The existence of evil and suffering in our world seems to pose a serious
challenge to belief in the existence of a perfect God. If God were all-knowing,
it seems that God would know about all of the horrible things that happen in
our world. If God were all-powerful, God would be able to do something about
all of the evil and suffering. Furthermore, if God were morally perfect, then
surely God would want to do something about it. And yet we find that our world
is filled with countless instances of evil and suffering. These facts
about evil and suffering seem to conflict with the orthodox theist claim that
there exists a perfectly good God. The challenged posed by this apparent
conflict has come to be known as the problem of evil.
This article addresses one form of that problem that is prominent in recent
philosophical discussions--that the conflict that exists between the claims of
orthodox theism and the facts about evil and suffering in our world is a
logical one. This is the "logical problem of evil."
The article clarifies the nature of the logical problem of evil and considers
various theistic responses to the problem. Special attention is given to the
free will defense, which has been the most widely discussed theistic response
to the logical problem of evil.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Introducing the Problem
Journalist and best-selling author Lee Strobel commissioned George Barna, the public-opinion pollster, to conduct a
nationwide survey. The survey included the question "If you could ask God only one question and you knew he would give you an
answer, what would you ask?" The most common response, offered by 17% of those who could think of a question was "Why is there pain
and suffering in the world?" (Strobel 2000, p. 29). If God is all-powerful, all-knowing and perfectly good, why does he let so many
bad things happen? This question raises what philosophers call "the problem of
evil."
It would be one thing if the only people who suffered debilitating diseases or tragic losses were the likes of Adolf Hitler, Joseph
Stalin or Osama Bin Laden. As it is, however, thousands of good-hearted, innocent people experience the ravages of violent crime,
terminal disease, and other evils. Michael Peterson (1998, p. 1) writes,
Something is dreadfully wrong with our world. An earthquake kills hundreds in Peru. A pancreatic cancer patient suffers prolonged,
excruciating pain and dies. A pit bull attacks a two-year-old child, angrily ripping his flesh and killing him. Countless
multitudes suffer the ravages of war in Somalia. A crazed cult leader pushes eighty-five people to their deaths in Waco, Texas.
Millions starve and die in North Korea as famine ravages the land. Horrible things of all kinds happen in our world—and that has
been the story since the dawn of civilization.
Peterson (1998, p. 9) claims that the problem of evil is a kind of "moral protest." In asking “How could God let this happen?”
people are often claiming "It's not fair that God has let this happen." Many atheists try to turn the existence of evil and
suffering into an argument against the existence of God. They claim that, since there is something morally problematic about a
morally perfect God allowing all of the evil and suffering we see, there must not be a morally perfect God after all. The popularity
of this kind of argument has led Hans Küng (1976, p. 432) to call the problem of evil "the rock of atheism." This essay examines one
form the argument from evil has taken, which is known as
"the logical problem of evil."
In the second half of the twentieth century, atheologians (that is, persons who try to
prove the non-existence of God) commonly claimed that the problem of evil was a
problem of logical inconsistency. J. L. Mackie (1955, p. 200), for example,
claimed,
Here it can be shown, not that religious beliefs lack rational support, but that
they are positively irrational, that several parts of the essential theological
doctrine are inconsistent with one another.
H. J. McCloskey (1960, p. 97) wrote,
Evil is a problem, for the theist, in that a contradiction is involved in the fact
of evil on the one hand and belief in the omnipotence and omniscience of God on the
other.
Mackie and McCloskey can be understood as claiming that it is impossible for all of
the following statements to be true at the same time:
(1) God is omnipotent (that is, all-powerful).
(2) God is omniscient (that is, all-knowing).
(3) God is perfectly good.
(4) Evil exists.
Any two or three of them might be true at the same time; but there is no way that
all of them could be true. In other words, (1) through (4) form a logically
inconsistent set. What does it mean to say that something is logically
inconsistent?
(5) A set of statements is logically inconsistent if and only if:
(a) that set includes a direct contradiction of the form "p & not-p"; or (b) a direct contradiction can be deduced from that set.
None of the statements in (1) through (4) directly contradicts any other, so if the
set is logically inconsistent, it must be because we can deduce a contradiction
from it. This is precisely what atheologians claim to be able to do.
Atheologians claim that a contradiction can easily be deduced from (1) through (4)
once we think through the implications of the divine attributes cited in (1)
through (3). They reason as follows:
(6) If God is omnipotent, he would be able to prevent all of the evil and suffering
in the world.
(7) If God is omniscient, he would know about all of the evil and suffering in the
world and would know how to eliminate or prevent it.
(8) If God is perfectly good, he would want to prevent all of the evil and suffering
in the world.
Statements (6) through (8) jointly imply that if the perfect God of theism really
existed, there would not be any evil or suffering. However, as we all know, our
world is filled with a staggering amount of evil and suffering. Atheologians claim
that, if we reflect upon (6) through (8) in light of the fact of evil and suffering
in our world, we should be led to the following conclusions:
(9) If God knows about all of the evil and suffering in the world, knows how to
eliminate or prevent it, is powerful enough to prevent it, and yet does not prevent
it, he must not be perfectly good.
(10) If God knows about all of the evil and suffering, knows how to eliminate or
prevent it, wants to prevent it, and yet does not do so, he must not be all-
powerful.
(11) If God is powerful enough to prevent all of the evil and suffering, wants to do
so, and yet does not, he must not know about all of the suffering or know how to
eliminate or prevent it—that is, he must not be all-knowing.
From (9) through (11) we can infer:
(12) If evil and suffering exist, then God is either not omnipotent, not omniscient,
or not perfectly good.
Since evil and suffering obviously do exist, we get:
(13) God is either not omnipotent, not omniscient, or not perfectly good.
Putting the point more bluntly, this line of argument suggests that—in light of the
evil and suffering we find in our world—if God exists, he is either impotent,
ignorant or wicked. It should be obvious that (13) conflicts with (1) through (3)
above. To make the conflict more clear, we can combine (1), (2) and (3) into the
following single statement.
