Vasubandhu was a prominent Buddhist teacher and one of the most important
figures in the development of Mahāyāna Buddhism in India. Though he is
particularly admired by later Buddhists as cofounder of the Yogācāra school
along with his half brother Asanga, his pre Yogācāra works, such as the
Abhidharmakosha and his auto-commentary (Abhidharmakoshabhāshya)
on it, are considered masterpieces. He wrote commentaries on many
sūtras, works on logic, devotional poetry, works on Abhidharma
classifications, as well as original and innovative philosophical treatises.
Some of his writings have survived in their original Sanskrit form, but many
others, particularly his commentaries, are extant only in their Chinese or
Tibetan translations. Vasubandhu was a many-sided thinker, and his personality
as it emerges from his works and his biographies shows him as a man who was not
only a great genius and a philosopher, but also a human being who was filled
with great compassion.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Sources on the Biography of Vasubandhu
The most important and the only complete account of the life of Vasubandhu
entitled Posou pandoufa shijuan (Biography of Master Vasubandhu) was
compiled into Chinese by Paramartha (499-569 CE), one of the chief exponents of
Yogacara doctrine in China. It is preserved in the Chinese Tripitaka and
its English translation was published by J. Takakusu in T'oung Pao (1904:
269-296). Apart from this account, the Xiyuji of Xuanzang (600-664 CE)
also provides important information about the life of Vasubandhu. Though
Paramartha and Xuanzang are the two most credible authorities for Vasubandhu's
life, yet serious discrepancies exist between their accounts. Paramartha's
account not only contains legendary or even mythical elements, but the time
sequence of events is also ambiguous and differs greatly in places from the
account of Xuanzang's the Xiyuji. The Tibetan historians, Taranatha and
Bu-ston, also give some important information on Vasubandhu's life, but their
account further disagrees with Paramartha and Xuanzang in terms of certain names
and events associated with the life of Vasubandhu. Scholars once suspected that
more than one person bore the name Vasubandhu in the history of Indian Buddhism,
although recent studies have eliminated this hypothesis.
2. Early Life of Vasubandhu
He was born at Purusapura (identified with modern Peshawar, capital of
North-West Frontier Province of Pakistan) in the state of Gandhara. Gandhara is
best known today as one of the earliest regions to develop a distinctive form of
Buddhist art noted for its Hellenistic influence. According to Taranatha,
Vasubandhu was born one year after his older brother Asanga became a Buddhist
monk. His father was a brahmanaof the Kaushika gotra. According to Posou
pandou fashi zhuan his mother's name was Virinci. But Bu-ston and
Taranatha mention the name of the mother of Asanga and Vasubandhu as
Prasannashila. According to these two Tibetan historians, Asanga and
Vasubandhu were half-brothers; Asanga's father being a kshatriya, and
Vasubandhu's a brahmana. Vasubandhu also had a younger brother called
Virincivatsa. Vasubandhu's father was a court priest, and according to
Taranatha was an authority on the Vedas. In all probability, he officiated at
the court of the Shaka princes of the Shilada clan, who at that time ruled from
Purusapura. During the formative years of his life, Vasubandhu may have been
introduced by his father not only to the Brahmanical tradition but also to the
postulates of classical Nyaya and Vaisheshika, both of which had influence on
his logical thought.
As a young student, he amazed his teachers with his brilliance and ready wit.
