A fallacy is a kind of error in reasoning. The alphabetical list below contains 176 names of the most common fallacies, and it provides explanations and examples of each of them. Fallacies should not be persuasive, but they often are. Fallacies may be created unintentionally, or they may be created intentionally in order to deceive other people. The vast majority of the commonly identified fallacies involve arguments, although some involve explanations, or definitions, or other products of reasoning. Sometimes the term "fallacy" is used even more broadly to indicate any false belief or cause of a false belief. The list below includes some fallacies of these sorts, but most are fallacies that involve kinds of errors made while arguing informally in natural language.  The discussion that precedes the list begins with an account of the ways in which the term "fallacy" is vague.  Attention then turns to the number of competing and overlapping ways to classify fallacies of argumentation.  For pedagogical purposes, researchers in the field of fallacies disagree about the following topics: which name of a fallacy is more helpful to students' understanding; whether some fallacies should be de-emphasized in favor of others; and which is the best taxonomy of the fallacies.  Researchers in the field are also deeply divided about how to define the term "fallacy" itself, how to define certain fallacies, and whether any general theory of fallacies at all should be pursued if that theory's goal is to provide necessary and sufficient conditions for distinguishing between fallacious and non-fallacious reasoning generally. Analogously, there is doubt in the field of ethics regarding whether researchers should pursue the goal of providing necessary and sufficient conditions for distinguishing moral actions from immoral ones. Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article) 1. Introduction 2. Taxonomy of Fallacies 3. Pedagogy 4. What is a fallacy? 5. Other Controversies 6. Partial List of Fallacies Abusive Ad Hominem Accent Accident Ad Baculum Ad Consequentiam Ad Crumenum Ad Hoc Rescue Ad Hominem Ad Ignorantiam Ad Misericordiam Ad Novitatem Ad Numerum Ad Populum Ad Verecundiam Affirming the Consequent Against the Person Amphiboly Anecdotal Evidence Anthropomorphism Appeal to Authority Appeal to Consequence Appeal to Emotions Appeal to Force Appeal to Ignorance Appeal to the Masses Appeal to Money Appeal to the People Appeal to Pity Appeal to Snobbery Appeal to Vanity Appeal to Unqualified Authority Argument from Outrage Argument from Popularity Argumentum Ad .... Avoiding the Issue Avoiding the Question Bald Man Bandwagon Begging the Question Biased Sample Biased Statistics Bifurcation Black-or-White Cherry-Picking the Evidence Circular Reasoning Circumstantial Ad Hominem Clouding the Issue Common Belief Common Cause. Common Practice Complex Question Composition Confirmation Bias Consensus Gentium Consequence Converse Accident Cover-up Cum Hoc, Ergo Propter Hoc Definist Denying the Antecedent Digression Distraction Division Domino Double Standard Either/Or Equivocation Etymological Every and All Exaggeration Excluded Middle False Analogy False Cause False Dichotomy False Dilemma Far-Fetched Hypothesis Faulty Comparison Formal Four Terms Gambler's Genetic Group Think Guilt by Association Hasty Conclusion Hasty Generalization Heap Hedging Hooded Man Ignoratio Elenchi Ignoring a Common Cause Incomplete Evidence Inconsistency Intensional Invalid Reasoning Irrelevant Conclusion Irrelevant Reason Is-Ought Jumping to Conclusions Lack of Proportion Line-Drawing Loaded Language Logical Lying Maldistributed Middle Many Questions Misconditionalization Misleading Vividness Misplaced Concreteness Misrepresentation Missing the Point Modal Monte Carlo Name Calling Naturalistic Neglecting a Common Cause No Middle Ground No True Scotsman Non Causa Pro Causa Non Sequitur One-Sidedness Outrage, Argument from Oversimplification Past Practice Pathetic Perfectionist Persuasive Definition Petitio Principii Poisoning the Well Popularity, Argument from Post Hoc Prejudicial Language Questionable Analogy Questionable Cause Questionable Premise Quibbling Quoting out of Context Rationalization Red Herring Refutation by Caricature Regression Reversing Causation Scapegoating Scare Tactic Scope Secundum Quid Selective Attention Self-Fulfilling Prophecy Sharpshooter's Slanting Slippery Slope Small Sample Smear Tactic Smokescreen Sorites Special Pleading Specificity Stacking the Deck Stereotyping Straw Man Style Over Substance Subjectivist Superstitious Thinking Suppressed Evidence Sweeping Generalization Syllogistic Tokenism Traditional Wisdom Tu Quoque Two Wrongs Make a Right Undistributed Middle Unfalsifiability Unrepresentative Sample Untestability Weak Analogy Willed ignorance Wishful Thinking 7. References and Further Reading 1. Introduction The first known systematic study of fallacies was due to Aristotle in his De Sophisticis Elenchis (Sophistical Refutations), an appendix to the Topics. He listed thirteen types. After the Dark Ages, fallacies were again studied systematically in Medieval Europe.  This is why so many fallacies have Latin names. The third major period of study of the fallacies began in the later twentieth century due to renewed interest from the disciplines of philosophy, logic, communication studies, rhetoric, psychology, and artificial intelligence. The more frequent the error within public discussion and debate the more likely it is to have a name. That is one reason why there is no specific name for the fallacy of subtracting five from thirteen and concluding that the answer is seven, though the error is common among elementary school children. The term "fallacy" is not a precise term. One reason is that it is ambiguous. It can refer either to (a) a kind of error in an argument, (b) a kind of error in reasoning (including arguments, definitions, explanations, and so forth), (c) a false belief, or (d) the cause of any of the previous errors including what are normally referred to as "rhetorical techniques". Philosophers who are researchers in fallacy theory prefer to emphasize (a), but their lead is often not followed in textbooks and public discussion. Regarding (d), ill health, being a bigot, being hungry, being stupid, and being hypercritical of our enemies are all sources of error in reasoning, so they could qualify as fallacies of kind (d), but they are not included in the list below. On the other hand, wishful thinking, stereotyping, being superstitious, rationalizing, and having a poor sense of proportion are sources of error and are included in the list below, though they wouldn't be included in a list devoted only to faulty arguments. Thus there is a certain arbitrariness to what appears in lists such as this. What have been left off the list below are the following persuasive techniques commonly used to influence others and to cause errors in reasoning: apple polishing, exaggerating, inappropriately assigning of the burden of proof, promising a proof without producing it, using propaganda techniques, ridiculing, being sarcastic, selecting terms with strong negative or positive associations, using innuendo, and weasling. All of the techniques are worth knowing about if one wants to avoid the fallacies. In describing the fallacies below, the custom is followed of not distinguishing between a reasoner committing a fallacy and the reasoning itself committing the fallacy, though it would be more accurate to say that a reasoner commits the fallacy and the reasoning contains the fallacy. In the list below, the examples are very short. If they were long, the article would be too long. Nevertheless real arguments are often embedded within a very long discussion. Richard Whately, one of the greatest of the 19th century researchers into informal logic, wisely said, "A very long discussion is one of the most effective veils of Fallacy; ...a Fallacy, which when stated barely...would not deceive a child, may deceive half the world if diluted in a quarto volume." Back to Table of Contents 2. Taxonomy of Fallacies There are a number of competing and overlapping ways to classify fallacies of argumentation. For example, they can be classified as either formal or informal. A formal fallacy can be detected by examining the logical form of the reasoning, whereas an informal fallacy depends upon the content of the reasoning and possibly the purpose of the reasoning. The list below contains very few formal fallacies. Fallacious arguments also can be classified as deductive or inductive, depending upon whether the fallacious argument is most properly assessed by deductive standards or instead by inductive standards. Deductive standards demand deductive validity, but inductive standards require inductive strength such as making the conclusion more likely.  Fallacies can be divided into categories according to the psychological factors that lead people to commit them, and they can also be divided into categories according to the epistemological or logical factors that cause the error.  In the latter division there are three categories: (1) the reasoning is invalid but is presented as if it were a valid argument, or else it is inductively much weaker than it is presented as being, (2) the argument has an unjustified premise, or (3) some relevant evidence has been ignored or suppressed.  Regarding (2), a premise can be justified or warranted at a time even if we later learn that the premise was false, and it can be justified if we are reasoning about what would have happened even when we know it didn't happen. Similar fallacies are often grouped together under a common name intended to bring out how the fallacies are similar. Here are three examples.  Fallacies of relevance include fallacies that occur due to reliance on an irrelevant reason. In addition, ad hominem, appeal to pity, and affirming the consequent are some other fallacies of relevance. Accent, amphiboly and equivocation are examples of fallacies of ambiguity. The fallacies of illegitimate presumption include begging the question, false dilemma, no true Scotsman, complex question and suppressed evidence.  Notice how these categories don't fall neatly into just one of the categories (1), (2), and (3) above. Back to Table of Contents 3. Pedagogy For pedagogical purposes, researchers in the field of fallacies disagree about the following topics: which name of a fallacy is more helpful to students' understanding; whether some fallacies should be de-emphasized in favor of others; and which is the best taxonomy of the fallacies. Fallacy theory is criticized by some teachers of informal reasoning for its emphasis on poor reasoning rather than good. Do colleges teach the Calculus by emphasizing all the ways one can make mathematical mistakes? The critics want more emphasis on the forms of good arguments and on the implicit rules that govern proper discussion designed to resolve a difference of opinion.  