Edmund Husserl (1859—1938)

Although not the first to coin the term, it is uncontroversial to suggest that the German philosopher, Edmund Husserl (1859-1938), is the “father” of the philosophical movement known as phenomenology.  Phenomenology can be roughly described as the sustained attempt to describe experiences (and the “things themselves”) without metaphysical and theoretical speculations. Husserl suggested that only by suspending or bracketing away the “natural attitude” could philosophy becomes its own distinctive and rigorous science, and he insisted that phenomenology is a science of consciousness rather than of empirical things. Indeed, in Husserl’s hands phenomenology began as a critique of both psychologism and naturalism.  Naturalism is the thesis that everything belongs to the world of nature and can be studied by the methods appropriate to studying that world (that is, the methods of the hard sciences). Husserl argued that the study of consciousness must actually be very different from the study of nature. For him, phenomenology does not proceed from the collection of large amounts of data and to a general theory beyond the data itself, as in the scientific method of induction. Rather, it aims to look at particular examples without theoretical presuppositions (such as the phenomena of intentionality, of love, of two hands touching each other, and so forth), before then discerning what is essential and necessary to these experiences. Although all of the key, subsequent phenomenologists (Heidegger, Sartre, Merleau-Ponty, Gadamer, Levinas, Derrida) have contested aspects of Husserl’s characterization of phenomenology, they have nonetheless been heavily indebted to him. As such, he is arguably one of the most important and influential philosophers of the twentieth century. The key features of his work, and his understanding of the phenomenological method, are considered in what follows.

Table of Contents

1. Biography
2. How to Interpret Husserl’s Texts
3. On the Concept of Number (Übert den Begriff der Zahl, 1887)
4. Logical Investigations (Logische Untersuchungen, 1900-01)
5. Ideas I (Ideen I, 1913)
6. Ideas II (Ideen II)
7. References and Further Reading

1. Biography

Edmund Husserl was born April 8, 1859, into a Jewish family in the town of Prossnitz in Moravia, then a part of the Austrian Empire. Although there was a Jewish technical school in the town, Edmund’s father, a clothing merchant, had the means and the inclination to send the boy away to Vienna at the age of 10 to begin his German classical education in the Realgymnasium of the capital. A year later, in 1870, Edmund transferred to the Staatsgymnasium in Olmütz, closer to home. He was remembered there as a mediocre student who nevertheless loved mathematics and science, “of blond and pale complexion, but of good appetite.” He graduated in 1876 and went to Leipzig for university studies.

At Leipzig Husserl studied mathematics, physics, and philosophy, and he was particularly intrigued with astronomy and optics. After two years he went to Berlin in 1878 for further studies in mathematics. He completed that work in Vienna, 1881-83, and received the doctorate with a dissertation on the theory of the calculus of variations. He was 24. Husserl briefly held an academic post in Berlin, then returned again to Vienna in 1884 and was able to attend Franz Brentano’s lectures in philosophy.

In 1886 he went to Halle, where he studied psychology and wrote his Habilitationsschrift on the concept of number. He also was baptized. The next year he became Privatdozent at Halle and married a woman from the Prossnitz Jewish community, Malvine Charlotte Steinschneider, who was baptized before the wedding. The couple had three children. They remained at Halle until 1901, and Husserl wrote his important early books there. The Habilitationsschrift was reworked into the first part of Philosophie der Arithmetik, published in 1891. The two volumes of Logische Untersuchungen came out in 1900 and 1901.

In 1901 Husserl joined the faculty at Göttingen, where he taught for 16 years and where he worked out the definitive formulations of his phenomenology that are presented in Ideen zu einer reinen Ph‰nomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie (Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy). The first volume of Ideen appeared in the first volume of Husserl’s Jahrbuch für Philosophie und phänomenologische Forschung in 1913. Then the world war disrupted the circle of Husserl’s younger colleagues, and Wolfgang Husserl, his son, died at Verdun. Husserl observed a year of mourning and kept silence professionally during that time.

However Husserl accepted appointment in 1916 to a professorship at Freiburg im Breisgau, a position from which he would retire in 1928. At Freiburg Husserl continued to work on manuscripts that would be published after his death as volumes two and three of the Ideen, as well as on many other projects. His retirement from teaching in 1928 did not slow the pace of his phenomenological research. But his last years were saddened by the escalation of National Socialism’s racist policies against Jews. He died of pleurisy in 1938, on Good Friday, reportedly as a Christian.

Most commentators, therefore, recognize three periods in Husserl’s career: the work at Halle, Göttingen, and Freiburg, respectively. Some argue that one or another of these periods ought to be taken as definitive and used as the interpretive key to unlock the others. But such an approach highlights disjunctions in Husserl’s thought while neglecting the significant continuities. Important strands of Husserl’s philosophy have their beginning long before his academic career commenced.

The community into which Husserl was born, Prossnitz, was a center of talmudic learning whose yeshiva had produced or welcomed a number of famous rabbis during the two centuries before Husserl’s birth. This scholarly activity was supported by the industries of textile and clothing manufacture, through which Prossnitz’s Jews had enhanced the prosperity of the region. Jews and Germans were minorities in the town and appear to have comprised its middle class. Their interests were naturally allied against those of the Slavic majority. (For example, the census of 1900 counted 1,680 Jews among the town’s 24,000 inhabitants, according to The Jewish Encyclopedia.) In the ethnically diverse town, several dialects were spoken, and the language of the Husserl home probably was Yiddish.

The Jewish community of Prossnitz had established a technical school in 1843, and it became a public school for all the town’s children in 1869–one year before young Edmund Husserl was sent off to Vienna’s Realgymnasium. 1868 was also a year when civic authorities called for reform of Jewish education at all levels throughout Moravia. These developments reflect a movement toward modernization and integration after centuries of enforced segregation and legal restriction of Jewish life.

Prossnitz was the second-largest Jewish community in Moravia, with 328 families. Exactly 328 families; it could have no more, because of the quota established by the Bohemian Familianten Gesetz in 1787. The Jewish population was controlled through marriage licenses. Civil law set specific economic, age, and educational requirements; but in addition, the license could be granted only after a death freed up one of the allotted 328 slots. In effect, only first sons could hope to marry. Others had to emigrate if they wanted to have families of their own. This population-control policy was enforced until 1849, ten years before Edmund Husserl’s birth. The requirement that Jews obtain special marriage licenses remained in effect until late in 1859, some months after Edmund’s birth.

But Edmund Husserl’s childhood was spent during an era of liberalization for Prossnitz’s Jews. He received an elite secular education and probably made his father quite proud. At that period, gymnasia provided separate religious instruction for Christian boys and Jewish boys. Edmund’s Jewish education would have continued in that context and in the language of secular culture, High German. He could hear and read the Bible in that modern language as well, for in the nineteenth century a wave of new translations into the language of German culture was spawned by Moses Mendelssohn’s groundbreaking work. (Mendelssohn’s 1783 translation into High German was printed in Hebrew characters, phonetically, to make it easy to read.) Some of these editions were lavishly illustrated for display in bourgeois homes like Edmund’s, and most took into account the findings of recent historical and philological science. But during Edmund’s childhood, translating the Hebrew Bible was still a controversial issue. Some educational leaders in the Jewish community warned that it would undermine Hebrew learning among the young. Hebrew learning was evidently not prized by a father who would send his son to the capital to study Greek and Latin at the age when boys traditionally were sent down the street to learn Hebrew and Torah. To complicate the picture, in 1870 when Edmund was eleven, a new rabbi came to serve the Prossnitz community.

One may surmise, then, that Edmund Husserl came by his knowledge of the Bible through his classical secular education, not his religious tradition. It was of a piece with the German cultural heritage for him. It was a source of literary allusions, and in later life he could compare himself to Moses and to Sisyphus with equal ease.

Literary allusions, along with fragments of correspondence, are all that remain to us for the reconstruction of what Husserl may have felt about himself and his work. There is no autobiography per se. But there are retrospective texts. One of the most illuminating is the brief introduction that Husserl prepared for the 1931 publication in English of the first book of Ideen, originally brought out in 1913.

Now in his seventies, Husserl complains that most readers have misunderstood his life’s work. When he undertakes to reformulate what phenomenology is and what he has accomplished, however, he writes from a vantage point that he did not have some two decades earlier. Husserl becomes, in effect, a critic and interpreter of his own work, which he describes with a sustained metaphor. He portrays himself as an explorer who has opened the way into new territory so that others may conquer, map, and farm it. Of himself, Husserl writes:

“(H)e who for decades did not speculate about a new Atlantis but instead actually journeyed in the trackless wilderness of a new continent and undertook the virgin cultivation of some of its areas will not allow himself to be deterred in any way by the rejection of geographers who judge his reports according to their habitual ways of experiencing and thinking and thereby excuse themselves from the pain of undertaking travels in the new land” (422)

Here is another example of this characterization:

I can see spread out before me the endlessly open plains of true philosophy, the ‘promised land’, though its thorough cultivation will come after me” (429)

By means of this spatial, geographical metaphor of crossing over into the “new land,” Husserl conveys something of the adventure and pioneer courage that should accompany phenomenological work. This science is related to “a new field of experience, exclusively its own, the field of ‘transcendental subjectivity’,” and it offers “a method of access to the transcendental-phenomenological sphere” (408). Husserl is the “first explorer” (419) of this marvelous place.

2. How to Interpret Husserl’s Texts

Husserl had already employed the spatial metaphor in the 1913 text, although without explicit reference to himself as explorer. In chapter I-1 of Ideen I he had distinguished states of affairs (Sachverhaltnis) from essences (Wesen) by assigning them to two “spheres”: the factual or material, and the formal or eidetic, respectively. These spheres are connected only by the mind’s ability to pass between them as easily as moving around within either of them; they do not connect on their own, as it were. That is, no causality obtains between them. “Movement between” and “movement within” are of course further elaborations upon the spatial metaphor, and serve to designate the ability of consciousness to flow along, concentrate itself, linger, combine, focus, or disperse as it will. Such acts of consciousness belong to these spheres. They are worldly. They are “psychological.”

Husserl’s task is to get from those spheres into another “field” that is quite unlike them. It will be the sphere of absolute consciousness, consciousness when it isn’t going anywhere. As the title of chapter II-3 puts it, this will be “The Region of Pure Consciousness.” You can’t “go there” with consciousness; instead you have to let the worldly go away and then inhabit what’s left. This is the import of the infamous fantasy that opens paragraph 33: “(W)as kann als Sein noch setzbar sein, wenn das Weltall, das All der Realit‰t eingeklammert bleibt?” (In Kersten’s paraphrase: “What can remain, if the whole world, including ourselves with all our cogitare, is excluded?” [63])

Now, it’s quite curious that Husserl should choose the spatial metaphor to introduce and induce his phenomenological reduction. This metaphor invites confusion for anyone familiar with Descartes– who after all named spatial extension as the substantial attribute of material being. None of Husserl’s “spheres” is literally extended, in the Cartesian sense; yet all are coextensive (coincident) with material being–inasmuch as there’s literally nowhere else besides the material universe where they could be. Why then should Husserl choose such an incongruous and counterproductive metaphor? A different metaphor (such as “fabric” or “organism,” for example) could have conveyed the notions of coherence, separation, and access that Husserl intended. What is distinctive about the spatial metaphor, however, is that it connotes exploration and conquest. If transcendental consciousness is a promised land, then you need a Moses to lead you toward it. You need Husserl. When Husserl remarks, in the 1931 Introduction, that he can look down across that land that he has discovered, but that others will enter, this is a literary allusion to the figure of Moses, who led his people to Canaan, “the promised land,” but did not lead them into it (Deuteronomy 34).

If these allusions from 1931 can be taken as a thumbnail self- portrait, still one must remember that it was sketched during Husserl’s retirement. But Husserl’s thought grew and changed throughout his long career. In his maturity, the philosopher joined his readers in producing commentary upon his youthful work. The three phases of Husserl’s career–Halle, Göttingen, and Freiburg–invite facile divisions, and decisive turning points have been suggested within each of those periods. (The survival of nearly 45,000 pages of stenographic notes from Husserl’s teaching and his private researches has fueled disputes about when he might have had the first glimmer of a thought that led to a lecture comment that led to a paragraph that found its way into a book published long after the man’s papers and ashes were shelved in Louvain!)

Husserl himself insisted that the threads of continuity throughout the evolution of his thought were more significant than any false starts that later had to be repudiated. It seems well to grant him this point. Yet on two issues one must take seriously the critical discussion arising from disjunctions in Husserl’s thought: (a) the question whether to characterize Husserl as realist or idealist, and (b) the question of which stage of Husserl’s evolution–if any–should be taken as the definitive version through which all other versions are to be read. Husserl himself, writing as his own critic later in life, took a position on each of those issues. On (a), he insisted that he was and always had meant to be a transcendental idealist. On (b), he claimed competence to correct the insights of 1887, 1900, and 1913 with the insights of the 1920’s and 1930’s. Thus the mature Husserl would wish to erase the impression that his early work resolved the realism-idealism conundrum in favor of realism, and that it did so in fidelity to an insight already expressed in his earliest work on number.

Various punctuations of Husserl’s career by time, place, and predominant question have been suggested by commentators (for example, Kockelmans 1967: 17-23; Ricoeur 1967: 3-12; Biemel 1970; and Bell 1990). Husserl’s phenomenology developed gradually, but there were several relatively sudden turns and several stalls. Two examples suffice to illustrate. While at Halle shortly after the publication of Philosophie der Arithmetik, Husserl distanced himself from his recent efforts to establish mathematical and logical principles upon the psychological operations of the mind—a project that he later termed “psychologism.” Many commentators have characterized this as an abrupt turn made in response to Frege’s effective criticism of Philosophie der Arithmetik. However Mohanty (1982: 13), who examines the Frege-Husserl correspondence along with other documentary evidence, concludes to the contrary, that:

the seeds of development of Husserl’s philosophy from the Philosophie der Arithmetik to the Prolegomena [i.e., the first volume of the Logische Untersuchungen, 1900] were immanent to his own thinking, so that the hypothesis of a traumatic effect of Frege’s 1894 review of his book and a consequent reversal of his mode of thinking is not only uncalled for but also unsubstantiated by the available evidence.

Mohanty, then, provides ample warrant for a reading of Husserl that pursues threads of continuity between his early mathematical work and the breakthrough to phenomenology while at Halle.

In a second example of a supposed disjuncture in Husserl’s development, there has been discussion of whether he changed his stance from realism to idealism between Göttingen and Freiburg. On the one hand, Eugen Fink (1933) and many others see a consistent evolution of transcendental idealism from the work published in Ideen I onward. They tend either to dismiss the earlier works as if they were merely youthful failures, or forcibly to harmonize the realist passages with Husserl’s later positions. Husserl himself endorsed such a reading. On the other hand, those who studied with Husserl at Göttingen insist that his work at that time had validity and integrity in its own right. His former student Edith Stein (1932: 44-45) remarks that Husserl’s disciples were surprised at the idealistic passages in Ideen, and she calls Fink a latecomer to Husserl’s phenomenology. One of Stein’s contemporaries among Husserl students, Roman Ingarden (1962: 159), says that:

the idealistic tendencies apparent in volume I of the Ideen had been opposed by his disciples when the work was being studied during the seminars at Göttingen and . . . his disciples pointed out many passages in the Ideen which seemed to contain direct arguments against his idealism.

Subsequently Ingarden presented arguments, based on both the text of Logische Untersuchungen and his conversations with Husserl, in support of the view that Husserl originally espoused a realist standpoint but later abandoned it (Ingarden 1975: 4-8). Further discussion of the issue is to be found in Kockelmans (1967: 418-449) and in Van de Pitte (1981: 36-42)–who suggests that the discrepancy will vanish if one reads Husserl’s idealism as an epistemological or methodological approach to a metaphysically real world.

For his own part, Husserl (1931: 418-9) claimed that his transcendental idealism had advanced altogether beyond ordinary idealism, beyond realism, and beyond the very distinction between them. He denied that he ever had held a realist position:

. . . I still consider, as I did before, every form of the usual philosophical realism nonsensical in principle, no less so than that idealism which it sets itself up against in its arguments and which it “refutes.” [Phenomenological reduction] is a piece of pure self- reflection, exhibiting the most original evident facts; moreover, if it brings into view in them the outlines of idealism . .. it is still anything but a party to the usual debates bewteen idealism and realism. . . .

Husserl argued that transcendental-phenomenological idealism did not deny the actual existence of the real world, but sought instead to clarify the sense of this world (which everyone accepts) as actually existing.

Thus Husserl joins the company of those who read his work “backwards,” from the standpoint of Freiburg, interpreting the earliest work in light of the transcendental idealism of the latest. This reading grants no validity to the earlier work in its own right. It sets Husserl against Kant, and phenomenology’s thoroughgoing idealism against Kantian critical idealism. Fink, in his detailed response to neo- Kantians’ readings of Husserl’s phenomenology (1932), scolds them for even addressing arguments made in Husserl’s 1900-1 and 1913 publications–for Fink contends that those positions now must be assimilated to Husserl’s later formulations. The extreme hermeneutical implications of this stance come clear in Fink’s delineation of the threefold paradox entailed in reading Husserl’s phenomenology: (1) It is inevitably misunderstood if the reader has not first cultivated the transcendental attitude; yet that attitude arises from the reading. (2) The words necessarily miss their meaning, and fail to refer effectively to the pre-worldly realm of transcendental subjectivity, since all available words are worldly. (3) Phenomenology goes to a realm beyond logic, individuation, and determination, which ordinarily structure understanding. In this extreme form, then, the Freiburg reading of Husserl’s work is a locked door for the newcomer who is trying to get acquainted with Husserl’s phenomenology.

Fortunately, there are other hermeneutical options. A second group of commentators read Husserl “forward” from his intellectual beginnings at Vienna and Halle. The early work in mathematics and logic continues to attract the interest of Analytic philosophers. They are among those who argue that Husserl’s concern with numbers and logical reasoning, stimulated by the Kantian challenge, fructified in the prescription of eidetic and, eventually, phenomenological reductions.

Besides reading Husserl from Halle “forward” or from Freiburg “backward,” there is yet a third option. One may base one’s reading upon the Göttingen period and upon questions involving the genesis of the Ideen, as the keystone in the arch of Husserl’s development. This is the stance suggested by Ingarden, who considered Husserl’s later transcendentalism a big mistake, and by Stein, whose own subsequent works unfold the implications of the realism and personalism embraced by Husserl at that period. On this view the world, lost by Kant, is won back for science.

The problems of oneness and unity occupied Husserl throughout all the phases of his philosophical development: his earliest work on number and logic, his pre-war realist descriptive phenomenology, and his idealist transcendental phenomenology. His philosophy in some respects parallels the emergence of modern psychology, with whose tenets it should not be confused. The following are his major works.

3. On the Concept of Number (Übert den Begriff der Zahl, 1887)

Husserl’s Habilitationsschrift is subtitled “psychological analyses,” and it addresses the question how we recognize manyness within a group. Husserl remarks that the common definition of number–that number is a multiplicity of units–leaves two key questions unanswered: “What is ‘multiplicity’? And what is ‘unity’?” It is the former question, multiplicity, that occupies his attention throughout the essay. However the latter question, unity, haunts the discussion and refuses to be ignored.

Husserl locates the origin of multiplicity in the activity of combining, which he takes to be a psychological process. After much consideration he identifies this activity as synthesis, or the gathering of items into a set. He notices then that synthetic unities are of two kinds. Either the relationship through which the multiple items belong to the one set is a content of the mental representation of those items (right in there alongside them as another item that can be attended to and counted), or it is not there. In the former case, the unity is physical. Otherwise it is psychical, stemming from the unifying mental act that sets the contents into the relationship.