According to Paramartha, Vasubandhu's teacher was called Buddhamitra. The
Xiyuji, however, never mentions Buddhamitra and names Manoratha as the
teacher of Vasubandhu. At Vasubandhu's time the dominant Buddhist school in
Gandhara was the Vaibhashika (also called Sarvastivada). Vasubandhu entered
the Sarvastivada order, and studied primarily the scholastic system of the
Vaibhashikas. Initially, he was quite impressed with the
Mahavibhasha. In time, however, Vasubandhu began to have grave doubts
about the validity and relevance of Vaibhashika metaphysics. At this time,
perhaps through the brilliant teacher Manoratha, he came into contact with the
theories of the Sautrantikas, the group of Buddhists who wished to reject
everything that was not the express word of the Buddha, and who held the
elaborate constructions of the Vibhasha up to ridicule. That there was a
strong Sautrantika tradition in Purusapura is likely in view of the fact that
it was the birthplace of that maverick philosopher of the second century,
Dharmatrata. In fact, the most orthodox Vaibhashika seat of learning was not
in Gandhara, but in Kashmir, whose masters looked down upon the Gandharans as
quasi-heretics. Therefore, according to Xuanzang's pupil Pu Kuang, Vasubandhu
decided to go to Kashmir disguised as a lunatic to investigate the Vaibhashika
teachings more deeply. Vasubandhu studied in Kashmir with different teachers for
four years and then came back to Purusapura.
After having returned to his native place, Vasubandhu began to prepare for an
enormous project that had been in his mind for some time. At this time he was
unattached to any particular order, and lived in a small private house in the
center of Purusapura. Vasubandhu supported himself by lecturing on Buddhism
before the general public, which presumably remunerated him with gifts.
According to tradition, during the day he would lecture on Vaibhashika doctrine
and in the evening distill the day's lectures into a verse. When collected
together the six hundred plus verses (karikas) gave a thorough summary
of the entire system. He entitled this work the Abhidharmakosha (Treasury
of Abhidharma). According to Paramartha, Vasubandhu composed the
Abhidharmakosha at Ayodhya, but according to Xuanzang, it was composed
in the suburbs of Purusapura. In the Abhidharmakosha Vasubandhu analyzed
and catalogued seventy-five dharmas, the basic factors of experience, for
the purposes of attaining Bodhi. He divided them into various categories
consisting of eleven types of rupani i.e., ‘material forms' (the five
sense organs, their corresponding objects, and avijnapti-rupa i.e.,
‘gesture unrevealing of intent'); citta (mind); ten types of
mahaabhumika i.e., ‘major groundings' (volition, desire, mindfulness,
attention etc.); ten types of kushala-mahabhumika i.e., ‘advantageous
major groundings' (faith, vigor, equanimity, ahimsa, serenity etc.); six types
of klesha-mahabhumika i.e., ‘mental disturbance major groundings'
(confusion, carelessness, restlessness etc.); two types of akushala
mahabhumika i.e., ‘nonadvantageous major groundings (shamelessness and
non-embarrassment); ten types of paritta-klesha-mahabhumika i.e.,
‘secondary mental disturbance major groundings' (anger, enmity, envy, conceit
etc.); eight types of aniyata-mahabhumika i.e., ‘indeterminate major
groundings' (remorse, arrigance, aversion, doubt, torpor etc.); fourteen types
of citta-viprayukta-samskara-dharmah i.e. ‘embodied-conditioning
disassociated from mind' (life-force, birth, decay, impermanence etc.); and
three types of asamskrita-dharmah i.e., ‘unconditioned dharmas
(spatiality, cessation through understanding, and cessation without
understanding). Not only were the definitions and interrelations of these
seventy-five dharmas analyzed in the Abhidharmakosha, but their karmic
qualities also examined. Besides, Vasubandhu also elaborated upon causal
theories, cosmology, practices of meditation, theories of perception, karma,
rebirth, and the characteristics of an Enlightened Being in this text.
As the Abhidharmakosha was an eloquent summary of the purport of the
Mahavibhasha, the Kashmiri Sarvastivadins are reported to have
rejoiced to see in it all their doctrines so well propounded. Accordingly, they
requested Vasubandhu to write a prose commentary (bhashya) on it.
However, it seems that after having written the Abhidharmakosha,
Vasubandhu began to have second thoughts about the Vaibhashika teachings. As a
consequence, it is said, Vasubandhu prepared the Abhidharmakoshabhashya.
