Transmission and Transmission Failure in Epistemology

An argument transmits justification to its conclusion just in case, roughly, the conclusion is justified in virtue of the premises’ being justified.  An argument fails to transmit justification just in case, roughly, the conclusion is not justified in virtue of the premises’ being justified.  An argument might fail to transmit justification for a variety of uncontroversial reasons, such as the premise’s being unjustified; the premises’ failing to support the conclusion; or the argument’s exhibiting premise circularity.  There are transmission issues concerning testimony, but this article focuses on when arguments (fail to) transmit justification or knowledge or some other epistemic status.

Transmission failure is an interesting issue because it is difficult to identify what, if anything, prevents competent deductions from justifying their conclusions.  One makes a competent deduction when she accepts a deductive argument in certain circumstances.  These deductions seem to be the paradigmatic form of reasoning in that they apparently must transmit justification to their conclusions.  At the same time, though, certain competent deductions seem bad.  Consider Moore’s Proof:  I have a hand therefore there is at least one material thing.  Some philosophers hold that Moore’s Proof cannot transmit justification to its conclusion under any circumstances, and so, despite appearances, some competent deductions are instances of transmission failure.  Identifying what, if anything, prevents such arguments from justifying their conclusions is a tricky, controversial affair.

Transmission principles are intimately connected with closure principles.  An epistemic closure principle might say that, if one knows P and deduces Q from P, then one knows that Q.  Closure principles are silent as to what makes Q known, but the corresponding transmission principles are not.  A transmission principle might say that, if one knows P and deduces Q from P, then one knows Q in virtue of knowing P.

Those sympathetic to Moore’s Proof sometimes say that the “proof” can justify its conclusion even though it lacks the power to resolve doubt.  An argument can resolve doubt about its conclusion when the argument can justify its conclusion even for a subject who antecedently disbelieves or withholds judgment about the argument’s conclusion.

Table of Contents

1. Transmission: The General Concept
2. Transmission in Epistemology
3. Transmission Failure
   1. Uncontroversial Causes
   2. Why Transmission Failure is an Interesting Issue
   3. Two More Puzzling Cases
4. Transmission (Failure) vs. Closure (Failure)
   1. The Basic Difference
   2. The (Misplaced?) Focus on Closure
   3. Why Transmission is an Interesting Issue, Revisited
5. Transmission Failure: Two Common Assumptions
   1. Transmission of Warrant vs. Transmission of Justification
   2. Transmission vs. Resolving Doubt
6. References and Further Reading

1. Transmission: The General Concept

The term ‘transmission’ is not unique to philosophical discourse: religious and cultural traditions often are transmitted from one generation to the next; diseases from one person to another; and information of various kinds from one computer to another (often via the internet).  A car’s transmission gets its name from its intended purpose, namely to transmit the energy from the engine to its wheels (to put it crudely).  The use of ‘transmission’ in epistemological contexts is deeply connected to its use in everyday contexts.  Tucker (2010, section 1) holds that one can clarify the epistemological concept of transmission by considering an everyday instance of transmission.

Under what conditions does Alvin’s computer A transmit information to another computer B?  Tucker suggests it will do so just in case (i) A had the information and (ii) B has the information in virtue of A’s having it.  The first condition is very intuitive.  If A does not have the information but B acquires it anyway, it may be true that something transmitted the information to B.  Yet, unless A has the information, it won’t be true that A transmitted the information to B.  The second condition is intuitive but vague.  If B has the information in virtue of A’s having it, then A causes B to have it.  Yet mere causation is not enough to satisfy this in virtue of relation.  If A sends the information to B over an Ethernet or USB cable, we do seem to have the requisite sort of causal relation, and, in these cases, A seems to transmit the information to B.

Suppose A just finished downloading the information, which makes Alvin so excited that he does a wild victory dance.  During this dance he accidently hits B’s keyboard, which causes B to download the information from the internet (and not Alvin’s computer).  In such a case, A’s having the information causes B to have it, but the information was not transmitted from A to B.  Although transmission requires that a causal relation hold, not just any causal relation will do.  This article will follow Tucker in using ‘in virtue of’ as a placeholder for whatever causal relation is required for transmission.

Generalizing from this example, Tucker concludes that transmission is a three-place relation between: (i) the property P that is transmitted; (ii) the thing a from which the property is transmitted; and (iii) the thing b to which the property is transmitted.  A property P is transmitted from a to b just in case b has P in virtue of a’s having P.  In the above example, the property P is having the information; a is A, Alvin’s computer; and b is B, some other computer.  So A transmits the information to B just in case B has the information in virtue of A’s having it.

The preceding discussion clarifies statements of the form ‘a transmits P to b’, but there is another, more informative kind of transmission ascription, which we can symbolize as ‘R transmits P from a to b’.  Contrast ‘A transmitted the information to B’ with the equally natural expression ‘The USB cable transmitted the information from A to B’.  Whereas the former notes only that the information was transmitted from A to B, the latter additionally notes how it was transmitted.  Under what conditions does the USB cable (more precisely: being connected by the USB cable) transmit the information from A to B?  I suggest that it will do so just in case (i) A had the information and (ii) B has the information in virtue of both A’s having it and A’s being connected by a USB cable to B.

2. Transmission in Epistemology

When epistemologists consider transmission or transmission failure, they generally ask such questions as:

• Under what conditions does entailment transmit justification?
• Under what conditions do competent deductions transmit rational belief?
• Does testimony transmit knowledge?

Epistemologists, then, are concerned with whether some relation (for example, entailment, competent deduction, testimony) transmits some epistemic property (for example, being rational, being justified, being known, or being defeated).  They tend to have in mind, therefore, the more informative sort of transmission ascription (see section 1).  That is, they are concerned not just with whether a belief is, say, known in virtue of another belief’s being known; they are also concerned with whether, say, entailment is the particular relation that allows the first belief to be known in virtue of the second.

This article will focus exclusively on when arguments or inferences (fail to) transmit some epistemic value property, such as being justified or being known.  The reason is that, when philosophers talk about transmission failure as an independent issue, they tend to have in mind the conditions under which an argument or inference fails to transmit.  The conditions under which testimony (fails to) transmit, say, knowledge is an interesting and important issue.  Yet these issues are often pursued in conjunction with or subsumed under other important issues relating to testimony, such as the conditions under which testimony preserves knowledge.  (For a brief intro to some of the relevant transmission issues pertaining to testimony, see Lackey 2008, section 3.)  In any case, this article will focus on the transmission issues pertaining to arguments or inferences, rather than the issues pertaining to testimony or other epistemically interesting relations.