Having made that distinction between natural or physical unity, and arbitrary or imposed unity, Husserl then goes on to contrast these varieties of synthetic oneness with something else entirely: unsynthesized unity. His example is a rose, whose so-called parts are continuous and come apart only for the examining mind.

“In order to note the uniting relations in such a whole, analysis is necessary. If, for example, we are dealing with the representational whole which we call ‘a rose,’ we get at its various parts successively, by means of analysis: the leaves, the stem…. Each part is thrown into relief by a distinct act of noticing, and is steadily held together with those parts already segregated” (114).

Ironically, Husserl has struck gold while mining coal, and doesn’t quite recognize what he’s got hold of. His description of nonsynthesized unity comes almost as a byproduct of his attempt to differentiate physical or real collective combination from psychic combination. He writes:

“… these combining relations present themselves as, so to speak, a certain ‘more,’ in contrast to the mere totality, which appears merely to seize upon its parts, but not really to unite them [because they’re already united, independently of the mind!]…. In the totality there is a lack of any intuitive unification, as that sort of unification so clearly manifests itself in the metaphysical or continuous whole” (114).

Husserl has succeeded in distinguishing between natural and artificially synthesized wholes, on the one hand, and, on the other hand, those totalities that are known as having been accomplished neither by natural aggregation nor by mental combination. The unity of such wholes is known to be real, even though it admits of subsequent mental analysis or physical dissection.

Again ironically, in his concluding discussion of “number” Husserl neglects to notice the number one even as he employs it to illustrate how combination works. Substituting the term “and” for the term “collective combination,” Husserl remarks:

“(T)otality or multiplicity in abstracto is nothing other than ‘something or other’, and ‘something or other’, and ‘something or other’, etc.; or, more briefly, one thing, and one thing, and one thing, etc. Thus we see that the concept of the multiplicity contains, besides the concept of collective combination, only the concept something. Now this most general of all concepts is, as to its origin and content, easily analyzed” (116).

Husserl terms the concept something the most general concept. It stands for any object–real or unreal, physical or psychical–upon which we reflect. Thus he says that multiplicity as a concept arises out of the indetermination of the et-cetera that allows the series of “one and one and one and …” to go however far you like.

Yet an objection must be registered concerning what Husserl has found but not noticed. Multiplicity is but relatively undetermined; ultimately, multiplicity is in fact determined, or reined in, by one itself. This happens at three points. (a) One is the starting point of the counting series. Every number except the first number is a multiplicity; therefore the set of natural numbers is greater (by one!) than the set of multiplicities. (b) One determines the unit of counting. Only one something at a time gets counted. The and‘s must be put in between one‘s. (c) Although the series can stop anywhere, nevertheless it has to stop at one single place, not at several places. Every number is one distinct number.

Husserl, however, tries to produce the concept number by suppressing what he has taken to be the absolute indetermination of the something-series. This is how he gets determinate multiplicity, which he equates with number. In other words, the and‘s are the main ingredient for making numbers Husserl-style. This is incorrect, of course, but it is incorrect in an interesting way. For example, to make the number five, you would need four and‘s. To come up with those four and‘s, you would have to count them out; but before you could count to four, you would need three and‘s with which to make that four. But… there’s a regression back to one. The number five is four and’s, and five one’s.

The maddening difficulty of focusing upon combination eventually will have a happy outcome, which Husserl did not see in 1887. The truly interesting problem is one, the prime ingredient in numbers and the determiner whose own determination was to become Husserl’s guiding quest.

4. Logical Investigations (Logische Untersuchungen, 1900-01)

With the turn of the century, Husserl’s attention turned from and to one; that is, away from the mental activity of combining, and toward that which is reliably there to be combined. He wanted to show that mental activity is not the source of the latter. Chapter 8 of LU I exposes and refutes the three premises or “prejudices” of psychologism. In short, “psychologism” for Husserl is the error of collapsing the normative or regulative discipline of logic down onto the merely descriptive discipline of psychology. It would make mental operations (such as combination) the source of their own regulation. The “should” of logic, that utter necessity inhering in logical inference, would become no more than the “is” or facticity of our customary thinking processes, empirically described.

Husserl’s formulation and refutation of the three psychologistic premises is wickedly clever, but cannot be treated in detail here. (See # 43-49 of LU I.) One example must suffice. Psychologism, Husserl charges, would place logical inferences on the same plane with mental operations (# 44), and this would make even mathematics into a branch of psychology (# 45). Indeed, math and logic do have structures that are isomorphic to those of mental operations, such as combination and distinction. But given that similarity, how then would one distinguish the regulation of any of these processes from the description of it? Under psychologism, there’s no way. But Husserl makes the distinction in a way that also shows how regulation (that is, the laws of logic) comes from elsewhere than the plane of mental activity.

And he does this by virtue of one. In # 46 Husserl agrees with his opponents that arithmetical operations occur in patterns that refer back to mental acts for their origin and also for their meaning. However, there’s a difference between them as well. Mental acts transpire in time: they begin and end, and they can be repeated and individually counted. Numbers, in contrast, are timeless. While they can be represented in mental acts, this representation is not a fresh production of the number but rather an instantiation of its form. There is only one five. Any time we count five things, it isn’t a production of a new five but merely a deja vu for the same old five, eternal five. We can’t count numbers themselves, for there’s only one of each. (A similar argument is made in #22 of Ideas I.)

The same goes for logic, Husserl says. Concepts comprising the laws of pure logic can have no empirical range. Their range or sphere is ideal singulars, not mental generalizations from multiple instantiations. The operators of logic are other than those mental acts that happen to share the same names: “and,” “not,” “is,” “or,” “implies,” “may,” “must,” “should.” Psychologically, there can be many factual acts of combining, negating, etc. Logically, there is only one “and,” one “not,” etc. Husserl concedes here, as he did for arithmetic, that the logical operators take their origin and meaning from the mental acts. This accounts for the equivocal character of logical terms, which refer both to ideal singulars, and to mental states and acts. But if you fail to notice this equivocation, you become ensnared in psychologism, losing the possibility of pure logic and unified science.

The danger of equivocation extends over judgments as well. On the one hand, we can count multiple apperceptive events of affirmation, occurring psychologically, which proceed in time, begin and end, and recur as often as we like, in happenings that can be distinguished one from another. On the other hand, the judgment thus reached remains the same throughout each act accessing it. It seems to persist and to be called back for encore appearances; it seems even to have pre-existed its first appearance to me (# 47). In this latter sense, the judgment is not the same as the mental act that reaches it. Moreover, the truth of the judgment is neither equivalent to nor dependent upon the psychological experience of clear evidence that accompanies the mental act embracing it. Husserl easily shows this by recalling that in both logic and arithmetic, there are truths that have never been entertained in any human consciousness, and indeed could never be humanly conceived (# 50). (Cases of truth without the possibility of psychological evidence would include the computation of very large numbers, and decisions about membership in sets that are uncountably large. The arithmetical and logical operations connected with such determinations could never be “done” by a human mind or a computer. Their truth cannot be “factual.”)

The number one, then, has become Husserl’s touchstone for discriminating between psychological processes and logical laws. It is his reality detector. What is psychological (or empirical) comes on in discrete individual instances–ones–and you can examine their edges. What is logical (or ideal) comes on as a seamless oceanic unity without temporal edges, reliably persisting even when not attended to. Husserl’s sensitivity to the modes of unity, first expressed in the Habilitationsschrift and developed in LU, provides the launching pad for transcendental phenomenology.

5. Ideas I (Ideen I, 1913)

What launches transcendental phenomenology is the recognition that those modes of unity correlate with each other and with a third mode of unity, in ways that are tantalizingly asymmetrical. These three onenesses are: the factual unity of things and states of affairs, the eidetic unity of essences, and the living unity of consciousness as it flows along in a stream of experiences. Each has, and exhibits, its own distinctive kind of identity and persistence. Factual and essential unities give objects to the straightforward regard of consciousness, entering it as items of experience, each in its distinctive way; but consciousness can also deflect its regard back onto these enterings and discover its own unity, which is unlike either of theirs.

The possibility of this complex correlation is provided by the “principle of principles”: that intuitions come on to us with distinctive boundary-conditions that we can accept as sources insuring the correctness of our knowledge of them. Or in Husserl’s formulation:

“… that every originary presentive intuition is a legitimizing source of cognition, that everything originarily (so to speak, in its “personal” actuality) offered to us in ‘intuition’ is to be accepted simply as what it is presented as being, but also only within the limits in which it is presented there” (44).

The different kinds of unities have different kinds of edges, and these give away what kind of a unity each of them is going to be. But it’s easy to miss the differences. That happens in the natural attitude, Husserl says, when all the objects of consciousness are taken as if they were factual items. Husserl complains that even his Logische Untersuchungen have been misunderstood as advocating just this error of “Platonic realism,” by those who read into his use of the term “object” the implication that, through a perverse hypostatization, every thought turns into a thing (# 22). On the contrary, he says, the eidetic reduction, operative already in LU, empowers him to differentiate between how essences appear, and how cases appear.

Now with Ideen I, this distinction is sketched in beautiful detail. You can tell when the object occupying your consciousness is a physical thing, because things don’t give themselves to you all at once. What you get instead is a perspective inviting you to move around to the other side to perceive some more of the thing. All the while the thing keeps its unity to itself, as the reference point of all the angles it gives to you, and out of which you must reproduce or copy or simulate the unified thing as you conceive it. But in conceiving, you don’t have to put an “and” between two separate perceptions, the north face of a building and the south face, in order to yield the perception of the building as if it were a sum. These different views are given to you as continuous, as views of one thing.

Husserl terms this “shading off” or adumbration. (The notion of off-shading is reminiscent of a multiple-exposure photograph that captures successive phases of a movement in a single frame. Such photos were being seen for the first time at the turn of the century. Husserl also mentions new media such as the stereoscope and the cinema.) In contrast, essences give themselves to you all at once. Their boundaries are not sides, but rather laws entailing the characteristic necessities and possibilities of kinds of things (more about which below). The unity of any particular essence coheres within that determinate outermost boundary which free imaginative variations of possible cases must not exceed if they are to remain cases of this particular kind. Essential unity is centripetal, so to speak.

Then are those other unities–the ones presenting themselves as extended or factual–to be termed centrifugal, inasmuch as each spins off appearances in all directions from an inaccessible center? No, for their off-shading appears contextualized, as a foreground; and even as we focus upon the foreground it pulls its background into readiness for perception as soon as attention may shift to it. Every one is surrounded by a halo of and‘s, and beyond that are other somethings, seemingly without end. Whatever is extended is inexorably connected to whatever else is extended. (This last formulation, by the way, is an instance of an eidetic law. But the shift of attention that brings this essential rule into view is an eidetic reduction, and it wrenches us away from our naive attention to instances of things naturally appearing, under consideration here.) Every perception “motivates” another, stretching on toward expanding horizons.

The shift to the transcendental attitude–that is, the phenomenological or transcendental reduction–brings to Husserl’s notice a third kind of unity, which discloses the off-shading of things in a startling new way. We notice now that what is adumbrated is spatial, but the adumbration itself is not spatial. It arises in consciousness. “Abschattung ist Erlebnis” (95), while what is adumbrated, das Abgeschattete, has to be something spatial. The off-shading of things is at the same time the streaming of conscious life. Peculiarly, the giving off of partial perceptibilities (by the thing) coincides with the taking up of partial perceptions (by streaming consciousness). Which one is doing the shading? Agency cannot be imputed absolutely to either side.

But on the “side” of consciousness, as it were, we now recognize that we are dealing with more than a progression of life-bites strung together in series with and‘s. The stream of conscious life is not a sum or aggregate; nor is it a generalization. That is, it exhibits a unity unlike either the sachverhaltig unity of a factual case or the eidetisch unity of an essence. Husserl must account for that unity, which he calls an ego, Ich.

Moreover, and of paramount significance, with the benefit of the transcendental reduction it can now be told that these three kinds of unities themselves are not connected merely in series, with and‘s combining them, as if they were three discrete somethings. Their relationship is vastly more subtle. In order to understand it, through reduction we try to isolate unity from what accounts for unity. (We are not looking for something “prior to” unity — such as some “cause” of unity –, because we can’t have priority without having the number one, and oneness is just what is in question.)

Isolating oneness from the live experience-stream means removing the individual subject (you or me or Napoleon or whomever) from consideration. What is left, says Husserl, is transcendental subjectivity, “the pure act-process with its own essence” (“das reine Akterlebnis mit seinem eigenen Wesen“). (Paradoxically, we can see, right here in this formulation, that the reduction has not at all done away with essence, with states of affairs, or even with identity. We still have Eigenheit and Wesen, set in relation within a sentence. But these are now supposedly purified.) Husserl likens this de-individualized ego to a ray (# 92) or glance (# 101). Characteristically (or essentially) it has two poles or directions: the noematic and the noetic (from Greek terms noema and noesis, indicating what is thought and the act of thinking, respectively).

Husserl’s discussion of “noetic-noematic structures” fails in its attempt to show how the ego reaches and secures both the unity of the known object, and the unity of the knowing subject. But it fails in a spectacular starburst of insight. Husserl notices that the mental stream has its own distinctive kind of adumbrations or continuities, which are more complex than those discussed above, the relatively simple off-shaded appearings of spatial objects in perception. Beyond that simple sort of off-shading, consciousness can also turn back on itself and reflect upon its own intending acts, or on any component thereof. The stream meanders among spatial objects, but can also at whim objectify aspects of its own acts of intending, and consider them. This yields a thick layering of possible objects (# 97). For example, here are some noemata that might enter the live experience stream: pencils … writing … German verbs … the frustration of strong verbs … Ulrike … memories in general … the unreliability of memory … components of perceptions … the advisability of analyzing perceptions into their components … the smell of popcorn wafting into the study … the effort to resist distractions … and so forth.

Some of these arise directly from things, while others arise as objectifications of what was inherent a moment ago in the very act of knowing, the noesis. How can we tell the difference? Husserl answers that you can tell when the ego-beam has penetrated through to the bottom of the stack of noemata, so to speak, and has gotten ahold of a thing itself, because at that point, all the aspects of the thing are known immanently–really–in the act of perceiving as being contained in the sense of the thing (# 98). For example, you know popcorn itself when you are perceiving the taste of butter and salt. (You do not know popcorn when you read this sentence; instead, you are reflecting on what it is to know popcorn, and popcorn’s qualities are not given immanently within your object. But then while tasting popcorn, saltiness was given immanently but not objectified.)

Husserl rightly points out that we are able to slide up and down the pole of the ego-beam at will, moving now toward the thing, now away from it to consider the act of knowing and its modalities. For example, noematically I can consider a certain cat who probably exists, but then I can turn back noetically to assess the degree of certitude that characterizes my consideration of that selfsame cat as existing (# 105). Now if we were to slide down to the point where all modalities are behind us on the noetic side of the pole, and if there we were to face the object, we would get the pure sense of the object in which its unity is given.

In # 102 Husserl claims that this can happen, and that we can indeed slide far enough toward the object that the unity of the noema will be known as not having been imposed by the act of knowing. At that point, all of its qualities supposedly will be given immanently, really, contained in the perception rather than in the secondary conscious act that may grasp it a split-second later. Its sense will have been captured as something known with certainty to comprise its qualities, without the interference of a synthetic conscious act. (If this worked, it would effectively ensure the objectivity of knowledge, and would win the day for realism against idealism.) Husserl writes:

“The noematic objects … are unities transcendent to, but evidentially intended to in, the mental process. But if that is the case, then characteristics, which arise in [those unities] for consciousness and which are seized upon as their properties in focusing the regard on them, cannot possibly be regarded as really inherent moments of the mental process” (248-249).

Rather, they inhere in the object’s sense, and subsequently are lifted out for analysis in the mental process.

The ambitiousness of this claim is matched by that of another, which has to do with the opposite end of the ego-pole. In # 108 Husserl says that we can also shinny far enough up the ego-pole that we can capture the affirming noesis in its purity. All the modalities will have been loaded over onto the side of the noema, and the no_sis will be a believing affirmation, pure and simple: an unqualified yes. Thus Husserl insists that there is a crucial difference between (a) being validly negated and (b) not-being. For example, he would distinguish (a) denying correctly that my spayed cat has a kitten, from (b) affirming that the kitten of my spayed cat is a non-entity. With (a), the negativity inheres in the noesis, which has not yet been purified of all modality; but with (b), the noesis would be pure affirmation (# 104).

How correct is Husserl’s argument? We must grant that whatever makes this particular kitten impossible inheres elsewhere than in my knowing about it, for my denying something can’t make it go away. Furthermore, there’s nothing to prevent my forcing myself to think positively the thought of the kitten that my cat never had. Such a noetic posture is at least conceivable. However, its mere possibility is not enough to accomplish Husserl’s purpose. Husserl needs to show that this pure affirming belief really is done, somewhere somehow, in the toughest case, the case of an intrinsically impossible entity such as the kitten of a spayed cat. (That is, has anyone succeeded in recapturing that magic moment of purely affirming noesis with regard to an intrinsically impossible object? And if so, how would one go about certifying the accomplishment?)

Unfortunately, neither end of the ego-ray connects as Husserl had hoped. At the noetic pole, the purely affirming ego eludes the grasp of consciousness; so does the pure sense of the thing itself, at the noematic pole. These terms may remain as ideal asymptotes toward which the ego-ray continually points while continually falling short. The successful recovery of the connection between knowing and reality awaits another strategy, to be mounted by Husserl in the posthumously published second volume of Ideen.

6. Ideas II (Ideen II)

The second volume of Husserl’s Ideen (publication withheld until 1952) is the work of many hands. Husserl was dissatisfied with it and did not publish it. The first draft was written very rapidly in 1912, immediately after the manuscript of the first volume was completed. Husserl added material in 1915, and turned it over for editing to his assistant Edith Stein, who had come with him to Freiburg from Gottingen. Stein transcribed the work from Husserl’s shorthand in 1916. He gave her further material, and in 1918 she produced a collation arranged and titled as at present: the constitution of material nature, of animal nature, and of the cultural world. But Husserl’s phenomenology was evolving, and the manuscript did not suit him. Another assistant, Ludwig Landgrebe, worked on it 1923-25, and Husserl himself edited it in again 1928. It finally came out posthumously.

If the pursuit of unity had guided Husserl like a north star from his earliest writing on through the discovery and first articulation of phenomenology, then in Ideen II that star becomes obscured by “light pollution” from numerous more recent and competing insights. Without access to the manuscripts, it is impossible to know with precision how that came about. In portions of the text as we have it, the concern with unity remains a significant factor.

However, other portions seem to go against the grain of key insights from the first volume and the earlier works. For example, in LU and Ideen I, the material sphere had comprised states of affairs; that is, facts or cases such as could be expressed in logical propositions. There were indeed “things” in there, such as roses, yet the emphasis was upon the factual scenarios into which these things figured. By contrast, in Ideen II “material nature” is populated with substantial items, and the fact they are embedded in circumstances has to be additionally stipulated, almost as an afterthought (# 15c). By the same token, in the earlier work the eidetic sphere had comprised the forms of logical propositions and the rules of inference. While there were indeed “essences” entailed there, nevertheless the emphasis fell upon the lawful patterns of thinking about being. By contrast, in Ideen II “animal nature” is populated by psychic items whose unity is analogous to that of physical things yet whose active engagement with the latter can hardly be explained.