But there has been little systematic study of which emphasis is more successful. Back to Table of Contents 4. What is a fallacy? Researchers disagree about how to define the very term "fallacy". Focusing just on fallacies in sense (a) above, namely fallacies of argumentation, some researchers define a fallacy as an argument that is deductively invalid or that has very little inductive strength. Because examples of false dilemma, inconsistent premises, and begging the question are valid arguments in this sense, this definition misses some standard fallacies. Other researchers say a fallacy is a mistake in an argument that arises from something other than merely false premises.  But the false dilemma fallacy is due to false premises.  Still other researchers define a fallacy as an argument that is not good. Good arguments are then defined as those that are deductively valid or inductively strong, and that contain only true, well-established premises, but are not question-begging. A complaint with this definition is that its requirement of truth would improperly lead to calling too much scientific reasoning fallacious; every time a new scientific discovery caused scientists to label a previously well-established claim as false, all the scientists who used that claim as a premise would become fallacious reasoners. This consequence of the definition is acceptable to some researchers but not to others. Because informal reasoning regularly deals with hypothetical reasoning and with premises for which there is great disagreement about whether they are true or false, many researchers would relax the requirement that every premise must be true. One widely accepted definition defines a fallacious argument as one that either is deductively invalid or is inductively very weak or contains an unjustified premise or that ignores relevant evidence that is available and that should be known by the arguer. Finally, yet another theory of fallacy says a fallacy is a failure to provide adequate proof for a belief, the failure being disguised to make the proof look adequate. Other researchers recommend characterizing a fallacy as a violation of the norms of good reasoning, the rules of critical discussion, dispute resolution, and adequate communication. The difficulty with this approach is that there is so much disagreement about how to characterize these norms. In addition, all the above definitions are often augmented with some remark to the effect that the fallacies are likely to persuade many reasoners. It is notoriously difficult to be very precise about this vague and subjective notion of being likely to persuade, and some researchers in fallacy theory have therefore recommended dropping the notion in favor of "can be used to persuade." Some researchers complain that all the above definitions of fallacy are too broad and do not distinguish between mere blunders and actual fallacies, the more serious errors. Researchers in the field are deeply divided, not only about how to define the term "fallacy" and how to define some of the individual fallacies, but also about whether any general theory of fallacies at all should be pursued if that theory's goal is to provide necessary and sufficient conditions for distinguishing between fallacious and non-fallacious reasoning generally. Analogously, there is doubt in the field of ethics whether researchers should pursue the goal of providing necessary and sufficient conditions for distinguishing moral actions from immoral ones. Back to Table of Contents 5. Other Controversies In the field of rhetoric, the primary goal is to persuade the audience. The audience is not going to be persuaded by an otherwise good argument with true premises unless they believe those premises are true. Philosophers tend to de-emphasize this difference between rhetoric and informal logic, and they concentrate on arguments that should fail to convince the ideally rational reasoner rather than on arguments that are likely not to convince audiences who hold certain background beliefs. Advertising in magazines and on television is designed to achieve visual persuasion. And a hug or the fanning of fumes from freshly baked donuts out onto the sidewalk are occasionally used for visceral persuasion. There is some controversy among researchers in informal logic as to whether the reasoning involved in this nonverbal persuasion can always be assessed properly by the same standards that are used for verbal reasoning. Back to Table of Contents 6. Partial List of Fallacies Consulting the list below will give a general idea of the kind of error involved in passages to which the fallacy name is applied. However, simply applying the fallacy name to a passage cannot substitute for a detailed examination of the passage and its context or circumstances because there are many instances of reasoning to which a fallacy name might seem to apply, yet, on further examination, it is found that in these circumstances the reasoning is really not fallacious. Back to Table of Contents Abusive Ad Hominem See Ad Hominem. Back to Table of Contents Accent The accent fallacy is a fallacy of ambiguity due to the different ways a word is emphasized or accented. Example: A member of Congress is asked by a reporter if she is in favor of the President's new missile defense system, and she responds, "I'm in favor of a missile defense system that effectively defends America." With an emphasis on the word "favor", this remark is likely to favor the President's missile defense system. With an emphasis, instead, on the words "effectively defends", this remark is likely to be against the President's missile defense system. Aristotle's fallacy of accent allowed only a shift in which syllable is accented within a word. Back to Table of Contents Accident We often arrive at a generalization but don't or can't list all the exceptions. When we reason with the generalization as if it has no exceptions, we commit the fallacy of accident. This fallacy is sometimes called the fallacy of sweeping generalization. Example: People should keep their promises, right? I loaned Dwayne my knife, and he said he'd return it. Now he is refusing to give it back, but I need it right now to slash up my neighbors' families. Dwayne isn't doing right by me. People should keep their promises, but there are exceptions as in this case of the psychopath who wants Dwayne to keep his promise to return the knife. Back to Table of Contents Ad Baculum See Scare Tactic and Appeal to Emotions (Fear). Back to Table of Contents Ad Consequentiam See Appeal to Consequence. Back to Table of Contents Ad Crumenum See Appeal to Money. Back to Table of Contents Ad Hoc Rescue Psychologically, it is understandable that you would try to rescue a cherished belief from trouble. When faced with conflicting data, you are likely to mention how the conflict will disappear if some new assumption is taken into account. However, if there is no good reason to accept this saving assumption other than that it works to save your cherished belief, your rescue is an ad hoc rescue. Example: Yolanda: If you take four of these tablets of vitamin C every day, you will never get a cold. Juanita: I tried that last year for several months, and still got a cold. Yolanda: Did you take the tablets every day? Juanita: Yes. Yolanda: Well, I'll bet you bought some bad tablets. The burden of proof is definitely on Yolanda's shoulders to prove that Juanita's vitamin C tablets were probably "bad" -- that is, not really vitamin C. If Yolanda can't do so, her attempt to rescue her hypothesis (that vitamin C prevents colds) is simply a dogmatic refusal to face up to the possibility of being wrong. Back to Table of Contents Ad Hominem You commit this fallacy if you make an irrelevant attack on the arguer and suggest that this attack undermines the argument itself. It is a form of the Genetic Fallacy. Example: What she says about Johannes Kepler's astronomy of the 1600's must be just so much garbage. Do you realize she's only fourteen years old? This attack may undermine the arguer's credibility as a scientific authority, but it does not undermine her reasoning. That reasoning should stand or fall on the scientific evidence, not on the arguer's age or anything else about her personally. If the fallacious reasoner points out irrelevant circumstances that the reasoner is in, the fallacy is a circumstantial ad hominem. Tu Quoque and Two Wrongs Make a Right are other types of the ad hominem fallacy. The major difficulty with labeling a piece of reasoning as an ad hominem fallacy is deciding whether the personal attack is relevant. For example, attacks on a person for their actually immoral sexual conduct are irrelevant to the quality of their mathematical reasoning, but they are relevant to arguments promoting the person for a leadership position in the church. Unfortunately, many attacks are not so easy to classify, such as an attack pointing out that the candidate for church leadership, while in the tenth grade, intentionally tripped a fellow student and broke his collar bone. Back to Table of Contents Ad Ignorantiam See Appeal to Ignorance. Back to Table of Contents Ad Misericordiam See Appeal to Emotions. Back to Table of Contents Ad Novitatem See Bandwagon. Back to Table of Contents Ad Numerum See Appeal to the People. Back to Table of Contents Ad Populum See Appeal to the People. Back to Table of Contents Ad Verecundiam See Appeal to Authority. Back to Table of Contents Affirming the Consequent If you have enough evidence to affirm the consequent of a conditional and then suppose that as a result you have sufficient reason for affirming the antecedent, you commit the fallacy of affirming the consequent. This formal fallacy is often mistaken for modus ponens, which is a valid form of reasoning also using a conditional. A conditional is an if-then statement; the if-part is the antecedent, and the then-part is the consequent. The following argument affirms the consequent that she does speaks Portuguese. Example: If she's Brazilian, then she speaks Portuguese. Hey, she does speak Portuguese. So, she is Brazilian. If the arguer believes or suggests that the premises definitely establish that she is Brazilian, then the arguer is committing the fallacy. See the non sequitur fallacy for more discussion of this point. Back to Table of Contents Against the Person See Ad Hominem. Back to Table of Contents Amphiboly This is an error due to taking