An argument is a set of propositions such that one proposition, the conclusion, is supported by or is taken to be supported by the other propositions in that set, the premises.  An argument, as such, is merely a set of propositions that bear a special relation with one another.  Arguments can play a role in transmitting justification or knowledge when a subject believes the premises or when a subject infers the conclusion from the premises.  If epistemic transmission is analogous to the above computer transmission case (sec. 1), then an argument transmits justification to its conclusion when (i) the premises have some epistemically valuable status (for example, being justified, being known) and (ii) the conclusion has that same status in virtue of the premises’ having it.  (Here and elsewhere, for the sake of simplicity, I ignore the additional complexity of the more informative transmission ascriptions.)  The following case seems to satisfy (i) and (ii), and so it seems to transmit justification from the premises to the conclusion.

The Counting Case: Consider this argument: (a) that there are exactly 25 people in the room; and (b) that if there are exactly 25 people in the room, then there are fewer than 100 people in the room; therefore (c) there are fewer than 100 people in the room.  Suppose that Counter justifiably believes (a) on the basis of perception; that he justifiably believes (b) a priori; and that he believes (c) on the basis of (a) and (b).

The counting case seems to be a paradigmatic case of successful transmission.  Counter’s belief in the premises, namely (a) and (b), are justified (so (i) is satisfied), and the conclusion, namely (c), seems to be justified in virtue the premises’ being justified (so (ii) is satisfied).  Notice, however, that whether an argument transmits is relative to a subject.  The argument in the Counting Case transmits for Counter but not for someone who lacks justification for the premises.

The Counting Case also illustrates the deep connection between the transmission of justification and inferential justification.  When philosophers address inferential justification, they are concerned with the conditions under which the premises of an argument justify the argument’s conclusion. If one belief (belief in the premise) justifies another belief (belief in the conclusion), belief in the conclusion is inferentially justified.  Notice that the conclusion in the counting case is inferentially justified because it is justified by its premises.  The Counting Case, therefore, illustrates both inferential justification and the successful transmission of justification.  This is no accident.  It is almost universally assumed that inferential justification works by transmission; it is assumed that when the conclusion is justified by the premises, the premises transmit their justification to their conclusions.  Hence, the transmission of justification across an argument is deeply connected to inferential justification.

It should be noted that sometimes, when philosophers talk about transmission, they use the term “transfer” rather than “transmission” (for example, Davies 1998).  The latter terminology seems preferable, as Davies now admits (2000: 393, nt. 17).  “Transfer” often connotes that, when P is transferred from a to b, a no longer has P.  If I transfer water from one cup to another, the transferred water is no longer in the first cup.  “Transmission” lacks that connotation: when a computer transmits some information to another computer, the first computer typically retains the transmitted information.

3. Transmission Failure

a. Uncontroversial Causes

An argument is an instance of transmission failure just in case it does not transmit (some degree of) justification (or whatever epistemic status is at issue) from the premises to the conclusion.  Arguments can fail to transmit justification to their conclusions for a number of reasons.  Here are a few relatively uncontroversial causes of transmission failure:

• Unjustified Premises: If an argument’s premises are all unjustified, then the argument is a trivial case of transmission failure; for the premises had no justification to transmit to its conclusion in the first place.  It does not follow, though, that all of an inference’s premises must be justified for it to transmit justification to its conclusion.  Consider an inductive inference with 100 premises of the form ‘on this occasion the unsuspended pencil fell to the ground’.  If 99 of the 100 premises are justified, it seems that those 100 premises can transmit justification to the belief that the next unsuspended pencil will also fall, despite that one of the premises fails to be justified.  (See the article “Deductive and Inductive Arguments” for a brief explanation of the differences between deductive and inductive arguments.)
• Premise Circularity:  An argument is premise circular just in case its ultimate conclusion also appears as a premise.  For instance, consider P therefore Q therefore P.  The ultimate conclusion, P, is used as the sole premise for the intermediate conclusion, Q.  Even given that P transmits justification to Q, it seems clear that the justification P has in virtue of Q cannot be transmitted back to Q.  (The term ‘premise circular’ will be used loosely, such that both the extended argument P therefore Q therefore P and the second stage of the argument, Q therefore P, are premise circular.)
• The Premises Fail to Evidentially Support Their Conclusion: Consider the argument: ‘I have a hand; therefore, the Stay Puft Marshmallow Man is eating a Ghostbuster’.  The premise is justified; however, it fails to transmit its justification to the conclusion because having a hand is not evidence that the Marshmallow Man is doing anything, much less eating a Ghostbuster.
• The Premises Provide Less Than Maximal Evidential Support: An argument that provides maximal evidential support, such as one in the form of modus ponens, is capable of transmitting all of its premises’ justification to the conclusion.  Arguments that provide some less-than-maximal degree of support, such as a good inductive argument, fail to transmit all of the premises’ justification to the conclusion.  Good inductive arguments with justified premises both partially transmit and partially fail to transmit justification from the premises to the conclusion.  Other things being equal, the stronger the support, the more justification the argument transmits from the premises to the conclusion.
• Defeaters: A good argument might fail to transmit justification because one has a relevant defeater (for example, relevant counterevidence).  Suppose I believe some mathematical theorem T on what is in fact exemplary deductive reasoning.  If I know that my coffee has been spiked with a drug known to cause egregious errors in reasoning, then my exemplary deductive reasoning is an instance of at least partial transmission failure.

b. Why Transmission Failure is an Interesting Issue

It is relatively uninteresting if an argument fails to transmit for any of the above reasons.  But suppose an argument has well-justified premises; the premises provide deductive (so maximal) support for their conclusion; the subject knows that the premises provide deductive support for their conclusions; there are no relevant defeaters; and it is not premise circular.  A person makes a competent deduction when they accept such an argument.  (Others use the term “competent deduction,” but they often mean something slightly different by the term, including Tucker (2010).)  One might think that competent deductions are the paradigm of good reasoning, that they must transmit justification to their conclusions.  Interest in transmission failure arises because, at first glance at least, there are such arguments that do seem to be instances of transmission failure.  Interest in transmission failure persists because it is very hard to identify what would cause such arguments to be instances of transmission failure.  Consider the following example.