(14) God is omnipotent, omniscient and perfectly good.
There is no way that (13) and (14) could both be true at the same time. These
statements are logically inconsistent or contradictory.
Statement (14) is simply the conjunction of (1) through (3) and expresses the
central belief of classical theism. However, atheologians claim that statement (
13) can also be derived from (1) through (3). [Statements (6) through (12) purport
to show how this is done.] (13) and (14), however, are logically contradictory.
Because a contradiction can be deduced from statements (1) through (4) and because
all theists believe (1) through (4), atheologians claim that theists have logically
inconsistent beliefs. They note that philosophers have always believed it is never
rational to believe something contradictory. So, the existence of evil and
suffering makes theists' belief in the existence of a perfect God irrational.
Can the believer in God escape from this dilemma? In his best-selling book
When Bad Things Happen to Good People, Rabbi Harold Kushner (1981) offers
the following escape route for the theist: deny the truth of (1). According to
this proposal, God is not ignoring your suffering when he doesn't act to prevent it
because—as an all-knowing God—he knows about all of your suffering. As a perfectly
good God, he also feels your pain. The problem is that he can't do anything about
it because he's not omnipotent. According to Kushner’s portrayal, God is something
of a kind-hearted wimp. He'd like to help, but he doesn’t have the power to do
anything about evil and suffering. Denying the truth of either (1), (2), (3) or (
4) is certainly one way for the theist to escape from the logical problem of evil,
but it would not be a very palatable option to many theists. In the remainder of
this essay, we will examine some theistic responses to the logical problem of evil
that do not require the abandonment of any central tenet of theism.
2. Logical Consistency
Theists who want to rebut the logical problem of evil need to find a way to show that (1) through (4)—perhaps despite initial
appearances—are consistent after all. We said above that a set of statements is logically inconsistent if and only if that set
includes a direct contradiction or a direct contradiction can be deduced from that set. That means that a set of statements is
logically consistent if and only if that set does not include a direct contradiction and a direct contradiction cannot be deduced
from that set. In other words,
(15) A set of statements is logically consistent if and only if it is possible for all of them to be true at the same time.
Notice that (15) does not say that consistent statements must actually be true at the same time. They may all be false or some may
be true and others false. Consistency only requires that it be possible for all of the statements to be true (even if that
possibility is never actualized). (15) also doesn't say anything about plausibility. It does not require the joint of a consistent
set of statements to be plausible. It may be exceedingly unlikely or improbable that a certain set of statements should all be true
at the same time. But improbability is not the same thing as impossibility. As long as there is nothing contradictory about their
conjunction, it will be possible (even if unlikely) for them all to be true at the same time.
This brief discussion allows us to see that the atheological claim that statements (1) through (4) are logically inconsistent is a
rather strong one. The atheologian is maintaining that statements (1) through
(4) couldn't possibly all be true at the same time. In other words,
(16) It is not possible for God and evil to co-exist.
The logical problem of evil claims that God's omnipotence, omniscience and
supreme goodness would completely rule out the possibility of evil and that the
existence of evil would do the same for the existence of a supreme being.
3. Logical Consistency and the Logical Problem of Evil
How might a theist go about demonstrating that (16) is false? Some theists suggest that perhaps God has a good reason for
allowing the evil and suffering that he does. Not just any old reason can justify God's allowing all of the evil and suffering we
see. Mass murderers and serial killers typically have reasons for why they commit horrible crimes, but they do not have good
reasons. It's only when people have morally good reasons that we excuse or condone their behavior. Philosophers of religion have
called the kind of reason that could morally justify God's allowing evil and suffering a
"morally sufficient reason."
Consider the following statement.
(17) It is possible that God has a morally sufficient reason for allowing
evil.
If God were to have a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil, would it be possible for God to be omnipotent,
omniscient, perfectly good, and yet for there to be evil and suffering? Many theists answer "Yes." If (17) were true,
(9) through (12) would have to be modified to read:
(9') If God knows about all of the evil and suffering in the world, knows how to eliminate or prevent it, is powerful enough to
prevent it, and yet does not prevent it, he must not be perfectly good—unless he has a morally sufficient reason for allowing
evil.
(10') If God knows about all of the evil and suffering, knows how to eliminate or prevent it, wants to prevent it, and yet does not do
so, he must not be all-powerful—unless he has a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil.
(11') If God is powerful enough to prevent all of the evil and suffering, wants to do so, and yet does not, he must not know about all
of the suffering or know how to eliminate or prevent it (that is, he must not be all-knowing)—unless he has a morally sufficient reason
for allowing evil.
(12') If evil and suffering exist, then either: a) God is not omnipotent, not omniscient, or not perfectly good; or b) God has a
morally sufficient reason for allowing evil.
From (9') through (12'), it is not possible to conclude that God does not exist. The most that can be concluded is that either
God does not exist or God has a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil. So, some theists suggest that the real question behind
the logical problem of evil is whether (17) is true.
If it is possible that God has a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil and suffering to occur, then the logical problem
of evil fails to prove the non-existence of God. If, however, it is not possible that God has a morally sufficient reason for
allowing evil, then it seems that (13) would be true: God is either not omnipotent, not omniscient, or not perfectly good.
An implicit assumption behind this part of the debate over the logical problem of evil is the following:
(18) It is not morally permissible for God to allow evil and suffering to occur unless he has a morally sufficient reason for
doing so.
Is (18) correct? Many philosophers think so. It is difficult to see how a God who allowed bad things to happen just for the heck of
it could be worthy of reverence, faith and worship. If God had no morally sufficient reason for allowing evil, then if we made it to
the pearly gates some day and asked God why he allowed so many bad things to happen, he would simply have to shrug his shoulders and
say "There was no reason or point to all of that suffering you endured. I just felt like letting it happen." This callous image of
God is difficult to reconcile with orthodox theism's portrayal of God as a loving Father who cares deeply about his creation. (18),
combined with the assumption that God does not have a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil, yields
(19) God is doing something morally inappropriate or blameworthy in allowing evil to occur,
and
(20) If God is doing something morally inappropriate or blameworthy, then God is not perfectly good.
