.
All popes reside at the Vatican.
John Paul II resides at the Vatican.
Therefore, John Paul II is a pope.
These arguments also have the same form:
All A's are F;
X is F;
Therefore, X is an A.
Arguments with this form are invalid. This is easy to see with
the first example. The second example may seem like
a good argument because the premises and the conclusion
are all true, but note that the conclusion's truth isn't
guaranteed by the premises' truth. It could have been
possible for the premises to be true and the conclusion
false. This argument is invalid, and all invalid
arguments are unsound.
While it is accepted by most contemporary logicians
that logical validity and invalidity is determined
entirely by form, there is some dissent. Consider,
for example, the following arguments:
My table is circular. Therefore, it is not square shaped.
Juan is bachelor. Therefore, he is not married.
These arguments, at least on the surface, have the form:
x is F;
Therefore, x is not G.
Arguments of this form are not valid as a rule. However, it
seems clear in these particular cases that it is, in some strong sense,
impossible for the premises to be true while the conclusion
is false. However, many logicians would respond to these complications
in various ways. Some might insist--although this is
controverisal--that these arguments actually contain
implicit premises such as "Nothing is both circular and
square shaped" or "All bachelors are unmarried," which, while
themselves necessary truths, nevertheless play a role in the
form of these arguments. It might also be suggested, especially
with the first argument, that while (even without the additional
premise) there is a necessary connection between the premise
and the conclusion, the sort of necessity involved is something
other than "logical" necessity, and hence that this argument
(in the simple form) should not be regarded as logically
valid. Lastly, especially with regard to the second example,
it might be suggested that because "bachelor" is defined as
"adult unmarried male", that the true logical form of the argument
is the following universally valid form:
x is F and not G and H;
Therefore, x is not G.
The logical form of a statement
is not always as easy to discern as one might expect. For example,
statements that seem to have the same surface grammar can nevertheless
differ in logical form. Take for example the two statements:
(1) Tony is a ferocious tiger.
(2) Clinton is a lame duck.
Despite their apparent similarity, only (1) has the form "x is a A that is F". From it one
can validly infer that Tony is a tiger. One cannot validly infer from (2) that Clinton
is a duck. Indeed, one and the same sentence can be used in different ways in
different contexts. Consider the statement:
(3) The King and Queen are visiting dignitaries.
It is not clear what the logical form of this statement is. Either there
are dignitaries that the King and Queen are visiting, in which case the
sentence (3) has the same logical form as "The King and Queen are playing
violins," or the King and Queen are themselves the dignitaries who are
visiting from somewhere else, in which case the sentence has the same logical
form as "The King and Queen are sniveling cowards." Depending on which
logical form the statement has, inferences may be valid or invalid. Consider:
The King and Queen are visiting dignitaries. Visiting dignitaries
is always boring. Therefore, the King and Queen are doing
something boring.
Only if the statement is given the first reading can this argument be considered
to be valid.
Because of the difficulty in identifying the logical form of an argument,
and the potential deviation of logical form from grammatical form in ordinary language,
contemporary logicians typically make use of artificial logical languages
in which logical form and grammatical form coincide. In these artificial
languages, certain symbols, similar to those used in mathematics, are used
to represent those elements of form analogous to ordinary English words such
as "all", "not", "or", "and", etc. The use of an artifically constructed
language makes it easier to specify a set of rules that determine whether or
not a given argument is valid or invalid. Hence, the study of which
deductive argument forms are valid and which are invalid is often called
"formal logic" or "symbolic logic".
In short, a deductive argument must be evaluated
in two ways. First, one must ask if the premises
provide support for the conclusion by examing the
form of the argument. If they do, then
the argument is valid. Then, one must ask whether
the premises are true or false in actuality. Only if an argument
passes both these tests is it sound. However,
if an argument does not pass these tests, its
conclusion may still be true, despite that no support
for its truth is given by the argument.
Note: there are other, related, uses of these
words that are found within more advanced mathematical
logic. In that context, a formula (on its own)
written in a logical language is said to be valid if
it comes out as true (or "satisfied") under all admissible
or standard assignments of meaning to that formula within
the intended semantics for the logical language. Moreover,
an axiomatic logical calculus (in its entirety) is said to
be sound if and only if all theorems derivable from
the axioms of the logical calculus are semantically valid
in the sense just described.
For a more sophisicated look at the nature of logical
validity, see the articles on "Logical Consequence" in this encyclopedia.
The articles
on "Argument" and "Deductive and Inductive Arguments"
in this encyclopedia may also be helpful.
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