Some philosophers, sometimes called “idealists,” hold that the only things that exist are minds and their ideas.  These idealists, therefore, are skeptics about material objects.  In other words, they reject that there are material objects, where material objects are non-mental objects composed of matter.  These philosophers tend to hold that there are ideas of hands but no hands.  There are ideas of chairs, even apparent perceptions of chairs, but there are no chairs.  Responding to these idealists, G. E. Moore declared that he could prove the existence of the external, or non-mental, world.  Here is his “proof”:

Moore’s Proof (MP)

(MP1)   I have a hand.

(If I have a hand, then there is at least one material object.)

(MP2)  There is at least one material object.

This argument is widely criticized and scorned.  Yet if it fails to transmit justification to its conclusion, why does it do so?

Well, Moore’s Proof is not an instance of transmission failure for any of the obvious reasons: it is a deductive argument; its premise seems well-justified on the basis of perceptual experience; there are no relevant defeaters; and it is not premise circular (that is, Moore did not—or at least need not—use MP2, the conclusion of Moore’s Proof, as a premise for his belief in MP1).  Still, it is hard to dispel the sense that this argument is bad.  This argument seems to beg the question against the skeptic, but it is unclear whether question-begging, by itself, can cause transmission failure (see sec. 5b).  Perhaps Moore’s Proof is not just question-begging, but also viciously circular in some way.  The problem is that it is hard to identify a type of circularity that both afflicts Moore’s argument and is clearly bad.

c. Two More Puzzling Cases

Moore’s Proof is a puzzling case.  If one accepts Moore’s Proof, she has made a competent deduction, which would seem to make it the paradigm of good reasoning.  Nonetheless, it still seems to be a bad argument.  The puzzling nature of this case also appears in a variety of other arguments, including the following two arguments.

Moore’s Proof is aimed at disproving idealism insofar as it is committed to skepticism about the material world, that is, the claim that the external world does not exist.  Consider, however, perceptual skepticism, the idea that, even if the external world does exist, our perceptual experiences do not give us knowledge (directly or via an inference) of this non-mental realm. Proponents of this skepticism typically concoct scenarios in which we would have exactly the same experiences that we do have, but where our perceptual experiences are wildly unreliable.  One popular scenario is that I am the unwitting victim of a mad scientist.  The mad scientist removed my brain, placed it in a vat of nutrients, and then hooked me up to his supercomputer.  In addition to keeping me alive, this supercomputer provides me with a computer generated reality, much like the virtual reality described by the movie Matrix.  Although all of my perceptual experiences are wildly unreliable, they seem just as genuine and trustworthy as my actual experiences.  The skeptic then reasons as follows: if you cannot tell whether you are merely a brain-in-a-vat in the above scenario, then you do not know you have a hand; you cannot tell whether you are a brain-in-a-vat (because your experiences would seem just as genuine even if you were a brain-in-a-vat); therefore, you do not know whether you have a hand.  (See Contemporary Skepticism, especially section 1, for further discussion of this type of skepticism.)

Some philosophers respond that the sort of reasoning in Moore’s Proof can be applied to rule out the skeptical hypothesis that we are brains-in-vats.  Hence:

The Neo-Moorean Argument

(NM1)    I have a hand.

(If I have a hand, then I am not a brain-in-a-vat.)

(NM2)    I am not a brain-in-a-vat.

The Neo-Moorean Argument is just as puzzling as Moore’s Proof.  If one accepts the Neo-Moorean Argument, she has accepted a competent deduction which seems to be the paradigm of good reasoning.  Yet the argument still seems bad, which is why some philosophers hold that it is an instance of transmission failure.

The Zebra Argument, like the Neo-Moorean Argument, is intended to rule out a certain kind of skeptical scenario.  Bobby is at the zoo and sees what appears to be zebra.  Quite naturally, he believes that the creature is a zebra on the basis of its looking like one.  His son, however, is not convinced and asks: “Dad, if a mule is disguised cleverly enough, it will look just like a real zebra.  So how do you know that the creature isn’t a cleverly disguised mule?”  Bobby answers his son’s question with:

The Zebra Argument

(Z1)        That creature is a zebra.

(If it is a zebra, then it is not a cleverly disguised mule.)

(Z2)        It is not a cleverly disguised mule.

It seems that to know that the creature is a zebra, one must know already in some sense that the creature is not a cleverly disguised mule.  Hence, Bobby’s argument seems to exhibit a suspicious type of circularity despite qualifying as a competent deduction.

(There is a rather wide variety of other puzzling cases.  For reasons that will be explained in the next section, arguments that allegedly violate closure principles are also potential examples of transmission failure.  Readers interested in semantic or content externalism should consider McKinsey’s Paradox in section 5 of the closure principles article.  Readers with expertise in the philosophy of mind might be interested in some examples raised by Davies (2003: secs. 3, 5).)

4. Transmission (Failure) vs. Closure (Failure)

Discussions of transmission and transmission failure are connected intimately with discussions of closure and closure failure, which raises the question of how these issues are related.

a. The Basic Difference

Closure principles say, roughly, that if one thing a has some property P and bears some relation R to another thing b, then b also will have P.  More succinctly (and ignoring universal quantification for simplicity’s sake), closure principles say that, if Pa and Rab, then Pb.  Suppose that the property being a pig is closed under the relation being the same species as.  Suppose, in other words, that if Albert is a pig, then anything that is the same species as Albert is also a pig.  Given this assumption, if Albert is a pig and Brutus is the same species as Albert, then Brutus is a pig.  Yet being a pig is clearly not closed under the relation being the same genus as.  Pigs are in the genus mammal along with humans, cows, poodles, and many other creatures.  If Albert is a pig and Brutus is in the same genus as Albert, it does not follow that Brutus is a pig.  Brutus could be a terribly ferocious poodle and still be in the same genus as Albert.

In epistemological contexts, the relevant P will be an epistemic property, such as being justified or known, and R will be something like being competently deduced from or being known to entail.  An epistemic closure principle might say: If Billy knows P and Billy competently deduces Q from P, then Billy also knows Q.

Transmission principles are stronger than their closure counterparts.  Transmission principles, in other words, say everything that their closure counterparts say and more besides.  Recall that closure principles hold that, if Pa and Rab, then Pb.   Transmission principles hold instead that, if Pa and Rab, then Pb in virtue of Pa. Closure principles merely say that b has the property P, but they do not specify why b has that property.  Transmission principles say not only that b has P, but also that b has P because, or in virtue of, Pa and Rab.

