| Most of us are certain that we have
free will, though what exactly this amounts to is much less
certain. According to David Hume,
the question of the nature of free will is “the most
contentious question of metaphysics.” If this is correct, then
figuring out what free will is will be no small task
indeed. Minimally, to say that an agent has free will is to
say that the agent has the capacity to choose his or her
course of action. But animals seem to satisfy this criterion,
and we typically think that only persons, and not animals,
have free will. Let us then understand free will as the
capacity unique to persons that allows them to control their
actions. It is controversial whether this minimal
understanding of what it means to have a free will actually
requires an agent to have a specific faculty of will, whether
the term "free will" is simply shorthand for other features of
persons, and whether there really is such a thing as free will
at all.
This article considers why we should care about free will
and how freedom of will relates to freedom of action. It
canvasses a number of the dominant accounts of what the will
is, and then explores the persistent question of the
relationship between free will and causal determinism,
articulating a number of different positions one might take on
the issue. For example, does determinism imply that there is
no free will, as the incompatibilists argue, or does it allow
for free will, as the compatibilists argue? This article
explores several influential arguments that have been given in
favor of these two dominant positions on the relationship
between free will and causal determinism. Finally, there is a
brief examination of how free will relates to theological
determinism and logical determinism.
Table of Contents
(Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of
this article)
1. Free Will, Free
Action and Moral Responsibility
Why should we even care whether or not agents have free
will? Probably the best reason for caring is that free will is
closely related to two other important philosophical issues:
freedom of action and moral responsibility. However, despite
the close connection between these concepts, it is important
not to conflate them.
We most often think that an agent’s free actions are those
actions that she does as a result of exercising her free will.
Consider a woman, Allison, who is contemplating a paradigmatic
free action, such as whether or not to walk her dog. Allison
might say to herself, “I know I should walk the dog—he needs
the exercise. And while I don’t really want to walk him since
it is cold outside, I think overall the best decision to make
is that I should take him for a walk.” Thus, we see that one
reason we care about free will is that it seems necessary for
free action—Allison must first decide, or choose, to walk the
dog before she actually takes him outside for his walk. If we
assume that human actions are those actions that result from
the rational capacities of humans, we then see that the
possibility of free action depends on the possibility of free
will: to say that an agent acted freely is minimally to say
that the agent was successful in carrying out a free volition
or choice.
Various philosophers have offered just such an account of
freedom. Thomas Hobbes
suggested that freedom consists in there being no external
impediments to an agent doing what he wants to do: “A free
agent is he that can do as he will, and
forbear as he will, and that liberty is the absence
of external impediments.” In An Enquiry Concerning
Human Understanding, David Hume thought that free will (or
"liberty," to use his term) is simply the “power of acting or
of not acting, according to the determination of the will:
that is, if we choose to remain at rest, we may; if we choose
to move, we also may.… This hypothetical liberty is
universally allowed to belong to everyone who is not a
prisoner and in chains.” This suggests that freedom is simply
the ability to select a course of action, and an agent is free
if he is not being prevented by some external obstacle from
completing that course of action. Thus, Hobbes and Hume would
hold that Allison is free to walk her dog so long as nothing
prevents her from carrying out her decision to walk her dog,
and she is free not to walk her dog so long as nothing would
compel her to walk her dog if she would decide not to.
However, one might still believe this approach fails to
make an important distinction between these two related, but
conceptually distinct, kinds of freedom: freedom of will versus
freedom of action. This distinction is motivated by the
apparent fact that agents can possess free will without also
having freedom of action. Suppose that before Allison made the
choice to walk the dog, she was taking a nap. And while
Allison slept, there was a blizzard that moved through the
area. The wind has drifted the snow up against the front of
her house so that it is impossible for Allison to get out her
front door and walk her dog even if she wanted to. So here we
have a case involving free will, because Allison has chosen to
take the dog for a walk, but not involving free action,
because Allison is not able to take her dog for a walk.
Whether or not one can have freedom of action without free
will depends on one’s view of what free will is. Also, the
truth of causal determinism would not entail that agents lack
the freedom to do what they want to do. An agent could do what
she wants to do, even if she is causally determined to do that
action. Thus, both Hobbes and Hume are rightly characterized
as compatibilists.
Even if there is a distinction between freedom of will and
freedom of action, it appears that free will is necessary for
the performance of free actions. If Allison is brainwashed
during her nap to want to walk her dog, then even if no
external impediment prevents her from carrying through with
this decision, we would say that her taking the dog for a walk
is not a free action. Presumably, the reason why it would not
be a free action is because, in the case of brainwashing,
Allison’s decision does not arise from her free will. Thus, it
looks like free will might be a necessary condition for free
action, even if the two are distinct. In what follows, the
phrase "acting with free will" means engaging in an action as
the result of the utilization of free will. Use of the phrase
does not deny the distinction between free will and free
action.