This shift matters, because judgments and perceptions reach unity in quite different ways. To certify that one selfsame proposition (e.g., that the cat is on the mat) returns to our consciousness on several occasions is quite a different task than to certify that one selfsame substantial entity (e.g., this mat-loving cat) returns to our sight every afternoon. Husserl’s early discoveries about unity had to do with judgment, and they were based upon the lived difference between synthetic judgments and analytic judgments. His ambitions then were not primarily metaphysical or epistemological. Moreover, it is relatively easy to “feel” the difference among three sorts of judgment: (a) a synthetic judgment that arbitrarily groups several items together, (b) a synthetic judgment that groups things in recognition of some characteristic that all share independently of the judgment, and (c) a judgment that the unity imputed to a thing is not owing to judgment at all. The distinction among these judgment-forms was already established in the Habilitationsschrift. However the task undertaken in Ideen II is forcibly to transpose that distinction onto perception, and so to come up with a general test for certifying when knowledge is genuinely in touch with reality.

This project is set in motion in # 9, where new terminology is introduced for the threefold distinction first made in “Begriff der Zahl.” (However, now that the transcendental reduction is presupposed, the arrow of causality should be removed. There can be only correlation or its absence.) BZ’s “psychic relation” now becomes “categorial synthesis,” in which perception serendipitously collects disparate items into one group, for no special reason intrinsic to the items. BZ’s “content relation” (or “physical relation”) becomes “aesthetic synthesis” (or “sensuous synthesis”), in which perception recognizes some intrinsic reason for grouping these items and finds itself constrained to do so by something other than mere whim. And BZ’s uncomposed unity (e.g., “that rose there”) becomes the “pure sense-object.”

In BZ, “synthesis” meant a combining judgment: a judgment that erected a set of things with many members. A set with one member–that is, a unified thing–obviously needed no synthesizing judgment to set it up. In Ideen II, however, “synthesis” means a perception that, while receiving multiple impressions (the off-shadings or Abschattungen), composes an object out of them. But this object is a unity, not a group; in fact, it is what Husserl would earlier have called an uncomposed unity. In other words aesthetic synthesis–operating now over partial views, not discrete items–finds that it has a reason for referring those multiple impressions to one object, even though the unity of the thing never gives itself directly to consciousness. What is that reason? This question is enticing, because Husserl is tantalizingly close here to describing a way in which the real unity of things is available for knowledge.

Husserl works on this question in # 15b, where “the spatial body is a synthetic unity of a manifold of strata of ‘sensuous appearances’ of different senses” (42-43). The spatially extended thing is a unity drawing together all the experiences we have had of it, and summoning us toward further experiences of it through sight and touch and our other senses. It achieves its unity as a spatial location, which seems not to depend upon whether or not it is actually perceived.

However, Husserl cautions, this unity alone is insufficient to validate itself. He writes:

“(W)e have first taken the body as independent of all causal conditioning, i.e., merely as a unity which presents itself visually or tactually, through multiplicities of sensations, as endowed with an inner content of characteristic features…. But in what we have said, it is also implied that under the presupposition referred to (namely, that we take the thing outside of the nexuses in which it is a thing) we do not find, as we carry out experiences, any possibility for deciding, in a way that exhibits, whether the experienced material thing is actual or whether we are subject to mere illusion and are experiencing a mere phantom” (43).

Thus, reality is not guaranteed for an isolated item, even when it seems to be giving us a reason to take it as the unified core attracting its manifold appearings to one hub of reference. The central location of the thing is dependent upon its real circumstances, as Husserl goes on to say in # 15c. The reality of “one” depends on “others”; i.e., on thing-connection. The thing is what it is in relation to its surroundings. This becomes apparent when things move and change, for their changes must correlate coherently with reciprocal changes in the things next to them.

Such co-variance is what certifies reality–or materiality, which Husserl seems to equate with it. In # 15c, reality means substantial causality. Within the webwork of material things, everything affects everything else. The real is the causal. Co-variance across the material realm, then, is what certifies the oneness and reality of that realm (# 15e).

Animated bodies also connect in the webwork of material things (# 13). Each of them is a center of appearings, a one, just as every other thing is. However, unlike soulless bodies, each animal is also a zero. It lives at a point of origination. The animal body bears the zero-point of orientation for the pure ego (61), as its absolute “here” (135, 166). Arithmetically, this is a stunning contrast. Every “something” whatsoever is either a one or a one-and-one-and-etc. But the animated body, in addition to being just one of those somethings, is also the one who is zero: the one from whom the counting starts, the one who chooses whether and where it is appropriate to insert the and‘s.

But any series that is initiated by/at/in the living body is counted off nonarbitrarily. Such series go in order; they are “motivated.” This is owing to the movement of the body itself within the material web. The body’s own kinesthetic sense will coordinate with the corresponding changes in sensory perceptions as it navigates among things. Thus, the zero shifts position in relation to the other unified centers to which perceptions accrue; but as it does so, the series of their appearings change in a regular way (63).

What about counting zero’s? Are they multiple; are there many human bodies? Husserl declines to pursue this avenue of approach into the problem of other minds and human community. Intersubjectivity will treated instead as an implication of the reality of the material world, not a precondition for it. The multiplicity of bodies is taken up only on page 83, where it is admitted that the foregoing analysis has been framed on the assumption that there would be only one, “solipsistic,” point-zero in reality. Belatedly, other bodies now are brought into the picture–but not because they are necessary for its unity, or because they have been apprehended among the realities presenting to consciousness. The others are brought in because they are required for the full unification of the thing in reality, whether that thing is one of the physical bodies or my very own live body. To be is to be describable (87). Reality for the thing entails a possibility of appearing to anyone at all. Being counted from one zero-point is not enough for the real thing. To count, it needs the possibility of being counted from multiple directions.

The thing is a rule of appearances. That means that the thing is a reality as a unity of a manifold of appearances connected according to rules. Moreover, this unity is an intersubjective one…. The physicalistic thing is intersubjectively common in that it has validity for all individuals who stand in possible communion with us (91-92).

To be real, the thing must count as a place or location, a center, independently of any particular point of origin. Yet what grants reality to the thing is not some consensus reached by observers. Indeed, the thing may look entirely different to different observers; however, its reality constrains all to agree that, at least, “it is there.” Oddly, then, the real thing is another kind of zero, for its barest reality consists in its being an empty place-holder (91-93).

Finally, Husserl makes unity a synonym for the philosophical term “substance” as traditionally meant. For example, he says that both the soul and the body are unities, so that an analogy obtains between psychic unity and material unity (129, 131). Oneness becomes the ontological form that determines substantial reality (133). The pure ego is one with respect to an individual stream of consciousness, that is, before the transcendental reduction has de-individuated the latter (117); however the pure ego is insubstantial and not one whenever the reduction is in effect (128).

And so Husserl’s quest for unity splinters and spends itself out by diverting into many contradictory projects pursued by the many unharmonized voices of Ideen II. Although the manuscript remained unpublished, it was made available for consultation by a number of Husserl’s younger colleagues. Among the last publication of Husserl’s lifetime was the Cartesian Meditations of 1931, in which he addressed the apparent solipsism of his transcendental phenomenology. That work itself was undergoing a comprehensive reworking in partnership with Husserl’s assistant Eugen Fink during the years before Husserl’s death in 1938.

7. References and Further Reading

Husserl’s publications and his extensive Nachlass are being brought out in a multi-volume critical edition entitled Husserliana – Edmund Husserl, Gesammelte Werke, from Nijhoff in The Hague. The major works published during Husserl’s lifetime are the following:

• Über den Begriff der Zahl. Psychologische Analysen, 1887.
• Philosophie der Arithmetik. Psychologische und logische Untersuchungen, 1891.
• Logische Untersuchungen. Erste Teil: Prolegomena zur reinen Logik, 1900; reprinted 1913.
• Logische Untersuchungen. Zweite Teil: Untersuchungen zur Phänomenologie und Theorie der Erkenntnis, 1901; second edition 1913 (for part one); second edition 1921 (for part two).
• “Philosophie als strenge Wissenschaft,” Logos 1 (1911) 289-341.
• Ideen zu einer reinen Ph‰nomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Erstes Buch: Allgemeine Einführung in die reine Phänomenologie, 1913.
• “Vorlesungen zur Phänomenologie des inneren Zeitbewusstseins,” Jahrbuch für Philosophie und phänomenologische Forschung 9 (1928), 367-498.
• “Formale und transzendentale Logik. Versuch einer Kritik der logischen Vernunft,” Jahrbuch für Philosophie und phänomenologische Forschung 10 (1929) 1-298.
• Mèditations cartèsiennes, 1931.
• “Die Krisis der europäischen Wissenschaften und die transzentale Phänomenologie: Eine Einleitung in die phänomenologische Philosophie,” Philosophia 1 (1936) 77-176.

Works translated into English by Husserl (In chronological order.  Publication dates of the German originals are in brackets.)

• “Philosophy as Rigorous Science,” trans. in Q. Lauer (ed.), Phenomenology and the Crisis of Philosophy, New York: Harper [1910], 1965.
• Formal and Transcendental Logic, trans. D. Cairns. The Hague: Nijhoff [1929], 1969.
• The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Philosophy, trans. D. Carr. Evanston: Northwestern University Press
  [1936/54], 1970.
• Logical Investigations, trans. J. N. Findlay, London: Routledge [1900/01; 2nd, revised edition 1913], 1973.
• Experience and Judgement, trans. J. S. Churchill and K. Ameriks, London: Routledge [1939], 1973.
• Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy – Third Book: Phenomenology and the Foundations of the Sciences, trans. T. E. Klein and W. E. Pohl, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1980.
• Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy — First Book: General Introduction to a Pure Phenomenology, trans. F. Kersten. The Hague: Nijhoff (= Ideas) [1913], 1982.
• Cartesian Meditations, trans. D. Cairns, Dordrecht: Kluwer [1931], 1988.
• Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy – Second Book: Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution, trans. R. Rojcewicz and A. Schuwer, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1989.
• On the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time (1893-1917), trans. J. B. Brough, Dordrecht: Kluwer [1928], 1990.
• Early Writings in the Philosophy of Logic and Mathematics, trans. D. Willard, Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1994.
• The Essential Husserl, ed. D. Welton, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999.

Further Reading:

• Bell, David (1990) Husserl, London: Routledge.
• Bernet, Rudolf and Kern, Iso and Marbach, Eduard (1993) An Introduction to Husserlian Phenomenology, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
• Carr, David (1987) Interpreting Husserl, Dordrecht: Nijhoff.
• Derrida, Jacques (1978) Edmund Husserl’s ‘Origin of Geometry’, trans. J.P. Leavy, New York: Harvester Press, 1978.
• Dreyfus, Hubert (ed.) (1982) Husserl, Intentionality, and Cognitive Science, Cambridge/Mass.: MIT Press.
• Drummond, John (1990) Husserlian Intentionality and Non-Foundational Realism, Dordrecht: Kluwer.
• Levinas, E., (1973) The Theory of Intuition in Husserl’s Phenomenology, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
• Mohanty, J. N. and McKenna, William (eds.) (1989) Husserl’s Phenomenology: A Textbook, Lanham: University Press of America.
• Smith, Barry and Smith, David Woodruff (eds.) (1995) The Cambridge Companion to Husserl, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Sokolowski, Robert (ed.) (1988) Edmund Husserl and the Phenomenological Tradition, Washington: Catholic University of America Press.
• Zahavi, Dan (2003) Husserl’s Phenomenology, Stanford: Stanford University Press.

Author Information

Marianne Sawicki
Email: law.sawicki@gmail.com
Huntingdon, Pennsylvania
U. S. A.

Jacques Derrida (1930—2004)

Jacques Derrida was one of the most well known twentieth century philosophers. He was also one of the most prolific. Distancing himself from the various philosophical movements and traditions that preceded him on the French intellectual scene (phenomenology, existentialism, and structuralism), he developed a strategy called “deconstruction” in the mid 1960s. Although not purely negative, deconstruction is primarily concerned with something tantamount to a critique of the Western philosophical tradition. Deconstruction is generally presented via an analysis of specific texts. It seeks to expose, and then to subvert, the various binary oppositions that undergird our dominant ways of thinking—presence/absence, speech/writing, and so forth.

Deconstruction has at least two aspects: literary and philosophical. The literary aspect concerns the textual interpretation, where invention is essential to finding hidden alternative meanings in the text. The philosophical aspect concerns the main target of deconstruction: the “metaphysics of presence,” or simply metaphysics. Starting from an Heideggerian point of view, Derrida argues that metaphysics affects the whole of philosophy from Plato onwards. Metaphysics creates dualistic oppositions and installs a hierarchy that unfortunately privileges one term of each dichotomy (presence before absence, speech before writing, and so on).

The deconstructive strategy is to unmask these too-sedimented ways of thinking, and it operates on them especially through two steps—reversing dichotomies and attempting to corrupt the dichotomies themselves. The strategy also aims to show that there are undecidables, that is, something that cannot conform to either side of a dichotomy or opposition. Undecidability returns in later period of Derrida’s reflection, when it is applied to reveal paradoxes involved in notions such as gift giving or hospitality, whose conditions of possibility are at the same time their conditions of impossibility. Because of this, it is undecidable whether authentic giving or hospitality are either possible or impossible.

In this period, the founder of deconstruction turns his attention to ethical themes. In particular, the theme of responsibility to the other (for example, God or a beloved person) leads Derrida to leave the idea that responsibility is associated with a behavior publicly and rationally justifiable by general principles. Reflecting upon tales of Jewish tradition, he highlights the absolute singularity of responsibility to the other.

Deconstruction has had an enormous influence in psychology, literary theory, cultural studies, linguistics, feminism, sociology and anthropology. Poised in the interstices between philosophy and non-philosophy (or philosophy and literature), it is not difficult to see why this is the case. What follows in this article, however, is an attempt to bring out the philosophical significance of Derrida’s thought.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works
2. Deconstructive Strategy
   1. Metaphysics of Presence/Logocentrism
3. Key terms from the early work
   1. Speech/Writing
   2. Arche-writing
   3. Différance
   4. Trace
   5. Supplement
4. Time and Phenomenology
5. Undecidability
   1. Decision
6. The Other
   1. Responsibility to the Other
   2. Wholly Other/Messianic
7. Possible and Impossible Aporias
   1. The Gift
   2. Hospitality
   3. Forgiveness
   4. Mourning
8. References and Further Reading
   1. Derrida’s Texts (and Their Abbreviations)
   2. Selected Commentaries

1. Life and Works

In 1930, Derrida was born into a Jewish family in Algiers. He was also born into an environment of some discrimination. In fact, he either withdrew from, or was forced out of at least two schools during his childhood simply on account of being Jewish. He was expelled from one school because there was a 7% limit on the Jewish population, and he later withdrew from another school on account of the anti-semitism. While Derrida would resist any reductive understanding of his work based upon his biographical life, it could be argued that these kind of experiences played a large role in his insistence upon the importance of the marginal, and the other, in his later thought.

Derrida was twice refused a position in the prestigious Ecole Normale Superieure (where Sartre, Simone de Beauvoir and the majority of French intellectuals and academics began their careers), but he was eventually accepted to the institution at the age of 19. He hence moved from Algiers to France, and soon after he also began to play a major role in the leftist journal Tel Quel. Derrida’s initial work in philosophy was largely phenomenological, and his early training as a philosopher was done largely through the lens of Husserl. Other important inspirations on his early thought include Nietzsche, Heidegger, Saussure, Levinas and Freud. Derrida acknowledges his indebtedness to all of these thinkers in the development of his approach to texts, which has come to be known as ‘deconstruction’.

It was in 1967 that Derrida really arrived as a philosopher of world importance. He published three momentous texts (Of Grammatology, Writing and Difference, and Speech and Phenomena). All of these works have been influential for different reasons, but it is Of Grammatology that remains his most famous work (it is analysed in some detail in this article). In Of Grammatology, Derrida reveals and then undermines the speech-writing opposition that he argues has been such an influential factor in Western thought. His preoccupation with language in this text is typical of much of his early work, and since the publication of these and other major texts (including Dissemination, Glas, The Postcard, Spectres of Marx, The Gift of Death, and Politics of Friendship), deconstruction has gradually moved from occupying a major role in continental Europe, to also becoming a significant player in the Anglo-American philosophical context. This is particularly so in the areas of literary criticism, and cultural studies, where deconstruction’s method of textual analysis has inspired theorists like Paul de Man. He has also had lecturing positions at various universities, the world over. Derrida died in 2004.

Deconstruction has frequently been the subject of some controversy. When Derrida was awarded an honorary doctorate at Cambridge in 1992, there were howls of protest from many ‘analytic’ philosophers. Since then, Derrida has also had many dialogues with philosophers like John Searle (see Limited Inc.), in which deconstruction has been roundly criticised, although perhaps unfairly at times. However, what is clear from the antipathy of such thinkers is that deconstruction challenges traditional philosophy in several important ways, and the remainder of this article will highlight why this is so.

2. Deconstructive Strategy

Derrida, like many other contemporary European theorists, is preoccupied with undermining the oppositional tendencies that have befallen much of the Western philosophical tradition. In fact, dualisms are the staple diet of deconstruction, for without these hierarchies and orders of subordination it would be left with nowhere to intervene. Deconstruction is parasitic in that rather than espousing yet another grand narrative, or theory about the nature of the world in which we partake, it restricts itself to distorting already existing narratives, and to revealing the dualistic hierarchies they conceal. While Derrida’s claims to being someone who speaks solely in the margins of philosophy can be contested, it is important to take these claims into account. Deconstruction is, somewhat infamously, the philosophy that says nothing. To the extent that it can be suggested that Derrida’s concerns are often philosophical, they are clearly not phenomenological (he assures us that his work is to be read specifically against Husserl, Sartre and Merleau-Ponty) and nor are they ontological.

Deconstruction, and particularly early deconstruction, functions by engaging in sustained analyses of particular texts. It is committed to the rigorous analysis of the literal meaning of a text, and yet also to finding within that meaning, perhaps in the neglected corners of the text (including the footnotes), internal problems that actually point towards alternative meanings. Deconstruction must hence establish a methodology that pays close attention to these apparently contradictory imperatives (sameness and difference) and a reading of any Derridean text can only reaffirm this dual aspect. Derrida speaks of the first aspect of this deconstructive strategy as being akin to a fidelity and a “desire to be faithful to the themes and audacities of a thinking” (WD 84). At the same time, however, deconstruction also famously borrows from Martin Heidegger’s conception of a ‘destructive retrieve’ and seeks to open texts up to alternative and usually repressed meanings that reside at least partly outside of the metaphysical tradition (although always also partly betrothed to it). This more violent and transgressive aspect of deconstruction is illustrated by Derrida’s consistent exhortation to “invent in your own language if you can or want to hear mine; invent if you can or want to give my language to be understood” (MO 57). In suggesting that a faithful interpretation of him is one that goes beyond him, Derrida installs invention as a vitally important aspect of any deconstructive reading. He is prone to making enigmatic suggestions like “go there where you cannot go, to the impossible, it is indeed the only way of coming or going” (ON 75), and ultimately, the merit of a deconstructive reading consists in this creative contact with another text that cannot be characterised as either mere fidelity or as an absolute transgression, but rather which oscillates between these dual demands. The intriguing thing about deconstruction, however, is that despite the fact that Derrida’s own interpretations of specific texts are quite radical, it is often difficult to pinpoint where the explanatory exegesis of a text ends and where the more violent aspect of deconstruction begins. Derrida is always reluctant to impose ‘my text’, ‘your text’ designations too conspicuously in his texts. This is partly because it is even problematic to speak of a ‘work’ of deconstruction, since deconstruction only highlights what was already revealed in the text itself. All of the elements of a deconstructive intervention reside in the “neglected cornerstones” of an already existing system (MDM 72), and this equation is not altered in any significant way whether that ‘system’ be conceived of as metaphysics generally, which must contain its non-metaphysical track, or the writings of a specific thinker, which must also always testify to that which they are attempting to exclude (MDM 73).

