|
|
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to that part of this article)
The birth-year of Thomas Aquinas is commonly given as 1227,
but he was probably born early in 1225 at his father's castle
of Roccasecea (75 m. e.s.e. of Rome) in Neapolitan territory.
He died at the monastery of Fossanova, one mile from Sonnino
(64 m. s.e. of Rome), Mar. 7, 1274. His father was Count Landulf
of an old high-born south Italian family, and his mother was Countess
Theodora of Theate, of noble Norman descent. In his fifth year
he was sent for his early education to the monastery of Monte
Cassino, where his father's brother Sinibald was abbot. Later
he studied in Naples. Probably in 1243 he determined to enter
the Dominican order; but on the way to Rome he was seized by his
brothers and brought back to his parents at the castle of S. Giovanni,
where he was held a captive for a year or two and besieged with
prayers, threats, and even sensual temptation to make him relinquish
his purpose. Finally the family yielded and the order sent Thomas
to Cologne to study under Albertus Magnus, where he arrived probably
toward the end of 1244. He accompanied Albertus to Paris in 1245,
remained there with his teacher, continuing his studies for three
years, and followed Albertus at the latter's return to Cologne
in 1248. For several years longer he remained with the famous
philosopher of scholasticism, presumably teaching. This long association
of Thomas with the great polyhistor was the most important influence
in his development; it made him a comprehensive scholar and won
him permanently for the Aristotelian method. In 1252 probably
Thomas went to Paris for the master's degree, which he found some
difficulty in attaining owing to attacks, at that time on the
mendicant orders. Ultimately, however, he received the degree
and entered ceremoniously Upon his office of teaching in 1257;
he taught in Paris for several years and there wrote certain of
his works and began others. In 1259 he was present at an important
chapter of his order at Valenciennes, At the solicitation of Pope
Urban IV. (therefore not before the latter part of 1261), he took
up his residence in Rome. In 1269-71 he was again active in Paris.
In 1272 the provincial chapter at Florence empowered him to found
a new studium generale at such place as he should choose,
and he selected Naples. Early in 1274 the pope directed Mm to
attend the Council of Lyons and he undertook the journey, although
he was far from well. On the way he stopped at the castle of
a niece and there became seriously ill. He wished to end his
days in a monastery and not being able to reach a house of the,
Dominicans he was carried to the Cistercian Fossanova. There,
first, after his death, his remains were preserved.
Writings
The writings of Thomas may be classified as, (1) exegetical,
homiletical, and liturgical; (2) dogmatic, apologetic, and ethical;
and (3) philosophical. Among the genuine works of the first class
were: Commentaries on Job (1261-65); on Psalms, according to
some a reportatum, or report of oral deliverances furnished
by his companion Raynaldus; on Isaiah; the Catena aurea,
which is a running commentary on the four Gospels, constructed
on numerous citations from the Fathers; probably a Commentary
on Canticles, and on Jeremiah; and wholly or partly reportata,
on John, on Matthew, and on the epistles of Paul, including, according
to one authority, Hebrews i.-x. Thomas prepared for Urban IV.,
Officium de corpore Christi (1264); and the following
works may be either genuine or reportata: Expositio
angelicce salutationis; Tractatus de decem praeceptis;
Orationis dominico expositio; Sermones pro dominicis diebus
et pro sanctorum solemnitatibus; Sermones de angelis,
and Sermones de quadragesima. Of his sermons only manipulated
copies are extant. In the second division were: In quatitor
sententiarum libros, of his first Paris sojourn; Questiones
disputatce, written at Paris and Rome; Questiones quodlibetales
duodecini; Summa catholicce fidei contra gentiles (1261-C,4);
and the Summa theologioe. To the dogmatic works belong
also certain commentaries, as follows: Expositio in librum
beati Dionysii de divinis nominibits; Expositiones primoe
et secundce; In Boethii libros de hebdomadibus; and
Proeclare quoestiones super librum Boethii de trinitate.
A large number of opuscitla also belonged to this group.
Of philosophical writings there are cataloged thirteen commentaries
on Aristotle, besides numerous philosophical opuscula of
which fourteen are classed as genuine.
The Summa Part I: God
The greatest work of Thomas was the Summa
and it is the fullest presentation of his views. He worked on
it from the time of Clement IV. (after 1265) until the end of
his life. When he died he had reached question ninety of part
iii., on the subject of penance. What was lacking, was afterward
added from the fourth book of his commentary on the "Sentences"
of Peter Lombard as a supplementum, which is not found
in manuscripts of the thirteenth and fourteenth centuries. The
Summa consists of three parts. Part i. treats of God, who is
the " first cause, himself uncaused " (primum movens
immobile) and as such existent only in act (actu),
that is pure actuality without potentiality and, therefore, without
corporeality. His essence is actus purus et perfectus.