Notice that a closure principle can be true when the corresponding transmission principle is false.  Consider:

Pig Closure: If Albert is a pig and is the same species as Brutus, then Brutus is also a pig.

Pig Transmission: If Albert is a pig and is the same species as Brutus, then Brutus is a pig in virtue of Albert’s being a pig.

Even though we are assuming that Pig Closure is true, Pig Transmission will be false when Albert and Brutus are unrelated pigs.  Brutus’ being a pig might be explained by his parents being pigs and/or his having a certain DNA structure, but not by Albert’s being a pig.  Although closure principles can be true when their transmission counterparts are false, if a transmission principle is true, its closure counterpart must also be true.  This is because transmission principles say everything that their closure counterparts say (and more besides).

Epistemic closure principles likewise can be true when their transmission counterparts are false.

Simple Closure: If S knows that P and deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q.

Simple Transmission: If S knows that P and deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q in virtue of knowing that P.

Even supposing Simple Closure is true (which it probably is not), Simple Transmission is false.  Suppose S knows Q on the basis of perceptual experience and then comes to know P on the basis of her knowing Q.  It would be premise circular if she then also based her belief in Q on her belief in P.  If she did so, her extended argument would be Q therefore P therefore Q.  It is plausible in such a case that S still knows the conclusion Q on the basis of the relevant perceptual experience.  Assuming she still knows Q, her deduction from P to Q is not a counterexample to Simple Closure.  On the other hand, this case is a clear counterexample to Simple Transmission.  Although she knows Q, she knows it in virtue of the perceptual experience, not deducing it from her knowledge that P.

The difference between closure and transmission principles was just explained.  Next, the difference between closure and transmission failure will be explained.  There is an instance of closure failure when Pa and Rab hold, but Pb does not.  Simple Closure suffers from closure failure just in case someone deduces Q from her knowledge that P but nonetheless fails to know that Q.  An instance of simple closure failure just is a counterexample to Simple Closure.

There is an instance of transmission failure whenever it is false that Pb in virtue of Pa and Rab.  There are three types of transmission failure which correspond to the three ways in which it might be false that Pb holds in virtue of Pa and Rab.  The first type occurs just in case either Pa or Rab does not hold.  If Pa and Rab do not hold, then Pb cannot hold in virtue of Pa and Rab.  Consequently, Rab would fail to transmit P from a to b.  Notice that this first type of transmission failure can occur even if the relevant transmission principle is true.  Transmission principles do not say that Pa and Rab in fact hold; instead they say if Pa and Rab hold, then Pb holds in virtue of Pa and Rab.  If S fails to know P or fails to deduce Q from P, then the deduction fails to transmit knowledge from P to Q.  Nonetheless, Simple Transmission might still be true, because it does not demand that S actually deduce Q from her knowledge that P.  A similar point explains why one can have type-one transmission failure without having closure failure, that is, without having a counterexample to the corresponding closure principle.  There is, therefore, an interesting difference between transmission and closure failure: an instance of closure failure just is a counterexample to some relevant closure principle, but an instance of transmission failure need not be a counterexample to some relevant transmission principle.

Although the first type of transmission failure never provides a counterexample to some relevant transmission principle, the second and third types always provide such a counterexample. The second type occurs just in case Pa and Rab holds but Pb does not—precisely the same circumstances in which closure failure occurs.  In other words, the second type of transmission failure occurs just in case closure failure does.  It follows that all instances of closure failure are instances of transmission failure.  It does not follow, however, that all instances of transmission failure are instances of closure failure: there will be transmission failure without closure failure whenever there is transmission failure of the first or third types.  Simple Transmission suffers from type-two transmission failure (and closure failure) just in case S deduces Q from her knowledge that P but nonetheless fails to know Q.  (The idea that all instances of closure failure are instances of transmission failure but not vice versa also follows from the fact that transmission principles say everything that their closure counterparts say and more besides.  By saying everything that closure principles say, transmission principles will fail whenever their closure counterparts do.  By saying more than their closure counterparts, they sometimes will fail even when their closure counterparts do not.)

The third type of transmission failure occurs just in case Pa, Rab, and Pb hold, but Pb does not hold in virtue of Pa and Rab.  Since closure principles do not demand that Pb hold in virtue of Pa and Rab, a closure principle may be true even if its corresponding transmission principle suffers from type-three transmission failure.  Simple Transmission suffers from type-three transmission failure just in case S deduces Q from S’s knowledge that P, S knows Q, but S does not know Q in virtue of the deduction from her knowledge that P.  The premise circular argument discussed in this sub-section is a plausible example of this type of failure.  As was explained above, in such a case Simple Closure might hold but Simple Transmission would not.

b. The (Misplaced?) Focus on Closure

There is no doubt that, in the epistemological literature, closure failure is in some sense the bigger issue.  Some epistemological theories seem committed to rejecting intuitive closure principles, and there is extensive debate over how serious of a crime it is to reject these principles.  Although the literature on transmission failure is by no means scant, considerably more ink has been spilt over closure failure.  One naturally is inclined to infer that closure failure is the more important issue, but this may be incorrect: the literature’s focus on closure failure may be misplaced—though this potential misplacement is likely harmless.

Crispin Wright (1985: 438, nt. 1) was perhaps the first to distinguish between epistemic closure and transmission principles, but much of the literature has not observed this distinction, a fact that has been noted by Wright (2003: 76, nt.1) and Davies (2000: 394, nt. 19).  When some philosophers purport to talk about closure principles, they are really talking about transmission principles.  Consider Williamson’s “intuitive closure” principle: “knowing p₁,…,p_n, competently deducing q, and thereby coming to believe q is in general a way of coming to know q” (2000: 117, emphasis mine).  Closure principles can tell us that everything we competently deduce from prior knowledge itself will be known; however, only transmission principles can tell us the how, that is, that the conclusions are known in virtue of the competent deductions.  Hawthorne likewise treats closure principles as if they were transmission ones: “Our closure principles are perfectly general principles concerning how knowledge can be gained by deductive inference from prior knowledge” (2004: 36, emphasis mine).  Closure principles can tell us that everything we competently deduce from prior knowledge itself will be known; however, only transmission principles can tell us that our knowledge of these conclusions was gained by the deduction from prior knowledge.