But as it contained a thoroughgoing critique of Vaibhashika dogmatics from a
Sautrantika viewpoint, the Kashmiri Sarvastivadins soon realized, to their
great disappointment, that the Abhidharmakoshabhashya in fact refuted
many Sarvastivada theories and upheld the doctrines of the Sautrantika
school. One major point that created bad blood between the Vaibhashikas and the
Sautrantikas was concerning the status and nature of the dharmas. The
Vaibhashikas held that the dharmas exist in the past and future as well as the present. On the other hand, the Sautrantikas held the view that they are discrete, particular moments only existing at the present moment in which they discharge causal efficacy. The Vaibhashikas wrote several treatises attempting to refute Vasubandhu's critiques.
3. Conversion to Mahayana
In the years directly following the composition of the
Abhidharmakoshabhashya, Vasubandhu seems to have spent much time in
travelling from place to place. Finally, after having spent some time at
Shakala/ Shagala (modern Sialkot in Pakistan), he shifted along with his
teachers Buddhamitra and Manoratha to Ayodhya (now located in Uttar Pradesh,
northern India), a city far removed from Kashmir. According to Posou pandou
fashi zhuan, Vasubandhu, now proud of the fame he had acquired, clung
faithfully to the Hinayana doctrine in which he was well-versed and, having no
faith in the Mahayana, denied that it was the teaching of the Buddha. Vasubandhu
had up to this time but little regard for the Yogacara treatises of his elder
brother. He had perhaps seen the voluminous Yogacarabhumi compiled by
Asanga, which may have simply repelled him by its bulk. According to Bu-ston,
he is reported to have said, "Alas, Asanga, residing in the forest, has
practised meditation for twelve years. Without having attained anything by this
meditation, he has founded a system, so difficult and burdensome, that it can be
carried only by an elephant." Asanga heard about this attitude of his brother
and feared that Vasubandhu would use his great intellectual gifts to undermine
the Mahayana. By feigning illness he was able to summon his younger brother to
Purusapura, where he lived. However, Xuanzang differs with some of these details
and the place provided by Paramartha regarding Vasubandhu's conversion.
According to the Xiyuji the conversion of Vasubandhu took place at
Ayodhya. At the rendezvous, Vasubandhu asked Asanga to explain the Mahayana
teaching to him, whereupon he immediately realized the supremacy of Mahayana
thought. After further study, we are told, the depth of his realization came to
equal that of his brother. Deeply ashamed of his former abuse of the Mahayana,
Vasubandhu wanted to cut out his tongue, but refrained from doing so when
Asanga told him to use it for the cause of Mahayana. Vasubandhu regarded the
study of the enormous Shatasahasrikaprajna-paramita-sutra as of
utmost importance. In view of the fact that they were the texts that converted
him to Mahayana, Vasubandhu's commentaries on the
Akshayamatinirdesha-sutra and the Dasha-bhumika may have been
his earliest Mahayana works. These were followed by a series of commentaries on
other Mahayana sutras and treatises, including the
Avatamsakasutra, Nirvanasutra,
Vimalakirtinirdeshasutra, and Shrimaladevisutra. He himself
composed a treatise on vijnaptimatra (cognition only) theory and
commented on the Mahayanasamgraha, Triratna-gotra,
Amrita-mukha, and other Mahayana treatises. According to the Tibetan
biographers, his favorite sutra was either the
Shatasahasrikaprajna-paramita-sutra or the
Ashtasahasrika. Considering that these texts reveal the most profound
insights into Mahayana thinking, it is not surprising that Vasubandhu liked
them. Since the output of Vasubandhu's Mahayana works is huge, he was in all
probability writing new treatises every year. According to Posou pandou fashi
zhuan Vasubandhu engaged in his literary activity on behalf of the Mahayana
after Asanga's death. Xuanzang, however, tells a strange story that suggests
that Vasubandhu died before Asanga.