a grammatically ambiguous phrase in two different ways during the reasoning. Example: In a cartoon, two elephants are driving their car down the road in India. They say, "We've better not get out here," as they pass a sign saying: ELEPHANTS PLEASE STAY IN YOUR CAR Upon one grammatical construction of the sign, the pronoun "YOUR" refers to the elephants in the car, but on another construction it refers to those humans who are driving cars in the vicinity. Unlike equivocation, which is due to multiple meanings of a phrase, amphiboly is due to syntactic ambiguity, ambiguity caused by alternative ways of taking the grammar. Back to Table of Contents Anecdotal Evidence If you discount evidence arrived at by systematic search or by testing in favor of a few firsthand stories, you are committing the fallacy of overemphasizing anecdotal evidence. Example: Yeah, I've read the health warnings on those cigarette packs and I know about all that health research, but my brother smokes, and he says he's never been sick a day in his life, so I know smoking can't really hurt you. Back to Table of Contents Anthropomorphism This is the error of projecting uniquely human qualities onto something that isn't human. Usually this occurs with projecting the human qualities onto animals, but when it is done to nonliving things, as in calling the storm cruel, the pathetic fallacy is created. There is also, but less commonly, called the Disney Fallacy or the Walt Disney Fallacy. Example: My dog is wagging his tail and running around me. Therefore, he knows that I love him. The fallacy would be averted if the speaker had said "My dog is wagging his tail and running around me. Therefore, he is happy to see me." Animals are likely to have some human emotions, but not the ability to ascribe knowledge to other beings. Your dog knows where it buried its bone, but not that you also know where the bone is. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Authority You appeal to authority if you back up your reasoning by saying that it is supported by what some authority says on the subject. Most reasoning of this kind is not fallacious. However, it is fallacious whenever the authority appealed to is not really an authority in this subject, when the authority cannot be trusted to tell the truth, when authorities disagree on this subject (except for the occasional lone wolf), when the reasoner misquotes the authority, and so forth. Although spotting a fallacious appeal to authority often requires some background knowledge about the subject or the authority, in brief it can be said that it is fallacious to accept the word of a supposed authority when we should be suspicious. Example: You can believe the moon is covered with dust because the president of our neighborhood association said so, and he should know. This is a fallacious appeal to authority because, although the president is an authority on many neighborhood matters, he is no authority on the composition of the moon. It would be better to appeal to some astronomer or geologist. If you place too much trust in expert opinion and overlook any possibility that experts talking in their own field of expertise make mistakes, too, then you also commit the fallacy of appeal to authority. Example: Of course she's guilty of the crime. The police arrested her, didn't they? And they're experts when it comes to crime. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Consequence Arguing that a belief is false because it implies something you'd rather not believe. Also called Argumentum Ad Consequentiam. Example: That can't be Senator Smith there in the videotape going into her apartment. If it were, he'd be a liar about not knowing her. He's not the kind of man who would lie. He's a member of my congregation. Smith may or may not be the person in that videotape, but this kind of arguing should not convince us that it's someone else in the videotape. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Emotions You commit the fallacy of appeal to emotions when someone's appeal to you to accept their claim is accepted merely because the appeal arouses your feelings of anger, fear, grief, love, outrage, pity, pride, sexuality, sympathy, relief, and so forth. Example of appeal to relief from grief: [The speaker knows he is talking to an aggrieved person whose house is worth much more than $100,000.] You had a great job and didn't deserve to lose it. I wish I could help somehow. I do have one idea. Now your family needs financial security even more. You need cash. I can help you. Here is a check for $100,000. Just sign this standard sales agreement, and we can skip the realtors and all the headaches they would create at this critical time in your life. There is nothing wrong with using emotions when you argue, but it's a mistake to use emotions as the key premises or as tools to downplay relevant information.  Regarding the fallacy of appeal to pity, it is proper to pity people who have had misfortunes, but if as the person's history instructor you accept Max's claim that he earned an A on the history quiz because he broke his wrist while playing in your college's last basketball game, then you've committed the fallacy of appeal to pity. However, if you realize he didn't earn the A, but nevertheless you still give him an A, then you have not committed the fallacy, but you may have acted improperly. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Force See Scare Tactic. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Ignorance The fallacy of appeal to ignorance comes in two forms: (1) Not knowing that a certain statement is true is taken to be a proof that it is false. (2) Not knowing that a statement is false is taken to be a proof that it is true. The fallacy occurs in cases where absence of evidence is not good enough evidence of absence. The fallacy uses an unjustified attempt to shift the burden of proof. The fallacy is also called "Argument from Ignorance." Example: Nobody has ever proved to me there's a God, so I know there is no God. This kind of reasoning is generally fallacious. It would be proper reasoning only if the proof attempts were quite thorough, and it were the case that if God did exist, then there would be a discoverable proof of this. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to the Masses See Appeal to the People. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Money The fallacy of appeal to money uses the error of supposing that, if something costs a great deal of money, then it must be better, or supposing that if someone has a great deal of money, then they're a better person in some way unrelated to having a great deal of money. Similarly it's a mistake to suppose that if something is cheap it must be of inferior quality, or to suppose that if someone is poor financially then they're poor at something unrelated to having money. Example: He's rich, so he should be the president of our Parents and Teachers Organization. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to the People If you suggest too strongly that someone's claim or argument is correct simply because it's what most everyone believes, then you've committed the fallacy of appeal to the people. Similarly, if you suggest too strongly that someone's claim or argument is mistaken simply because it's not what most everyone believes, then you've also committed the fallacy. Agreement with popular opinion is not necessarily a reliable sign of truth, and deviation from popular opinion is not necessarily a reliable sign of error, but if you assume it is and do so with enthusiasm, then you're guilty of committing this fallacy. It is also called mob appeal, appeal to the gallery, argument from popularity, and argumentum ad populum. The 'too strongly' is important in the description of the fallacy because what most everyone believes is, for that reason, somewhat likely to be true, all things considered. However, the fallacy occurs when this degree of support is overestimated. Example: You should turn to channel 6. It's the most watched channel this year. This is fallacious because of its implicitly accepting the questionable premise that the most watched channel this year is, for that reason alone, the best channel for you. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Pity See Appeal to Emotions. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Snobbery See Appeal to Emotions. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Unqualified Authority See Appeal to Authority. Back to Table of Contents Appeal to Vanity See Appeal to Emotions. Back to Table of Contents Argument from Outrage See Appeal to Emotions. Back to Table of Contents Argument from Popularity See Appeal to the People. Back to Table of Contents Argumentum Ad .... See Ad .... without the word "Argumentum." Back to Table of Contents Avoiding the Issue A reasoner who is supposed to address an issue but instead goes off on a tangent has committed the fallacy of avoiding the issue. Also called missing the point, straying off the subject, digressing, and not sticking to the issue. Example: A city official is charged with corruption for awarding contracts to his wife's consulting firm. In speaking to a reporter about why he is innocent, the city official talks only about his wife's conservative wardrobe, the family's lovable dog, and his own accomplishments in supporting Little League baseball. However, the fallacy isn't committed by a reasoner who says that some other issue must first be settled and then continues by talking about this other issue, provided the reasoner is correct in claiming this dependence of one issue on the other. Back to Table of Contents Avoiding the Question The fallacy of avoiding the question is a type of fallacy of avoiding the issue that occurs when the issue is how to answer some question. The fallacy is committed when someone's answer doesn't really respond to the question asked. Example: Question: Would the Oakland Athletics be in first place if they were to win tomorrow's game? Answer: What makes you think they'll ever win tomorrow's game? Back to Table of Contents Bald Man See Line-Drawing. Back to Table of Contents Bandwagon If you suggest that someone's claim is correct simply because it's what most everyone is coming to believe, then you're committing the bandwagon fallacy. Get up here with us on the wagon where the band is playing, and go where we go, and don't think too much about the reasons. The Latin term for this fallacy of appeal to novelty is Argumentum ad Novitatem. Example: [Advertisement] More and more people are buying sports utility vehicles. Isn't it time you bought one, too? [You commit the fallacy if you buy the vehicle solely because of