If (19) and (20) are true, then the God of orthodox theism does not exist.
What would it look like for God to have a morally sufficient reason for allowing
evil? Let's first consider a down-to-earth example of a morally sufficient
reason a human being might have before moving on to the case of God. Suppose a
gossipy neighbor were to tell you that Mrs. Jones just allowed someone to
inflict unwanted pain upon her child. Your first reaction to this news might be
one of horror. But once you find out that the pain was caused by a shot that
immunized Mrs. Jones' infant daughter against polio, you would no longer view
Mrs. Jones as a danger to society. Generally, we believe the following moral
principle to be true.
(21) Parents should not inflict unwanted pain upon their children.
In the immunization case, Mrs. Jones has a morally sufficient reason for
overriding or suspending this principle. A higher moral duty—namely, the duty of
protecting the long-term health of her child—trumps the lesser duty expressed by
(21). If God has a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil and suffering,
theists claim, it will probably look something like Mrs. Jones'.
4. Plantinga's Free Will Defense
What might God's reason be for allowing evil and suffering to occur? Alvin Plantinga (1974, 1977) has offered the most famous
contemporary philosophical response to this question. He suggests the following as a possible morally sufficient reason:
(MSR1) God's creation of persons with morally significant free will is something of tremendous value. God could not eliminate
much of the evil and suffering in this world without thereby eliminating the greater good of having created persons with free will
with whom he could have relationships and who are able to love one another and do good deeds.
(MSR1) claims that God allows some evils to occur that are smaller in value than a greater good to which they are intimately
connected. If God eliminated the evil, he would have to eliminate the greater good as well. God is pictured as being in a situation
much like that of Mrs. Jones: she allowed a small evil (the pain of a needle) to be inflicted upon her child because that pain was
necessary for bringing about a greater good (immunization against polio). Before we try to decide whether (MSR1) can justify God in
allowing evil and suffering to occur, some of its key terms need to be explained.
To begin with, (MSR1) presupposes the view of free will known as "libertarianism":
(22) Libertarianism=df the view that a person is free with respect to a given action if and only if that person is both free to
perform that action and free to refrain from performing that action; in other words, that person is not determined to perform or
refrain from that action by any prior causal forces.
Although the term "libertarianism" isn’t exactly a household name, the view it expresses is commonly taken to be the average person’s
view of free will. It is the view that causal determinism is false, that—unlike robots or other machines—we can make choices that
are genuinely free.
According to Plantinga, libertarian free will is a morally significant kind of free will. An action is morally significant just when
it is appropriate to evaluate that action from a moral perspective (for example, by ascribing moral praise or blame). Persons have morally
significant free will if they are able to perform actions that are morally significant. Imagine a possible world where God creates
creatures with a very limited kind of freedom. Suppose that the persons in this world can only choose good options and are incapable
of choosing bad options. So, if one of them were faced with three possible courses of action—two of which were morally good and one
of which was morally bad—this person would not be free with respect to the morally bad option. That is, that person would not be
able to choose any bad option even if they wanted to. Our hypothetical person does, however, have complete freedom to decide which
of the two good courses of action to take. Plantinga would deny that any such person has morally significant free will. People in
this world always perform morally good actions, but they deserve no credit for doing so. It is impossible for them to do wrong. So,
when they do perform right actions, they should not be praised. It would be ridiculous to give moral praise to a robot for putting
your soda can in the recycle bin rather than the trash can, if that is what it was programmed to do. Given the program running
inside the robot and its exposure to an empty soda can, it's going to take the can to the recycle bin. It has no choice about the
matter. Similarly, the people in the possible world under consideration have no choice about being good. Since they are
pre-programmed to be good, they deserve no praise for it.
According to Plantinga, people in the actual world are free in the most robust sense of that term. They are fully free and
responsible for their actions and decisions. Because of this, when they do what is right, they can properly be praised. Moreover,
when they do wrong, they can be rightly blamed or punished for their actions.
It is important to note that (MSR1) directly conflicts with a common assumption about what kind of world God could have created.
Many atheologians believe that God could have created a world that was populated with free creatures and yet did not contain any evil
or suffering. Since this is something that God could have done and since a world with free creatures and no evil is better than a
world with free creatures and evil, this is something God should have done. Since he did not do so, God did something blameworthy by
not preventing or eliminating evil and suffering (if indeed God exists at all). In response to this charge, Plantinga maintains that
there are some worlds God cannot create. In particular, he cannot do the logically impossible. (MSR1) claims that God cannot get
rid of much of the evil and suffering in the world without also getting rid of morally significant free will. (The question of
whether God's omnipotence is compatible with the claim that God cannot do the logically impossible will be addressed below.)
Consider the following descriptions of various worlds. We need to determine which ones describe worlds that are logically possible
and which ones describe impossible worlds. The worlds described will be possible if the descriptions of those worlds are logically
consistent. If the descriptions of those worlds are inconsistent or contradictory, the worlds in question will be impossible.
| W1: |
(a) God creates persons with morally significant free will; |
| |
(b) God does not causally determine people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong; and |
| |
(c) There is evil and suffering in W1. |
| |
|
| W2: |
(a) God does not create persons with morally significant
free will; |
| |
(b) God causally determines people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong; and |
| |
(c) There is no evil or suffering in W2. |
| |
|
| W3: |
(a) God creates persons with morally significant free will; |
| |
(b) God causally determines people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong; and |
| |
(c) There is no evil or suffering in W3. |
| |
|
| W4: |
(a) God creates persons with morally significant free will; |
| |
(b) God does not causally determine people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong; and |
| |
(c) There is no evil or suffering in W4. |
Let's figure out which of these worlds are possible. Is W1 possible? Yes. In fact, on the assumption that God
exists, it seems to describe the actual world. People have free will in this world and there is evil and suffering. God has
obviously not causally determined people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong because there would be
no evil or suffering if he had. So, W1 is clearly possible.