4. Intellectual Debates
With the composition of the Abhidharmakosha, Vasubandhu came to enjoy
the patronage and favor of two Gupta rulers, Vikramaditya and his heir
Baladitya, who can be identified respectively, as Skandagupta (ruled circa
455-467 CE) and Narasimhagupta (ruled circa 467-473 CE). The first important
intellectual debate which Vasubandhu had was with Vasurata. Vasurata was a
grammarian and the husband of the younger sister of Baladitya. It was
Baladitya who had challenged Vasubandhu to a debate. Vasubandhu was able to
defeat him successfully. Another well-known intellectual encounter which
Vasubandhu had was with Samkhyas. While Vasubandhu was away, his old master
Buddhamitra was defeated in a debate at Ayodhya by Vindhyavasin. When
Vasubandhu came to know of it, he was enraged and subsequently trounced the
Samkhyas both in debate and in a treatise the Paramarthasaptatika.
Candragupta II rewarded him with 300,000 gold coins for his victory over the
Samkhyas. Vasubandhu made use of this money to build three monasteries, one
for the Mahayanists, another one for his old colleagues the Sarvastivadins,
and a third for nuns. Refutation of Vaisheshika and Samkhya theories had been
presented by Vasubandhu already in the Abhidharmakosha, but it was
perhaps from this point onward that Vasubandhu was regarded as a philosopher
whose views could not be lightly challenged. Samghabhadra, a Sarvastivada
scholar from Kashmir, also once challenged Vasubandhu regarding the
Abhidharmakosha. He composed two treatises, one consisting of 10,000
verses and another of 120,000 verses. According to Xuanzang, it took twelve
years for Samghabhadra to finish the two works. He challenged Vasubandhu to a
debate, but Vasubandhu refused, saying, "I am already old, so I will let you say
what you wish. Long ago, this work of mine destroyed the Vaibhashika (i.e., the
Sarvastivada) doctrines. There is no need now of confronting you... Wise men
will know which of us is right and which one is wrong."
5. Date of Vasubandhu
The date of Vasubandhu has posed a problem for historians. According to
Paramartha, Vasubandhu lived 900 years after the Mahaparinirvana of the
Buddha. At another place, Paramartha also mentions the figure of 1100. Xuanzang
and his disciples respectively mention that Vasubandhu lived 1000 and 900 years
after the Mahaparinirvana of the Buddha. Now though it is generally believed
that the Mahaparinirvana of the Buddha took place within few years of 400
BCE, some scholars are still hesitant to accept this date. This has led to
different scholars proposing different dates for Vasubandhu. Noul Pari and
Shio Benkyoo give as Vasubandhu's dates the years 270 to 350 CE. Steven Anacker
proposes his date as 316-396 CE, Ui Hakuju places him in the fourth century
(320-400 CE). Takakusu Junjiroo and Kimura Taiken gave 420 to 500, Wogihara
Unrai gives 390 to 470 CE, and Hikata Ryushoo gives 400 to 480 CE. Erich
Frauwallner suggests that there were two Vasubandhus and hence two different
dates. According to him Vasubandhu the elder lived between about 320 and 380 CE
and Vasubandhu the younger between around 400 and 480 CE. However, this
hypothesis of two Vasubandhus is no longer tenable in current scholarship as
many of the early Chinese documents used by Frauwallner are of spurious nature
and thus, their testimony cannot be accepted.
6. Writings of Vasubandhu
Vasubandhu is said to have been the author of one thousand works, 500 in the
Hinayana tradition and 500 Mahayana treatises. But only forty-seven works of
Vasubandhu are extant, nine of which survive in the Sanskrit original,
twenty-seven in Chinese translation, and thirty-three in Tibetan translation.
The Abhidharmakosha is the most voluminous among Vasubandhu's independent
expositions. It attained the status of a primary textbook to be studied by all
students of the tradition in the Northern Buddhist countries, including Tibet.
