Help Sheet for Late Submissions

Many prospective IEP authors, who have articles reserved in their names, fail to submit the articles by the pre-arranged due date. One of the tasks of volunteers is to routinely go through the reserve2.txt document (see link below), and contact authors who are one month over their due date. The form letter can be used to contact these authors:

Dear Ibrahim Hassan,

I am contacting prospective authors who are past the due date for articles
reserved in their names.  Are you still intending to write this article?  We hope so.

Lakatos, Ibrahim Hassan, ibrahimh@hotmail.com,
Ain Shams University, Cairo, Egypt, due by Jan. 2006

To keep our submission process running smoothly, please reply to this
message and let me know if you still intend to submit the article. If so,
give a new date by which we can expect it, preferably a due date
within the next six months.

If I do not hear from you, I will assume that you are no longer interested,
and I will remove the reservation in your name. I request that you contact
me even if you do not plan to write the article, though, which will make our
record keeping easier.

If you have in fact already submitted the item, I also apologize for this
oversight, and I need to be reminded of this.

Sincerely yours,

Your name

Once an author has replied with a new due date, update his/her entry in reserve2.txt by adding something like this:

Lakatos, Ibrahim Hassan, ibrahimh@hotmail.com,
Ain Shams University, Cairo, Egypt, due by Jan. 2006, extended to Jan. 2007.

Leave in the old due date, so we have some memory of how long the potential author is reserving the title and thereby warding off other potential authors.  If the author wishes to have the reservation cancelled, delete the entry on both reserved lists. You can expect that many authors will not respond to your message, so you’ll probably want to delete their entry after two or three weeks of silence from them.  If your email bounces back as undeliverable, then you can delete their entry immediately.

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