These are, of course, themes reflected upon at length by Derrida, and they have an immediate consequence on the meta-theoretical level. To the minimal extent that we can refer to Derrida’s own arguments, it must be recognised that they are always intertwined with the arguments of whomever, or whatever, he seeks to deconstruct. For example, Derrida argues that his critique of the Husserlian ‘now’ moment is actually based upon resources within Husserl’s own text which elide the self-presence that he was attempting to secure (SP 64-66). If Derrida’s point is simply that Husserl’s phenomenology holds within itself conclusions that Husserl failed to recognise, Derrida seems to be able to disavow any transcendental or ontological position. This is why he argues that his work occupies a place in the margins of philosophy, rather than simply being philosophy per se.

Deconstruction contends that in any text, there are inevitably points of equivocation and ‘undecidability’ that betray any stable meaning that an author might seek to impose upon his or her text. The process of writing always reveals that which has been suppressed, covers over that which has been disclosed, and more generally breaches the very oppositions that are thought to sustain it. This is why Derrida’s ‘philosophy’ is so textually based and it is also why his key terms are always changing, because depending upon who or what he is seeking to deconstruct, that point of equivocation will always be located in a different place.

This also ensures that any attempt to describe what deconstruction is, must be careful. Nothing would be more antithetical to deconstruction’s stated intent than this attempt at defining it through the decidedly metaphysical question “what is deconstruction?” There is a paradoxicality involved in trying to restrict deconstruction to one particular and overarching purpose (OG 19) when it is predicated upon the desire to expose us to that which is wholly other (tout autre) and to open us up to alternative possibilities. At times, this exegesis will run the risk of ignoring the many meanings of Derridean deconstruction, and the widely acknowledged difference between Derrida’s early and late work is merely the most obvious example of the difficulties involved in suggesting “deconstruction says this”, or “deconstruction prohibits that”.

That said, certain defining features of deconstruction can be noticed. For example, Derrida’s entire enterprise is predicated upon the conviction that dualisms are irrevocably present in the various philosophers and artisans that he considers. While some philosophers argue that he is a little reductive when he talks about the Western philosophical tradition, it is his understanding of this tradition that informs and provides the tools for a deconstructive response. Because of this, it is worth briefly considering the target of Derridean deconstruction – the metaphysics of presence, or somewhat synonymously, logocentrism.

a. Metaphysics of Presence/Logocentrism

There are many different terms that Derrida employs to describe what he considers to be the fundamental way(s) of thinking of the Western philosophical tradition. These include: logocentrism, phallogocentrism, and perhaps most famously, the metaphysics of presence, but also often simply ‘metaphysics’. These terms all have slightly different meanings. Logocentrism emphasises the privileged role that logos, or speech, has been accorded in the Western tradition (see Section 3). Phallogocentrism points towards the patriarchal significance of this privileging. Derrida’s enduring references to the metaphysics of presence borrows heavily from the work of Heidegger. Heidegger insists that Western philosophy has consistently privileged that which is, or that which appears, and has forgotten to pay any attention to the condition for that appearance. In other words, presence itself is privileged, rather than that which allows presence to be possible at all – and also impossible, for Derrida (see Section 4, for more on the metaphysics of presence). All of these terms of denigration, however, are united under the broad rubric of the term ‘metaphysics’. What, then, does Derrida mean by metaphysics?

In the ‘Afterword’ to Limited Inc., Derrida suggests that metaphysics can be defined as:

“The enterprise of returning ‘strategically’, ‘ideally’, to an origin or to a priority thought to be simple, intact, normal, pure, standard, self-identical, in order then to think in terms of derivation, complication, deterioration, accident, etc. All metaphysicians, from Plato to Rousseau, Descartes to Husserl, have proceeded in this way, conceiving good to be before evil, the positive before the negative, the pure before the impure, the simple before the complex, the essential before the accidental, the imitated before the imitation, etc. And this is not just one metaphysical gesture among others, it is the metaphysical exigency, that which has been the most constant, most profound and most potent” (LI 236).

According to Derrida then, metaphysics involves installing hierarchies and orders of subordination in the various dualisms that it encounters (M 195). Moreover, metaphysical thought prioritises presence and purity at the expense of the contingent and the complicated, which are considered to be merely aberrations that are not important for philosophical analysis. Basically then, metaphysical thought always privileges one side of an opposition, and ignores or marginalises the alternative term of that opposition.

In another attempt to explain deconstruction’s treatment of, and interest in oppositions, Derrida has suggested that: “An opposition of metaphysical concepts (speech/writing, presence/absence, etc.) is never the face-to-face of two terms, but a hierarchy and an order of subordination. Deconstruction cannot limit itself or proceed immediately to neutralisation: it must, by means of a double gesture, a double science, a double writing, practise an overturning of the classical opposition, and a general displacement of the system. It is on that condition alone that deconstruction will provide the means of intervening in the field of oppositions it criticises” (M 195). In order to better understand this dual ‘methodology’ – that is also the deconstruction of the notion of a methodology because it no longer believes in the possibility of an observer being absolutely exterior to the object/text being examined – it is helpful to consider an example of this deconstruction at work (See Speech/Writing below).

3. Key terms from the early work

Derrida’s terms change in every text that he writes. This is part of his deconstructive strategy. He focuses on particular themes or words in a text, which on account of their ambiguity undermine the more explicit intention of that text. It is not possible for all of these to be addressed (Derrida has published in the vicinity of 60 texts in English), so this article focused on some of the most pivotal terms and neologisms from his early thought. It addresses aspects of his later, more theme-based thought, in Sections 6 & 7.

a. Speech/Writing

The most prominent opposition with which Derrida’s earlier work is concerned is that between speech and writing. According to Derrida, thinkers as different as Plato, Rousseau, Saussure, and Levi-Strauss, have all denigrated the written word and valorised speech, by contrast, as some type of pure conduit of meaning. Their argument is that while spoken words are the symbols of mental experience, written words are the symbols of that already existing symbol. As representations of speech, they are doubly derivative and doubly far from a unity with one’s own thought. Without going into detail regarding the ways in which these thinkers have set about justifying this type of hierarchical opposition, it is important to remember that the first strategy of deconstruction is to reverse existing oppositions. In Of Grammatology (perhaps his most famous work), Derrida hence attempts to illustrate that the structure of writing and grammatology are more important and even ‘older’ than the supposedly pure structure of presence-to-self that is characterised as typical of speech.

For example, in an entire chapter of his Course in General Linguistics, Ferdinand de Saussure tries to restrict the science of linguistics to the phonetic and audible word only (24). In the course of his inquiry, Saussure goes as far as to argue that “language and writing are two distinct systems of signs: the second exists for the sole purpose of representing the first”. Language, Saussure insists, has an oral tradition that is independent of writing, and it is this independence that makes a pure science of speech possible. Derrida vehemently disagrees with this hierarchy and instead argues that all that can be claimed of writing – eg. that it is derivative and merely refers to other signs – is equally true of speech. But as well as criticising such a position for certain unjustifiable presuppositions, including the idea that we are self-identical with ourselves in ‘hearing’ ourselves think, Derrida also makes explicit the manner in which such a hierarchy is rendered untenable from within Saussure’s own text. Most famously, Saussure is the proponent of the thesis that is commonly referred to as “the arbitrariness of the sign”, and this asserts, to simplify matters considerably, that the signifier bears no necessary relationship to that which is signified. Saussure derives numerous consequences from this position, but as Derrida points out, this notion of arbitrariness and of “unmotivated institutions” of signs, would seem to deny the possibility of any natural attachment (OG 44). After all, if the sign is arbitrary and eschews any foundational reference to reality, it would seem that a certain type of sign (ie. the spoken) could not be more natural than another (ie. the written). However, it is precisely this idea of a natural attachment that Saussure relies upon to argue for our “natural bond” with sound (25), and his suggestion that sounds are more intimately related to our thoughts than the written word hence runs counter to his fundamental principle regarding the arbitrariness of the sign.

b. Arche-writing

In Of Grammatology and elsewhere, Derrida argues that signification, broadly conceived, always refers to other signs, and that one can never reach a sign that refers only to itself. He suggests that “writing is not a sign of a sign, except if one says it of all signs, which would be more profoundly true” (OG 43), and this process of infinite referral, of never arriving at meaning itself, is the notion of ‘writing’ that he wants to emphasise. This is not writing narrowly conceived, as in a literal inscription upon a page, but what he terms ‘arche-writing’. Arche-writing refers to a more generalised notion of writing that insists that the breach that the written introduces between what is intended to be conveyed and what is actually conveyed, is typical of an originary breach that afflicts everything one might wish to keep sacrosanct, including the notion of self-presence.

This originary breach that arche-writing refers to can be separated out to reveal two claims regarding spatial differing and temporal deferring. To explicate the first of these claims, Derrida’s emphasis upon how writing differs from itself is simply to suggest that writing, and by extension all repetition, is split (differed) by the absence that makes it necessary. One example of this might be that we write something down because we may soon forget it, or to communicate something to someone who is not with us. According to Derrida, all writing, in order to be what it is, must be able to function in the absence of every empirically determined addressee (M 375). Derrida also considers deferral to be typical of the written and this is to reinforce that the meaning of a certain text is never present, never entirely captured by a critic’s attempt to pin it down. The meaning of a text is constantly subject to the whims of the future, but when that so-called future is itself ‘present’ (if we try and circumscribe the future by reference to a specific date or event) its meaning is equally not realised, but subject to yet another future that can also never be present. The key to a text is never even present to the author themselves, for the written always defers its meaning. As a consequence we cannot simply ask Derrida to explain exactly what he meant by propounding that enigmatic sentiment that has been translated as “there is nothing outside of the text” (OG 158). Any explanatory words that Derrida may offer would themselves require further explanation. [That said, it needs to be emphasised that Derrida’s point is not so much that everything is simply semiotic or linguistic – as this is something that he explicitly denies – but that the processes of differing and deferring found within linguistic representation are symptomatic of a more general situation that afflicts everything, including the body and the perceptual]. So, Derrida’s more generalised notion of writing, arche-writing, refers to the way in which the written is possible only on account of this ‘originary’ deferral of meaning that ensures that meaning can never be definitively present. In conjunction with the differing aspect that we have already seen him associate with, and then extend beyond the traditional confines of writing, he will come to describe these two overlapping processes via that most famous of neologisms: différance.

c. Différance

Différance is an attempt to conjoin the differing and deferring aspects involved in arche-writing in a term that itself plays upon the distinction between the audible and the written. After all, what differentiates différance and différence is inaudible, and this means that distinguishing between them actually requires the written. This problematises efforts like Saussure’s, which as well as attempting to keep speech and writing apart, also suggest that writing is an almost unnecessary addition to speech. In response to such a claim, Derrida can simply point out that there is often, and perhaps even always, this type of ambiguity in the spoken word – différence as compared to différance – that demands reference to the written. If the spoken word requires the written to function properly, then the spoken is itself always at a distance from any supposed clarity of consciousness. It is this originary breach that Derrida associates with the terms arche-writing and différance.

Of course, différance cannot be exhaustively defined, and this is largely because of Derrida’s insistence that it is “neither a word, nor a concept”, as well as the fact that the meaning of the term changes depending upon the particular context in which it is being employed. For the moment, however, it suffices to suggest that according to Derrida, différance is typical of what is involved in arche-writing and this generalised notion of writing that breaks down the entire logic of the sign (OG 7). The widespread conviction that the sign literally represents something, which even if not actually present, could be potentially present, is rendered impossible by arche-writing, which insists that signs always refer to yet more signs ad infinitum, and that there is no ultimate referent or foundation. This reversal of the subordinated term of an opposition accomplishes the first of deconstruction’s dual strategic intents. Rather than being criticised for being derivative or secondary, for Derrida, writing, or at least the processes that characterise writing (ie. différance and arche-writing), are ubiquitous. Just as a piece of writing has no self-present subject to explain what every particular word means (and this ensures that what is written must partly elude any individual’s attempt to control it), this is equally typical of the spoken. Utilising the same structure of repetition, nothing guarantees that another person will endow the words I use with the particular meaning that I attribute to them. Even the conception of an internal monologue and the idea that we can intimately ‘hear’ our own thoughts in a non-contingent way is misguided, as it ignores the way that arche-writing privileges difference and a non-coincidence with oneself (SP 60-70).

d. Trace

In this respect, it needs to be pointed out that all of deconstruction’s reversals (arche-writing included) are partly captured by the edifice that they seek to overthrow. For Derrida, “one always inhabits, and all the more when one does not suspect it” (OG 24), and it is important to recognise that the mere reversal of an existing metaphysical opposition might not also challenge the governing framework and presuppositions that are attempting to be reversed (WD 280). Deconstruction hence cannot rest content with merely prioritising writing over speech, but must also accomplish the second major aspect of deconstruction’s dual strategies, that being to corrupt and contaminate the opposition itself.

Derrida must highlight that the categories that sustain and safeguard any dualism are always already disrupted and displaced. To effect this second aspect of deconstruction’s strategic intents, Derrida usually coins a new term, or reworks an old one, to permanently disrupt the structure into which he has intervened – examples of this include his discussion of the pharmakon in Plato (drug or tincture, salutary or maleficent), and the supplement in Rousseau, which will be considered towards the end of this section. To phrase the problem in slightly different terms, Derrida’s argument is that in examining a binary opposition, deconstruction manages to expose a trace. This is not a trace of the oppositions that have since been deconstructed – on the contrary, the trace is a rupture within metaphysics, a pattern of incongruities where the metaphysical rubs up against the non-metaphysical, that it is deconstruction’s job to juxtapose as best as it can. The trace does not appear as such (OG 65), but the logic of its path in a text can be mimed by a deconstructive intervention and hence brought to the fore.

e. Supplement

The logic of the supplement is also an important aspect of Of Grammatology. A supplement is something that, allegedly secondarily, comes to serve as an aid to something ‘original’ or ‘natural’. Writing is itself an example of this structure, for as Derrida points out, “if supplementarity is a necessarily indefinite process, writing is the supplement par excellence since it proposes itself as the supplement of the supplement, sign of a sign, taking the place of a speech already significant” (OG 281). Another example of the supplement might be masturbation, as Derrida suggests (OG 153), or even the use of birth control precautions. What is notable about both of these examples is an ambiguity that ensures that what is supplementary can always be interpreted in two ways. For example, our society’s use of birth control precautions might be interpreted as suggesting that our natural way is lacking and that the contraceptive pill, or condom, etc., hence replaces a fault in nature. On the other hand, it might also be argued that such precautions merely add on to, and enrich our natural way. It is always ambiguous, or more accurately ‘undecidable’, whether the supplement adds itself and “is a plenitude enriching another plenitude, the fullest measure of presence”, or whether “the supplement supplements… adds only to replace… represents and makes an image… its place is assigned in the structure by the mark of an emptiness” (OG 144). Ultimately, Derrida suggests that the supplement is both of these things, accretion and substitution (OG 200), which means that the supplement is “not a signified more than a signifier, a representer than a presence, a writing than a speech” (OG 315). It comes before all such modalities.

This is not just some rhetorical suggestion that has no concrete significance in deconstruction. Indeed, while Rousseau consistently laments the frequency of his masturbation in his book, The Confessions, Derrida argues that “it has never been possible to desire the presence ‘in person’, before this play of substitution and the symbolic experience of auto-affection” (OG 154). By this, Derrida means that this supplementary masturbation that ‘plays’ between presence and absence (eg. the image of the absent Therese that is evoked by Rousseau) is that which allows us to conceive of being present and fulfilled in sexual relations with another at all. In a sense, masturbation is ‘originary’, and according to Derrida, this situation applies to all sexual relations. All erotic relations have their own supplementary aspect in which we are never present to some ephemeral ‘meaning’ of sexual relations, but always involved in some form of representation. Even if this does not literally take the form of imagining another in the place of, or supplementing the ‘presence’ that is currently with us, and even if we are not always acting out a certain role, or faking certain pleasures, for Derrida, such representations and images are the very conditions of desire and of enjoyment (OG 156).

4. Time and Phenomenology

Derrida has had a long and complicated association with phenomenology for his entire career, including ambiguous relationships with Husserl and Heidegger, and something closer to a sustained allegiance with Lévinas. Despite this complexity, two main aspects of Derrida’s thinking regarding phenomenology remain clear. Firstly, he thinks that the phenomenological emphasis upon the immediacy of experience is the new transcendental illusion, and secondly, he argues that despite its best intents, phenomenology cannot be anything other than a metaphysics (SP 75, 104). In this context, Derrida defines metaphysics as the science of presence, as for him (as for Heidegger), all metaphysics privileges presence, or that which is. While they are presented schematically here, these inter-related claims constitute Derrida’s major arguments against phenomenology.

According to Derrida, phenomenology is a metaphysics of presence because it unwittingly relies upon the notion of an indivisible self-presence, or in the case of Husserl, the possibility of an exact internal adequation with oneself (SP 66-8). In various texts, Derrida contests this valorisation of an undivided subjectivity, as well as the primacy that such a position accords to the ‘now’, or to some other kind of temporal immediacy. For instance, in Speech and Phenomena, Derrida argues that if a ‘now’ moment is conceived of as exhausting itself in that experience, it could not actually be experienced, for there would be nothing to juxtapose itself against in order to illuminate that very ‘now’. Instead, Derrida wants to reveal that every so-called ‘present’, or ‘now’ point, is always already compromised by a trace, or a residue of a previous experience, that precludes us ever being in a self-contained ‘now’ moment (SP 68). Phenomenology is hence envisaged as nostalgically seeking the impossible: that is, coinciding with oneself in an immediate and pre-reflective spontaneity. Following this refutation of Husserlian temporality, Derrida remarks that “in the last analysis, what is at stake is… the privilege of the actual present, the now” (SP 62-3). Instead of emphasising the presence of a subject to themselves (ie. the so-called living-present), Derrida strategically utilises a conception of time that emphasises deferral. John Caputo expresses Derrida’s point succinctly when he claims that Derrida’s criticisms of Husserlian temporality in Speech and Phenomena involve an attempt to convey that: “What is really going on in things, what is really happening, is always “to come”. Every time you try to stabilise the meaning of a thing, try to fix it in its missionary position, the thing itself, if there is anything at all to it, slips away” (cf. SP 104, Caputo DN 31). To put Derrida’s point simplistically, it might be suggested that the meaning of a particular object, or a particular word, is never stable, but always in the process of change (eg. the dissemination of meaning for which deconstruction has become notorious). Moreover, the significance of that past change can only be appreciated from the future and, of course, that ‘future’ is itself implicated in a similar process of transformation were it ever to be capable of becoming ‘present’. The future that Derrida is referring to is hence not just a future that will become present, but the future that makes all ‘presence’ possible and also impossible. For Derrida, there can be no presence-to-self, or self-contained identity, because the ‘nature’ of our temporal existence is for this type of experience to elude us. Our predominant mode of being is what he will eventually term the messianic (see Section 6), in that experience is about the wait, or more aptly, experience is only when it is deferred. Derrida’s work offers many important temporal contributions of this quasi-transcendental variety.

5. Undecidability

In its first and most famous instantiation, undecidability is one of Derrida’s most important attempts to trouble dualisms, or more accurately, to reveal how they are always already troubled. An undecidable, and there are many of them in deconstruction (eg. ghost, pharmakon, hymen, etc.), is something that cannot conform to either polarity of a dichotomy (eg. present/absent, cure/poison, and inside/outside in the above examples). For example, the figure of a ghost seems to neither present or absent, or alternatively it is both present and absent at the same time (SM).