As pointed out above, the Abhidharmakosha pictures the Buddhist Path to
Enlightenment through the categorization and analysis of the seventy-five
dharmas.
Vasubandhu's Karmasiddhi (Establishing Karma) is a short,
quasi-Hinayana treatise coloured, as is the Abhidharmakosha, by
Sautrantika leanings. His Pancaskandhaprakarana (Exposition on the
Five Aggregates) discusses most of the subjects taken up in the
Abhidharmakosha. In cataloguing and categorization of dharmas in the
Pancaskandhaprakarana the dharmas is a bit different than the
Abhidharmakosha. Moreover, whereas the Abhidharmakosha talks about
seventy five dharmas, not only have several dharmas been added, but many of the
original seventy five have been dropped in the
Pancaskandhaprakarana.
In his Karmasiddhiprakarana (Exposition on Establishing Karma),
Vasubandhu challenged the views of those who held that dharmas are anything
other than being momentary. The doctrine of momentariness (kshanikavada)
perceived consciousness as a causal sequence of moments in which each moment is
caused by its immediate predecessor. However, he felt that this theory could not
explain certain categories of continuity. For instance, kshanikavada did
not offer any satisfactory explanation for the re-emergence of a consciousness
stream after having been interrupted in deep sleep. Similarly, continuity from
one life to the next could not be explained satisfactorily by this theory. To
solve such inconsistencies, Vasubandhu introduced the Yogacara notion of the
alaya vijnana (storehouse consciousness). Through this concept he
explained that the seed (bija) of a previous experience is stored
subliminally and released into a new experience. In this way, Vasubandhu not
only explained continuity between two separate moments of consciousness, but he
also provided a quasi causal explanation for the functioning of karmic
retribution. In other words, Vasubandhu's alaya vijnana provided an
explanation as to how an action performed at one time could produce its result
at another time. This concept also did away with the necessity of a permanent
atman as the doer and recipient of karma since, like a stream, it is
continuously changing with new conditions from moment to moment.
From the Yogacara point of view the most important of Vasubandhu's works are
the Vimshatika (Twenty Verses), Trimshika (Thirty Verses), and
Trisvabhavanirdesha (Exposition on the Three Natures). According to
tradition, the Trisvabhavanirdesha was reputedly his last treatise, and
his Vimshatika and Trimshika were written near the end of his
life, though we have no actual evidence to support this order. Despite the fact
that all these three texts are very concise and the Trisvabhavanirdesha
was not even known in China (and is never read in Tibet despite being part of
Tibetan canon), they form a kind of troika and represent Vasubandhu's final
accomplishment as a Yogacara-Vijnanavada teacher.
The Vimshatika is perhaps the most original and philosophically
interesting treatise of Vasubandhu. Vasubandhu devotes a major portion of this
text in dealing with the Realist objections against Yogacara. To the Realist
position that external things must exist because they are consistently located
in space as well as time, Vasubandhu responds by saying that objects also appear
to have spatial and temporal qualities in dreams, whereas nothing ‘external' is
present in the dreams. This means that the appearance of cognitive objects does
not require an actual object external to the consciousness cognizing it.
Vasubandhu, however, points out that without the consciousness nothing
whatsoever can be apprehended. Therefore, it is consciousness that is the
necessary condition and not an external object. Vasubandhu does not deny that
cognitive objects exist. However, what he denies is that such cognitive objects
have external reference points. From the Yogacara point of view, what we believe
to be external objects are actually nothing more than mental projections. Thus,
whatever we think about, know, experience, or conceptualize, occurs to us only
in our consciousness and nowhere else. In other words, according to Vasubandhu,
cognition takes place only in consciousness and nowhere else. Thus, everything
that we know is acquired through sensory experience. We are fooled by
consciousness into believing that those things which we perceive and appropriate
within consciousness are actually outside our cognitive sphere. To the Realist
objection that subjective wishes do not determine objective realities,
Vasubandhu replies that due to collective-karma groups give rise to common
misperceptions. He pointed out that it is the result of a person's own karma
that determines the type of situation in which that person would be born. Thus,
Vasubandhu points out that how we see things is shaped by previous experience,
and since experience is inter-subjective, we gather in groups that see things
the way we do. To another Realist objection that the objective world functions
by determinate causal principles, Vasubandhu points out that the appearance of
causal efficacy also occurs in dreams. Thus our conscious ‘dreams' can have
causal efficacy.