Dretske’s 1970 paper “Epistemic Operators” introduced the epistemological world to the issue of closure failure, and his subsequent work on the topic has been extremely important.  Yet even he now admits that discussing transmission failure “provides a more revealing way” of explaining some of his key claims concerning closure failure (2005: 15).  One wonders, then, whether the literature’s greater focus on closure failure is (harmlessly?) misplaced.

c. Why Transmission is an Interesting Issue, Revisited

Although it seems salutary to appreciate the distinction between closure and transmission failure, it may be that some philosophers read too much into this distinction.  Although Wright holds that certain competent deductions are instances of transmission failure, he is “skeptical whether there are any genuine counterexamples to closure” (2002: 332; 2003: 57-8; cf. 2000: 157).  Davies seems sympathetic to a similar position at times (2000: 394) but not at others (1998: 326).  These remarks suggest the following way of explaining why transmission is an interesting issue: “Moore’s Proof seems to be a bad argument, but intuitive closure principles seem too plausible to reject.  This tension can be resolved when Moore’s Proof is treated as an instance of transmission rather than closure failure.  Moore’s Proof seems to be a bad argument and is a bad argument because it fails to transmit justification to its conclusion; it is not, however, a counterexample to intuitive closure principles.”

Smith (2009: 181) comes closest to endorsing this motivation explicitly, but even if it is not widely held, it is worth explaining why it fails.  To do so, two new closure principles need to be introduced.  Simple Closure and Simple Transmission were discussed in 4.A in order to provide a clear case in which a transmission principle is false even if its closure counterpart is true.  Yet Simple Closure is too simple to be plausible.  For example, it fails to account for defeaters (for example, relevant counterevidence).  If S deduces Q from her knowledge that P, then Simple Closure says that S knows Q.  Yet if S makes that deduction even though her total evidence supports ~Q, she will not know Q.

When philosophers defend closure principles, they typically defend, not Simple Closure, but something like:

Strong Closure: If S knows P and S competently deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q.

Simple Closure holds that knowledge is closed over deductions.  Strong Closure, on the other hand, holds that knowledge is closed over competent deductions.  Recall from 3.B that a deduction is competent just in case the premises are well justified; the premises provide deductive (so maximal) support for their conclusions; the subject knows that the premises provide deductive support; there are no relevant defeaters; and it is not premise circular.  Given that competent deductions seem, at first glance at least, to be the paradigm of good reasoning (see 3.B), it should not be surprising that philosophers defend something like Strong Closure.

The second closure principle that needs to be introduced is:

Weak Closure: If S knows P and S competently deduces Q from P, then S has some epistemic status for Q, no matter how weak.

Suppose S competently deduces Q from her knowledge that P.  Strong Closure holds that S must know Q.  Weak Closure, on the other hand, says only that S must have some positive epistemic status for Q, no matter how weak.  (It is worth noting that, despite its name, Weak Closure is not obviously a closure principle.  Closure principles say that if Pa and Rab, then Pb (see 4.A).  If there are three different epistemic properties P, Q, and R, then Weak Closure is in this form: if Pa and Rab, then Pb or Qb or Rb.  This concern can be ignored, because if Weak Closure fails to count as a closure principle, then there would only be further problems with the above motivation.)

Wright (2004), Davies (2003: 29-30), and perhaps also Smith (2009: 180-1) endorse an account of non-inferential knowledge which allows them to endorse Weak Closure but not Strong Closure.  (McLaughlin 2003: 91-2 endorses a similar view, but it is not clear that his explanation of transmission failure is compatible with even Weak Closure.)  Put simply, they hold that to have (strong) non-inferential justification for P, one must have prior entitlement for certain background assumptions.  An entitlement to some background assumption A is something like a very weak justification for A that one has automatically, or by default.  Since they suppose (as is common) that knowledge requires the strong type of justification, they also hold that non-inferential knowledge likewise requires this prior weak and default justification for background assumptions.  (The most extensive defense of this view of non-inferential justification is Wright’s 2004.  See Tucker’s 2009 for a criticism of this view as it relates to perceptual justification.)

Applied to Moore’s Proof, this view holds that, to have non-inferential knowledge that one has a hand (the premise of Moore’s Proof), she must have some prior entitlement to accept that there are material things (the conclusion of Moore’s Proof).  Since the conclusion of Moore’s Proof would not be used as a sub-premise to establish that one has hands, it would not count as premise circular.  Nonetheless, since knowing the premise would require some previous (however weak) justification for the conclusion, this view of non-inferential justification makes Moore’s Proof circular in some other sense.  Does this type of circularity prevent the premise from transmitting knowledge to the conclusion?  Wright and Davies certainly think so, but Cohen (1999:76-7, 87, nt. 52) is more optimistic.  If Wright and Davies are correct, then one has some very weak justification for the conclusion of Moore’s Proof, but they do not and cannot know this conclusion.  Since the conclusion, that there are material things, does have some weak epistemic status, Wright and Davies can endorse Weak Closure.  Yet they are forced to reject Strong Closure because they hold that one cannot know that there are material things.

The ability to endorse Weak Closure is not enough for the above way of motivating the issue of transmission failure to succeed.  Strong Closure (or some principle in the general neighborhood) is what most epistemologists find too plausible to reject.  Since Wright and Davies must reject Strong Closure, their diagnosis of Moore’s Proof cannot explain the badness of Moore’s Proof without rejecting the version of closure that most philosophers find intuitive.  (See Silins 2005: 89-95 for related discussion.)

Something like Strong Closure seems extremely plausible even to those who ultimately reject it (for example, Dretske 2005: 18).  But why does it seem so plausible?  Tucker (2010: 498-9) holds that it seems so plausible because its corresponding transmission principle seems so plausible.  Consider:

Strong Transmission: If S knows P and S competently deduces Q from P, then S knows that Q in virtue of that competent deduction.

Strong Transmission says what Strong Closure says and that the conclusion is justified in virtue of that competent deduction.  Tucker’s suggestion is that Strong Closure seems plausible because Strong Transmission seem plausible.  It seems that justification is closed over a competent deduction because it seems competent deductions must transmit justification to their conclusions, a point discussed above in section 2.B.  From this point of view, it is no surprise to find that the literature often treats closure principles as if they were transmission ones, for our intuitions concerning transmission would explain why certain closure principles seem so plausible.