However, Derrida has a recurring tendency to resuscitate terms in different contexts, and the term undecidability also returns in later deconstruction. Indeed, to complicate matters, undecidability returns in two discernible forms. In his recent work, Derrida often insists that the condition of the possibility of mourning, giving, forgiving, and hospitality, to cite some of his most famous examples, is at once also the condition of their impossibility (see section 7). In his explorations of these “possible-impossible” aporias, it becomes undecidable whether genuine giving, for example, is either a possible or an impossible ideal.

a. Decision

Derrida’s later philosophy is also united by his analysis of a similar type of undecidability that is involved in the concept of the decision itself. In this respect, Derrida regularly suggests that a decision cannot be wise, or posed even more provocatively, that the instant of the decision must actually be mad (DPJ 26, GD 65). Drawing on Kierkegaard, Derrida tells us that a decision requires an undecidable leap beyond all prior preparations for that decision (GD 77), and according to him, this applies to all decisions and not just those regarding the conversion to religious faith that preoccupies Kierkegaard. To pose the problem in inverse fashion, it might be suggested that for Derrida, all decisions are a faith and a tenuous faith at that, since were faith and the decision not tenuous, they would cease to be a faith or a decision at all (cf. GD 80). This description of the decision as a moment of madness that must move beyond rationality and calculative reasoning may seem paradoxical, but it might nevertheless be agreed that a decision requires a ‘leap of faith’ beyond the sum total of the facts. Many of us are undoubtedly stifled by the difficulty of decision-making, and this psychological fact aids and, for his detractors, also abets Derrida’s discussion of the decision as it appears in texts like The Gift of Death, Deconstruction and the Possibility of Justice, Adieu to Emmanuel Lévinas, and Politics of Friendship.

In Adieu to Emmanuel Lévinas, Derrida argues that a decision must always come back to the other, even if it is the other ‘inside’ the subject, and he disputes that an initiative which remained purely and simply “mine” would still be a decision (AEL 23-4). A theory of the subject is incapable of accounting for the slightest decision (PF 68-9), because, as he rhetorically asks, “would we not be justified in seeing here the unfolding of an egological immanence, the autonomic and automatic deployment of predicates or possibilities proper to a subject, without the tearing rupture that should occur in every decision we call free?” (AEL 24). In other words, if a decision is envisaged as simply following from certain character attributes, then it would not genuinely be a decision. Derrida is hence once more insisting upon the necessity of a leap beyond calculative reasoning, and beyond the resources of some self-contained subject reflecting upon the matter at hand. A decision must invoke that which is outside of the subject’s control. If a decision is an example of a concept that is simultaneously impossible within its own internal logic and yet nevertheless necessary, then not only is our reticence to decide rendered philosophically cogent, but it is perhaps even privileged. Indeed, Derrida’s work has been described as a “philosophy of hesitation”, and his most famous neologism, différance, explicitly emphasises deferring, with all of the procrastination that this term implies. Moreover, in his early essay “Violence and Metaphysics”, Derrida also suggests that a successful deconstructive reading is conditional upon the suspension of choice: on hesitating between the ethical opening and the logocentric totality (WD 84). Even though Derrida has suggested that he is reluctant to use the term ‘ethics’ because of logocentric associations, one is led to conclude that ‘ethical’ behaviour (for want of a better word) is a product of deferring, and of being forever open to possibilities rather than taking a definitive position. The problem of undecidability is also evident in more recent texts including The Gift of Death. In this text, Derrida seems to support the sacrificing of a certain notion of ethics and universality for a conception of radical singularity not unlike that evinced by the “hyper-ethical” sacrifice that Abraham makes of his son upon Mt Moriah, according to both the Judaic and Christian religions alike (GD 71). To represent Derrida’s position more precisely, true responsibility consists in oscillating between the demands of that which is wholly other (in Abraham’s case, God, but also any particular other) and the more general demands of a community (see Section 6). Responsibility is enduring this trial of the undecidable decision, where attending to the call of a particular other will inevitably demand an estrangement from the “other others” and their communal needs. Whatever decision one may take, according to Derrida, it can never be wholly justified (GD 70). Of course, Derrida’s emphasis upon the undecidability inherent in all decision-making does not want to convey inactivity or a quietism of despair, and he has insisted that the madness of the decision also demands urgency and precipitation (DPJ 25-8). Nevertheless, what is undergone is described as the “trial of undecidability” (LI 210) and what is involved in enduring this trial would seem to be a relatively anguished being. In an interview with Richard Beardsworth, Derrida characterises the problem of undecidability as follows: “However careful one is in the theoretical preparation of a decision, the instant of the decision, if there is to be a decision, must be heterogeneous to the accumulation of knowledge. Otherwise, there is no responsibility. In this sense not only must the person taking the decision not know everything… the decision, if there is to be one, must advance towards a future which is not known, which cannot be anticipated” (NM 37). This suggestion that the decision cannot anticipate the future is undoubtedly somewhat counter-intuitive, but Derrida’s rejection of anticipation is not only a rejection of the traditional idea of deciding on the basis of weighing-up and internally representing certain options. By suggesting that anticipation is not possible, he means to make the more general point that no matter how we may anticipate any decision must always rupture those anticipatory frameworks. A decision must be fundamentally different from any prior preparations for it. As Derrida suggests in Politics of Friendship, the decision must “surprise the very subjectivity of the subject” (PF 68), and it is in making this leap away from calculative reasoning that Derrida argues that responsibility consists (PF 69).

6. The Other

a. Responsibility to the Other

Perhaps the most obvious aspect of Derrida’s later philosophy is his advocation of the tout autre, the wholly other, and The Gift of Death will be our main focus in explaining what this exaltation of the wholly other might mean. Any attempt to sum up this short but difficult text would have to involve the recognition of a certain incommensurability between the particular and the universal, and the dual demands placed upon anybody intending to behave responsibly. For Derrida, the paradox of responsible behaviour means that there is always a question of being responsible before a singular other (eg. a loved one, God, etc.), and yet we are also always referred to our responsibility towards others generally and to what we share with them. Derrida insists that this type of aporia, or problem, is too often ignored by the “knights of responsibility” who presume that accountability and responsibility in all aspects of life – whether that be guilt before the human law, or even before the divine will of God – is quite easily established (GD 85). These are the same people who insist that concrete ethical guidelines should be provided by any philosopher worth his or her ‘salt’ (GD 67) and who ignore the difficulties involved in a notion like responsibility, which demands something importantly different from merely behaving dutifully (GD 63).

Derrida’s exploration of Abraham’s strange and paradoxical responsibility before the demands of God, which consists in sacrificing his only son Isaac, but also in betraying the ethical order through his silence about this act (GD 57-60), is designed to problematise this type of ethical concern that exclusively locates responsibility in the realm of generality. In places, Derrida even verges on suggesting that this more common notion of responsibility, which insists that one should behave according to a general principle that is capable of being rationally validated and justified in the public realm (GD 60), should be replaced with something closer to an Abrahamian individuality where the demands of a singular other (eg. God) are importantly distinct from the ethical demands of our society (GD 61, 66). Derrida equivocates regarding just how far he wants to endorse such a conception of responsibility, and also on the entire issue of whether Abraham’s willingness to murder is an act of faith, or simply an unforgivable transgression. As he says, “Abraham is at the same time, the most moral and the most immoral, the most responsible and the most irresponsible” (GD 72). This equivocation is, of course, a defining trait of deconstruction, which has been variously pilloried and praised for this refusal to propound anything that the tradition could deem to be a thesis. Nevertheless, it is relatively clear that in The Gift of Death, Derrida intends to free us from the common assumption that responsibility is to be associated with behaviour that accords with general principles capable of justification in the public realm (ie. liberalism). In opposition to such an account, he emphasises the “radical singularity” of the demands placed upon Abraham by God (GD 60, 68, 79) and those that might be placed on us by our own loved ones. Ethics, with its dependence upon generality, must be continually sacrificed as an inevitable aspect of the human condition and its aporetic demand to decide (GD 70). As Derrida points out, in writing about one particular cause rather than another, in pursuing one profession over another, in spending time with one’s family rather than at work, one inevitably ignores the “other others” (GD 69), and this is a condition of any and every existence. He argues that: “I cannot respond to the call, the request, the obligation, or even the love of another, without sacrificing the other other, the other others” (GD 68). For Derrida, it seems that the Buddhist desire to have attachment to nobody and equal compassion for everybody is an unattainable ideal. He does, in fact, suggest that a universal community that excludes no one is a contradiction in terms. According to him, this is because: “I am responsible to anyone (that is to say, to any other) only by failing in my responsibility to all the others, to the ethical or political generality. And I can never justify this sacrifice; I must always hold my peace about it… What binds me to this one or that one, remains finally unjustifiable” (GD 70). Derrida hence implies that responsibility to any particular individual is only possible by being irresponsible to the “other others”, that is, to the other people and possibilities that haunt any and every existence.

b. Wholly Other/Messianic

This brings us to a term that Derrida has resuscitated from its association with Walter Benjamin and the Judaic tradition more generally. That term is the messianic and it relies upon a distinction with messianism.

According to Derrida, the term messianism refers predominantly to the religions of the Messiahs – ie. the Muslim, Judaic and Christian religions. These religions proffer a Messiah of known characteristics, and often one who is expected to arrive at a particular time or place. The Messiah is inscribed in their respective religious texts and in an oral tradition that dictates that only if the other conforms to such and such a description is that person actually the Messiah. The most obvious of numerous necessary characteristics for the Messiah, it seems, is that they must invariably be male. Sexuality might seem to be a strange prerequisite to tether to that which is beyond this world, wholly other, but it is only one of many. Now, Derrida is not simplistically disparaging religion and the messianisms they propound. In an important respect, the messianic depends upon the various messianisms and Derrida admits that he cannot say which is the more originary. The messianism of Abraham in his singular responsibility before God, for Derrida, reveals the messianic structure of existence more generally, in that we all share a similar relationship to alterity even if we have not named and circumscribed that experience according to the template provided by a particular religion. However, Derrida’s call to the wholly other, his invocation for the wholly other “to come”, is not a call for a fixed or identifiable other of known characteristics, as is arguably the case in the average religious experience. His wholly other is indeterminable and can never actually arrive. Derrida more than once recounts a story of Maurice Blanchot’s where the Messiah was actually at the gates to a city, disguised in rags. After some time, the Messiah was finally recognised by a beggar, but the beggar could think of nothing more relevant to ask than: “when will you come?”(DN 24). Even when the Messiah is ‘there’, he or she must still be yet to come, and this brings us back to the distinction between the messianic and the various historical messianisms. The messianic structure of existence is open to the coming of an entirely ungraspable and unknown other, but the concrete, historical messianisms are open to the coming of a specific other of known characteristics. The messianic refers predominantly to a structure of our existence that involves waiting – waiting even in activity – and a ceaseless openness towards a future that can never be circumscribed by the horizons of significance that we inevitably bring to bear upon that possible future. In other words, Derrida is not referring to a future that will one day become present (or a particular conception of the saviour who will arrive), but to an openness towards an unknown futurity that is necessarily involved in what we take to be ‘presence’ and hence also renders it ‘impossible’. A deconstruction that entertained any type of grand prophetic narrative, like a Marxist story about the movement of history toward a pre-determined future which, once attained, would make notions like history and progress obsolete, would be yet another vestige of logocentrism and susceptible to deconstruction (SM). Precisely in order to avoid the problems that such messianisms engender – eg. killing in the name of progress, mutilating on account of knowing the will of God better than others, etc. – Derrida suggests that: “I am careful to say ‘let it come’ because if the other is precisely what is not invented, the initiative or deconstructive inventiveness can consist only in opening, in uncloseting, in destabilising foreclusionary structures, so as to allow for the passage toward the other” (RDR 60).

7. Possible and Impossible Aporias

Derrida has recently become more and more preoccupied with what has come to be termed “possible-impossible aporias” – aporia was originally a Greek term meaning puzzle, but it has come to mean something more like an impasse or paradox. In particular, Derrida has described the paradoxes that afflict notions like giving, hospitality, forgiving and mourning. He argues that the condition of their possibility is also, and at once, the condition of their impossibility. In this section, I will attempt to reveal the shared logic upon which these aporias rely.

a. The Gift

The aporia that surrounds the gift revolves around the paradoxical thought that a genuine gift cannot actually be understood to be a gift. In his text, Given Time, Derrida suggests that the notion of the gift contains an implicit demand that the genuine gift must reside outside of the oppositional demands of giving and taking, and beyond any mere self-interest or calculative reasoning (GT 30). According to him, however, a gift is also something that cannot appear as such (GD 29), as it is destroyed by anything that proposes equivalence or recompense, as well as by anything that even proposes to know of, or acknowledge it. This may sound counter-intuitive, but even a simple ‘thank-you’ for instance, which both acknowledges the presence of a gift and also proposes some form of equivalence with that gift, can be seen to annul the gift (cf. MDM 149). By politely responding with a ‘thank-you’, there is often, and perhaps even always, a presumption that because of this acknowledgement one is no longer indebted to the other who has given, and that nothing more can be expected of an individual who has so responded. Significantly, the gift is hence drawn into the cycle of giving and taking, where a good deed must be accompanied by a suitably just response. As the gift is associated with a command to respond, it becomes an imposition for the receiver, and it even becomes an opportunity to take for the ‘giver’, who might give just to receive the acknowledgement from the other that they have in fact given. There are undoubtedly many other examples of how the ‘gift’ can be deployed, and not necessarily deliberately, to gain advantage. Of course, it might be objected that even if it is psychologically difficult to give without also receiving (and in a manner that is tantamount to taking) this does not in-itself constitute a refutation of the logic of genuine giving. According to Derrida, however, his discussion does not amount merely to an empirical or psychological claim about the difficulty of transcending an immature and egocentric conception of giving. On the contrary, he wants to problematise the very possibility of a giving that can be unequivocally disassociated from receiving and taking.

The important point is that, for Derrida, a genuine gift requires an anonymity of the giver, such that there is no accrued benefit in giving. The giver cannot even recognise that they are giving, for that would be to reabsorb their gift to the other person as some kind of testimony to the worth of the self – ie. the kind of self-congratulatory logic that rhetorically poses the question “how wonderful I am to give this person that which they have always desired, and without even letting them know that I am responsible?”. This is an extreme example, but Derrida claims that such a predicament afflicts all giving in more or less obvious ways. For him, the logic of a genuine gift actually requires that self and other be radically disparate, and have no obligations or claims upon each other of any kind. He argues that a genuine gift must involve neither an apprehension of a good deed done, nor the recognition by the other party that they have received, and this seems to render the actuality of any gift an impossibility. Significantly, however, according to Derrida, the existential force of this demand for an absolute altruism can never be assuaged, and yet equally clearly it can also never be fulfilled, and this ensures that the condition of the possibility of the gift is inextricably associated with its impossibility. For Derrida, there is no solution to this type of problem, and no hint of a dialectic that might unify the apparent incommensurability in which possibility implies impossibility and vice versa. At the same time, however, he does not intend simply to vacillate in hyperbolic and self-referential paradoxes. There is a sense in which deconstruction actually seeks genuine giving, hospitality, forgiving and mourning, even where it acknowledges that these concepts are forever elusive and can never actually be fulfilled.

b. Hospitality

It is also worth considering the aporia that Derrida associates with hospitality. According to Derrida, genuine hospitality before any number of unknown others is not, strictly speaking, a possible scenario (OH 135, GD 70, AEL 50, OCF 16). If we contemplate giving up everything that we seek to possess and call our own, then most of us can empathise with just how difficult enacting any absolute hospitality would be. Despite this, however, Derrida insists that the whole idea of hospitality depends upon such an altruistic concept and is inconceivable without it (OCF 22). In fact, he argues that it is this internal tension that keeps the concept alive.

As Derrida makes explicit, there is a more existential example of this tension, in that the notion of hospitality requires one to be the ‘master’ of the house, country or nation (and hence controlling). His point is relatively simple here; to be hospitable, it is first necessary that one must have the power to host. Hospitality hence makes claims to property ownership and it also partakes in the desire to establish a form of self-identity. Secondly, there is the further point that in order to be hospitable, the host must also have some kind of control over the people who are being hosted. This is because if the guests take over a house through force, then the host is no longer being hospitable towards them precisely because they are no longer in control of the situation. This means, for Derrida, that any attempt to behave hospitably is also always partly betrothed to the keeping of guests under control, to the closing of boundaries, to nationalism, and even to the exclusion of particular groups or ethnicities (OH 151-5). This is Derrida’s ‘possible’ conception of hospitality, in which our most well-intentioned conceptions of hospitality render the “other others” as strangers and refugees (cf. OH 135, GD 68). Whether one invokes the current international preoccupation with border control, or simply the ubiquitous suburban fence and alarm system, it seems that hospitality always posits some kind of limit upon where the other can trespass, and hence has a tendency to be rather inhospitable. On the other hand, as well as demanding some kind of mastery of house, country or nation, there is a sense in which the notion of hospitality demands a welcoming of whomever, or whatever, may be in need of that hospitality. It follows from this that unconditional hospitality, or we might say ‘impossible’ hospitality, hence involves a relinquishing of judgement and control in regard to who will receive that hospitality. In other words, hospitality also requires non-mastery, and the abandoning of all claims to property, or ownership. If that is the case, however, the ongoing possibility of hospitality thereby becomes circumvented, as there is no longer the possibility of hosting anyone, as again, there is no ownership or control.

c. Forgiveness

Derrida discerns another aporia in regard to whether or not to forgive somebody who has caused us significant suffering or pain. This particular paradox revolves around the premise that if one forgives something that is actually forgivable, then one simply engages in calculative reasoning and hence does not really forgive. Most commonly in interviews, but also in his recent text On Cosmopolitanism and Forgiveness, Derrida argues that according to its own internal logic, genuine forgiving must involve the impossible: that is, the forgiving of an ‘unforgivable’ transgression – eg. a ‘mortal sin’ (OCF 32, cf. OH 39). There is hence a sense in which forgiving must be ‘mad’ and ‘unconscious’ (OCF 39, 49), and it must also remain outside of, or heterogenous to, political and juridical rationality. This unconditional ‘forgiveness’ explicitly precludes the necessity of an apology or repentance by the guilty party, although Derrida acknowledges that this pure notion of forgiveness must always exist in tension with a more conditional forgiveness where apologies are actually demanded. However, he argues that this conditional forgiveness amounts more to amnesty and reconciliation than to genuine forgiveness (OCF 51). The pattern of this discussion is undoubtedly beginning to become familiar. Derrida’s discussions of forgiving are orientated around revealing a fundamental paradox that ensures that forgiving can never be finished or concluded – it must always be open, like a permanent rupture, or a wound that refuses to heal.

This forgiveness paradox depends, in one of its dual aspects, upon a radical disjunction between self and other. Derrida explicitly states that “genuine forgiveness must engage two singularities: the guilty and the victim. As soon as a third party intervenes, one can again speak of amnesty, reconciliation, reparation, etc., but certainly not of forgiveness in the strict sense” (OCF 42). Given that he also acknowledges that it is difficult to conceive of any such face-to-face encounter without a third party – as language itself must serve such a mediating function (OCF 48) – forgiveness is caught in an aporia that ensures that its empirical actuality looks to be decidedly unlikely. To recapitulate, the reason that Derrida’s notion of forgiveness is caught in such an inextricable paradox is because absolute forgiveness requires a radically singular confrontation between self and other, while conditional forgiveness requires the breaching of categories such as self and other, either by a mediating party, or simply by the recognition of the ways in which we are always already intertwined with the other. Indeed, Derrida explicitly argues that when we know anything of the other, or even understand their motivation in however minimal a way, this absolute forgiveness can no longer take place (OCF 49). Derrida can offer no resolution in regard to the impasse that obtains between these two notions (between possible and impossible forgiving, between an amnesty where apologies are asked for and a more absolute forgiveness). He will only insist that an oscillation between both sides of the aporia is necessary for responsibility (OCF 51).

d. Mourning

In Memoires: for Paul de Man, which was written almost immediately following de Man’s death in 1983, Derrida reflects upon the political significance of his colleague’s apparent Nazi affiliation in his youth, and he also discusses the pain of losing his friend. Derrida’s argument about mourning adheres to a similarly paradoxical logic to that which has been associated with him throughout this article. He suggests that the so-called ‘successful’ mourning of the deceased other actually fails – or at least is an unfaithful fidelity – because the other person becomes a part of us, and in this interiorisation their genuine alterity is no longer respected. On the other hand, failure to mourn the other’s death paradoxically appears to succeed, because the presence of the other person in their exteriority is prolonged (MDM 6). As Derrida suggests, there is a sense in which “an aborted interiorisation is at the same time a respect for the other as other” (MDM 35). Hence the possibility of an impossible bereavement, where the only possible way to mourn, is to be unable to do so. However, even though this is how he initially presents the problem, Derrida also problematises this “success fails, failure succeeds” formulation (MDM 35).