The second reason to care about free will is that it seems
to be required for moral responsibility. While there are
various accounts of what exactly moral responsibility is, it
is widely agreed that moral responsibility is distinct from
causal responsibility. Consider a falling branch that lands on
a car, breaking its window. While the branch is causally
responsible for the broken window, it is not morally
responsible for it because branches are not moral agents.
Depending on one’s account of causation, it also might be
possible to be morally responsible for an event or state of
affairs even if one is not causally responsible for that same
event or state of affairs. For present purposes, let us simply
say that an agent is morally responsible for an event or state
of affairs only if she is the appropriate recipient of moral
praise or moral blame for that event or state of affairs (an
agent can thus be morally responsible even if no one,
including herself, actually does blame or praise her for her
actions). According to the dominant view of the relationship
between free will and moral responsibility, if an agent does
not have free will, then that agent is not morally responsible
for her actions. For example, if Allison is coerced into doing
a morally bad act, such as stealing a car, we shouldn’t hold
her morally responsible for this action since it is not an
action that she did of her own free will.
Some philosophers do not believe that free will is required
for moral responsibility. According to John Martin Fischer,
human agents do not have free will, but they are still morally
responsible for their choices and actions. In a nutshell,
Fischer thinks that the kind of control needed for moral
responsibility is weaker than the kind of control needed for
free will. Furthermore, he thinks that the truth of causal
determinism would preclude the kind of control needed for free
will, but that it wouldn’t preclude the kind of control needed
for moral responsibility. See Fischer (1994). As this example
shows, virtually every issue pertaining to free will is
contested by various philosophers.
However, many think that the significance of free will is
not limited to its necessity for free action and moral
responsibility. Various philosophers suggest that free will is
also a requirement for agency, rationality, the autonomy and
dignity of persons, creativity, cooperation, and the value of
friendship and love [see Anglin (1990), Kane (1998) and
Ekstrom (1999)]. We thus see that free will is central to many
philosophical issues.
2. Accounts of the Will
Nearly every major figure in the history of philosophy has
had something or other to say about free will. The present
section considers three of the most prominent theories of what
the will is.
a. Faculties Model of the Will
The faculties model of the will has its origin in the
writings of ancient philosophers such as Plato and Aristotle,
and it was the dominant view of the will for much of medieval
and modern philosophy [see Descartes (1998) and the discussion
of Aquinas in Stump (2003)]. It still has numerous proponents
in the contemporary literature. What is distinct about free
agents, according to this model, is their possession of
certain powers or capacities. All living things possess some
capacities, such as the capacities for growth and
reproduction. What is unique about free agents, however, is
that they also possess the capacities for intellection and
volition. Another way of saying this is that free agents alone
have the faculties of intellect and will. It is in virtue of
having these additional faculties, and the interaction between
them, that agents have free will.
The intellect, or the rational faculty, is the power of
cognition. As a result of its cognitions, the intellect
presents various things to the will as good under some
description. To return to the case of Allison contemplating
walking her dog, Allison’s intellect might evaluate walking
the dog as good for the health of the dog. Furthermore, all
agents that have an intellect also have a will. The will, or
the volitional faculty, is an appetite for the good; that is,
it is naturally drawn to goodness. The will, therefore, cannot
pursue an option that the intellect presents as good in no
way. The will is also able to command the other faculties; the
will can command the body to move or the intellect to consider
something. In the case of Allison, the will could command the
body to pick up the leash, attach it to the dog, and go
outside for a walk. As Aquinas, a
proponent of the this view of the will, puts it: “Only an
agent endowed with an intellect can act with a judgment which
is free, in so far as it apprehends the common note of
goodness; from which it can judge this or the other thing to
be good. Consequently, wherever there is intellect, there is
free will” (Summa Theologiae, q. 59 a. 3). Thus,
through the interaction between the intellect and will, an
agent has free will to pursue something that it perceives as
good.
b. Hierarchical Model of the Will
A widely influential contemporary account of the will is
Harry Frankfurt’s hierarchical view of the will [see Frankfurt
(1971)]. This account is also sometimes called a
"structuralist" or "mesh" account of the will, since a will is
free if it has a certain internal structure or "mesh" among
the various levels of desires and volitions. According to the
hierarchical model, agents can have different kinds of
desires. Some desires are desires to do a particular action;
for example, Allison may desire to go jogging. Call these
desires "1st order desires." But even if Allison doesn’t
desire to go jogging, she may nevertheless desire to be the
kind of person who desires to go jogging. In other words, she
may desire to have a certain 1st order desire. Call desires of
this sort "2nd order desires." If agents also have further
desires to have particular 2nd order desires, one could
construct a seemingly infinite hierarchy of desires.