5. Transmission Failure: Two Common Assumptions

It is commonly held that Moore’s Proof, the Neo-Moorean Argument, and the Zebra Argument are instances of transmission failure.  When philosophers attempt to explain why these arguments fail to transmit, they tend to make two assumptions.

a. Transmission of Warrant vs. Transmission of Justification

Much of the literature on transmission failure focuses on the transmission of warrant rather than the transmission of (doxastic) justification (see Wright 1985, 2002, 2003; Davies 1998, 2000, 2003; and Dretske 2005).  A warrant for P, roughly, is something that counts in favor of accepting P.  An evidential warrant for P is some (inferential or non-inferential) evidence that counts in favor of accepting P.  Entitlement, which was discussed in 4.B, is a type of non-evidential warrant for P, a warrant that one has by default.  One can have a warrant for P even if she does not believe P or believes P but not on the basis of the warrant.  Notice that it is propositions that are warranted relative to a person.

(Doxastic) justification, on the other hand, is a property that beliefs have.  Roughly, a belief is justified when it is held in an epistemically appropriate way.  S is justified in believing P only if (i) S has warrant for P and (ii) S’s belief in P is appropriately connected to that warrant for P.  Hence, one can have warrant for a belief even though it is not justified.  Suppose Merla has some genuine evidential warrant for her belief that Joey is innocent, so her belief satisfies (i); but her belief will not be justified if she believes that Joey is innocent solely because the Magic 8-Ball says so.  Although Merla would have warrant for Joey’s innocence, her belief in his innocence would not be connected appropriately to that warrant.  In other words, her belief would not be justified because it would not satisfy (ii).

Again, Wright, Davies, and Dretske focus on the transmission of warrant, not justification. In a representative statement, Davies maintains that “The question is whether the epistemic warrants that I have for believing the premises add up to an epistemically adequate warrant for the conclusion” (2000: 399, cf. 2003: 51). Dretske focuses more specifically on the transmission of evidential warrant.  Transmission failure, he says, is the idea “that some reasons for believing P do not transmit to things, Q, known to be implied by P” (15).  These philosophers hold that Moore’s Proof fails to transmit in the sense that it fails to make the warrant for its premise warrant for its conclusion.

These philosophers assume, however, that the failure to transmit warrant suffices for the failure to transmit justification.  In other words, they make:

Common Assumption 1: if an argument fails to transmit warrant, then it fails to transmit justification.

The difference between these two types of transmission failure is subtle.  To say that an argument fails to transmit justification is to say that an argument fails to make its conclusion justified.  To say that an argument fails to transmit warrant is to say that the argument fails to make belief in its conclusion justified in a very particular way, namely by converting warrant for the premise into warrant for the conclusion.

Davies, Wright, and, to a lesser extent, Dretske reveal this assumption when they discuss the significance of failing to transmit warrant.  Wright assumes that when an argument fails to transmit warrant, it is not an argument “whereby someone could be moved to rational [or justified] conviction of its conclusion” (2000: 140).  In one paragraph, Davies seems to suppose, at the very least, that “limitations on the transmission of epistemic warrants” suffice for “limitations on our ability to achieve knowledge [and presumably also justification] by inference” (2003: 35-6).  Although there is no one passage that illustrates this, Dretske (2005) assumes that an evidential warrant’s failing to transmit prevents knowledge (and presumably also justification) from transmitting.

This first assumption is significant because the transmission of justification seems to be the more important type of transmission. When we evaluate the quality of arguments (insofar as they are used to organize one’s beliefs) we want to know whether we can justifiably believe the conclusion in virtue of accepting the argument.  Whether an argument transmits warrant is usually relevant to this aim only insofar as it implies something about when the argument transmits justification.

Silins (2005: 87-88) and Tucker (2010: 505-7) criticize this first assumption.  Suppose that Harold’s belief in P is doxastically justified by his evidence E; he notices that P entails Q; and then he subsequently deduces Q from P.  According to Silins and Tucker, it is natural to identify Harold’s reason for accepting Q as P, not E.  Since we are supposing that P entails Q, P is presumably a warrant for Q.  But if P is Harold’s reason for Q and is itself a warrant for Q, it does not seem to matter whether the deduction transmits warrant, that is, whether the deduction makes E into a warrant for Q.  It is worth noting that, even if Common Assumption 1 is ultimately correct, Tucker and Silins still have a point: this assumption is not sufficiently obvious to be taken for granted, as Wright, Dretske, and Davies do.

b. Transmission vs. Resolving Doubt

The second common assumption may be the more important.  It says that failing to have the power to resolve doubt suffices for failing to transmit justification.  In other words:

Common Assumption 2: if an argument fails to have the power to resolve doubt, then it fails to transmit justification to its conclusion.

A deduction P therefore C has the power to resolve doubt (about its conclusion) iff it is possible for one to go from doubting C to justified belief in C solely in virtue of accepting P therefore C.  As I am using the term, one (seriously) doubts P just in case she either disbelieves or withholds judgment about P.  Withholding judgment is more than merely failing to believe or disbelieve P: it is resisting or refraining from both believing and disbelieving P, and one cannot do that unless one has considered P.

Suppose that Hillbilly has been very out of the loop the last few years, and he doubts that Obama is the president.  He then discovers that both CNN and the NY Times say that he is the president.  He might justifiably infer that, after all, Obama is the president.  This is because the argument he would accept has the power to resolve doubt.  On the other hand, the Neo-Moorean Argument, for example, does not have the power to resolve doubt.  If one doubts NM2, that she is not a brain-in-a-vat, she cannot rationally believe, NM1, that she has a hand.  So doubting the conclusion of the Neo-Moorean Argument prevents a key premise in the argument from being justified, thereby preventing the argument from justifying the conclusion.  Since the argument cannot justify its conclusion when the subject antecedently disbelieves or withholds judgment about the conclusion, it lacks the power to resolve doubt.

Wright (2002, 2003), Davies (2003), and McLaughlin (2000) make this second assumption. Wright maintains that “Intuitively, a transmissible warrant should make for the possible advancement of knowledge, or warranted belief, and the overcoming of doubt or agnosticism” (2002: 332, emphasis mine).  In another paper, he says of an example that, “The inference from A to B is thus not at the service of addressing an antecedent agnosticism about B.  So my warrant does not transmit” (2003: 63).