What about W2? Granting Plantinga's assumption that human beings are genuinely free creatures, the first thing to notice
about W2 is that you and I would not exist in such a world. We are creatures with morally significant free will. If you
took away our free will, we would no longer be the kinds of creatures we are. We would not be human in that world. Returning to the
main issue, there does not seem to be anything impossible about God causally determining people in every situation to choose what is
right and to avoid what is wrong. It seems clearly possible that whatever creatures God were to make in such a world would not have
morally significant free will and that there would be no evil or suffering. W2, then, is also possible.
Now let's consider the philosophically more important world W3. Is W3 possible? Plantinga says, "No." Parts
(a) and (b) of the description of W3 are, he claims, logically inconsistent. In W3 God causally determines
people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong. People in this world couldn't do morally bad things
if they wanted to. And yet part of what it means for creatures to have morally significant free will is that they can do morally
bad things whenever they want to. Think about what it would be like to live in W3. If you wanted to tell a lie, you
would not be able to do so. Causal forces beyond your control would make you tell the truth on every occasion. You would also be
physically incapable of stealing your neighbor's belongings. In fact, since W3 is a world without evil of any kind and
since merely wanting to lie or steal is itself a bad thing, the people in W3 would not even be able to have morally bad
thoughts or desires. If God is going to causally determine people in every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is
wrong in W3, there is no way that he could allow them to be free in a morally significant sense. Peterson (1998, p. 39)
writes,
if a person is free with respect to an action A, then God does not bring it about or cause it to be the case that she
does A or refrains from doing A. For if God brings it about or causes it to be the case in any manner whatsoever that
the person either does A or does not do A, then that person is not really free.
God can't have it both ways. He can create a world with free creatures or he can causally determine creatures to choose what is
right and to avoid what is wrong every time; but he can't do both. God can forcibly eliminate evil and suffering (as in
W2) only at the cost of getting rid of free will.
The fact that W3 is impossible is centrally important to Plantinga's Free Will Defense. Atheologians, as we saw above,
claim that God is doing something morally blameworthy by allowing evil and suffering to exist in our world. They charge that a good
God would and should eliminate all evil and suffering. The assumption behind this charge is that, in so doing, God could leave human
free will untouched. Plantinga claims that when we think through what robust free will really amounts to, we can see that
atheologians are (unbeknownst to themselves) asking God to do the logically impossible. Being upset that God has not done something
that is logically impossible is, according to Plantinga, misguided. He might say, "Of course he hasn't done that. It’s logically
impossible!" As we will see in section V below, Plantinga maintains that divine omnipotence involves an ability to do anything that
is logically possible, but it does not include the ability to do the logically impossible.
Consider W4. Is it possible? Yes! Most people are tempted to answer "No" when first exposed to this description, but
think carefully about it. Although there is no evil and suffering in this world, it is not because God causally determines people in
every situation to choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong. In this world God has given creatures morally significant free
will without any strings attached. If there is nothing bad in this world, it can only be because the free creatures that inhabit
this world have—by their own free will—always chosen to do the right thing. Is this kind of situation really possible? Yes.
Something is logically possible just when it can be conceived without contradiction. There is nothing contradictory about supposing
that there is a possible world where free creatures always make the right choices and never go wrong. Of course, it's highly
improbable, given what we know about human nature. But improbability and impossibility, as we said above, are two different things.
In fact, according to the Judeo-Christian story of Adam and Eve, it was God's will that significantly free human beings would live in
the Garden of Eden and always obey God's commands. If Adam and Eve had followed God’s plan, then W4 would have been the
actual world.
It is important to note certain similarities between W1 and W4. Both worlds are populated by creatures with
free will and in neither world does God causally determine people to always choose what is right and to avoid what is wrong. The
only difference is that, in W1, the free creatures choose to do wrong at least some of the time, and in W4, the
free creatures always make morally good decisions. In other words, whether there is immorality in either one of these worlds depends
upon the persons living in these worlds—not upon God. According to Plantinga's Free Will Defense, there is evil and suffering in
this world because people do immoral things. People deserve the blame for the bad things that happen—not God. Plantinga (1974, p.
190) writes,
The essential point of the Free Will Defense is that the creation of a world containing moral good is a cooperative venture; it
requires the uncoerced concurrence of significantly free creatures. But then the actualization of a world W containing moral good is
not up to God alone; it also depends upon what the significantly free creatures of W would do.
Atheist philosophers such as Anthony Flew and J. L. Mackie have argued that an omnipotent God should be able to create a world
containing moral good but no moral evil. As Flew (1955, p. 149) put it, "If there is no contradiction here then Omnipotence might
have made a world inhabited by perfectly virtuous people." Mackie (1955, p. 209) writes,
If God has made men such that in their free choices they sometimes prefer what is good and sometimes what is evil, why could he not
have made men such that they always freely choose the good? If there is no logical impossibility in a man's choosing the good on
one, or on several occasions, there cannot be a logical impossibility in his freely choosing the good on every occasion. God was
not, then, faced with a choice between making innocent automata and making beings who, in acting freely, would sometimes go wrong:
there was open to him the obviously better possibility of making beings who would act freely but always go right. Clearly, his
failure to avail himself of this possibility is inconsistent with his being both omnipotent and perfectly good.
According to Plantinga, Mackie is correct in thinking that there is nothing impossible about a world in which people always freely
choose to do right. That's W4. He is also correct in thinking that God’s only options were not "making innocent automata
and making beings who, in acting freely, would sometimes go wrong." In other words, worlds like W1 and W2 are
not the only logically possible worlds. But Plantinga thinks he is mistaken in thinking that W3 is possible and in not
recognizing important differences between W3 and W4. People can freely choose to do what is right only when
their actions are not causally determined.
We might wonder why God would choose to risk populating his new creation with free creatures if he knew there was a chance that human
immorality could foul the whole thing up. C. S. Lewis (1943, p. 52) offers the following answer to this question:
Why, then, did God give them free will? Because free will, though it makes evil possible, is also the only thing that makes possible
any love or goodness or joy worth having. A world of automata—of creatures that worked like machines—would hardly be worth creating.