Not all of an agent’s desires result in action. In fact, if
one has conflicting desires, then it is impossible for an
agent to satisfy all her desires. Suppose that Allison not
only desires to run, but that she also desires to stay curled
up in bed, where it is nice and warm. In such a case, Allison
cannot fulfill both of her 1st order desires. If Allison
decides to act on her desire to run, we say that her desire to
run has moved her to action. An effective desire of this sort
is called a volition; a volition is a desire that moves the
agent all the way to action. Similarly, one can differentiate
between a mere 2nd order desire (simply a desire to have a
certain desire) and a 2nd order volition (a desire for a
desire to become one’s will, or a desire for a desire to
become a volition). According to the hierarchical view of the
will, free will consists in having 2nd order volitions. In
other words, an agent has a free will if she is able to have
the sort of will that she wants to have. An agent acts on her
own free will if her action is the result of a 1st order
desire that she wants to become a 1st order volition.
Hierarchical views of the will are problematic, however,
because it looks as if certain sorts of questionable
manipulation can be compatible with this view’s account of
free will. According to the view under consideration, Allison
has free will with regard to going jogging if she has a 2nd
order desire that her 1st order desire to go jogging will
move her to go jogging. Nothing in this account, however,
depends on how she got these desires. Even if she were
manipulated, via brainwashing, for example, into having her
2nd order desire for her 1st order desire to go running become
her will, Allison has the right "mesh" between her various
orders of desires to qualify as having free will. This is an
untoward consequence. While more robust hierarchical accounts
of the will have the resources for explaining why Allison
might not be free in this case, it is widely agreed that cases
of manipulation and coercion are problematic for solely
structural accounts of the will [see Ekstrom (1999), Fischer
(1994), Kane, (2005), Pereboom (2001) and van Inwagen (1983)].
c. Reasons-Responsive View of the
Will
A third treatment of free will takes as its starting point
the claim that agency involves a sensitivity to certain
reasons. An agent acts with free will if she is responsive to
the appropriate rational considerations, and she does not act
with a free will if she lacks such responsiveness. To see what
such a view amounts to, consider again the case of Allison and
her decision to walk her dog. A reasons-responsive view of the
will says that Allison’s volition to walk her dog is free if,
had she had certain reasons for not walking her dog, she would
not have decided to walk her dog. Imagine what would have
happened had Allison turned on the television after waking
from her nap and learned of the blizzard before deciding to
walk her dog. Had she known of the blizzard, she would have
had a good reason for deciding not to walk her dog. Even if
such reasons never occur to her (that is, if she doesn’t learn
of the blizzard before her decision), her disposition to have
such reasons influence her volitions shows that she is
responsive to reasons. Thus, reasons-responsive views of the
will are essentially dispositional in nature.
Coercion and manipulation undermine free will, on this
view, in virtue of making agents not reasons-responsive. If
Allison has been brainwashed to walk the dog at a certain
time, then even if she were to turn on the news and sees that
it is snowing, she would attempt to walk the dog despite
having good reasons not to. Thus, manipulated agents are not
reasons-responsive, and in virtue of this lack free will. [See
Fischer and Ravizza (1998) for one of the primary
reasons-responsive views of free will.]
3. Free Will and Determinism
a. The Thesis of Causal Determinism
Most contemporary scholarship on free will focuses on
whether or not it is compatible with causal determinism.
Causal determinism is sometimes also called "nomological
determinism." It is important to keep causal determinism
distinct from other sorts of determinism,
such as logical determinism or theological determinism (to be
discussed below). Causal determinism (hereafter, simply
"determinism") is the thesis that the course of the future is
entirely determined by the conjunction of the past and the
laws of nature. Imagine a proposition that completely
describes the way that the entire universe was at some point
in the past, say 100 million years ago. Let us call this
proposition "P." Also imagine a proposition that expresses the
conjunction of all the laws of nature; call this proposition
"L." Determinism then is the thesis that the conjunction of P
and L entails a unique future. Given P and L, there is only
one possible future, one possible way for things to end up. To
make the same point using possible world semantics,
determinism is the thesis that all the states of affairs
that obtain at some time in the past, when conjoined with the
laws of nature, entail which possible world is the actual
world. Since a possible world includes those states of affairs
that will obtain, the truth of determinism amounts to the
thesis that the past and the laws of nature entail what states
of affairs will obtain in the future, and that only those
states of affairs entailed by the past and the laws will in
fact obtain.