this advertisement.] Like its close cousin, the fallacy of appeal to the people, the bandwagon fallacy needs to be carefully distinguished from properly defending a claim by pointing out that many people have studied the claim and have come to a reasoned conclusion that it is correct. What most everyone believes is likely to be true, all things considered, and if one defends a claim on those grounds, this is not a fallacious inference. What is fallacious is to be swept up by the excitement of a new idea or new fad and to unquestionably give it too high a degree of your belief solely on the grounds of its new popularity, perhaps thinking simply that 'new is better.' Back to Table of Contents Begging the Question A form of circular reasoning in which a conclusion is derived from premises that presuppose the conclusion. Normally, the point of good reasoning is to start out at one place and end up somewhere new, namely having reached the goal of increasing the degree of reasonable belief in the conclusion. The point is to make progress, but in cases of begging the question there is no progress. Example: "Women have rights," said the Bullfighters Association president. "But women shouldn't fight bulls because a bullfighter is and should be a man." The president is saying basically that women shouldn't fight bulls because women shouldn't fight bulls. This reasoning isn't making an progress toward determining whether women should fight bulls. Insofar as the conclusion of a deductively valid argument is "contained" in the premises from which it is deduced, this containing might seem to be a case of presupposing, and thus any deductively valid argument might seem to be begging the question. It is still an open question among logicians as to why some deductively valid arguments are considered to be begging the question and others are not. Some logicians suggest that, in informal reasoning with a deductively valid argument, if the conclusion is psychologically new insofar as the premises are concerned, then the argument isn't an example of the fallacy. Other logicians suggest that we need to look instead to surrounding circumstances, not to the psychology of the reasoner, in order to assess the quality of the argument. For example, we need to look to the reasons that the reasoner used to accept the premises. Was the premise justified on the basis of accepting the conclusion? A third group of logicians say that, in deciding whether the fallacy is committed, we need more. We must determine whether any premise that is key to deducing the conclusion is adopted rather blindly or instead is a reasonable assumption made by someone accepting their burden of proof. The premise would here be termed reasonable if the arguer could defend it independently of accepting the conclusion that is at issue. Back to Table of Contents Biased Sample See Unrepresentative Sample. Back to Table of Contents Biased Statistics See Unrepresentative Sample. Back to Table of Contents Back to Table of Contents Bifurcation See Black-or-White. Back to Table of Contents Black-or-White The black-or-white fallacy is a false dilemma fallacy that unfairly limits you to only two choices. Example: Well, it's time for a decision. Will you contribute $10 to our environmental fund, or are you on the side of environmental destruction? A proper challenge to this fallacy could be to say, "I do want to prevent the destruction of our environment, but I don't want to give $10 to your fund. You are placing me between a rock and a hard place." The key to diagnosing the black-or-white fallacy is to determine whether the limited menu is fair or unfair. Simply saying, "Will you contribute $10 or won't you?" is not unfair. Back to Table of Contents Cherry-Picking the Evidence This is another name for the Fallacy of Suppressed Evidence. Back to Table of Contents Circular Reasoning Circular reasoning occurs when the reasoner begins with what he or she is trying to end up with. The most well known examples are cases of the fallacy of begging the question. However, if the circle is very much larger, including a wide variety of claims and a large set of related concepts, then the circular reasoning can be informative and so is not considered to be fallacious. For example, a dictionary contains a large circle of definitions that use words which are defined in terms of other words that are also defined in the dictionary. Because the dictionary is so informative, it is not considered as a whole to be fallacious. However, a small circle of definitions is considered to be fallacious. Example: Definition: A couch is a sofa. Definition: A sofa is a davenport. Definition: A davenport is a couch. For additional difficulties in deciding whether an argument is deficient because it is circular, see Begging the Question. Back to Table of Contents Circumstantial Ad Hominem See Ad Hominem. Back to Table of Contents Clouding the Issue See Smokescreen. Back to Table of Contents Common Belief See Appeal to the People and Traditional Wisdom. Back to Table of Contents Common Cause This fallacy occurs during causal reasoning when a causal connection between two kinds of events is claimed when evidence is available indicating that both are the effect of a common cause. Example: Noting that the auto accident rate rises and falls with the rate of use of windshield wipers, one concludes that the use of wipers is somehow causing auto accidents. However, it's the rain that's the common cause of both. Back to Table of Contents Common Practice See Appeal to the People and Traditional Wisdom. Back to Table of Contents Complex Question You commit this fallacy when you frame a question so that some controversial presupposition is made by the wording of the question. Example: [Reporter's question] Mr. President: Are you going to continue your policy of wasting taxpayer's money on missile defense? The question unfairly presumes the controversial claim that the policy really is a waste of money. The fallacy of complex question is a form of begging the question. Back to Table of Contents Composition The composition fallacy occurs when someone mistakenly assumes that a characteristic of some or all the individuals in a group is also a characteristic of the group itself, the group "composed" of those members. It is the converse of the division fallacy. Example: Each human cell is very lightweight, so a human being composed of cells is also very lightweight. Back to Table of Contents   Confirmation Bias The tendency to look only for evidence in favor of one's controversial hypothesis and not to look for disconfirming evidence, or to pay insufficient attention to it.  This is the most common kind of Fallacy of Selective Attention. Example: She loves me, and there are so many ways that she has shown it.  When we signed the divorce papers in her lawyer's office, she wore my favorite color.  When she slapped me at the bar and called me a "handsome pig," she used the word "handsome" when she didn't have to.  When I called her and she said never to call her again, she first asked me how I was doing and whether my life had changed.  When I suggested that we should have children in order to keep our marriage together, she laughed.  If she can laugh with me, if she wants to know how I am doing and whether my life has changed, and if she calls me "handsome" and wears my favorite color on special occasions, then I know she really loves me. Committing the fallacy of confirmation bias is often a sign that one has adopted some belief dogmatically and isn't seriously setting about to confirm or disconfirm the belief. Back to Table of Contents   Consensus Gentium Fallacy of argumentum consensus gentium (argument from the consensus of the nations). See Traditional Wisdom. Back to Table of Contents Consequence See Appeal to Consequence. Back to Table of Contents Converse Accident If we reason by paying too much attention to exceptions to the rule, and generalize on the exceptions, we commit this fallacy. This fallacy is the converse of the accident fallacy. It is a kind of Hasty Generalization. Example: I've heard that turtles live longer than tarantulas, but the one turtle I bought lived only two days. I bought it at Dowden's Pet Store. So, I think that turtles bought from pet stores do not live longer than tarantulas. The original generalization is "Turtles live longer than tarantulas." There are exceptions, such as the turtle bought from the pet store. Rather than seeing this for what it is, namely an exception, the reasoner places too much trust in this exception and generalizes on it to produce the faulty generalization that turtles bought from pet stores do not live longer than tarantulas. Back to Table of Contents Cover-up See Suppressed Evidence. Back to Table of Contents Cum Hoc, Ergo Propter Hoc Latin for "with this, therefore because of this." This is a false cause fallacy that doesn't depend on time order (as does the post hoc fallacy), but on any other chance correlation of the supposed cause being in the presence of the supposed effect. Example: Gypsies live near our low-yield cornfields. So, gypsies are causing the low yield. Back to Table of Contents Definist The definist fallacy occurs when someone unfairly defines a term so that a controversial position is made easier to defend.  Same as the Persuasive Definition. Example: During a controversy about the truth or falsity of atheism, the fallacious reasoner says, "Let's define 'atheist' as someone who doesn't yet realize that God exists." Back to Table of Contents Denying the Antecedent You are committing a fallacy if you deny the antecedent of a conditional and then suppose that doing so is a sufficient reason for denying the consequent. This formal fallacy is often mistaken for modus tollens, a valid form of argument using the conditional. A conditional is an if-then statement; the if-part is the antecedent, and the then-part is the consequent. Example: If she were Brazilian, then she would know that Brazil's official language is Portuguese. She isn't Brazilian; she's from London. So, she surely doesn't know this about Brazil's language. Back to Table of Contents Digression See Avoiding the Issue. Back to Table of Contents Distraction See Smokescreen. Back to Table of Contents Division Merely because a group as a whole has a characteristic, it often doesn't follow that individuals in the group have that characteristic. If you suppose that it does follow, when it doesn't, you commit the fallacy of division. It is the converse of the composition fallacy. Example: Joshua's soccer team is the best in the division because it had an undefeated season and shared the division title, so Joshua, who is their goalie, must be the best goalie in the division. Back to Table of Contents Domino See Slippery Slope. Back to Table of Contents Double Standard There are many situations in which you should judge two things or people by the same standard. If in one of those situations you use different standards for the two, you commit the fallacy of using a double standard. Example: I know we will hire any man who gets over a 70 percent on the screening test for hiring Post Office employees, but women should have to get an 80 to be hired because they often have to take care of their children. This example is a fallacy if it can be presumed that men and women should have to meet the same standard for becoming a Post Office employee. Back to Table of Contents Either/Or See Black-or-White. Back to Table of Contents Equivocation Equivocation is the illegitimate switching of the meaning of a term during the reasoning. Example: Brad is a nobody, but since nobody is perfect, Brad must be perfect, too. The term "nobody" changes its meaning without warning in the passage.  