The happiness which God designs for His higher creatures is the happiness of being freely, voluntarily united to Him and to each
other.... And for that they must be free. Of course, God knew what would happen if they used their freedom the wrong way:
apparently He thought it worth the risk.
Plantinga concurs. He writes,
A world containing creatures who are sometimes significantly free (and freely perform more good than evil actions) is more valuable,
all else being equal, than a world containing no free creatures at all. Now God can create free creatures, but he cannot cause or
determine them to do only what is right. For if he does so, then they are not significantly free after all; they do not do what is
right freely. To create creatures capable of moral good, therefore, he must create creatures capable of moral evil; and he cannot
leave these creatures free to perform evil and at the same time prevent them from doing so.... The fact that these free creatures
sometimes go wrong, however, counts neither against God's omnipotence nor against his goodness; for he could have forestalled the
occurrence of moral evil only by excising the possibility of moral good. (Plantinga 1974, pp. 166-167)
According to his Free Will Defense, God could not eliminate the possibility of moral evil without at the same time eliminating some
greater good.
5. Divine Omnipotence and the Free Will Defense
Some scholars maintain that Plantinga has rejected the idea of an omnipotent God because he claims there are some things God
cannot do—namely, logically impossible things. Plantinga, however, doesn't take God’s omnipotence to include the power to do the
logically impossible. He reasons as follows. Can God create a round square? Can he make 2 + 2 = 5? Can he create a stick that is
not as long as itself? Can he make contradictory statements true? Can he make a rock so big he can't lift it? In response to each
of these questions, Plantinga's answer is "No." Each of the scenarios depicted in these questions is impossible: the objects or
events in question couldn't possibly exist. Omnipotence, according to Plantinga, is the power to do anything that is logically
possible. The fact that God cannot do the logically impossible is not, Plantinga claims, a genuine limitation of God's power. He
would urge those uncomfortable with the idea of limitations on God's power to think carefully about the absurd implications of a God
who can do the logically impossible. If you think God really can make a round square, Plantinga would like to know what such a shape
would look like. If God can make 2 + 2 = 5, then what would 2 + 3 equal? If God can make a rock so big that he can't lift it,
exactly how big would that rock be? What Plantinga would really like to see is a stick that is not as long as itself. Each of these
things seems to be absolutely, positively impossible.
Many theists maintain that it is a mistake to think that God's omnipotence requires that the blank in the following sentence must
never be filled in:
(23) God is not able to ______________.
According to orthodox theism, all of the following statements (and many more like them) are true.
(24) God is not able to lie.
(25) God is not able to cheat.
(26) God is not able to steal.
(27) God is not able to be unjust.
(28) God is not able to be envious.
(29) God is not able to fail to know what is right.
(30) God is not able to fail to do what he knows to be right.
(31) God is not able to have false beliefs about anything.
(32) God is not able to be ignorant.
(33) God is not able to be unwise.
(34) God is not able to cease to exist.
(35) God is not able to make a mistake of any kind.
According to classical theism, the fact that God cannot do any of these things is not a sign of weakness. On the contrary, theists
claim, it is an indication of his supremacy and uniqueness. These facts reveal that God is, in St. Anselm's (1033-1109 A.D.) words,
"that being than which none greater can be conceived." Plantinga adds the following two items to the list of things God cannot do.
(36) God is not able to contradict himself.
(37) God is not able to make significantly free creatures and to causally determine that they will always choose what is right and
avoid what is wrong.
These inabilities follow not from God's omnipotence alone but from his
omnipotence in combination with his omniscience, moral perfection and the other
divine perfections God possesses.
6. An Objection: Free Will and Natural Evil
At this point, someone might raise the following objection.
Plantinga can't put all the blame for pain and suffering on human beings. Although much of the evil in this world results from the
free choices people make, some of it does not. Cancer, AIDS, famines, earthquakes, tornadoes, and many other kinds of diseases and
natural disasters are things that happen without anybody choosing to bring them about. Plantinga's Free Will Defense, then, cannot
serve as a morally sufficient reason for God's allowing disease and natural disasters.
This objection leads us to draw a distinction between the following two kinds of evil and suffering:
(38) Moral evil =df evil or suffering that results from the immoral choices of free creatures.
(39) Natural evil =df evil or suffering that results from the operations of
nature or nature gone awry.
According to Edward Madden and Peter Hare (1968, p. 6), natural evil
includes
the terrible pain, suffering, and untimely death caused by events like fire, flood, landslide, hurricane, earthquake, tidal wave, and
famine and by diseases like cancer, leprosy and tetanus—as well as crippling defects and deformities like blindness, deafness,
dumbness, shriveled limbs, and insanity by which so many sentient beings are cheated of the full benefits of life.
Moral evil, they continue, includes
both moral wrong-doing such as lying, cheating, stealing, torturing, and murdering and character defects like greed, deceit, cruelty,
wantonness, cowardice, and selfishness. (ibid.)
It seems that, although Plantinga's Free Will Defense may be able to explain why God allows moral evil to occur, it cannot explain
why he allows natural evil. If God is going to allow people to be free, it seems plausible to claim that they need to have the
capacity to commit crimes and to be immoral. However, it is not clear that human freedom requires the existence of natural evils
like deadly viruses and natural disasters. How would my free will be compromised if tomorrow God completely eliminated cancer from
the face of the Earth? Do people really need to die from heart disease and flash floods in order for us to have morally significant
free will? It is difficult to see that they do. So, the objection goes, even if Plantinga's Free Will Defense explains why God
allows moral evil, it does not explain why he allows natural evil.
Plantinga, however, thinks that his Free Will Defense can be used to solve the logical problem of evil as it pertains to natural
evil. Here is a possible reason God might have for allowing natural evil:
(MSR2) God allowed natural evil to enter the world as part of Adam and Eve's punishment for their sin in the Garden of Eden.
(Those familiar with Plantinga's work will notice that this is not the same reason Plantinga offers for God’s allowing natural evil.