A system's being determined is different from its being
predictable. It is possible for determinism to be true and for
no one to be able to predict the future.
The fact that no human agent knows or is able to know future
truths has no bearing on whether there are future truths
entailed by the conjunction of the past and the laws. However,
there is a weaker connection between the thesis of determinism
and the predictability of the future. If determinism were
true, then a being with a complete knowledge of P and L and
with sufficient intellective capacities should be able to
infallibly predict the way that the future will turn out.
However, given that we humans lack both the relevant knowledge
and the intellective capacities required, the fact that we are
not able to predict the future is not evidence for the falsity
of determinism.
b. Determinism, Science and "Near
Determinism"
Most philosophers agree that whether or not determinism is
true is a contingent matter; that is, determinism is neither
necessarily true nor necessarily false. If this is so, then
whether or not determinism is true becomes an empirical
matter, to be discovered by investigating the way the world
is, not through philosophical argumentation. This is not to
deny that the truth of determinism would have metaphysical
implications. For one, the truth of determinism would entail
that the laws of nature are not merely probabilistic—for if
they were, then the conjunction of the past and the laws would
not entail a unique future. Furthermore, as we shall see
shortly, philosophers care very much about what implications
the truth of determinism would have for free will. But the
point to note is that if the truth of determinism is a
contingent truth about the way the world actually is, then
scientific investigation should give us insight into this
matter. Let us say that a possible world is deterministic if
causal determinism is true in that world. There are two ways
that worlds could fail to be deterministic. As already noted,
if the laws of nature in a given world were probabilistic,
then such a world would not be deterministic. Secondly, if
there are entities within a world that are not fully governed
by the laws of nature, then even if those laws are themselves
deterministic, that world would not be deterministic.
Some scientists suggest that certain parts of physics give
us reason to doubt the truth of determinism. For example, the
standard interpretation of Quantum Theory, the Copenhagen
Interpretation, holds that the laws governing nature are
indeterministic and probabilistic. According to
this interpretation, whether or not a small particle such as
a quark swerves in a particular direction at a particular
time is described properly only by probabilistic equations.
Although the equations may predict the likelihood that a
quark swerves to the left at a certain time, whether or not
it actually swerves is indeterministic or random.
There are also deterministic interpretations of Quantum
Theory, such as the Many-Worlds Interpretation. Fortunately,
the outcome of the debate regarding whether Quantum Theory is
most properly interpreted deterministically or
indeterminstically, can be largely avoided for our current
purposes. Even if (systems of) micro-particles such as
quarks are indeterministic, it might be that (systems
involving) larger physical objects such as cars, dogs, and
people are deterministic. It is possible that the only
indeterminism is on the scale of micro-particles
and that macro-objects themselves obey deterministic laws. If
this is the case, then causal determinism as defined above is,
strictly speaking, false, but it is "nearly" true. That is, we
could replace determinism with "near determinism," the thesis
that despite quantum indeterminacy, the behaviors of all large
physical objects—including all our actions—obey deterministic
laws [see Honderich (2002), particularly chapter 6].
What would be the implications of the truth of either
determinism or near determinism? More specifically, what would
be the implications for questions of free will? One way to
think about the implications would be by asking the following
the question: could we still be free even if scientists were
to discover that causal determinism (or near determinism) is
true?
c. Compatibilism, Incompatibilism, and
Pessimism
The question at the end of the preceding section (Could we
have free will even if determinism is true?) is a helpful way to
differentiate the main positions regarding free will.
Compatibilists answer this question in the affirmative. They
believe that agents could have free will even if causal
determinism is true (or even if near determinism is true. In
what follows, I will omit this qualification). In other words,
the existence of free will in a possible world is compatible
with that world being deterministic. For this reason, this
position is known as "compatibilism," and its proponents are
called "compatibilists." According to the compatibilist, it is
possible for an agent to be determined in all her choices and
actions and still make some of her choices freely.
According to "incompatibilists," the existence of free will
is incompatible with the truth of determinism. If a given
possible world is deterministic, then no agent in that world
has free will for that very reason. Furthermore, if one
assumes that having free will is a necessary condition for
being morally responsible for one’s actions, then the
incompatibility of free will and determinism would entail the
incompatibility of moral responsibility and causal
determinism.