So does the term "political jokes" in this joke: I don't approve of political jokes. I've seen too many of them get elected. Back to Table of Contents Etymological The etymological fallacy occurs whenever someone falsely assumes that the meaning of a word can be discovered from its etymology or origins. Example: The word "vise" comes from the Latin "that which winds", so it means anything that winds. Since a hurricane winds around its own eye, it is a vise. Back to Table of Contents Every and All The fallacy of every and all turns on errors due to the order or scope of the quantifiers "every" and "all" and "any." This is a version of the scope fallacy. Example: Every action of ours has some final end. So, there is some common final end to all our actions. In proposing this fallacious argument, Aristotle believed the common end is the supreme good, so he had a rather optimistic outlook on the direction of history. Back to Table of Contents Exaggeration When we overstate or overemphasize a point that is a crucial step in a piece of reasoning, then we are guilty of the fallacy of exaggeration.  This is a kind of error called Lack of Proportion. Example: She's practically admitted that she intentionally yelled at that student while on the playground in the fourth grade.  That's assault.  Then she said nothing when the teacher asked, "Who did that?"  That's lying, plain and simple.  Do you want to elect as secretary of this society someone who is a known liar prone to assault?  Doing so would be a disgrace to the Collie Society. When we exaggerate in order to make a joke, though, we aren't guilty of the fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Excluded Middle See False Dilemma or Black-or-White. Back to Table of Contents False Analogy When reasoning by analogy, the fallacy occurs when the analogy is irrelevant or very weak or when there is a more relevant disanalogy. See also Faulty Comparison. Example: The book Investing for Dummies really helped me understand my finances better. The book Chess for Dummies was written by the same author, was published by the same press, and costs about the same amount.  So, this chess book would probably help me understand my finances. Back to Table of Contents False Cause Improperly concluding that one thing is a cause of another. The Fallacy of Non Causa Pro Causa is another name for this fallacy. Its four principal kinds are the Post Hoc Fallacy, the Fallacy of Cum Hoc, Ergo Propter Hoc, the Regression Fallacy, and the Fallacy of Reversing Causation. Example: My psychic adviser says to expect bad things when Mars is aligned with Jupiter. Tomorrow Mars will be aligned with Jupiter. So, if a dog were to bite me tomorrow, it would be because of the alignment of Mars with Jupiter. Back to Table of Contents False Dichotomy See False Dilemma or Black-or-White. Back to Table of Contents False Dilemma A reasoner who unfairly presents too few choices and then implies that a choice must be made among this short menu of choices commits the false dilemma fallacy, as does the person who accepts this faulty reasoning. Example: I want to go to Scotland from London. I overheard McTaggart say there are two roads to Scotland from London: the high road and the low road.  I expect the high road is dangerous because it's through the hills. But it's raining, so both roads are probably slippery.  I don't like either choice, but I guess I should take the low road. This would be fine reasoning is you were limited to only two roads, but you've falsely gotten yourself into a dilemma with such reasoning. There are many other ways to get to Scotland. Don't limit yourself to these two choices. You can take other roads, or go by boat or train or airplane. Think of the unpleasant choice as a charging bull.  By demanding other choices beyond those on the unfairly limited menu, you thereby "go between the horns" of the dilemma, and are not gored.  For another example of the fallacy, see  Black-or-White. Back to Table of Contents Far-Fetched Hypothesis This is the fallacy of offering a bizarre (far-fetched) hypothesis as the correct explanation without first ruling out more mundane explanations. Example: Look at that mutilated cow in the field, and see that flattened grass. Aliens must have landed in a flying saucer and savaged the cow to learn more about the beings on our planet. Back to Table of Contents Faulty Comparison If you try to make a point about something by comparison, and if you do so by comparing it with the wrong thing, you commit the fallacy of faulty comparison or the fallacy of questionable analogy. Example: We gave half the members of the hiking club Durell hiking boots and the other half good-quality tennis shoes. After three months of hiking, you can see for yourself that Durell lasted longer. You, too, should use Durell when you need hiking boots. Shouldn't Durell hiking boots be compared with other hiking boots, not with tennis shoes? Back to Table of Contents Formal Formal fallacies are all the cases or kinds of reasoning that fail to be deductively valid. Formal fallacies are also called logical fallacies or invalidities. Example: Some cats are tigers. Some tigers are animals. So, some cats are animals. This might at first seem to be a good argument, but actually it is fallacious because it has the same logical form as the following more obviously invalid argument: Some women are Americans.  Some Americans are men.  So, some women are men. Nearly all the infinity of types of invalid inferences have no specific fallacy names. Back to Table of Contents Four Terms The fallacy of four terms (quaternio terminorum) occurs when four rather than three categorical terms are used in a standard-form syllogism. Example: All rivers have banks. All banks have vaults. So, all rivers have vaults. The word "banks" occurs as two distinct terms, namely river bank and financial bank, so this example also is an equivocation. Without an equivocation, the four term fallacy is trivially invalid. Back to Table of Contents Gambler's This fallacy occurs when the gambler falsely assumes that the history of outcomes will affect future outcomes. Example: I know this is a fair coin, but it has come up heads five times in a row now, so tails is due on the next toss. The fallacious move was to conclude that the probability of the next toss coming up tails must be more than a half. The assumption that it's a fair coin is important because, if the coin comes up heads five times in a row, one would otherwise become suspicious that it's not a fair coin and therefore properly conclude that the probably is high that heads is more likely on the next toss. Back to Table of Contents Genetic A critic commits the genetic fallacy if the critic attempts to discredit or support a claim or an argument because of its origin (genesis) when such an appeal to origins is irrelevant. Example: Whatever your reasons are for buying that DVD they've got to be ridiculous. You said yourself that you got the idea for buying it from last night's fortune cookie. Cookies can't think! Fortune cookies are not reliable sources of information about what DVD to buy, but the reasons the person is willing to give are likely to be quite relevant and should be listened to. The speaker is committing the genetic fallacy by paying too much attention to the genesis of the idea rather than to the reasons offered for it. An ad hominem fallacy is one kind of genetic fallacy, but the genetic fallacy in our passage isn't an ad hominem. If I learn that your plan for building the shopping center next to the Johnson estate originated with Johnson himself, who is likely to profit from the deal, then my pointing out to the planning commission the origin of the deal would be relevant in their assessing your plan. Because not all appeals to origins are irrelevant, it sometimes can be difficult to decide if the fallacy has been committed. For example, if Sigmund Freud shows that the genesis of a person's belief in God is their desire for a strong father figure, then does it follow that their belief in God is misplaced, or does this reasoning commit the genetic fallacy? Back to Table of Contents Group Think A reasoner commits the group think fallacy if he or she substitutes pride of membership in the group for reasons to support the group's policy. If that's what our group thinks, then that's good enough for me. It's what I think, too. "Blind" patriotism is a rather nasty version of the fallacy. Example: We K-Mart employees know that K-Mart brand items are better than Wall-Mart brand items because, well, they are from K-Mart, aren't they? Back to Table of Contents Guilt by Association Guilt by association is a version of the ad hominem fallacy in which a person is said to be guilty of error because of the group he or she associates with. Example: Secretary of State Dean Acheson is soft on communism as you can see by the fuzzy-headed liberals who come to his White House cocktail parties and the bleeding hearts of his Democratic Party who call for "moderation and constraint" against Soviet terror. Has any evidence been presented here that Acheson's actions are inappropriate in regards to communism? This sort of reasoning is an example of McCarthyism, the technique of smearing liberal Democrats that was so effectively used by the late Senator Joe McCarthy in the early 1950s. In fact, Acheson was strongly anti-communist and the architect of President Truman's firm policy of containing Soviet power. Back to Table of Contents Hasty Conclusion See Jumping to Conclusions. Back to Table of Contents Hasty Generalization A hasty generalization is a fallacy of jumping to conclusions in which the conclusion is a