In his essay “Fors: The Anglish Words of Nicolas Abraham and Maria Torok”, Derrida again considers two models of the type of encroachment between self and other that is regularly associated with mourning. Borrowing from post-Freudian theories of mourning, he posits (although later undermines) a difference between introjection, which is love for the other in me, and incorporation, which involves retaining the other as a pocket, or a foreign body within one’s own body. For Freud, as well as for the psychologists Abraham and Torok whose work Derrida considers, successful mourning is primarily about the introjection of the other. The preservation of a discrete and separate other person inside the self (psychologically speaking), as is the case in incorporation, is considered to be where mourning ceases to be a ‘normal’ response and instead becomes pathological. Typically, Derrida reverses this hierarchy by highlighting that there is a sense in which the supposedly pathological condition of incorporation is actually more respectful of the other person’s alterity. After all, incorporation means that one has not totally assimilated the other, as there is still a difference and a heterogeneity (EO 57). On the other hand, Abraham and Torok’s so-called ‘normal’ mourning can be accused of interiorising the other person to such a degree that they have become assimilated and even metaphorically cannibalised. Derrida considers this introjection to be an infidelity to the other. However, Derrida’s account is not so simple as to unreservedly valorise the incorporation of the other person, even if he emphasises this paradigm in an effort to refute the canonical interpretation of successful mourning. He also acknowledges that the more the self “keeps the foreign element inside itself, the more it excludes it” (Fors xvii). If we refuse to engage with the dead other, we also exclude their foreignness from ourselves and hence prevent any transformative interaction with them. When fetishised in their externality in such a manner, the dead other really is lifeless and it is significant that Derrida describes the death of de Man in terms of the loss of exchange and of the transformational opportunities that he presented (MDM xvi, cf WM). Derrida’s point hence seems to be that in mourning, the ‘otherness of the other’ person resists both the process of incorporation as well as the process of introjection. The other can neither be preserved as a foreign entity, nor introjected fully within. Towards the end of Memoires: for Paul de Man, Derrida suggests that responsibility towards the other is about respecting and even emphasising this resistance (MDM 160, 238).

8. References and Further Reading

a. Derrida’s Texts (and Their Abbreviations)

• Acts of Literature, ed. Attridge, New York: Routledge, 1992 (AL).
• Adieu to Emmanuel Lévinas, trans. Brault & Naas, Stanford, California: Stanford University Press, 1999 (AEL).
• Circumfessions: Fifty Nine Periphrases, in Bennington, G., Jacques Derrida, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1993 (Circ).
• On Cosmopolitanism and Forgiveness, London: Routledge, 2001 (OCF).
• Deconstruction and the Possibility of Justice, (inc. “Force of the Law”), eds. Cornell, Carlson, & Benjamin, New York: Routledge, 1992 (DPJ).
• Dissemination, trans. Johnson, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1981 (D).
• “‘Eating Well’ or the Calculation of the Subject: An Interview with Jacques Derrida” in Who Comes After the Subject? eds. Cadava, Connor, & Nancy, New York: Routledge, 1991, p 96-119.
• The Ear of the Other: Otobiography, Transference, Translation, trans. Kamuf, ed. McDonald, New York: Schocken Books, 1985 (EO).
• Edmund Husserl’s ‘Origin of Geometry’: An Introduction, trans. Leavey, Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1978 (1962) (HOG).
• “Fors: The Anglish Words of Nicolas Abraham and Maria Torok”, trans. Johnson, in The Wolfman’s Magic Word: A Cryptonomy, Abraham, N., & Torok, M., trans. Rand, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1986 (Fors).
• The Gift of Death, trans. Wills, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1995 (1991) (GD).
• Given Time: i. Counterfeit Money, trans. Kamuf, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1992 (GT).
• “Hostipitality” in Angelaki: Journal of the Theoretical Humanities, Vol. 5, Number 3, Dec 2000.
• Le Toucher: Jean-Luc Nancy, Paris: Galilée, 2000 (T).
• “Le Toucher: Touch/to touch him”, in Paragraph, trans. Kamuf, 16:2, 1993, p 122-57.
• Limited Inc. (inc. “Afterword”), ed. Graff, trans. Weber, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1998 edition (LI).
• Margins of Philosophy, trans. Bass, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1982 (M).
• Memoires: for Paul de Man, trans. Lindsay, Culler, Cadava, & Kamuf, New York: Columbia University Press, 1989 (MDM).
• Memoirs of the Blind: The Self-Portrait and Other Ruins, trans. Brault & Naas, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1993 (1991) (MB).
• Monolingualism of the Other or the Prosthesis of Origin, trans. Mensh, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1996 (MO).
• “Nietzsche and the Machine: Interview with Jacques Derrida” (interviewer Beardsworth) in Journal of Nietzsche Studies, Issue 7, Spring 1994 (NM). Of Grammatology, trans. Spivak, Baltimore: John Hopkins University Press, 1976 (OG).
• Derrida, J., & Dufourmantelle, A., Of Hospitality, trans. Bowlby, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2000 (OH).
• On the Name (inc. “Passions”), ed. Dutoit, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1995 (ON).
• “Ousia and Gramme: A Note to a Footnote in Being and Time” trans. Casey in Phenomenology in Perspective, ed. Smith, The Hague: Nijhoff, 1970.
• Parages, Paris: Galilée, 1986. Points… Interviews, 1974-1995, ed. Weber, trans. Kamuf et al, Stanford: Stanford University Press, 1995 (P).
• Politics of Friendship, trans. Collins, New York: Verso, 1997 (PF).
• Positions, trans. Bass, London: Athlone Press, 1981 (1972) (PO).
• “Psyche: Inventions of the Other” in Reading De Man Reading, eds. Waters & Godzich, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press, 1989 (RDR).
• Spectres of Marx: The State of the Debt, the Work of Mourning and the New International, trans. Kamuf, New York: Routledge, 1994 (SM).
• ‘Speech and Phenomena’ and Other Essays on Husserl’s Theory of Signs, trans. Allison, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1973 (1967) (SP).
• The Work of Mourning, eds. Brault & Naas, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2001 (WM).
• Writing and Difference, trans. Bass, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1978 (1967) (WD).

b. Selected Commentaries

• Bennington, G., Interrupting Derrida, Warwick Studies in European Philosophy, London: Routledge, 2000.
• Bennington, G., Jacques Derrida, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1993.
• Caputo, J., Deconstruction in a Nutshell, New York: Fordham University Press, 1997.
• Caputo, J., The Prayers and Tears of Jacques Derrida, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1997.
• Critchley, S., The Ethics of Deconstruction: Derrida and Lévinas, Oxford, UK: Blackwell, 1992.
• Culler, J., On Deconstruction: Theory and Criticism after Structuralism, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, 1983.
• Gasché, R., Inventions of Difference: On Jacques Derrida, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1994. Gasché, R., The Tain of the Mirror: Derrida and the Philosophy of Reflection, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1986.
• Hart, K., The Trespass of the Sign: Deconstruction, Theology and Philosophy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1989.
• Harvey, I., Derrida and the Economy of Différance, Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1986.
• Howells, C., Derrida: Deconstruction from Phenomenology to Ethics, Cambridge: Polity Press, 1999.
• Krell, D., The Purest of Bastards: Works of Art, Affirmation and Mourning in the Thought of Jacques Derrida, Pennsylvania: Pennsylvania University Press, 2000.
• Norris, C., Derrida, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 1987.
• Patrick, M., Derrida, Responsibility and Politics, Avebury Series in Philosophy, Aldershot: Ashgate Publishing, 1997.
• Silverman, H., ed. Derrida and Deconstruction, New York: Routledge, 1989.
• Wood, D., The Deconstruction of Time, Contemporary Studies in Philosophy and the Human Sciences, Atlantic Highlands, New Jersey: Humanities Press, 1989.
• Wood, D., ed. Derrida: A Critical Reader, Oxford: Blackwell, 1992.
• Wood, D., & Bernasconi, R., eds. Derrida and Différance, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1988.

Author Information

Jack Reynolds
Email: Jack.Reynolds@latrobe.edu.au
La Trobe University
Australia

Martin Heidegger (1889—1976)

Martin Heidegger is widely acknowledged to be one of the most original and important philosophers of the 20^th century, while remaining one of the most controversial.  His thinking has contributed to such diverse fields as phenomenology (Merleau-Ponty), existentialism (Sartre, Ortega y Gasset), hermeneutics (Gadamer, Ricoeur), political theory (Arendt, Marcuse, Habermas), psychology (Boss, Binswanger, Rollo May), and theology (Bultmann, Rahner, Tillich). His critique of traditional metaphysics and his opposition to positivism and technological world domination have been embraced by leading theorists of postmodernity (Derrida, Foucault, and Lyotard). On the other hand, his involvement in the Nazi movement has invoked a stormy debate.  Although he never claimed that his philosophy was concerned with politics, political considerations have come to overshadow his philosophical work.

Heidegger’s main interest was ontology or the study of being. In his fundamental treatise, Being and Time, he attempted to access being (Sein) by means of phenomenological analysis of human existence (Dasein) in respect to its temporal and historical character. After the change of his thinking (“the turn”), Heidegger placed an emphasis on language as the vehicle through which the question of being can be unfolded. He turned to the exegesis of historical texts, especially of the Presocratics, but also of Kant, Hegel, Nietzsche and Hölderlin, and to poetry, architecture, technology, and other subjects. Instead of looking for a full clarification of the meaning of being, he tried to pursue a kind of thinking which was no longer “metaphysical.” He criticized the tradition of Western philosophy, which he regarded as nihilistic, for, as he claimed, the question of being as such was obliterated in it. He also stressed the nihilism of modern technological culture. By going to the Presocratic beginning of Western thought, he wanted to repeat the early Greek experience of being, so that the West could turn away from the dead end of nihilism and begin anew. His writings are notoriously difficult. Being and Time remains his most influential work.

Table of Contents

1. Life and Works
2. Philosophy as Phenomenological Ontology
3. Dasein and Temporality
4. The Quest for the Meaning of Being
5. Overcoming Metaphysics
6. From the First Beginning to the New Beginning
7. From Philosophy to Political Theory
8. Heidegger’s Collected Works
   1. Published Writings, 1910-1976
   2. Lectures from Marburg and Freiburg, 1919-1944
   3. Private Monographs and Lectures, 1919-1967
   4. Notes and Fragments

1. Life and Works

Heidegger was born on September 26, 1889 in Messkirch in south-west Germany to a Catholic family. His father worked as sexton in the local church. In his early youth, Heidegger was being prepared for the priesthood. In 1903 he went to the high school in Konstanz, where the church supported him with a scholarship, and then, in 1906, he moved to Freiburg. His interest in philosophy first arose during his high school studies in Freiburg when, at the age of seventeen, he read Franz Brentano’s book entitled On the Manifold Meaning of Being according to Aristotle. By his own account, it was this work that inspired his life-long quest for the meaning of being. In 1909, after completing the high school, he became a Jesuit novice, but was discharged within a month for reasons of health. He then entered Freiburg University, where he studied theology. However, because of health problems and perhaps because of a lack of a strong spiritual vocation, Heidegger left the seminary in 1911 and broke off his training for the priesthood. He took up studies in philosophy, mathematics, and natural sciences. It was also at that time that he first became influenced by Edmund Husserl. He studied Husserl’s Logical Investigations. In 1913 he completed a doctorate in philosophy with a dissertation on The Doctrine of Judgement in Psychologism under the direction of the neo-Kantian philosopher Heinrich Rickert.

The outbreak of the First World War interrupted Heidegger’s academic career only briefly. He was conscripted into the army, but was discharged after two months because of health reasons. Hoping to take over the chair of Catholic philosophy at Freiburg, Heidegger now began to work on a habilitation thesis, the required qualification for teaching at the university. His thesis, Duns Scotus’s Doctrine of Categories and Meaning, was completed in 1915, and in the same year he was appointed a Privatdozent, or lecturer. He taught mostly courses in Aristotelian and scholastic philosophy, and regarded himself as standing in the service of the Catholic world-view. Nevertheless, his turn from theology to philosophy was soon to be followed by another turn.

In 1916, Heidegger became a junior colleague of Edmund Husserl when the latter joined the Freiburg faculty. The following year, he married Thea Elfride Petri, a Protestant student who had attended his courses since the fall of 1915. His career was again interrupted by military service in 1918. He served for the last ten months of the war, the last three of those in a meteorological unit on the western front. Within a few weeks of his return to Freiburg, he announced his break with the “system of Catholicism” (January 9, 1919), got appointed as Husserl’s assistant (January 21, 1919), and began lecturing in a new, insightful way (February 7, 1919). His lectures on phenomenology and his creative interpretations of Aristotle would now earn him a wide acclaim. And yet, Heidegger did not simply become Husserl’s faithful follower. In particular, he was not captivated by the later developments of Husserl’s thought—by his neo-Kantian turn towards transcendental subjectivity and even less by his Cartesianism—but continued to value his earlier work, Logical Investigations. Laboring over the question of things themselves, Heidegger soon began a radical reinterpretation of Husserl’s phenomenology.

In 1923, with the support of Paul Natorp, Heidegger was appointed associate professor at Marburg University. Between 1923 and 1928, he enjoyed there the most fruitful years of his entire teaching career. His students testified to the originality of his insight and the intensity of his philosophical questioning. Heidegger extended the scope of his lectures, and taught courses on the history of philosophy, time, logic, phenomenology, Plato, Aristotle, Aquinas, Kant, and Leibniz. However, he had published nothing since 1916, a factor that threatened his future academic career. Finally, in February 1927, partly because of administrative pressure, his fundamental but also unfinished treatise, Being and Time, appeared. Within a few years, this book was recognized as a truly epoch-making work of 20^th century philosophy. It earned Heidegger, in the fall of 1927, full professorship at Marburg, and one year later, after Husserl’s retirement from teaching, the chair of philosophy at Freiburg University. Although Being and Time is dedicated to Husserl, upon its publication Heidegger’s departure from Husserl’s phenomenology and the differences between two philosophers became apparent. In 1929, his next published works—“What is Metaphysics?,” “On the Essence of Ground,” and Kant and the Problem of Metaphysics—further revealed how far Heidegger had moved from neo-Kantianism and phenomenology of consciousness to his own phenomenological ontology.

Heidegger’s life entered a problematic and controversial stage with Hitler’s rise to power. In September 1930, Adolf Hitler’s National Socialist German Workers’ Party (NSDAP) became the second largest party in Germany, and on January 30, 1933 Hitler was appointed chancellor of Germany. Up to then virtually apolitical, Heidegger now became politically involved. On April 21, 1933, he was elected rector of the University of Freiburg by the faculty. He was apparently urged by his colleagues to become a candidate for this politically sensitive post, as he later claimed in an interview with Der Spiegel, to avoid the danger of a party functionary being appointed. But he also seemed to believe that he could steer the Nazi movement in the right direction. On May 3, 1933, he joined the NSDAP, or Nazi, party. On May 27, 1933, he delivered his inaugural rectoral address on “The Self-Assertion of the German University.” The ambiguous text of this speech has often been interpreted as an expression of his support for Hitler’s regime. During his tenure as rector he produced a number of speeches in the Nazi cause, such as, for example, “Declaration of Support for Adolf Hitler and the National Socialist State” delivered in November 1933. There is little doubt that during that time, Heidegger placed the great prestige of his scholarly reputation at the service of National Socialism, and thus, willingly or not, contributed to its legitimization among his fellow Germans. And yet, just one year later, on April 23, 1934, Heidegger resigned from his office and took no further part in politics. His rectoral address was found incompatible with the party line, and its text was eventually banned by the Nazis. Because he was no longer involved in the party’s activities, Heidegger’s membership in the NSDAP became a mere formality. Certain restrictions were put on his freedom to publish and attend conferences. In his lecture courses of the late 1930s and early 1940s, and especially in the course entitled Hölderlin’s Hymnen “Germanien” und “Der Rein” (Hölderlin’s Hymns “Germania” and “The Rhine”) originally presented at the University of Freiburg during the winter semester of 1934/35, he expressed covert criticism of Nazi ideology. He came under attack of Ernst Krieck, semi-official Nazi philosopher. For some time he was under the surveillance of the Gestapo. His final humiliation came in 1944, when he was declared the most “expendable” member of the faculty and sent to the Rhine to dig trenches. Following Germany’s defeat in the Second World War, Heidegger was accused of Nazi sympathies. He was forbidden to teach and in 1946 was dismissed from his chair of philosophy. The ban was lifted in 1949.

The 1930s are not only marked by Heidegger’s controversial involvement in politics, but also by a change in his thinking which is known as “the turn” (die Kehre). In his lectures and writings that followed “the turn,” he became less systematic and often more obscure than in his fundamental work, Being and Time. He turned to the exegesis of philosophical and literary texts, especially of the Presocratics, but also of Kant, Hegel, Nietzsche and Hölderlin, and makes this his way of philosophizing. A recurring theme of that time was “the essence of truth.” During the decade between 1931 and 1940, Heidegger offered five courses under this title. His preoccupation with the question of language and his fascination with poetry were expressed in lectures on Hörderlin which he gave between 1934 and 1936. Towards the end of 1930s and the beginning of 1940s, he taught five courses on Nietzsche, in which he submitted to criticism the tradition of western metaphysics, described by him as nihilistic, and made allusions to the absurdity of war and the bestiality of his contemporaries. Finally, his reflection upon the western philosophical tradition and an endeavor to open a space for philosophizing outside it, brought him to an examination of Presocratic thought. In the course of lectures entitled An Introduction to Metaphysics, which was originally offered as a course of lectures in 1935, and can be seen as a bridge between earlier and later Heidegger, the Presocratics were no longer a subject of mere passing remarks as in Heidegger’s earlier works. The course was not about early Greek thought, yet the Presocratics became there the pivotal center of discussion. It is clear that with the evolution of Heidegger’s thinking in the 1930s, they gained in importance in his work. During the 1940s, in addition to giving courses on Aristotle, Kant and Hegel, Heidegger lectured extensively on Anaximander, Parmenides, and Heraclitus.

During the last three decades of his life, from the mid 1940s to the mid 1970s, Heidegger wrote and published much, but in comparison to earlier decades, there was no significant change in his philosophy. In his insightful essays and lectures, such as “What are Poets for?” (1946), “Letter on Humanism” (1947), “The Question Concerning Technology” (1953), “The Way to Language” (1959), “Time and Being” (1962), and “The End of Philosophy and the Task of Thinking” (1964), he addressed different issues concerning modernity, labored on his original philosophy of history—the history of being—and attempted to clarify his way of thinking after “the turn”. Most of his time was divided between his home in Freiburg, his second study in Messkirch, and his mountain hut in the Black Forest. But he escaped provincialism by being frequently visited by his friends (including, among the others, the political philosopher Hannah Arendt, the physicist Werner Heisenberg, the theologian Rudolf Bultmann, the psychologist Ludwig Binswanger) and by traveling more widely than ever before. He lectured on “What is Philosophy?” at Cerisy-la-Salle in 1955, and on “Hegel and the Greeks” at Aix-en-Provence in 1957, and also visited Greece in 1962 and 1967. In 1966, Heidegger attempted to justify his political involvement during the Nazi regime in an interview with Der Spiegel entitled “Only God Can Save Us”. One of his last teaching stints was a seminar on Parmenides that he gave in Zähringen in 1973. Heiddegger died on May 26, 1976, and was buried in the churchyard in Messkirch. He remained intellectually active up until the very end, working on a number of projects, including the massive Gesamtausgabe, the complete edition of his works.