This follows from the fivefold proof for the existence of God;
namely, there must be a first mover, unmoved, a first cause in
the chain of causes, an absolutely necessary being, an absolutely
perfect being, and a rational designer. In this connection the
thoughts of the unity, infinity, unchangeableness, and goodness
of the highest being are deduced. The spiritual being of God
is further defined as thinking and willing. His knowledge is
absolutely perfect since he knows himself and all things as appointed
by him. Since every knowing being strives after the thing known
as end, will is implied in knowing. Inasmuch as God knows himself
as the perfect good, he wills himself as end. But in that everything
is willed by God, everything is brought by the divine will to
himself in the relation of means to end. Therein God wills good
to every being which exists, that is he loves it; and, therefore,
love is the fundamental relation of God to the world. If the
divine love be thought of simply as act of will, it exists for
every creature in like measure: but if the good assured by love
to the individual be thought of, it exists for different beings
in various degrees. In so far as the loving God gives to every
being what it needs in relation practical reason," affording
the idea of the moral law of nature, so important in medieval
ethics.
The Summa Part II: Ethics
The first part of the Summa is summed
up in the thought that God governs the world as the universal
first cause. God sways the intellect in that he gives the power
to know aid impresses the species intelligibiles on the
mind, and he ways the will in that he holds the good before it
as aim, and creates the virtus volendi. To will is nothing
else than a certain inclination toward the object of the volition
which is the universal good. God works all in all, but so that
things also themselves exert their proper efficiency. Here the
Areopagitic ideas of the graduated effects of created things play
their part in Thomas's thought. The second part of the Summa (two
parts, prima secundae and secundae, secunda) follows
this complex of ideas. Its theme is man's striving after the
highest end, which is the blessedness of the visio beata.
Here Thomas develops his system of ethics, which has its root
in Aristotle. In a chain of acts of will man strives for the
highest end. They are free acts in so far as man has in himself
the knowledge of their end and therein the principle of action.
In that the will wills the end, it wills also the appropriate
means, chooses freely and completes the consensus. Whether the
act be good or evil depends on the end. The "human reason"
pronounces judgment concerning the character of the end, it is,
therefore, the law for action. Human acts, however, are meritorious
in so far as they promote the purpose of God and his honor. By
repeating a good action man acquires a moral habit or a quality
which enables him to do the good gladly and easily. This is true,
however, only of the intellectual and moral virtues, which Thomas
treats after the mariner of Aristotle; the theological virtues
are imparted by God to man as a " disposition," from
which the acts here proceed, but while they strengthen, they do
not form it. The " disposition " of evil is the opposite
alternative. An act becomes evil through deviation from the reason
and the divine moral law. Therefore, sin involves two factors:
its substance or matter is lust; in form, however, it is deviation
from the divine law. Sin has its origin in the will, which decides,
against the reason, for a changeable good." Since, however,
the will also moves the other powers of man, sin has its seat
in these too. By choosing such a lower good as end, the will
is misled by self-love, so that this works as cause in every sin.
God is not the cause of sin, since, on the contrary, he draws
all things to himself. But from another side God is the cause
of all things, so he is efficacious also in sin as *-ctio but
not as ens. The devil is not directly the cause of sin,
but he incites by working on the imagination and the sensuous
impulse of man, as men or things may also do. Sin is original.
Adam's first sin passes upon himself and all the succeeding race;
because he is the head of the human race and "by virtue of
procreation human nature is transmitted and along with nature
its infection." The powers of generation are, therefore,
designated especially as "infected." The thought is
involved here by the fact that Thomas, like the other to the whole,
he is just: in so far as he thereby does away with misery, he
is merciful. In every work of God both justice and mercy are
united and, indeed, his justice always presupposes his mercy,
since he owes no one anything and gives more bountifully than
is due. As God rules in the world, the "plan of the order
of things" preexists in him; i.e., his providence and the
exercise of it in his government are what condition as cause everything
which comes to pass in the world. Hence follows predestination:
from eternity some are destined to eternal life, while as concerns
others "he permits some to fall short of that end."
Reprobation, however, is more than mere foreknowledge; it is the
"will of permitting anyone to fall into sin and incur the
penalty of condemnation for sin." The effect of predestination
is grace. Since God is the first cause of everything, he is the
cause of even the free acts of men through predestination. Determinism
is deeply grounded in the system of Thomas; things with their
source of becoming in God are ordered from eternity as means for
the realization of his end in himself. On moral grounds Thomas
advocates freedom energetically; but, with his premises, he can
have in mind only the psychological form of self-motivation.
Nothing in the world is accidental or free, although it may appear
so in reference to the proximate cause. From this point of view
miracles become necessary in themselves and are to be considered
merely as inexplicable to man. From the point of view of the
first cause all is unchangeable; although from the limited point
of view of the secondary cause miracles may be spoken of. In
his doctrine of the Trinity Thomas starts from the Augustinian
system. Since God has only the functions of thinking and willing,
only two processiones can be asserted from the Father.
But these establish definite relations of the persons of the
Trinity one to another. The relations must be conceived as real
and not as merely ideal; for, as with creatures relations arise
through certain accidents, since in God there is no accident but
all is substance, it follows that " the relation really existing
in God is the same as the essence according to the thing."