generalization. See also Biased Statistics. Example: I've met two people in Nicaragua so far, and they were both nice to me. So, all people I will meet in Nicaragua will be nice to me. Back to Table of Contents Heap See Line-Drawing. Back to Table of Contents Hedging You are hedging if you refine your claim simply to avoid counterevidence and then act as if your revised claim is the same as the original. Example: Samantha: David is a totally selfish person. Yvonne: I thought we was a boy scout leader. Don’t you have to give a lot of your time for that? Samantha: Well, David’s totally selfish about what he gives money to. He won’t spend a dime on anyone else. Yvonne: I saw him bidding on things at the high school auction fundraiser. Samantha: Well, except for that he’s totally selfish about money. You don’t commit the fallacy if you explicitly accept the counterevidence, admit that your original claim is incorrect, and then revise it so that it avoids that counterevidence. Back to Table of Contents   Hooded Man This is an error in reasoning due to confusing the knowing of a thing with the knowing of it under all its various names or descriptions. Example: You claim to know Socrates, but you must be lying. You admitted you didn't know the hooded man over there in the corner, but the hooded man is Socrates. Back to Table of Contents  Ignoratio Elenchi See Irrelevant Conclusion. Back to Table of Contents Ignoring a Common Cause See Common Cause. Back to Table of Contents Incomplete Evidence See Suppressed Evidence. Back to Table of Contents Inconsistency The fallacy occurs when we accept an inconsistent set of claims, that is, when we accept a claim that logically conflicts with other claims we hold. Example: I'm not racist. Some of my best friends are white. But I just don't think that white women love their babies as much as our women do. That last remark implies the speaker is a racist, although the speaker doesn't notice the inconsistency. Back to Table of Contents Intensional The mistake of treating different descriptions or names of the same object as equivalent even in those contexts in which the differences between them matter. Reporting someone's beliefs or assertions or making claims about necessity or possibility can be such contexts. In these contexts, replacing a description with another that refers to the same object is not valid and may turn a true sentence into a false one. Example: Michelle said she wants to meet her new neighbor Stalnaker tonight. But I happen to know Stalnaker is a spy for North Korea, so Michelle said she wants to meet a spy for North Korea tonight. Michelle said no such thing. The faulty reasoner illegitimately assumed that what is true of a person under one description will remain true when said of that person under a second description even in this context of indirect quotation. What was true of the person when described as “her new neighbor Stalnaker” is that Michelle said she wants to meet him, but it wasn’t legitimate for me to assume this is true of the same person when he is described as “a spy for North Korea.” Extensional contexts are those in which it is legitimate to substitute equals for equals with no worry. But any context in which this substitution of co-referring terms is illegitimate is called an intensional context. Intensional contexts are produced by quotation, modality, and intentionality (propositional attitudes). Intensionality is failure of extensionality, thus the name “intensional fallacy”. Back to Table of Contents Invalid Reasoning An invalid inference.  An argument can be assessed by deductive standards to see if the conclusion would have to be true if the premises were to be true.  If the argument cannot meet this standard, it is invalid. An argument is invalid only if it is not an instance of any valid argument form.  The fallacy of invalid reasoning is a formal fallacy. Example: If it's raining, then there are clouds in the sky. It's not raining. Therefore, there are no clouds in the sky. This invalid argument is an instance of denying the antecedent. Any invalid inference that is also inductively very weak is a non sequitur. Back to Table of Contents Irrelevant Conclusion If an arguer argues for a certain conclusion while falsely believing or suggesting that a different conclusion is established, one for which the first conclusion is irrelevant, then the arguer commits the fallacy of irrelevant conclusion. Example: In court, Thompson testifies that the defendant is a honorable person, who wouldn't harm a flea. The defense attorney rises to say that Thompson's testimony shows his client was not near the murder scene. The testimony of Thompson may be relevant to a request for leniency, but it is irrelevant to any claim about the defendant not being near the murder scene. Back to Table of Contents Irrelevant Reason This fallacy is a kind of non sequitur in which the premises are wholly irrelevant to drawing the conclusion. Example: Lao Tze Beer is the top selling beer in Thailand. So, it will be the best beer for Canadians. Back to Table of Contents Is-Ought The is-ought fallacy occurs when a conclusion expressing what ought to be so is inferred from premises expressing only what is so, in which it is supposed that no implicit or explicit ought-premises are need. There is controversy in the philosophical literature regarding whether this type of inference is always fallacious. Example: He's torturing the cat. So, he shouldn't do that. This argument clearly would not commit the fallacy if there were an implicit premise indicating that he is a person and persons shouldn't torture other beings. Back to Table of Contents Jumping to Conclusions When we draw a conclusion without taking the trouble to acquire all the relevant evidence, we commit the fallacy of jumping to conclusions, provided there was sufficient time to assess that extra evidence, and that the effort to get the evidence isn't prohibitive. Example: This car is really cheap. I'll buy it. Hold on. Before concluding that you should buy it, you ought to have someone check its operating condition, or else you should make sure you get a guarantee about the car's being in working order. And, if you stop to think about it, there may be other factors you should consider before making the purchase. Are size or appearance or gas mileage relevant? Back to Table of Contents Lack of Proportion Either exaggerating or downplaying a point that is a crucial step in a piece of reasoning is an example of the Fallacy of Lack of Proportion.  It's a mistake of not adopting the proper perspective.  An extreme form of downplaying occurs in the Fallacy of Suppressed Evidence. Example: Chandra just overheard the terrorists say that they are about to plant the bomb in the basement of the courthouse, after which they'll drive to the airport and get away.  But they won't be taking along their cat.  The poor cat.  The first thing that Chandra and I should do is to call the Humane Society and check the "Cat Wanted" section of the local newspapers to see if we can find a proper home for the cat. Back to Table of Contents Line-Drawing If we improperly reject a vague claim because it's not as precise as we'd like, then we commit the line-drawing fallacy. Being vague is not being hopelessly vague. Also called the Bald Man Fallacy, the Fallacy of the Heap and the Sorites Fallacy. Example: Dwayne can never grow bald. Dwayne isn't bald now. Don't you agree that if he loses one hair, that won't make him go from not bald to bald? And if he loses one hair after that, then this one loss, too, won't make him go from not bald to bald. Therefore, no matter how much hair he loses, he can't become bald. Back to Table of Contents Loaded Language Loaded language is emotive terminology that expresses value judgments. When used in what appears to be an objective description, the terminology unfortunately can cause the listener to adopt those values when in fact no good reason has been given for doing so. Also called Prejudicial Language. Example: [News broadcast] In today's top stories, Senator Smith carelessly cast the deciding vote today to pass both the budget bill and the trailer bill to fund yet another excessive watchdog committee over coastal development. This broadcast is an editorial posing as a news report. Back to Table of Contents Logical See Formal. Back to Table of Contents Lying A fallacy of reasoning that depends on intentionally saying something that is known to be false. If the lying occurs in an argument's premise, then it is an example of the fallacy of questionable premise. Example: Abraham Lincoln, Theodore Roosevelt, and John Kennedy were assassinated. They were U.S. presidents. Therefore, at least three U.S. presidents have been assassinated. Roosevelt was never assassinated. Back to Table of Contents Maldistributed Middle See Undistributed Middle. Back to Table of Contents Many Questions See Complex Question. Back to Table of Contents Misconditionalization See Modal Fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Misleading Vividness When the fallacy of jumping to conclusions is committed due to a special emphasis on an anecdote or other piece of evidence, then the fallacy of misleading vividness has occurred. Example: Yes, I read the side of the cigarette pack about smoking being harmful to your health. That's the Surgeon General's opinion, him and all his statistics. But let me tell you about my uncle. Uncle Harry has smoked cigarettes for forty years now and he's never been sick a day in his life. He even won a ski race at Lake Tahoe in his age group last year. You should have seen him zip down the mountain. He smoked a cigarette during the award ceremony, and he had a broad smile on his face. I was really proud. I can still remember the cheering. Cigarette smoking can't be as harmful as people say. The vivid anecdote is the story about Uncle Harry. Too much emphasis is placed on it and not enough on the statistics from the Surgeon General. Back to Table of Contents   Misplaced Concreteness Mistakenly supposing that something is a concrete object with independent existence, when it's not. Example: There are two footballs lying on the floor of an otherwise empty room. When asked to count all the objects in the room, John says there are three: the two balls plus the group of two. John mistakenly supposed a group or set of concrete objects is also a concrete object. Back to Table of Contents   Misrepresentation If the misrepresentation occurs on purpose, then it is an example of lying. If the misrepresentation occurs during a debate in which there is misrepresentation of the opponent's claim, then it would be the cause of a straw man fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Missing the Point See Irrelevant Conclusion. Back to Table of Contents Modal This is the error of treating modal conditionals as if the modality applies only to the consequent of the conditional. "The" modal fallacy is the most well known of the infinitely many errors involving modal concepts, concepts such as necessity, possibility and so forth. A conditional is an if-then proposition. The consequent is the then-part, and the antecedent is the if-part. Example: If a proposition is true, then it can not be false. But if a proposition can not be false, then it is not only true but necessarily true. Therefore, if a proposition is true, then it's necessarily true. The acceptable interpretation of the first premise, requires the modality to apply to the entire conditional in the sense that it really means "It's not possible that if a proposition is true, then it's false." However, the entire inference works only if the first premise is miscontrued as saying "If a proposition is true, then it is necessary that it's not false." To see that the misconstrual is unacceptable, pick a proposition such as "It's raining in Detroit." Let's suppose it actually is raining in Detroit. So, the antecedent of the misconstrual is true, but the consequent isn't, because it says "It is necessary that 'it's raining in Detroit' is not false." This isn't necessary, is it? Back to Table of Contents Monte Carlo See Gambler's Fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Name Calling See Ad Hominem. Back to Table of Contents Naturalistic On a broad interpretation of the fallacy, it is said to apply to any attempt to argue from an "is" to an "ought," that is, to argue directly from a list of facts to a claim about what ought to be done. Example: Owners of financially successful companies are more successful than poor people in the competition for wealth, power and social status. Therefore, these owners are morally better than poor people, and the poor deserve to be poor. The fallacy would also occur if one argued from the natural to the moral as follows: since women are naturally capable of bearing and nursing children, they ought to be the primary caregivers of children. There is considerable disagreement among philosophers regarding what sorts of arguments the term "Naturalistic Fallacy" applies to, and even whether it is a fallacy at all. Back to Table of Contents Neglecting a Common Cause See Common Cause. Back to Table of Contents No Middle Ground See False Dilemma. Back to Table of Contents No True Scotsman This error is a kind of ad hoc rescue of one's generalization in which the reasoner re-characterizes the situation solely in order to escape refutation of the generalization. Example: Smith: All Scotsmen are loyal and brave. Jones: But McDougal over there is a Scotsman, and he was arrested by his commanding officer for running from the enemy. Smith: Well, if that's right, it just shows that McDougal wasn't a TRUE Scotsman. Back to Table of Contents Non Causa Pro Causa This label is Latin for mistaking the "non-cause for the cause." See False Cause. Back to Table of Contents Non Sequitur When a conclusion is supported only by extremely weak reasons or by irrelevant reasons, the argument is fallacious and is said to be a non sequitur. However, we usually apply the term only when we cannot think of how to label the argument with a more specific fallacy name. Any deductively invalid inference is a non sequitur if it also very weak when assessed by inductive standards. Example: Nuclear disarmament is a risk, but everything in life involves a risk. Every time you drive in a car you are taking a risk. If you're willing to drive in a car, you should be willing to have disarmament. The following is not an example: "If she committed the murder, then there'd be his blood stains on her hands. His blood stains are on her hands. So, she committed the murder." This deductively invalid argument commits the fallacy of affirming the consequent, but it isn't a non sequitur because it has significant inductive strength. Back to Table of Contents One-Sidedness See Slanting and Suppressed Evidence. Back to Table of Contents Oversimplification You oversimplify when you cover up relevant complexities or make a complicated problem appear to be too much simpler than it really is. Example: President Bush wants our country to trade with Fidel Castro's Communist Cuba. I say there should be a trade embargo against Cuba. The issue in our election is Cuban trade, and if you are against it, then you should vote for me for president. Whom to vote for should be decided by considering quite a number of issues in addition to Cuban trade. When an oversimplification results in falsely implying that a minor causal factor is the major one, then the reasoning also commits the false cause fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Past Practice See Traditional Wisdom. Back to Table of Contents Pathetic The pathetic fallacy is a mistaken belief due to attributing peculiarly human qualities to inanimate objects (but not to animals). The fallacy is caused by anthropomorphism. Example: Aargh, it won't start again. This old car always breaks down on days when I have a job interview. It must be afraid that if I get a new job, then I'll be able to afford a replacement, so it doesn't want me to get to my interview on time. Back to Table of Contents Persuasive Definition Some people try to win their arguments by getting you to accept their faulty definition.  If you buy into their definition, they've practically persuaded you already.   Same as the Definist Fallacy.  Poisoning the Well when presenting a definition would be an example of a using persuasive definition.  Example: Let's define a Democrat as a leftist who desires to overtax the corporations and abolish freedom in the economic sphere. Back to Table of Contents Perfectionist If you remark that a proposal or claim should be rejected solely because it doesn't solve the problem perfectly, in cases where perfection isn't really required, then you've committed the perfectionist fallacy. Example: You said hiring a house cleaner would solve our cleaning problems because we both have full-time jobs. Now, look what happened. Every week she unplugs the toaster oven and leaves it that way. I should never have listened to you about hiring a house cleaner. Back to Table of Contents Petitio Principii See Begging the Question. Back to Table of Contents Poisoning the Well Poisoning the well is a preemptive attack on a person in order to discredit their testimony or argument in advance of their giving it. A person who thereby becomes unreceptive to the testimony reasons fallaciously and has become a victim of the poisoner. This is a kind of ad hominem. Example: [Prosecuting attorney in court] When is the defense attorney planning to call that twice-convicted child molester, David Barnington, to the stand? OK, I'll rephrase that. When is the defense attorney planning to call David Barnington to the stand? Back to Table of Contents Post Hoc Suppose we notice that an event of kind A is followed in time by an event of kind B, and then hastily leap to the conclusion that A caused B. If so, we commit the post hoc fallacy. Correlations are often good evidence of causal connection, so the fallacy occurs only when the leap to the causal conclusion is done "hastily." The Latin term for the fallacy is post hoc, ergo propter hoc ("After this, therefore because of this"). It is a kind of false cause fallacy. Example: I ate in that Ethiopian restaurant three days ago and now I've just gotten food poisoning. The only other time I've eaten in an Ethiopian restaurant I also got food poisoning, but that time I got sick a week later. My eating in those kinds of restaurants is causing my food poisoning. Your background knowledge should tell you this is unlikely because the effects of food poisoning are felt soon after the food is eaten. Before believing your illness was caused by eating in an Ethiopian restaurant, you'd need to rule out other possibilities, such as your illness being caused by what you ate a few hours before the onset of the illness. Back to Table of Contents Prejudicial Language See Loaded Language. Back to Table of Contents Questionable Analogy See False Analogy. Back to Table of Contents Questionable Cause See False Cause. Back to Table of Contents Questionable Premise If you have sufficient background information to know that a premise is questionable or unlikely to be acceptable, then you commit this fallacy if you accept an argument based on that premise. This broad category of fallacies of argumentation includes appeal to authority, false dilemma, inconsistency, lying, stacking the deck, straw man, suppressed evidence, and many others. Back to Table of Contents Quibbling We quibble when we complain about a minor point and falsely believe that this complaint somehow undermines the main point. To avoid this error, the logical reasoner will not make a mountain out of a mole hill nor take people too literally. Example: I've found typographical errors in your poem, so the poem is neither inspired nor perceptive. Back to Table of Contents Quoting out of Context If you quote someone, but select the quotation so that essential context is not available and therefore the person's views are distorted, then you've quoted "out of context." Quoting out of context in an argument creates a straw man fallacy. Example: Smith: I've been reading about a peculiar game in this article about vegetarianism. When we play this game, we lean out from a fourth-story window and drop down strings containing "Free food" signs on the end in order to hook unsuspecting passers-by. It's really outrageous, isn't it? Yet isn't that precisely what sports fishermen do for entertainment from their fishing boats? The article says it's time we put an end to sport fishing. Jones: Let me quote Smith for you. He says "We...hook unsuspecting passers-by." What sort of moral monster is this man Smith? Jones's selective quotation is fallacious because it makes Smith appear to advocate this immoral activity when the context makes it clear that he doesn't. Back to Table of Contents Rationalization We rationalize when we inauthentically offer reasons to support our claim. We are rationalizing when we give someone a reason to justify our action even though we know this reason is not really our own reason for our action, usually because the offered reason will sound better to the audience than our actual reason. Example: "I bought the matzo bread from Kroger's Supermarket because it is the cheapest brand and I wanted to save money," says Alex [who knows he bought the bread from Kroger's Supermarket only