Davies’ (2003) Limitation Principles for the transmission of warrant are, he thinks, motivated “by making use of the idea that failure of transmission of epistemic warrant is the analogue, within the thought of a single subject, of the dialectical phenomenon of begging the question” (41).  In Davies’ view, “The speaker begs the question against the hearer if the hearer’s doubt rationally requires him to adopt background assumptions relative to which the considerations that are supposed to support the speaker’s premises no longer provide that support” (41).  Take the Zebra Argument.  If you doubted Z2, that the animal is not a cleverly disguised mule, then Davies suggests that your perceptual experience will no longer count in favor of your belief in Z1, that the animal is a zebra.  So if I offered you the Zebra Argument in order to convince you that the animal is not a cleverly disguised mule, I would beg the question against you.

It is pretty clear, as Davies’ discussion suggests, that accepting an argument that fails to be a “question-settling justification,” that is, accepting an argument lacking the power to resolve doubt, is the analogue of the dialectical phenomenon of begging the question (for example, 2003: 41-5, esp. 42).  Were I to accept the Zebra Argument when I have antecedent doubt about its conclusion, I would, as it were, beg the question against myself.  Yet Davies never provides any reason to believe that transmission failure is an analogue of begging the question.  He seems to take for granted that for something (for example, an experience or argument) to be a justification at all, it must have the power to resolve doubt.

McLaughlin’s (2000) primary concern is with the transmission of knowledge, not justification, but he seems to make a parallel assumption.  He says the Neo-Moorean Argument cannot transmit knowledge because it begs the question: “The premises fail to provide a sufficient epistemic basis on which to know the conclusion because my basis for one of the premises is dependent on the truth of the conclusion in such a way as to render the argument question begging” (104).  It is Neo-Moorean Argument’s inability to resolve doubt that makes it question-begging.  Hence, McLaughlin seems to assume that the power to resolve doubt is required for the power to make a conclusion known.

Much of the literature on transmission failure, then, operates on the assumption that the power to justify requires the power to resolve doubt.  Taking this assumption for granted was probably a reasonable thing to do at the time the literature was first published; however, this assumption is now challenged most directly by Pryor (2004), but Markie (2005: 409) and Bergmann (2006: 198-200) challenge similar assumptions in connection with easy knowledge and epistemic circularity, respectively.  Although Davies initially endorses Common Assumption 2, he seems inclined to reject it in his later work (2004: 242-3).  Those who challenge this assumption first emphasize (though not necessarily in these words) the conceptual distinction between transmission failure and the inability to resolve doubt, and then they contend that we need some special reason to think that the inability to resolve doubt suffices for transmission failure.

Sometimes philosophers press similar distinctions in different terminology, and it is worth explaining the connection with one other popular way of talking.  Some (for example, Pryor 2004: 369) hold that Moore’s Proof can transmit justification even though it is dialectically ineffective for some audiences.  An argument is dialectically effective for an audience when it is one that will transmit justification (knowledge) to the argument’s conclusion given the audience’s current beliefs, experiences, and other epistemically relevant factors.  Consider again Hillbilly’s argument that Two reliable sources, namely CNN and NY Times, say that Obama is the president; therefore, Obama is the president.  This argument is dialectically effective for Hillbilly because he has no antecedent doubt about the reliability of CNN and NY Times.  This same argument nonetheless may be dialectically ineffective for his cousin if the cousin antecedently doubts (rationally or irrationally) the reliability of these two news outlets.  Before this argument will be dialectically effective for the cousin, her antecedent doubt must be resolved.

Defenders of Moore’s Proof sometimes say that the “proof” is dialectically effective for audiences that lack antecedent doubt in the argument’s conclusion that there are no material things, but not for its intended audience, namely those skeptical of this conclusion.  Moore’s Proof fails to be dialectically effective for this skeptical audience because such skeptics tend to doubt the reliability of perception.

Appreciating the distinction between transmission failure and the inability to resolve doubt (or dialectical effectiveness) not only casts doubt on Common Assumption 2, but also provides proponents of Moore’s Proof with an error theory.  In general, an error theory attempts to explain why something seems true when it is not.  The proponent of Moore’s Proof wants to explain why Moore’s Proof seems to be an instance of transmission failure when it is not.  In other words, this error theory attempts to explain away the intuition that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure.  The proponent of this error theory will say that this intuition is partly right and partly wrong.  What it gets right is that Moore’s Proof exhibits a genuine failure, namely the failure to resolve doubt (and/or be dialectically effective for its target audience).  What it gets wrong is that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure.  Yet, since it is easy to conflate the two types of failure, it is easy to mistakenly think that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure too.

The success of this error theory depends on at least two factors.  The first is whether transmission failure and the inability to resolve doubt are in fact easily confused.  This seems plausible given the widespread tendency to implicitly endorse Common Assumption 2 without comment.  The second is whether one retains the intuition that Moore’s Proof is an instance of transmission failure.  If, after considering this error theory and carefully distinguishing transmission failure from the inability to resolve doubt, one no longer has the intuition that Moore’s Proof is a bad argument, then the error theory seems promising.  If, however, one retains the intuition that Moore’s Proof is a bad argument, it is far less plausible that the intuition of transmission failure arises from conflating transmission failure with the inability to resolve doubt.  Consequently, the error theory would seem considerably less promising.  (Wright 2008 responds to Pryor’s version of this error theory, a response which is criticized by Tucker’s 2010: 523-4.)