From another side, however, the relations as real must be really
distinguished one from another. Therefore, three persons are
to be affirmed in God. Man stands opposite to God; he consists
of soul and body. The " intellectual soul" consists
of intellect and will. Furthermore the soul is the absolutely
indivisible form of man; it is immaterial substance, but not one
and the same in all men (as the Averrhoists assumed). The soul's
power of knowing has two sides; a passive (the intellectus
possibilis) and an active (the intellectus agens).
It is the capacity to form concepts and to abstract the mind's
images (species) from the objects perceived by sense. But since
what the intellect abstracts from individual things is a universal,
the mind knows the universal primarily and directly, and knows
the singular only indirectly by virtue of a certain reflection.
As certain principles are immanent in the mind for its speculative
activity, so also a " special disposition of works,"
or the synderesis (rudiment of conscience), is inborn in
the scholastics, held to creationism, therefore taught that the
souls are created by God. Two things according to Thomas constituted
man's righteousness in paradise-the justitia originalis
or the harmony of all man's powers before they were blighted by
desire, and the possession of the gratia gratum faciens
(the continuous indwelling power of good). Both are lost through
original sin, which in form is the " loss of original righteousness."
The consequence of this loss is the disorder and maiming of man's
nature, which shows itself in " ignorance, malice, moral
weakness, and especially in concupiscentia, which is the
material principle of original sin." The course of thought
here is as follows: when the first man transgressed the order
of his nature appointed by nature and grace, he, and with him
the human race, lost this order. This negative state is the essence
of original sin. From it follow an impairment and perversion of
human nature in which thenceforth lower aims rule contrary to
nature and release the lower element in man. Since sin is contrary
to the divine order, it is guilt, and subject to punishment. Guilt
and punishment correspond to each other; and since the "apostasy
from the invariable good which is infinite," fulfilled by
man, is unending, it merits everlasting punishment.
The Summa Part III: Christ
The way which leads to God is Christ:
and Christ is the theme of part iii. It can not be asserted that
the incarnation was absolutely necessary, "since God in his
omnipotent power could have repaired human nature in many other
ways": but it was the most suitable way both for the purpose
of instruction and of satisfaction. The Unio between the
Logos and the human nature is a " relation " between
the divine and the human nature which comes about by both natures
being brought together in the one person of the Logos. An incarnation
can be spoken of only in the sense that the human nature began
to be in the eternal hypostasis of the divine nature. So Christ
is unum since his human nature lacks the hypostasis. The
person of the Logos, accordingly, has assumed the impersonal human
nature, and in such way that the assumption of the soul became
the means for the assumption of the body. This union with the
human soul is the gratia unionis which leads to the impartation
of the gratia habitualis from the Logos to the human nature.
Thereby all human potentialities are made perfect in Jesus.
Besides the perfections given by the vision of God, which Jesus
enjoyed from the beginning, he receives all others by the gratia
habitualis. In so far, however, as it is the limited human
nature which receives these perfections, they are finite. This
holds both of the knowledge and the will of Christ. The Logos
impresses the species intelligibiles of all created things
on the soul, but the intellectus agens transforms them
gradually into the impressions of sense. On another side the
soul of Christ works miracles only as instrument of the Logos,
since omnipotence in no way appertains to this human soul in itself.
Furthermore, Christ's human nature partook of imperfections,
on the one side to make his true humanity evident, on another
side because he would bear the general consequences of sin for
humanity. Christ experienced suffering, but blessedness reigned
in his soul, which, however, did not extend to his body. Concerning
redemption, Thomas teaches that Christ is to be regarded as redeemer
after his human nature but in such way that the human nature produces
divine effects as organ of divinity. The one side of the work
of redemption consists herein, that Christ as head of humanity
imparts perfection and virtue to his members. He is the teacher
and example of humanity; his whole life and suffering as well
as his work after he is exalted serve this end. The love wrought
hereby in men effects, according to Luke vii. 47, the forgiveness
of sins.
This is the first course of thought., Then follows a second complex
of thoughts which has the idea of satisfaction as its center.
To be sure, God as the highest being could forgive sins without
satisfaction; but because his justice and mercy could be best
revealed through satisfaction he chose this way. As little, however,
as satisfaction is necessary in itself, so little does it offer
an equivalent, in a correct sense, for guilt; it is rather a "
super-abundant satisfaction," since on account of the divine
subject in Christ in a certain sense his suffering and activity
are infinite. With this thought the strict logical deduction
of Anselm's theory is given up. Christ's suffering bore personal
character in that it proceeded out of love and obedience."
It was an offering brought to God, which as personal act had the
character of merit. Thereby Christ " merited " salvation
for men. As Christ, exalted, still influences men, so does he
still work in their behalf continually in heaven through the intercession
(interpellatio). In this way Christ as head of humanity
effects the forgiveness of their sins, their reconciliation with
God, their immunity from punishment, deliverance from the devil,
and the opening of heaven's gate. But inasmuch as all these benefits
are already offered through the inner operation of the love of
Christ, Thomas has combined the theories of Anselm and Abelard
by joining the one to the other.