because his girlfriend works there]. Back to Table of Contents Red Herring A red herring is a smelly fish that would distract even a bloodhound. It is also a digression that leads the reasoner off the track of considering only relevant information. Example: Will the new tax in Senate Bill 47 unfairly hurt business? One of the provisions of the bill is that the tax is higher for large employers (fifty or more employees) as opposed to small employers (six to forty-nine employees). To decide on the fairness of the bill, we must first determine whether employees who work for large employers have better working conditions than employees who work for small employers. Bringing up the issue of working conditions is the red herring. Back to Table of Contents Refutation by Caricature See Ad Hominem. Back to Table of Contents Regression This fallacy occurs when regression to the mean is mistaken for a sign of a causal connection. Also called the Regressive Fallacy. It is a kind of false cause fallacy. Example: You are investigating the average heights of groups of Americans. You sample some people from Chicago and determine their average height. You have the figure for the mean height of Americans and notice that your Chicagoans have an average height that differs from this mean. Your second sample of the same size is from people from Miami. When you find that this group's average height is closer to the American mean height [as it is very likely to be due to common statistical regression to the mean], you falsely conclude that there must be something causing Miamians rather than Chicagoans be more like the average American. There is most probably nothing causing Miamians to be more like the average American; but rather what is happening is that averages are regressing to the mean. Back to Table of Contents Reversing Causation Drawing an improper conclusion about causation due to a causal assumption that reverses cause and effect. A kind of false cause fallacy. Example: All the corporate officers of Miami Electronics and Power have big boats. If you're ever going to become an officer of MEP, you'd better get a bigger boat. The false assumption here is that having a big boat helps cause you to be an officer in MEP, whereas the reverse is true. Being an officer causes you to have the high income that enables you to purchase a big boat. Back to Table of Contents Scapegoating If you unfairly blame an unpopular person or group of people for a problem, then you are scapegoating. This is a kind of fallacy of appeal to emotions. Example: Augurs were official diviners of ancient Rome. During the pre-Christian period, when Christians were unpopular, an augur would make a prediction for the emperor about, say, whether a military attack would have a successful outcome. If the prediction failed to come true, the augur would not admit failure but instead would blame nearby Christians for their evil influence on his divining powers. The elimination of these Christians, the augur would claim, could restore his divining powers and help the emperor. By using this reasoning tactic, the augur was scapegoating the Christians. Back to Table of Contents Scare Tactic If you suppose that terrorizing your opponent is giving him a reason for believing that you are correct, you are using a scare tactic and reasoning fallaciously. Example: David: My father owns the department store that gives your newspaper fifteen percent of all its advertising revenue, so I'm sure you won't want to publish any story of my arrest for spray painting the college. Newspaper editor: Yes, David, I see your point. The story really isn't newsworthy. David has given the editor a financial reason not to publish, but he has not given a relevant reason why the story is not newsworthy. David's tactics are scaring the editor, but it's the editor who commits the scare tactic fallacy, not David. David has merely used a scare tactic. This fallacy's name emphasizes the cause of the fallacy rather than the error itself. See also the related fallacy of appeal to emotions. Back to Table of Contents Scope The scope fallacy is caused by improperly changing or misrepresenting the scope of a phrase. Example: Every concerned citizen who believes that someone living in the US is a terrorist should make a report to the authorities. But Shelley told me herself that she believes there are terrorists living in the US, yet she hasn't made any reports. So, she must not be a concerned citizen. The first sentence has ambiguous scope. It was probably originally meant in this sense: Every concerned citizen who believes (of someone that this person is living in the US and is a terrorist) should make a report to the authorities. But the speaker is clearly taking the sentence in its other, less plausible sense: Every concerned citizen who believes (that there is someone or other living in the US who is a terrorist) should make a report to the authorities. Scope fallacies usually are amphibolies. Back to Table of Contents Secundum Quid See Accident and Converse Accident, two versions of the fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Selective Attention Improperly focusing attention on certain things and ignoring others.  Example: Father: Justine, how was your school day today?  Another C on the history test like last time? Justine: Dad, I got an A- on my history test today.  Isn't that great?  Only one student got an A. Father: I see you weren't the one with the A.  And what about the math quiz? Justine: I think I did OK, better than last time. Father: If you really did well, you'd be sure.  What I'm sure of is that today was a pretty bad day for you. The pessimist who pays attention to all the bad news and ignores the good news thereby commits the fallacy of selective attention.  The remedy for this fallacy is to pay attention to all the relevant evidence.  The most common examples of selective attention are the fallacy of Suppressed Evidence and the fallacy of Confirmation Bias. See also the Sharpshooter's Fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Self-Fulfilling Prophecy The fallacy occurs when the act of prophesying will itself produce the effect that is prophesied, but the reasoner doesn't recognize this and believes the prophesy is a significant insight. Example: A group of students are selected to be interviewed individually by the teacher. Each selected student is told that the teacher has predicted they will do significantly better in their future school work. Actually, though, the teacher has no special information about the students and has picked the group at random. If the students believe this prediction about themselves, then, given human psychology, it is likely that they will do better merely because of the teacher's making the prediction. The prediction will fulfill itself, so to speak, and the students commit the fallacy. This fallacy can be dangerous in an atmosphere of potential war between nations when the leader of a nation predicts that their nation will go to war against their enemy. This prediction could very well precipitate an enemy attack because the enemy calculates that if war is inevitable then it is to their military advantage not to get caught by surprise. Back to Table of Contents Sharpshooter's The sharpshooter's fallacy gets its name from someone shooting a rifle at the side of the barn and then going over and drawing a target and bulls eye concentrically around the bullet hole.  The fallacy is caused by overemphasizing random results or making selective use of coincidence. See the Fallacy of Selective Attention. Example: Psychic Sarah makes twenty-six predictions about what will happen next year.  When one, but only one, of the predictions comes true, she says, "Aha!  I can see into the future."   Back to Table of Contents Slanting This error occurs when the issue is not treated fairly because of misrepresenting the evidence by, say, suppressing part of it, or misconstruing some of it, or simply lying. See the following fallacies: Lying, Misrepresentation, Questionable Premise, Quoting out of Context, Straw Man, Suppressed Evidence. Back to Table of Contents Slippery Slope Suppose someone claims that a first step (in a chain of causes and effects, or a chain of reasoning) will probably lead to a second step that in turn will probably lead to another step and so on until a final step ends in trouble. If the likelihood of the trouble occurring is exaggerated, the slippery slope fallacy is committed. Example: Mom: Those look like bags under your eyes. Are you getting enough sleep? Jeff: I had a test and stayed up late studying. Mom: You didn't take any drugs, did you? Jeff: Just caffeine in my coffee, like I always do. Mom: Jeff! You know what happens when people take drugs! Pretty soon the caffeine won't be strong enough. Then you will take something stronger, maybe someone's diet pill. Then, something even stronger. Eventually, you will be doing cocaine. Then you will be a crack addict! So, don't drink that coffee. The form of a slippery slope fallacy looks like this: A leads to B. B leads to C. C leads to D. ... Z leads to HELL. We don't want to go to HELL. So, don't take that first step A. Think of the sequence A, B, C, D, ..., Z as a sequence of closely stacked dominoes. The key claim in the fallacy is that pushing over the first one will start a chain reaction of falling dominoes, each one triggering the next. But the analyst asks how likely is it really that pushing the first will lead to the fall of the last? For example, if A leads to B with a probability of 80 percent, and B leads to C with a probability of 80 percent, and C leads to D with a probability of 80 percent, is it likely that A will eventually lead to D? No, not at all; there is about a 50- 50 chance. The proper analysis of a slippery slope argument depends on sensitivity to such probabilistic calculations. Regarding terminology, if the chain of reasoning A, B, C, D, ..., Z is about causes, then the fallacy is called the Domino Fallacy. Back to Table of Contents Small Sample This is the fallacy of using too small a sample. If the sample is too small to provide a representative sample of the population, and if we have the background information to know that there is this problem with sample size, yet we still accept the generalization upon the sample results, then we commit the fallacy. This fallacy is the fallacy of hasty generalization, but it emphasizes statistical sampling techniques. Example: I've eaten in restaurants twice in my life, and both times I've gotten sick. I've learned one thing from these experiences: restaurants make me sick. How big a sample do you need to avoid the fallacy? Relying on background knowledge about