They will also be able to guess why a different reason was chosen in this
article.) The sin of Adam and Eve was a moral evil. (MSR2)
claims that all natural evil followed as the result of the world's first moral evil. So, if it is plausible to think that
Plantinga's Free Will Defense solves the logical problem of evil as it pertains to moral evil, the current suggestion is that it is
plausible also to think that it solves the logical problem of evil as it pertains to natural evil because all of the worlds evils
have their source in moral evil.
(MSR2) represents a common Jewish and Christian response to the challenge posed by natural evil. Death, disease, pain and even the
tiresome labor involved in gleaning food from the soil came into the world as a direct result of Adam and Eve's sin. The emotional
pain of separation, shame and broken relationships are also consequences that first instance of moral evil. In fact, according to
the first chapter of Genesis, animals in the Garden of Eden didn't even kill each other for food before the Fall. In the description
of the sixth day of creation God says to Adam and Eve,
I give you every seed-bearing plant on the face of the whole earth and every tree that has fruit with seed in it. They will be yours
for food. And to all the beasts of the earth and all the birds of the air and all the creatures that move on the ground—everything
that has the breath of life in it—I give every green plant for food. (Gen. 1:29-30, NIV)
In other words, the Garden of Eden is pictured as a peaceful, vegetarian commune until moral evil entered the world and brought
natural evil with it. It seems, then, that the Free Will Defense might be adapted to rebut the logical problem of natural evil after
all.
Some might think that (MSR2) is simply too far-fetched to be taken seriously. [If you think (MSR2) is far-fetched, see Plantinga's
(1974, pp. 191-193) own suggestions about who is responsible for natural evil.] Natural disasters, it will be said, bear no essential
connection to human wrongdoing, so it is absurd to think that moral evil could somehow bring natural evil into the world. Moreover,
(MSR2) would have us believe that there were real persons named Adam and Eve and that they actually performed the misdeeds attributed
to them in the book of Genesis. (MSR2) seems to be asking us to believe things that only a certain kind of theist would believe.
The implausibility of (MSR2) is taken by some to be a serious defect.
7. Evaluating the Free Will Defense
What should we make of Plantinga's Free Will Defense? Does it succeed in solving the logical problem of evil as it pertains to
either moral or natural evil? In order to answer these questions, let's briefly consider what it would take for any response to the
logical problem of evil to be successful. Recall that the logical problem of evil can be summarized as the following claim:
(16) It is not possible for God and evil to co-exist.
When someone claims
(40) Situation x is impossible,
what is the least that you would have to prove in order to show that (40) is false? If you could point to an actual instance of the
type of situation in question, that would certainly prove that (40) is false. But you don't even need to trouble yourself with
finding an actual x. All you need is a possible x. The claim
(41) Situation x is possible
is the contradictory of (40). The two claims are logical opposites. If one is true, the other is false; if one is false, the other
is true. If you can show that x is merely possible, you will have refuted (40).
How would you go about finding a logically possible x? Philosophers claim that you only need to use your imagination. If you can
conceive of a state of affairs without there being anything contradictory about what you're imagining, then that state of affairs
must be possible. In a word, conceivability is your guide to possibility.
Since the logical problem of evil claims that it is logically impossible for God and evil to co-exist, all that Plantinga (or any
other theist) needs to do to combat this claim is to describe a possible situation in which God and evil co-exist. That situation
doesn't need to be actual or even realistic. Plantinga doesn’t need to have a single shred of evidence supporting the truth of his
suggestion. All he needs to do is give a logically consistent description of a way that God and evil can co-exist. Plantinga claims
God and evil could co-exist if God had a morally sufficient reason for allowing evil. He suggests that God's morally sufficient
reason might have something to do with humans being granted morally significant free will and with the greater goods this freedom
makes possible. All that Plantinga needs to claim on behalf of (MSR1) and (MSR2) is that they are logically possible (that
is, not
contradictory).
Does Plantinga's Free Will Defense succeed in describing a possible state of affairs in which God has a morally sufficient reason for
allowing evil? It certainly seems so. In fact, it appears that even the most hardened atheist must admit that (MSR1) and (MSR2) are
possible reasons God might have for allowing moral and natural evil. They may not represent God's actual reasons, but for the
purpose of blocking the logical problem of evil, it is not necessary that Plantinga discover God's actual reasons. In the last
section we noted that many people will find (MSR2)'s explanation of natural evil extremely difficult to believe because it assumes
the literal existence of Adam and Eve and the literal occurrence of the Fall. However, since (MSR2) deals with the logical problem
of evil as it pertains to natural evil (which claims that it is logically impossible for God and natural evil to co-exist), it only
needs to sketch a possible way for God and natural evil to co-exist. The fact that (MSR2) may be implausible does not keep it from
being possible. Since the situation described by (MSR2) is clearly possible, it appears that it successfully rebuts the logical
problem of evil as it pertains to natural evil.
Since (MSR1) and (MSR2) together seem to show contra the claims of the logical problem of evil how it is possible for God and (moral
and natural) evil to co-exist, it seems that the Free Will Defense successfully defeats the logical problem of evil.
8. Was Plantinga's Victory Too Easy?
Some philosophers feel that Plantinga's apparent victory over the logical problem of evil was somehow too easy. His solution to
the logical problem of evil leaves them feeling unsatisfied and suspicious that they have been taken in by some kind of sleight of
hand. For example, J. L. Mackie one of the most prominent atheist philosophers of the mid-twentieth-century and a key exponent of
the logical problem of evil has this to say about Plantinga's Free Will Defense:
Since this defense is formally [that is, logically] possible, and its principle involves no real abandonment of our ordinary view of the
opposition between good and evil, we can concede that the problem of evil does not, after all, show that the central doctrines of
theism are logically inconsistent with one another. But whether this offers a real solution of the problem is another question.
(Mackie 1982, p. 154)
Mackie admits that Plantinga's defense shows how God and evil can co-exist, that
is, it shows that "the central doctrines of theism" are
logically consistent after all. However, Mackie is reluctant to attribute much significance to Plantinga's accomplishment. He
expresses doubt about whether Plantinga has adequately dealt with the problem of evil.