The Trimshika, which became the basic text of the Faxiang (Japanese
Hossoo) school, is one of Vasubandhu's most mature works. Through concise verses
he sums up his doctrine of vijnapti matra (cognition only) by
explaining Yogacara theories of eight-consciousnesses, three-natures and the
five-step path to Enlightenment. The eight types of consciousness are the five
sense consciousnesses, the empirical consciousness (mano-vijnana), a
self-aggrandizing mentality (manas), and the alaya-vijnana.
Vasubandhu describes and explains how each of these can be extinguished through
ashraya-paravritti i.e., through the overturning of the very basis of
these eight types of consciousness. This over-turning i.e., achievement of the
Bodhi gradually takes place through the five-step path in a way that
consciousness (vijnana) is transformed into unmediated cognition
(jnana). According to the theory of three natures, there are three
cognitive realms at play: the delusional cognitively constructed realm, which is
intrinsically unreal; the realm of causal dependency; and the perfectional realm
which is intrinsically ‘empty.' To Vasubandhu, Buddhism is a method of cleansing
the stream of consciousness from ‘contaminations' and ‘defilements.’
The Foxinglun (Treatise on Buddha Nature) exerted great influence on
Sino-Japanese Buddhism by propounding the concept of tathagata-garbha (Buddha
Nature). The Vadavidhi (A Method for Argumentation) is another important
text attributed to Vasubandhu. Though this text is not strictly speaking a
‘logic' text and does not make any distinction between techniques of debate and
logic as such, still its importance in the field of logic cannot be overlooked.
It not only provides information on the state of Buddhist logic prior to
Dignaga, but also paved the way for the revolutionary contribution of Dignaga
and Dharmakirti in the field of logic. Though not many details on the
meditative career of Vasubandhu are available, his
Madhyantavibhagabhashya (Commentary on the Separation of the Middle
from Extremes) points to his keen interest in the techniques of meditation.
Vasubandhu's commentaries on sutras and shastras are by no
means less important than the above-mentioned independent treatises. He wrote
commentaries on three treatises: the Madhyantavibhaga (Discrimination
between the Middle and the Extremes), Mahayanasutralamkara (Ornament
of the Mahayana Sutras), and Dharmadharmatavibhaga/
Dharmadharmtavibhanga (Discrimination between Existence and Essence).
All these three treatises are important texts of the Yogacara school and are
ascribed to Asanga's teacher Maitreya. Vasubandhu also composed a commentary on
Asanga's Mahayanasamgraha (Compendium of Mahayana). It is the first
methodical presentation of the doctrines of Yogacara-Vijnanavada.
Vasubandhu's Sukhavativyuhasutranirdesha (Commentary on the
Sukhavativyuha Sutra) is another important text. This text became a
fundamental treatise of the Pure Land faith in China and Japan. The Indian
Yogacara-Vijnanavada is represented in China by three schools, and the
development of all these schools is credited to the works of Vasubandhu. The
first of these schools, called the Dilun school (which was established in the
first half of the sixth century CE), took his Dashabhumikasutranirdesha
(Commentary on the Dashabhumika Sutra) as its basic text. The second, the
Shelun school which originated in the second half of the sixth century CE,
developed around a translation of the Mahayanasamgraha done by
Paramartha. The third school, known as the Faxiang school (founded by Xuanzang
and his disciple Kuiji in the seventh century), adopted the Trimshika
as its basic text.