2. Philosophy as Phenomenological Ontology

In order to understand Heidegger’s philosophy before “the turn”, let us first briefly consider his indebtedness to Edmund Husserl. As it has been mentioned, Heidegger was interested in Husserl from his early student years at the University of Freiburg when he read Logical Investigations. Later, when Husserl accepted a chair at Freiburg, Heidegger became his assistant. His debt to Husserl cannot be overlooked. Not only is Being and Time dedicated to Husserl, but also Heidegger acknowledges in it that without Husserl’s phenomenology his own investigation would not have been possible. How then is Heidegger’s philosophy related to the Husserlian program of phenomenology?

By “phenomenology” Husserl himself had always meant the science of consciousness and its objects; this core of sense pervades the development of this concept as eidetic, transcendental or constructive throughout his works. Following the Cartesian tradition, he saw the ground and the absolute starting point of philosophy in the subject. The procedure of bracketing is essential to Husserl’s “phenomenological reduction”—the methodological procedure by which we are led from “the natural attitude,” in which we are involved in the actual world and its affairs, to “the phenomenological attitude,” in which the analysis and detached description of the content of consciousness is possible. The phenomenological reduction helps us to free ourselves from prejudices and secure the purity of our detachment as observers, so that we can encounter “things as they are in themselves” independently of any presuppositions. The goal of phenomenology for Husserl is then a descriptive, detached analysis of consciousness, in which objects, as its correlates, are constituted.

What right does Husserl have to insist that the original mode of encounter with beings, in which they appear to us as they are as things in themselves, is the encounter of consciousness purified by phenomenological reduction and its objects? “Whence and how is it determined what must be experienced as the ‘things themselves’ in accordance with the principle of phenomenology?” These are pressing questions which Heidegger might well have asked. Perhaps because of his reverence for Husserl, he does not subject him to direct criticism in his fundamental work. Nevertheless, Being and Time is itself a powerful critique of the Husserlian phenomenology. Heidegger there gives attention to many different modes in which we exist and encounter things. He analyses the structures constitutive of things not only as they are encountered in the detached, theoretical attitude of consciousness, but also in daily life as “utensils” (Zuhandene) or in special moods, especially in anxiety (Angst). What is more, he exhibits there the structures that are constitutive of the particular kind of being which is the human being and which he calls “Dasein.” For Heidegger, it is not pure consciousness in which beings are originally constituted. The starting point of philosophy for him is not consciousness, but Dasein in its being.

The central problem for Husserl is the problem of constitution: How is the world as phenomenon constituted in our consciousness? Heidegger takes the Husserlian problem one step further. Instead of asking how something must be given in consciousness in order to be constituted, he asks: “What is the mode of being of that being in which the world constitutes itself?” In a letter to Husserl dated October 27, 1927, he states that the question of Dasein’s being cannot be evaded, as far as the problem of constitution is concerned. Dasein is that being in which any being is constituted. Further, the question of Dasein’s being directs him to the problem of being in general. The “universal problem of being,” he says in the same letter, “refers to that which constitutes and to that which is constituted.” While far from being dependent upon Husserl, Heidegger finds in his thought an inspiration leading him to the theme which has continued to draw his attention since his early years: the question of the meaning of being.

Phenomenology thus receives in Heidegger a new meaning. He conceives it more broadly, and more etymologically, than Husserl, as “letting what shows itself to be seen from itself, just as it shows from itself.” Husserl applies the term “phenomenology” to a whole philosophy. Heidegger takes it rather to designate a method. Since in Being and Time philosophy is described as “ontology” and has being as its theme, it cannot adopt its method from any of the actual sciences. For Heidegger the method of ontology is phenomenology. “Phenomenology,” he says, “is the way of access to what is to become the theme of ontology.” Being is to be grasped by means of the phenomenological method. However, being is always the being of a being, and accordingly, it becomes accessible only indirectly through some existing entity. Therefore, “phenomenological reduction” is necessary. One must direct oneself toward an entity, but in such a way that its being is thereby brought out. It is Dasein which Heidegger chooses as the particular entity to access being. Hence, as the basic component of his phenomenology, Heidegger adopts the Husserlian phenomenological reduction, but gives it a completely different meaning.

To sum up, Heidegger does not base his philosophy on consciousness as Husserl did. For him the phenomenological or theoretical attitude of consciousness, which Husserl makes the core of his doctrine, is only one possible mode of that which is more fundamental, namely, Dasein’s being. Although he agrees with Husserl that the transcendental constitution of the world cannot be unveiled by naturalistic or physical explanations, in his view it is not a descriptive analysis of consciousness that leads to this end, but the analysis of Dasein. Phenomenology for him is not a descriptive, detached analysis of consciousness. It is a method of access to being. For the Heidegger of Being and Time, philosophy is phenomenological ontology which takes its departure from the analysis of Dasein.

3. Dasein and Temporality

In everyday German language the word “Dasein” means life or existence. The noun is used by other German philosophers to denote the existence of any entity. However, Heidegger breaks the word down to its components “Da” and “Sein,” and gives to it a special meaning which is related to his answer to the question of who the human being is. He relates this question to the question of being. Dasein, that being which we ourselves are, is distinguished from all other beings by the fact that it makes issue of its own being. It stands out to being. As Da-sein, it is the site, “Da”, for the disclosure of being, “Sein.”

Heidegger’s fundamental analysis of Dasein from Being and Time points to temporality as the primordial meaning of Dasein’s being. Dasein is essentially temporal. Its temporal character is derived from the tripartite ontological structure: existence, thrownness, and fallenness by which Dasein’s being is described. Existence means that Dasein is potentiality-for-being (Seinkönnen); it projects its being upon various possibilities. Existence represents thus the phenomenon of the future. Then, as thrownness, Dasein always finds itself already in a certain spiritual and material, historically conditioned environment; in short, in the world, in which the space of possibilities is always somehow limited. This represents the phenomenon of the past as having-been. Finally, as fallenness, Dasein exists in the midst of beings which are both Dasein and not Dasein. The encounter with those beings, “being-alongside” or “being-with” them, is made possible for Dasein by the presence of those beings within-the-world. This represents the primordial phenomenon of the present. Accordingly, Dasein is not temporal for the mere reason that it exists “in time,” but because its very being is rooted in temporality: the original unity of the future, the past and the present. Temporality cannot be identified with ordinary clock time – with simply being at one point in time, at one “Now” after another—which for Heidegger is a derivative phenomenon. Neither does Dasein’s temporality have the merely quantitative, homogeneous character of the concept of time found in natural science. It is the phenomenon of original time, of the time which “temporalizes” itself in the course of Dasein’s existence. It is a movement through a world as a space of possibilities. The “going back” to the possibilities that have been (the past) in the moment of thrownness, and their projection in the resolute movement “coming towards” (the future) in the moment of existence, which both take place in “being with” others (the present) in the moment of fallenness, provide for the original unity of the future, the past, and the present which constitutes authentic temporality.

As authentically temporal, Dasein as potentiality-for-being comes towards itself in its possibilities of being by going back to what has been; it always comes towards itself from out of a possibility of itself. Hence, it comports itself towards the future by always coming back to its past; the past which is not merely past but still around as having-been. But in this “going back” to what it has been which is constitutive together with “coming towards” and “being with” for the unity of Dasein’s temporality, Dasein hands down to itself its own historical “heritage,” namely, the possibilities of being that have come down to it. As authentically temporal, Dasein is thus authentically historical. The repetition of the possibilities of existence, of that which has been, is for Heidegger constitutive for the phenomenon of original history which is rooted in temporality.

4. The Quest for the Meaning of Being

Throughout his long academic career, Heidegger was preoccupied with the question of the meaning of being. His first formulation of this question goes as far back as his high school studies, during which he read Franz Brentano’s book On the Manifold Meaning of Being in Aristotle. In 1907, the seventeen-year-old Heidegger asked: “If what-is is predicated in manifold meanings, then what is its leading fundamental meaning? What does being mean?” The question of being, unanswered at that time, becomes the leading question of Being and Time twenty years later. Surveying the long history of the meaning attributed to “being,” Heidegger notes that in the philosophical tradition it has generally been presupposed that being is at once the most universal concept, the concept indefinable in terms of other concepts, and the self-evident concept. In short, it is a concept that is mostly taken for granted. However, Heidegger claims that even though we seem to understand being, its meaning is still veiled in darkness. Therefore, we need to restate the question of the meaning of being.

In accordance with the method of philosophy which he employs in his fundamental treatise, before attempting to provide an answer to the question of being in general, Heidegger sets out to answer the question of the being of the particular kind of entity that is the human being, which he calls Dasein. The vivid phenomenological descriptions of Dasein’s being-in-the-world, especially Dasein’s everydayness and resoluteness toward death, have attracted many readers with interests related to existential philosophy, theology, and literature. The basic concepts such as temporality, understanding, historicity, repetition, and authentic or inauthentic existence were carried over into and further explored in his later works.  Still, from the point of view of the quest for the meaning of being, Being and Time was a failure and remained unfinished. As Heidegger himself admitted in his later essay, “Letter on Humanism” (1946), the third division of its first part, entitled “Time and Being,” was held back “because thinking failed in adequate saying of the turning and did not succeed with the help of the language of metaphysics.” The second part also remained unwritten.

“The turn” (Kehre) that occurs in the 1930’s is the change in Heidegger’s thinking mentioned above.  The consequence of “the turn” is not the abandoning of the leading question of Being and Time.  Heidegger stresses the continuity of his thought over the course of the change. Nevertheless, as “everything is reversed,” even the question concerning the meaning of Being is reformulated in Heidegger’s later work. It becomes a question of the openness, that is, of the truth, of being. Furthermore, since the openness of being refers to a situation within history, the most important concept in the later Heidegger becomes the history of being.

For a reader unacquainted with Heidegger’s thought, both the “question of the meaning of being” and the expression “history of being” sound strange. In the first place, such a reader may argue that when something is said to be, there is nothing expressed which the word “Being” could properly denote. Therefore, the word “being” is a meaningless term and the Heideggerian quest for the meaning of being is in general a misunderstanding. Secondly, the reader may also think that the being of Heidegger is no more likely to have a history than the being of Aristotle, so the “history of being” is a misunderstanding as well. Nevertheless, Heidegger’s task is precisely to show that there is a meaningful concept of being. “We understand the ‘is’ we use in speaking,” he claims, “although we do not comprehend it conceptually.” Therefore, Heidegger asks: Can being then be thought? We can think of beings: a table, my desk, the pencil with which I am writing, the school building, a heavy storm in the mountains . . . but being? If the being whose meaning Heidegger seeks seems so elusive, almost like no-thing, it is because it is not an entity. It is not something; it is not a being. “Being is essentially different from a being, from beings.” The “ontological difference,” the distinction between being (das Sein) and beings (das Seiende), is fundamental for Heidegger. The forgetfulness of being that, according to him, occurs in the course of Western philosophy amounts to the oblivion of this distinction.

The conception of the history of being is of central importance in Heidegger’s thought. Already in Being and Time its idea is foreshadowed as “the destruction of the history of ontology.” In Heidegger’s later writings the story is considerably recast and called the “history of being” (Seinsgeschichte). The beginning of this story, as told by Heidegger especially in the Nietzsche lectures, is the end, the completion of philosophy by its dissolution into particular sciences and nihilism—questionlessness of being, a dead end into which the West has run. Heidegger argues that the question of being would still provide a stimulus to the research of Plato and Aristotle, but it was precisely with them that the original experience of being of the early Greeks was covered over. The fateful event was followed by the gradual slipping away of the distinction between being and beings. Described variously by different philosophers, being was reduced to a being: to idea in Plato, substantia and actualitas in Medieval philosophy, objectivity in modern philosophy, and will to power in Nietzsche and contemporary thought. The task which the later Heidegger sets before himself is then to make a way back into the primordial beginning, so that the “dead end” can be replaced by a new beginning. And since the primordial beginning of western thought lies in ancient Greece, in order to solve the problems of contemporary philosophy and reverse the course of modern history, Heidegger ultimately turns for help to the Presocratics, the first western thinkers.

5. Overcoming Metaphysics

For the later Heidegger, “western philosophy,” in which there occurs forgetfulness of being, is synonymous with “the tradition of metaphysics.” Metaphysics inquires about the being of beings, but in such a way that the question of being as such is disregarded, and being itself is obliterated. The Heideggerian “history of being” can thus be seen as the history of metaphysics, which is the history of being’s oblivion. However, looked at from another angle, metaphysics is also the way of thinking that looks beyond beings toward their ground or basis. Each metaphysics aims at the fundamentum absolutum, the ground of such a metaphysics which presents itself indubitably. In Descartes, for example, the fundamentum absolutum is attained through the “Cogito” argument. Cartesian metaphysics is characterized by subjectivity because it has its ground in the self-certain subject. Furthermore, metaphysics is not merely the philosophy which asks the question of the being of beings. At the end of philosophy—i.e., in our present age where there occurs the dissolution of philosophy into particular sciences—the sciences still speak of the being of what-is as a whole. In the wider sense of this term, metaphysics is thus, for Heidegger, any discipline which, whether explicitly or not, provides an answer to the question of the being of beings and of their ground. In medieval times such a discipline was scholastic philosophy, which defined beings as entia creatum (created things) and provided them with their ground in ens perfectissimum (the perfect being), God. Today the discipline is modern technology, through which the contemporary human being establishes himself in the world by working on it in the various modes of making and shaping. Technology forms and controls the human position in today’s world. It masters and dominates beings in various ways.

“In distinction from mastering beings, the thinking of thinkers is the thinking of being.” Heidegger believes that early Greek thinking is not yet metaphysics. Presocratic thinkers ask the question concerning the being of beings, but in such a way that being itself is laid open. They experience the being of beings as the presencing (Anwesen) of what is present (Anwesende). Being as presencing means enduring in unconcealment, disclosing. Throughout his later works Heidegger uses several words in order rightly to convey this Greek experience. What-is, what is present, the unconcealed, is “what appears from out of itself, in appearing shows itself , and in this self-showing manifests.” It is the “emerging arising, the unfolding that lingers.” He describes this experience with the Greek words phusis (emerging dominance) and alêtheia (unconcealment). He attempts to show that the early Greeks did not “objectify” beings (they did not try to reduce them to an object for the thinking subject), but they let them be as they were, as self-showing rising into unconcealment. They experienced the phenomenality of what is present, its radiant self-showing. The departure of Western philosophical tradition from concern with what is present in presencing, from this unique experience that astonished the Greeks, has had profound theoretical and practical consequences.

According to Heidegger, the experience of what is present in presencing signifies the true, unmediated experience of “the things themselves” (die Sache selbst). We may recall that the call to “the things themselves” was included in the Husserlian program of phenomenology. By means of phenomenological description Husserl attempted to arrive at pure phenomena and to describe beings just as they were given independently of any presuppositions. For Heidegger, this attempt has, however, a serious drawback. Like the tradition of modern philosophy preceding him, Husserl stood at the ground of subjectivity. The transcendental subjectivity or consciousness was for him “the sole absolute being.” It was the presupposition that had not been accounted for in his program which aimed to be presuppositionless. Consequently, in Heidegger’s view, the Husserlian attempt to arrive at pure, unmediated phenomena fails. Husserl’s phenomenology departs from the original phenomenality of beings and represents them in terms of the thinking subject as their presupposed ground. By contrast, Heidegger argues, for the Presocratics, beings are grounded in being as presencing. Being, however, is not a ground. To the early Greeks, being, unlimited in its dis-closure, appears as an abyss, the source of thought and wonder. Being calls everything into question, casts the human being out of any habitual ground, and opens before him the mystery of existence.

The departure of western philosophical tradition from what is present in presencing results in metaphysics. Heidegger believes that today’s metaphysics, in the form of technology and the calculative thinking related to it, has become so pervasive that there is no realm of life that is not subject to its dominance. It imposes its technological-scientific-industrial character on human beings, making it the sole criterion of the human sojourn on earth. As it ultimately degenerates into ideologies and worldviews, metaphysics provides an answer to the question of the being of beings for contemporary men and women, but skillfully removes from their lives the problem of their own existence. Moreover, because its sway over contemporary human beings is so powerful, metaphysics cannot be simply cast aside or rejected. Any direct attempt to do so will only strengthen its hold. Metaphysics cannot be rejected, canceled or denied, but it can be overcome by demonstrating its nihilism. In Heidegger’s use of the term, “nihilism” has a very specific meaning. It refers to the forgetfulness of being. What remains unquestioned and forgotten in metaphysics is Being; hence, it is nihilistic.

According to Heidegger, Western humankind in all its relations with beings is sustained by metaphysics. Every age, every human epoch, no matter however different they may be—

Greece after the Presocratics, Rome, the Middle Ages, modernity—has asserted a metaphysics and, therefore, is placed in a specific relationship to what-is as a whole. Metaphysics inquires about the being of beings, but it reduces being to a being; it does not think of being as being. Insofar as being itself is obliterated in it, metaphysics is nihilism. The metaphysics of Plato is no less nihilistic than that of Nietzsche. Consequently, Heidegger tries to demonstrate the nihilism of metaphysics in his account of the history of being, which he considers as the history of being’s oblivion. His attempt to overcome metaphysics is not based on a common-sense positing of a different set of values or the setting out of an alternative worldview, but rather is related to his concept of history, the central theme of which is the repetition of the possibilities for existence. This repetition consists in thinking being back to the primordial beginning of the West—to the early Greek experience of being as presencing—and repeating this beginning, so that the Western world can begin anew.

6. From the First Beginning to the New Beginning

Many scholars perceive something unique in the Greek beginning of philosophy. It is commonly acknowledged that Thales and his successors asked generalized questions concerning what is as a whole, and proposed general, rational answers which were no longer based on a theological ground. However, Heidegger does not associate the unique beginning with the alleged discovery of rationality and science. In fact, he claims that both rationality and science are later developments, so that they cannot apply to Presocratic thought. In his view, the Presocratics ask: “What are beings as such as a whole?” and they answer: aletheia—unconcealment. They experience beings in their phenomenality: as what is present in presencing. But the later thought which begins with Plato and Aristotle is unable to keep up with the beginning. With Plato and Aristotle metaphysics begins and the history of being’s oblivion originates.

The aim which the later Heidegger sets before himself is precisely to return to the original experience of beings in being that stands at the beginning of Western thought. This unmediated experience of beings in their phenomenality can be variously described: what is present in presencing, the unconcealment of what is present, the original disclosure of beings. To repeat the primordial beginning more originally in its originality means to bring us back to the Presocratic experiences, to dis-close them, and to let them be as they originally are. But the repetition is not for the sake of the Presocratics themselves. Heidegger’s work is not a mere antiquarian, scholarly study of early Greek thinking, nor is it an affirmation of the long lost Greek way of life. It occurs within the perspective of nihilism and being’s forgetfulness, both unknown to the Greeks, and has as a goal the future possibilities for existence. It happens as the listening that opens itself out to the words of the Presocratics from our contemporary age, from the age of the world picture and representation, the world which is marked by the domination of technology and the oblivion of being. In the first beginning, the task of the Greeks was to ask the question “What are beings?,” and hence to bring beings as such as a whole to the first recognition and the most simple interpretation. In the end, the task is to make questionable what at the end of a long tradition of philosophy-metaphysics has been forgotten. The new beginning begins thus with the question of being.