6. References and Further Reading

• Bergmann, Michael. 2006. Justification without Awareness. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • In Chapter 7, Bergmann makes a distinction similar to the transmission/resolving doubt distinction and uses it to defend some instances of epistemic circularity.
• Cohen, Stewart. 1999. “Contextualism, Skepticism, and the Structure of Reasons.” Philosophical Perspectives 13: 57-89.
  • Cohen’s main goal is to defend epistemic contextualism, but he also seems to approve of a type of circularity that Davies and Wright find vicious (see 76-7, 87, nt. 52).
• Davies, Martin. 2004. “Epistemic Entitlement, Warrant Transmission, and Easy Knowledge.” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 78: 213-45.
  • In this paper, Davies distances himself from his earlier work on transmission failure and seems sympathetic to the error theory discussed in 5.B.
• Davies, Martin. 2003. “The Problem of Armchair Knowledge.” In Nuccetelli 23-56.
  • In this paper, Davies defends his early views concerning transmission failure, but perhaps its most useful contribution is that it considers a wide variety of cases that he holds are instances of transmission failure (see especially section 5).
• Davies, Martin. 2000. “Externalism and Armchair Knowledge.” In Boghossian, Paul and Christopher Peacocke (eds.) 384-414.
  • This paper is probably the place to start for those interested in Davies’ early views on transmission failure.
• Davies, Martin. 1998. “Externalism, Architecturalism, and Epistemic Warrant.” In Wright, Crispin, C. Smith, and C. Macdonald (eds.). Knowing Our Own Minds. Oxford: Oxford University Press, pgs. 321- 361.
  • Davies presents his initial views on transmission failure, which he refines in his 2000 and 2003 and then apparently reconsiders in his 2004.
• Dretske, Fred. 2005. “The Case against Closure.” In Steup, Matthias and Ernest Sosa (eds.). Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 13-25.
  • Dretske defends his view that closure principles are false, and, in sec. 1, he explains how some of what he says about closure failure in his earlier work can be better expressed in terms of transmission failure.
• Dretske, Fred. 1970. “Epistemic Operators” Journal of Philosophy 67: 1007-23.
  • Dretske introduces closure failure as an issue for discussion, but his 2005 provides a simpler introduction to the closure failure issue.
• Hawthorne, John. 2005. “The Case for Closure.” In Steup, Matthias and Ernest Sosa (eds.). Contemporary Debates in Epistemology. Malden: Blackwell Publishing, 26-42.
  • Hawthorne defends intuitive closure principles and criticizes Dretske’s views regarding closure (and transmission) failure.
• Lackey, Jennifer. 2006.  “Introduction.” In Lackey, Jennifer and Ernest Sosa (eds.). The Epistemology of Testimony. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • In Section 3, Lackey briefly discusses some of the transmission issues concerning testimony.
• Markie, Peter J. “Easy Knowledge.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 70: 406-16.
  • Markie discusses some competent deductions that seem to be instances of transmission failure (though he does not use that terminology), and he provides an error theory of the sort discussed in section 5.B above.
• McKinsey, Michael. 2003. “Transmission of Warrant and Closure of Apriority.”
  • In Nuccetelli 97-115.  McKinsey responds to Wright (2000) and Davies’ (1998, 2000, 2003) charge that McKinsey’s Paradox is an instance of transmission failure.
• McLaughlin, Brian. 2003. “McKinsey’s Challenge, Warrant Transmission, and Skepticism.”  In Nuccetelli 79-96.
  • McLaughlin provides an objection to Wright’s 2000 conditions for transmission failure, which convinces Wright to modify those conditions in his later work.  It also provides a careful discussion of whether McKinsey’s Paradox is an instance of transmission failure.
• McLaughlin, Brian. 2000. “Skepticism, Externalism, and Self-Knowledge.” The Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 74: 93-118.
  • On pages 104-5, McLaughlin connects transmission failure with question-begging and claims that the Neo-Moorean argument is an instance of transmission failure.
• Nuccetelli, Susana (ed.). 2003. New Essays on Semantic Externalism and Self-Knowledge. Cambridge: MIT Press.
  • Several chapters of this collection were referenced in this article.
• Pryor, James. 2004. “What’s Wrong with Moore’s Argument.” Philosophical Issues 14: 349-77.
  • Pryor defends Moore’s Proof from the charge of transmission failure, which includes a very careful discussion of the error theory discussed in 5.B.
• Silins, Nicholas. 2005. “Transmission Failure Failure.” Philosophical Studies 126: 71-102.
  • Silins defends the Zebra Argument from the charge of transmission failure and provides detailed criticisms of the views of Wright and Davies.
• Smith, Martin. 2009. “Transmission Failure Explained.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 79: 164-89.
  • Smith provides an account of transmission failure in terms of safety and reliability.  A full appreciation of Smith’s view requires at least some background in modal logic, particularly with counterfactuals, or subjunctive conditionals.
• Tucker, Chris. 2010. “When Transmission Fails.” Philosophical Review 119: 497-529.
  • Tucker defends the Neo-Moorean and Zebra arguments by developing and defending a very permissive account of transmission failure. Much of this entry is merely a simplified version of the first half of Tucker’s 2010 paper.
• Tucker, Chris. 2009. “Perceptual Justification and Warrant by Default.”  Australasian Journal of Philosophy 87: 445-63.
  • This paper attacks the view of non-inferential justification that Wright, and, to a lesser extent, Smith, Davies, and McLaughlin (2003) assume in their work on transmission failure.
• Williamson, Timothy. 2000. Knowledge and Its Limits. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • This book contains some important work on closure failure that is equally work on transmission failure.
• Wright, Crispin. 2008. “The Perils of Dogmatism.” Themes from G. E. Moore: New Essays in Epistemology and Ethics. Oxford: Oxford University Press, 25-48.
  • Wright criticizes an alternative to his account of non-inferential justification and, on page 38, he criticizes Pryor’s version of the error theory discussed in 5.B.
• Wright, Crispin. 2004. “Warrant for Nothing (and Foundations for Free)?” Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume 78: 167- 212.
  • Wright’s extended defense of his account of non-inferential justification.
• Wright, Crispin. 2003. “Some Reflections on the Acquisition of Warrant by Inference.” In Nuccetelli 57-78.
  • The place to start for those interested in understanding Wright’s account of transmission failure as it relates to McKinsey’s Paradox and content externalism.
• Wright, Crispin. 2002. “(Anti)-Sceptics Simple and Subtle: G. E. Moore and John McDowell.” Philosophy and Phenomenological Research 65: 330-348.
  • The place to start for those interested in Wright’s account of transmission failure as it relates to perceptual justification.
• Wright, Crispin. 2000. “Cogency and Question-Begging: Some Reflections on McKinsey’s Paradox and Putnam’s Proof.” Philosophical Issues 10: 140-63.
  • Wright provides a transmission failure principle which he refines in his 2002 and 2003 in light of McLaughlin’s 2003 criticism.
• Wright, Crispin. 1985. “Facts and Certainty.” Proceedings of the British Academy, 429-472. Reprinted in Williams, Michael (ed.). 1993. Skepticism. Aldershot: Dartmouth Publishing Company Limited, pgs. 303-346.
  • Wright’s earliest work on transmission failure and perhaps the first paper to distinguish between closure and transmission principles.  Since Wright’s main focus is not transmission failure, you might start with one of Wright’s later papers unless one is very interested in the full details of Wright’s broadly Wittgensteinian epistemology.

Author Information

Chris Tucker
Email: c.tucker@auckland.ac.nz
University of Auckland
New Zealand