Later in life, Vasubandhu went so far ahead with his contemplative exercises
that he even refused to engage in a debate with his worthy opponent
Samghabhadra. He died at the age of eighty. Paramartha says that he died at
Ayodhya, whereas Bu-ston says that his death took place in the northern
frontier countries, which he calls ‘Nepal.' In recognition of his contribution
and achievements as a Mahayana teacher, he came to be reverently called a
bodhisattva in various traditions from India to China. In fact, some go to the
extent of even calling him the ‘second Buddha.' As rightly pointed out in
Bu-ston, he "was possessed of the wealth (vasu of the Highest wisdom and,
having propagated the Doctrine out of mercy, had become the friend
(bandhu) of the living beings."
7. References and Further Readings
Anacker, Steven. Seven Works of Vasubandhu. Delhi: Motilal
Banarsidass, 1984.
Duerlinger, James. Indian Buddhist Theories of Person: Vasubandhu's
Refutation of the Theory of a Self. London: RoutledgeCurzon, 2003.
Frauwallner, Erich. On the Date of the Buddhist Master of the Law,
Vasubandhu. Rome: IsMeo, 1951.
Hall, Bruce C. "The Meaning of Vijnapti in Vasubandhu's Concept of
Mind." Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 9
(1986): 7-23.
Chimpa, Lama, and A. Chattopadhyaya, trans. Taranatha's History of
Buddhism in India. Simla: Indian Institute of Advanced Study, 1970.
Jaini, Padmanabh S. "On the Theory of Two Vasubandhus." Bulletin of the
School of Oriental and African Studies 21 (1958): 48-53.
Kaplan, Stefan. "A Holographic Alternative to a Traditional Yogacara
Simile: An Analysis of Vasubandhu's Trisvabhava Doctrine." Eastern
Buddhist 23 (1990): 56-78.
Kochumuttom, Thomas. A Buddhist Doctrine of Experience: A New
Translation and Interpretation of the Works of Vasubandhu the Yogacarin.
Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1982.
Kritzer, Robert. "Vasubandhu on samapratyaya vijnanamam."
Journal of the International Association of Buddhist Studies 16/1
(1993): 24-55.
p>Levi, Sylvain. Un systeme de philosophie bouddhique: Materiaux
pour l`etude du systeme Vijnaptimatra.Paris: Bibliotheque de l`ecole des
Hautes Etudes, fasc. 260, 1932.
Lusthaus, Dan. Buddhist Phenomenology: A Philosophical Investigation of
Yogacara Buddhism and the Ch'eng wei shih lun. London: Curzon, 2000.
Obermiller, E., trans. The History of Buddhism in India and Tibet by
Bu-Ston. 2nd rev. ed. Delhi: Sri Satguru Publications, 1986.
Poussin, Louis de la Vallee, trans. L'Abhidharmakosha de
Vasubandhu. 6 vols. Bruxelles, 1971 [reprint].
Pruden, Leo, trans. Abhidharma Kosha Bhashyam. 4 vols. Berkeley:
Asian Humanities Press, 1988-90.
Ryushoo, Hikata. "A Reconsideration on the Date of Vasubandhu."
Bulletin of the Faculty of the Kyushu University 4 (1956): 53-74.
Takakusu, J. "A Study of Paramartha's Life of Vasubandhu and the Date of
Vasubandhu." Journal of the Royal Asiatic Society (1905): 33-53.
Tola, Fernando, and Carmen Dragonetti, eds. "The Trisvabhavakarika
of Vasubandhu." Journal of Indian Philosophy 11 (1983):
225-266.
Waldron, William S. The Buddhist Unconsciousness: The alaya-vijnana
in the Context of Indian Buddhist Thought. London: RoutledgeCurzon,
2003.
Yamada, Isshi. "Vijnaptimatrata of Vasubandhu." Journal of the
Royal Asiatic Society (1977): 158-176.
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