From Being and Time (1927) where the question of the meaning of being is first developed, but still expressed in the language of metaphysics, to “Time and Being” (1962) where an attempt to think being without regard to metaphysics is made, Heidegger goes full circle. Heidegger begins by asking about the multiple meanings of being and ends up conceding its multiplicity and acknowledging that there are multiple determinations or meanings of being in which being discloses itself in history. Nevertheless, in neither of these meanings does being give itself fully. “As it discloses itself in beings, being withdraws.” There is an essential withdrawal of being. Therefore, the truth of being is none of its particular historical determinations—idea, substantia, actualitas, objectivity or the will to power. The truth of being can be defined as the openness, the free region which always out of sight provides the space of play for the different determinations of being and human epochs established in them. It is that which is before actual things and grants them a possibility of manifestation as what is present, ens creatum, and objects.

The truth of being, its openness, is for Heidegger not something which we can merely consider or think of. It is not our own production. It is where we always come to stand. We find ourselves thrown in a historically conditioned environment, in an epoch in which the decision concerning the prevailing interpretation of the being of being is already made for us. Yet, by asking the question of being, we can at least attempt to free ourselves from our historical conditioning. Heidegger’s program expressed in “The End of Philosophy and the Task of Thinking” (1964) consists solely in the character of thinking which does not attempt to dominate, but engages in disclosing and opening up what shows itself, emerges, and is manifest. When Heidegger urges us to stand in being, he does not merely ask us to acknowledge our own place in being’s history, but to be future-oriented and see the future in a unity with the past as having-been and the present. It means turning oneself into being in its disclosing withdrawal.

7. From Philosophy to Political Theory

Heidegger never claimed that his philosophy was concerned with politics. Nevertheless, there are certainly some political implications of his thought. He perceives the metaphysical culture of the West as a continuity. It begins with Plato and ends with modernity, and the dominance of science and technology. He thus implies in the post-modernist fashion that Nazism and the atom bomb, Auschwitz and Hiroshima, have been something like the “fulfillment” of the tradition of Western metaphysics and tries to distance himself from that tradition. He turns to the Presocratics in order to retrieve a pre-metaphysical mode of thought that would serve as a starting point for a new beginning. However, his grand vision of the essential history of the West and of western nihilism can be questioned. Modernity, whose development involves not only a technological but also a social revolution, which sets individuals loose from religious and ethnic communities, from parishes and family bonds, and which affirms materialistic values, can be regarded as a radical departure from earlier classical and Christian traditions. Contrary to Heidegger’s argument, rather than being a mere continuity, the “essential” history of the West can then be seen as a history of radical transformations. Christianity challenges the classical world, while assimilating some aspects of it, and is in turn challenged by modernity. Modernity overturns the ideas and values of the traditional (Christian and classical) culture of the West, and, once it becomes global, leads to the erosion of nonwestern traditional cultures.

Under the cover of immense speculative depth and rich ontological vocabulary full of intricate wordplay (both which make his writings extremely hard to follow) Heidegger expresses a simple political vision. He is a revolutionary thinker who denies the traditional philosophical division between theory and practice, and this is especially clear when he boldly declares in his Introduction to Metaphysics that “we have undertaken the great and lengthy task of demolishing a world that has grown old and of building it truly anew”. He wants to overturn the traditional culture of the West and build it anew on the basis of earlier traditions in the name of being. Like other thinkers of modernity, he adopts a Eurocentric perspective and sees the revival of German society as a condition for the revival of Europe (or the West), and that of Europe as a condition for the revival of for the whole world; like them, while rejecting God as an end, he attempts to set up fabricated ends for human beings. Ultimately, in the famous interview with Der Spiegel, he expresses his disillusionment with his project and says: “Philosophy will not be able to bring about a direct change of the present state of the world . . . The greatness of what is to be thought is too great.” Like being, which he describes as “disclosing self-concealing,” after making a disclosure he withdraws; after stirring up a revolution, he leaves all its problems to others. He says: “only a God can still save us,” but the God for whom, in the absence of philosophical thought, he now looks is clearly not that of the Christians or of any contemporary religion.

In the Spiegel interview Heidegger tells us that in order to begin anew, we need to go to the “age-old” (i.e., pre-classical and pre-metaphysical) traditions of thought. He invokes the concept of the ancient polis. Yet, since he does not want to concern himself with the question of ethics (beyond saying in the “Letter of Humanism” that the word “ethics appeared for the first time in the school of Plato” and thus implying that ethics does not think the truth of being and is nihilistic), he does not consider the fact that even in pre-Platonic and pre-Socratic times a Greek polis was an ethical community, in which moral questions were raised and discussed. The Iliad and Odyssey of Homer, the poems of Hesiod, and the tragedies of Sophocles, as well as the other ancient Greek texts, including the monumental political work of Thucydides, the History of the Peloponnesian War, express concerns with ethical behavior at both the individual and community levels. Furthermore, the strength of Western civilization, insofar as its roots can be traced to ancient Greece, is that from its beginning it was based on rationality, understood as free debate, and the affirmation of fundamental moral values. Whenever it turned to irrationality and moral relativism, as in Nazism and Communism, that civilization was in decline. Therefore, Heidegger is likely to be mistaken in his diagnosis of the ills of the contemporary society, and his solution to those ills seems to be wrong. Asking the question of being (and, drawing our attention to this question is certainly his significant contribution) is an important addition to, but never a replacement for asking moral questions in the spirit of rationality and freedom.

Heidegger claims that the human being as Da-sein can be understood as the “there” (Da) which being (Sein) requires in order to disclose itself. The human being is the unique being whose being has the character of openness toward Being. But men and women can also turn away from being, forget their true selves, and thus deprive themselves of their humanity. This is, in Heidegger’s view, the situation of contemporary humans, who have replaced authentic questioning concerning their existence with ready-made answers served up by ideologies, the mass media, and overwhelming technology. Consequently, Heidegger attempts to bring today’s men and women back to the question of being. At the beginning of the tradition of Western philosophy, the human being was defined as animal rationale, the animal endowed with reason. Since then, reason has become an absolute value which through education brings about a gradual transformation of all spheres of human life. It is not more reason in the modern sense of calculative thinking, Heidegger believes, that we need today, but more openness toward and more reflection on that which is nearest to us—being.

8. Heidegger’s Collected Works

Heidegger’s earlier publications and transcripts of his lectures are being brought out in Gesamtausgabe, the complete edition of his works. The Gesamtausgabe, which is not yet complete and projected to fill about one hundred volumes, is published by Vittorio Klostermann, Frankfurt am Main. The series consists of four divisions: (I) Published Writings 1910-1976; (II) Lectures from Marburg and Freiburg, 1919-1944; (III) Private Monographs and Lectures, 1919-1967; (IV) Notes and Fragments. Below there is a list of the collected works of Martin Heidegger. English translations and publishers are cited with each work translated into English.

a. Published Writings, 1910-1976

• Frühe Schriften (1912-16).
• Sein und Zeit (1927). Translated as Being and Time by John Macquarrie and Edward Robinson (Oxford: Basil Blackwell, 1978).
• Kant und das Problem der Metaphysik (1929). Translated as Kant and the Problem of Metaphysics, by Richard Taft (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1997).
• Erläuterungen zu Hölderlins Dichtung (1936-68). Translated as Elucidations of Hölderlin’s Poetry, by Keith Hoeller (Amherst, New York: Humanity Books, 2000).
• Holzwege (1935-46).
  • “Der Ursprung der Kunstwerkes.” Translated as “The Origin of the Work of Art,” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought (New York: Harper & Row, 1971), and in Basic Writings (New York: Harper & Row, 1977, 1993).
  • “Die Zeit des Weltbildes.” Translated as “The Age of the World Picture” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays (NewYork: Harper & Row, 1977).
  • “Hegels Begriff der Erfahrung.”
  • “Nietzsches Wort ‘Gott ist tot’.” Translated as “The Word of Nietzsche: ‘God Is Dead’” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays.
  • “Wozu Dichter?.” Translated as “What Are Poets For?” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought.
  • “Der Spruch der Anaximander.” Translated as “The Anaximander Fragment” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking (New York: Harper & Row, 1975).
• Vol. I, Nietzsche I (1936-39). Translated as Nietzsche I: The Will to Power as Art by David F. Krell (New York: Harper & Row, 1979)
• Vol. II, Nietzsche II (1939-46). Translated as “The Eternal Recurrence of the Same” by David F. Krell in Nietzsche II: The Eternal Recurrence of the Same (New York, Harper & Row, 1984).
• Vorträge und Aufsätze (1936-53).
  • “Die Frage nach der Technik.” Translated as “The Question Concerning Technology” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays.
  • “Wissenschaft und Besinnung.” Translated as “Science and Reflection” by William Lovitt in The Question Concerning Technology and Other Essays.
  • “Überwindung der Metaphysik.” Translated as “Overcoming Metaphysics” by Joan Stambaugh in The End of Philosophy (New York: Harper & Row, 1973).
  • “Wer ist Nietzsches Zarathustra.” Translated as “Who is Nietzsche’s Zarathustra?” by David F. Krell in Nietzsche II: The Eternal Recurrence of the Same.
  • “Bauen Wohnen Denken.” Translated as “Building Dwelling Thinking.”
  • “Das Ding.” Translated as “The Thing” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought.
  • “…dichterisch wohnet der Mensch...” Translated as “…Poetically Man Dwells…” by Albert Hofstadter, in Poetry, Language, Thought.
  • “Logos.” Translated as “Logos (Heraclitus, Fragment B 50)” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking.
  • “Moira.” Translated as “Moira (Parmenides VIII, 34-41)” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking.
  • “Aletheia.” Translated as “Aletheia (Heraclius, Fragment B 16)” by David F. Krell and Frank A. Capuzzi in Early Greek Thinking.
• Was heisst Denken? (1951-52). Translated as What Is Called Thinking? by Fred D. Wieck and J. Glenn Gray (New York: Harper & Row, 1968).
• Wegmarken (1919-58). Translated as Pathmarks. Edited by William McNeill (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998).
  • Contains: “Comments on Karl Jaspers’ Psychology of Worldviews” (1919/21), “Phenomenology and Theology” (1927), “From the Last Marburg Lecture Course” (1928), “What is Metaphysics?” (1929), “On the Essence of Ground” (1929), “On the Essence of Truth” (1930), “Plato’s Doctrine of Truth” (1931-1932, 1940), “On the Essence and Concept in Aristotle’s Physics B 1” (1939), “Postscript to ‘What is Metaphysics?’” (1943); “Letter on Humanism” (1946), “Introduction to ‘What is Metaphysics?’” (1949), “On the Question of Being” (1955), “Hegel and the Greeks” (1958), “Kant’s Thesis About Being” (1961).
• Der Satz vom Grund (1955-56). Translated as The Principle of Reason by Reginald Lilly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1991).
• Identität und Differenz (1955-57). Translated as Identity and Difference by Joan Stambaugh (New York: Harper & Row, 1969).
• Unterwegs zur Sprache (1950-59). Translated as On the Way to Language by Peter D. Hertz (New York: Harper & Row, 1971).
• Aus der Erfahrung des Denkens (1910-76).
• Zur Sache des Denkens (1962-64). Translated as On Time and Being by Joan Stambaugh (New York: Harper & Row, 1972). Contains: “Time and Being,” “The End of Philosophy and the Task of Thinking,” and “My Way to Phenomenology.”
• Seminare (1951-73).
• Reden und andere Zeugnisse eines Lebensweges (1910-1976).

b. Lectures from Marburg and Freiburg, 1919-1944

• Der Beginn der neuzeitlichen Philosophie (winter semester, 1923-1924).
• Aristoteles: Rhetorik (summer semester, 1924).
• Platon: Sophistes (winter semester, 1924-1925). Translated as Plato’s Sophist by Richard Rojcewicz and Andre Schuwer (Bloomington, Indiana University Press, 1997).
• Prolegomena zur Geschite des Zeitbegriffs (summer semester, 1925). Translated as History of the Concept of Time by Theodore Kisiel (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1985).
• Logik: Die frage nach der Wahrheit (winter semester 1925-1926).
• Grundbegriffe der antiken Philosophie (summer semester 1926).
• Geschichte der Philosophie von Thomas v. Aquin bis Kant (winter semester 1926-1927).
• Die Grundprobleme der Phänomenologie (summer semester 1927). Translated as The Basic Problems of Phenomonology by Albert Hofstadter (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1982).
• Phänomenologie Interpretation von Kants Kritik der reinen Vernunft (winter semester 1927-1928). Translated as Phenomenological Interpretations of Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason by Parvis Emad and Kenneth Maly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1997).
• Metaphysische Anfangsgründe der Logik im Ausgang von Leibniz (summer semester, 1928). Translated as The Metaphysical Foundations of Logic by Michael Heim (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1984).
• Einleitung in die Philosophie (winter semester 1928-1929).
• Der Deutsche Idealismus (Fichte, Hegel, Schelling) und die philosophische Problemlage der Gegenwart (summer semester, 1929).
• Die Grundbegriffe der Metaphysik: Welt-Endlichkeit-Einsamkeit (winter semester, 1929-1930). Translated as The Fundamental Concepts of Metaphysics by William McNeill and Nicholas Walker (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1995).
• Vom Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit. Einleitung in die Philosophie (summer semester, 1930).
• Hegels Phänomenologie des Geistes (winter semester, 1930-1931). Translated as Hegel’s Phenomenology of Spirit by Parvis Emad and Kenneth Maly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1988).
• Aristoteles: Metaphysik IX (summer semester, 1931). Translated as Aristotle’s Metaphysics Theta 1-3 On the Essence and Actuality of Force by Walter Brogan and Peter Warnek (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1995).
• Vom Wesen der Wahrheit. Zu Platons Höhlengleichnis und Theätet (winter semester, 1931-1932).
• Der Anfang der abendländischen Philosophie (Anaximander und Parmenides) (summer semester, 1932).
• Sein und Wahrheit (winter semester, 1933-1934).
• Logik als die Frage nach dem Wesen der Sprache (summer semester, 1934).
• Hölderlins Hymnen “Germanien” und “Der Rhein” (winter semester, 1934-1935).
• Einführung in die Metaphysik (summer semester, 1935). Translated as An Introduction to Metaphysics by Gregory Fried and Richard Polt (New Haven, Conn.: Yale University Press, 2000).
• Die Frage nach dem Ding. Zu Kants Lehre von den transzendentalen Grundsätzen. (winter semester, 1935-1936). Translated as What Is a Thing by W. B. Barton, Jr. and Vera Deutsch, (Chicago: Henry Regnery Company, 1967).
• Schelling: Vom Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit (1809) (summer semester, 1936). Translated as Schelling’s Treatise on the Essence of Human Freedom by Joan Stambaugh, (Athens: Ohio University Press, 1984).
• Nietzsche: Der Wille zur Macht als Kunst (winter semester, 1936-1937). Translated as Nietzsche I: The Will to Power as Art by David F. Krell (New York, Harper & Row, 1979).
• Nietzsches Metaphysische Grundstellung im abendländischen Denken: Die ewige Wiederkehr des Gleichen (summer semester, 1937). Translated as “The Eternal Recurrence of the Same” in Nietzsche II: The Eternal Recurrence of the Same by David F. Krell (New York: Harper & Row, 1984).
• Grundfragen der Philosophie. Ausgewählte “Probleme” der “Logik” (winter semester, 1937-1938). Translated as Basic Questions of Philosophy by Albert Hofstadter (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1982).
• Nietzsches II. Unzeitgemässe Betrachtung (winter semester, 1938-1939).
• Nietzsches Lehre vom Willen zur Macht als Erkenntnis (summer semester, 1939). Translated as “The Will to Power as Knowledge” in Nietzsche III: The Will to Power as Knowledge and Metaphysics by Joan Stambaugh (New York, Harper & Row, 1987).
• Nietzsche: Der europäische Nihilismus (second trimester, 1940).
• Die Metaphysik des deutschen Idealismus. Zur erneuten auslegung von Schelling: Philosophische untersuchungen ueber das Wesen der menschlichen Freiheit und die damit zusammenhaengenden Gegenstaende (1809) (first trimester, 1941).
• Nietzsches Metaphysik (1941-2). Einleitung in die Philosopie – Denken und Dichten (1944-5).
• Grundbegriffe (summer semester, 1941). Translated as Basic Concepts by Gary Aylesworth (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1993).
• Hölderlins Hymne “Andenken” (winter semester, 1941-1942).
• Hölderlins Hymne “Der Ister” (summer semester, 1942). Translated as Hölderlin’s Hymn “The Ister” by William McNeill and Julia Davis (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1996).
• Parmenides (winter semester, 1942-1943). Translated as Parmenides by Andre Schuwer and Richard Rojcewicz (Bloomington, Indiana University Press, 1992).
• Heraklit. 1. Der Anfang des abendländischen Denkens (Heraklit). (summer semester, 1943); 2. Logik. Heraklits Lehre vom Logos (summer semester, 1944).
• Zur Bestimmung der Philosophie (1919).
• Grundprobleme der Phänomenologie (winter semester, 1919-1920).
• Phaenomenologie der Anschauung und des Ausdrucks. Theorie der philosophischen Begriffsbildung (summer semester, 1920).
• Phänomenologie des religiösen Lebens (summer semester, 1921).
• Phänomenologische Interpretationen zu Aristoteles: Einführung in die phänomeno-logische Forschung (winter semester, 1921-1922).
• Phänomenologische Interpretationen ausgewählter Abhandlungen des Aristoteles zur Ontologie und Logik. (summer semester, 1922).
• Ontologie: Hermeneutik der Faktizität (summer semester, 1923). Translated as Ontology: The Hermeneutics of Facticity by John va Buren (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999).

c. Private Monographs and Lectures, 1919-1967

• Der Begriff der Zeit (1924). Translated as The Concept of Time by William McNeill, (Oxford: Blackwell, 1992).
• Beiträge zur Philosophie (Vom Ereignis) (1936-1938). Translated as Contributions to Philosophy: (From Enowning) by Parvis Emad and Kenneth Maly (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1999).
• Besinnung.
• Metaphysik und Nihilismus. Die Überwindung derMetaphysik. Das Wesen des Nihilismus.
• Hegel. Die Negativität. Eine Auseinandersetzung mit Hegel aus dem Ansatz in der Negativität (1938-1939, 1941). 2 Erläuterung der “Einleitung” zu Hegels “Phänomenologie des Geistes” (1942).
• Die Geschichte des Seyns (1938-1940).
• Das Ereignis (1941)
• Wahrheitsfrage als Vorfrage. Die Aletheia: Die Erinnerung in den ersten Anfang; Entmachtung der Ousis (1937).
• Zu Hölderlin – Griechenlandreisen.
• Feldweg-Gespräche. (1944-1945)
• Bremer und Freiburger Vortraege.
• Vorträge Vom Wesen der Wahrheit Freiburg lecture (1930). Der Ursprung der Kunstwerkes (1935).
• Gedachtes.
• Anmerkungen zu “Vom Wesen des Grundes” (1936). Eine Auseinandersetzung mit “Sein und Zeit” (1936). Laufende Anmerkungen zu Sein und Zeit (1936).
• Marburger Übungen. Auslegungen der Aristotelischen “physik”.
• Leibniz-Übungen.

d. Notes and Fragments

• Vom Wesen der Sprache
• Übungen SS 1937. Neitzsches metaphysische Grundstellung. Sein und Schein (1937)
• Einübung in das Denken. Die metaphysischen Grundstellungen des abendländischen Denkens. Die Bedrohung der Wissenschaft.
• Überlegungen II-VI.
• Überlegungen VII-XI.
• Überlegungen XII-XV.

Author Information

W. J. Korab-Karpowicz
Email: Sopot_Plato@hotmail.com
Anglo-American University of Prague
Czech Republic