Part of Mackie's dissatisfaction probably stems from the fact that Plantinga only gives a possible reason for why God might have for
allowing evil and suffering and does not provide any evidence for his claims or in any way try to make them plausible. Although
sketching out mere possibilities without giving them any evidential support is typically an unsatisfactory thing to do in philosophy,
it is not clear that Mackie's unhappiness with Plantinga is completely warranted. It was, after all, Mackie himself who
characterized the problem of evil as one of logical inconsistency:
Here it can be shown, not that religious beliefs lack rational support, but that they are positively irrational, that several parts
of the essential theological doctrine are inconsistent with one another. (Mackie 1955, p. 200)
In response to this formulation of the problem of evil, Plantinga showed that this charge of inconsistency was mistaken. Even Mackie
admits that Plantinga solved the problem of evil, if that problem is understood as one of inconsistency. It is, therefore, difficult
to see why Plantinga's Free Will Defense should be found wanting if that defense is seen as a response to the logical problem of
evil. As an attempt to rebut the logical problem of evil, it is strikingly successful.
The dissatisfaction many have felt with Plantinga's solution may stem from a desire to see Plantinga’s Free Will Defense
respond more generally to the problem of evil and not merely to a single formulation of the problem. As an all-around response to
the problem of evil, the Free Will Defense does not offer us much in the way of explanation. It leaves several of the most important
questions about God and evil unanswered. The desire to see a theistic response to the problem of evil go beyond merely undermining a
particular atheological argument is understandable. However, we should keep in mind that all parties admit that Plantinga's Free
Will Defense successfully rebuts the logical problem of evil as it was formulated by atheists during the mid-twentieth-century.
If there is any blame that needs to go around, it may be that some of it should go to Mackie and other atheologians
for claiming that the problem of evil was a problem of inconsistency. The ease
with which Plantinga undermined that formulation of the problem suggests that
the logical formulation did not adequately capture the difficult and perplexing
issue concerning God and evil that has been so hotly debated by philosophers
and theologians. In fact, this is precisely the message that many philosophers
took away from the debate between Plantinga and the defenders of the logical
problem of evil. They reasoned that there must be more to the problem of evil
than what is captured in the logical formulation of the problem. It is now
widely agreed that this intuition is correct. Current discussions of the
problem focus on what is called "the probabilistic problem of evil" or "the
evidential problem of evil." According to this formulation
of the problem, the evil and suffering (or, in some cases, the amounts, kinds
and distributions of evil and suffering) that we find in the world count as
evidence against the existence of God (or make it improbable that God exists).
Responding to this formulation of the problem requires much more than simply
describing a logically possible scenario in which God and evil co-exist.
9. Other Responses to the Logical Problem of Evil
Plantinga's Free Will Defense has been the most famous theistic response to the logical problem of evil because he did more to
clarify the issues surrounding the logical problem than anyone else. It has not, however, been the only such response. Other
solutions to the problem include John Hick's (1977) soul-making theodicy. Hick rejects the traditional view of the Fall, which
pictures humans as being created in a finitely perfect and finished state from which they disastrously fell away. Instead, Hick
claims that human beings are unfinished and in the midst of being made all that God intended them to be. The long evolutionary
process made humans into a distinguishable species capable of reasoning and responsibility, but they must now (as individuals) go
through a second process of "spiritualization" or “soul-making,” during which they become “children of God.” According to Hick, the
suffering and travails of this life are part of the divine plan of soul-making. A world full of suffering, trials and temptations is
more conducive to the process of soul-making than a world full of constant pleasure and the complete absence of pain. Hick (1977,
pp. 255-256) writes,
The value-judgment that is implicitly being invoked here is that one who has attained to goodness by meeting and eventually mastering
temptations, and thus by rightly making responsible choices in concrete situations, is good in a richer and more valuable sense than
would be one created ab initio in a state either of innocence or of virtue…. I suggest, then, that it is an ethically reasonable
judgment… that human goodness slowly built up through personal histories of moral effort has a value in the eyes of the Creator which
justifies even the long travail of the soul-making process.
Unlike Plantinga's response to the logical problem of evil, which is merely a "defense" (that
is, a negative attempt to undermine a
certain atheological argument without offering a positive account of why God allows evil and suffering), Hick's response is a
"theodicy" (that is, a more comprehensive attempt to account for why God is justified in allowing evil and suffering).
Eleonore Stump (1985) offers another response to the problem of evil that brings a range of distinctively Christian theological
commitments to bear on the issue. She claims that a world full of evil and suffering is "conducive to bringing about both the
initial human [receipt of God's gift of salvation] and also the subsequent process of sanctification" (Stump 1985, p. 409). She
writes,
Natural evil—the pain of disease, the intermittent and unpredictable destruction of natural disasters, the decay of old age, the
imminence of death—takes away a person's satisfaction with himself. It tends to humble him, show him his frailty, make him reflect
on the transience of temporal goods, and turn his affections towards other-worldly things, away from the things of this world. No
amount of moral or natural evil, of course, can guarantee that a man will [place his faith in God].... But evil of this sort is the
best hope, I think, and maybe the only effective means, for bringing men to such a state. (Stump 1985, p. 409)
Stump claims that, although the sin of Adam—and not any act of God—first brought moral and natural evil into this world, God
providentially uses both kinds of evil in order to bring about the greatest good that a fallen, sinful human being can experience: a
repaired will and eternal union with God.
The responses of both Hick and Stump are intended to cover not only the logical problem of evil but also any other formulation of the
problem as well. Thus, some of those dissatisfied with Plantinga's merely defensive response to the problem of evil may find these
more constructive, alternative responses more attractive. Regardless of the details of these alternatives, the fact remains that all
they need to do in order to rebut the logical problem of evil is to describe a logically possible way that God and evil can co-exist.
A variety of morally sufficient reasons can be proposed as possible explanations of why a perfect God might allow evil and suffering
to exist. Because the suggestions of Hick and Stump are clearly logically possible, they, too, succeed in undermining the logical
problem of evil.
10. Problems with the Free Will Defense
A. Even though it is widely agreed that Plantinga's Free Will Defense describes a state of affairs that is logically
possible, some of the details of his defense seem to conflict with important theistic doctrines. One point of conflict concerns the
possibility of human free will in heaven. Plantinga claims that if someone is incapable of doing evil, that person cannot have
morally significant free will. He also maintains that part of what makes us the creatures we are is that we possess morally
significant freedom. If that freedom were to be taken away, we might very well cease to be the creatures we are. However, consider
the sort of freedom enjoyed by the redeemed in heaven. According to classical theism, believers in heaven will somehow be changed so
that they will no longer commit any sins. It is not that they will contingently always do what is right and contingently always
avoid what is wrong. They will somehow no longer be capable of doing wrong. In other words, their good behavior will be necessary
rather than contingent.
This orthodox view of heaven poses the following significant challenges to Plantinga's view:
(i) If heavenly dwellers do not possess morally significant free will and yet their existence is something of tremendous value, it is
not clear that God was justified in creating persons here on Earth with the capacity for rape, murder, torture, sexual molestation,
and nuclear war. It seems that God could have actualized whatever greater goods are made possible by the existence of persons
without allowing horrible instances of evil and suffering to exist in this world.
(ii) If possessing morally significant free will is essential to human nature, it is not clear how the redeemed can lose their morally
significant freedom when they get to heaven and still be the same people they were before.
(iii) If despite initial appearances heavenly dwellers do possess morally significant free will, then it seems that it is not
impossible for God to create genuinely free creatures who always (of necessity) do what is right.
In other words, it appears that
W3 isn't impossible after all. If W3 is possible, an important plank in Plantinga’s Free Will Defense is
removed.
None of these challenges undermines the basic point established above that Plantinga's Free Will Defense successfully rebuts the
logical problem of evil. However, they reveal that some of the central claims of his defense conflict with other important theistic
doctrines. Although Plantinga claimed that his Free Will Defense offered merely possible and not necessarily actual reasons God
might have for allowing evil and suffering, it may be difficult for other theists to embrace his defense if it runs contrary to what
theism says is actually the case in heaven.
B. Another problem facing Plantinga's Free Will Defense concerns the question of God’s free will. God, it seems, is
incapable of doing anything wrong. Thus, it does not appear that, with respect to any choice of morally good and morally bad
options, God is free to choose a bad option. He seems constitutionally incapable of choosing (or even wanting) to do what is wrong.
According to Plantinga's description of morally significant free will, it does not seem that God would be significantly free.
Plantinga suggests that morally significant freedom is necessary in order for one's actions to be assessed as being morally good or
bad. But then it seems that God's actions could not carry any moral significance. They could never be praiseworthy. That certainly
runs contrary to central doctrines of theism.
If, as theists must surely maintain, God does possess morally significant freedom, then perhaps this sort of freedom does not
preclude an inability to choose what is wrong. But if it is possible for God to possess morally significant freedom and for him to
be unable to do wrong, then W3 once again appears to be possible after all. Originally, Plantinga claimed that
W3 is not a logically possible world because the description of that world is logically inconsistent. If W3 is
possible, then the complaint lodged by Flew and Mackie above that God could (and therefore should) have created a world full of
creatures who always did what is right is not answered.
There may be ways for Plantinga to resolve the difficulties sketched above, so that the Free Will Defense can be shown to be
compatible with theistic doctrines about heaven and divine freedom. As it stands, however, some important challenges to the Free
Will Defense remain unanswered. It is also important to note that, simply because Plantinga's particular use of free will in
fashioning a response to the problem of evil runs into certain difficulties, that does not mean that other theistic uses of free will
in distinct kinds of defenses or theodicies would face the same difficulties.
11. References and Further Reading
References
Clark, Kelly James. 1990. Return to Reason: A
Critique of Enlightenment Evidentialism and a Defense
of Reason and Belief in God. Grand Rapids, MI:
Eerdmans.
Flew, Anthony. 1955. "Divine Omnipotence and Human
Freedom." In Anthony Flew and Alasdair MacIntyre
(eds.) New Essays in Philosophical Theology.
New York: Macmillan.
Hick, John. 1977. Evil and the God of Love,
revised ed. New York: Harper & Row.
Küng, Hans. 1976. On Being a Christian, trans.
Edward Quinn. Garden City, New York: Doubleday.
Kushner, Harold S. 1981. When Bad Things Happen to
Good People. New York: Schocken Books.
Lewis, C. S. 1943. Mere Christianity. New York:
Macmillan.
Mackie, J. L. 1982. The Miracle of Theism.
Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Mackie, J. L. 1955. "Evil and Omnipotence."
Mind 64: 200-212.
Madden, Edward and Peter Hare. 1968. Evil and the
Concept of God. Springfield, IL: Charles C.
Thomas.
McCloskey, H. J. 1960. "God and Evil."
Philosophical Quarterly 10: 97-114.
Peterson, Michael L. 1998. God and Evil: An
Introduction to the Issues. Boulder, CO: Westview
Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1974. The Nature of
Necessary. Oxford: Oxford University Press.
Plantinga, Alvin. 1977. God, Freedom, and Evil.
Grand Rapids, MI: Eerdmans.
Strobel, Lee. 2000. The Case for Faith: A
Journalist Investigates the Toughest Objections to
Christianity. Grand Rapids, MI: Zondervan.
Stump, Eleonore. 1985. "The Problem of Evil." Faith
and Philosophy 2: 392-423.
Further Reading
Adams, Robert Merrihew and Marilyn McCord Adams, eds.
1990. The Problem of Evil. Oxford: Oxford
University Press.
Howard-Snyder, Daniel, ed. 1996. The Evidential
Argument from Evil. Bloomington, IN: Indiana
University Press.
Peterson, Michael L., ed. 1992. The Problem of
Evil: Selected Readings. Notre Dame, IN:
University of Notre Dame Press.
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