There are at least two kinds of incompatibilists. Some
incompatibilists think that determinism is true of the actual
world, and thus no agent in the actual world possesses free
will. Such incompatibilists are often called "hard
determinists" [see Pereboom (2001) for a defense of hard
determinism]. Other incompatibilists think that the actual
world is not deterministic and that at least some of the
agents in the actual world have free will. These
incompatibilists are referred to as "libertarians" [see Kane
(2005), particularly chapters 3 and 4]. However, these two
positions are not exhaustive. It is possible that one is an
incompatibilist, thinks that the actual world is not
deterministic, and yet still thinks that agents in the actual
world do not have free will. While it is less clear what to
call such a position (perhaps "free will deniers"), it illustrates that hard determinism and
libertarianism do not exhaust the ways to be an
incompatibilist. Since all incompatibilists, whatever their
stripe, agree that the falsity of determinism is a necessary
condition for free will, and since compatibilists deny this
assertion, the following sections speak simply of
incompatibilists and compatibilists.
It is also important to keep in mind that both
compatibilism and incompatibilism are claims about
possibility. According to the compatibilist, it is possible
that an agent is both fully determined and yet free. The
incompatibilist, on the other hand, maintains that such a
state of affairs is impossible. But neither position by itself
is making a claim about whether or not agents actually do
possess free will. Assume for the moment that incompatibilism
is true. If the truth of determinism is a contingent matter,
then whether or not agents are morally responsible will depend
on whether or not the actual world is deterministic.
Furthermore, even if the actual world is indeterministic, it
doesn’t immediately follow that the indeterminism present is
of the sort required for free will (we will return to a
similar point below when considering an objection to
incompatibilism). Likewise, assume both that compatibilism is
true and that causal determinism is true in the actual world.
It does not follow from this that agents in the actual world
actually possess free will.
Finally, there are free will pessimists [see Broad (1952)
and G. Strawson (1994)]. Pessimists agree with the
incompatibilists that free will is not possible if determinism
is true. However, unlike the incompatibilists, pessimists do
not think that indeterminism helps. In fact, they claim,
rather than helping support free will, indeterminism
undermines it. Consider Allison contemplating taking her dog
for a walk. According to the pessimist, if Allison is
determined, she cannot be free. But if determinism is false,
then there will be indeterminacy at some point prior to her
action. Exactly where one locates this indeterminacy will
depend on one’s particular view of the nature of free will.
Let us assume that that indeterminacy is located in which
reasons occur to Allison. It is hard to see, the pessimist
argues, how this indeterminacy could enhance Allison’s free
will, for it the occurrence of her reasons is indeterministic,
then having those reasons is not within Allison’s control. But
if Allison decides on the basis of whatever reasons she does
have, then her volition is based upon something outside of her
control. It is based instead on chance. Thus, pessimists think
that the addition of indeterminism actually makes agents lack
the kind of control needed for free will. While pessimism
might seem to be the same position as that advocated by free will deniers, pessimism is
a stronger claim. Free will deniers thinks that while
free will is possible, it just isn’t actual: agents in fact don’t
have free will. Pessimists, however, have a stronger position,
thinking that free will is impossible. Not only do agents lack
free will, there is no way that they could have it [see G.
Strawson (1994)]. The only way to preserve moral
responsibility, for the pessimist, is thus to deny that free
will is a necessary condition for moral responsibility.
As pessimism shows us, even a resolution to the debate
between compatibilists and incompatibilists will not by itself
solve the debate about whether or not we actually have free
will. Nevertheless, it is to this debate that we now turn.
4. Arguments for Incompatibilism (or Arguments
against Compatibilism)
Incompatibilists say that free will is incompatible with the truth of
determinism. Not all arguments for incompatibilism can be considered here;
let us focus on two major varieties. The first variety is
built around the idea that having free will is a matter of
having a choice about certain of our actions, and that having
a choice is a matter of having genuine options or alternatives
about what one does. The second variety of arguments is built
around the idea that the truth of determinism would mean that
we don’t cause our actions in the right kind of way. The truth of determinism would mean that
we don’t originate our actions in
a significant way and our actions are not ultimately
controlled by us. In other words, we lack the ability for
self-determination. Let us consider a representative argument
from each set.
a. The Consequence Argument
The most well-known and influential argument for
incompatibilism from the first set of arguments is called the
"Consequence Argument," and it has been championed by Carl
Ginet and Peter van Inwagen [see Ginet (1966) and van Inwagen
(1983)]. The Consequence Argument is based on a fundamental
distinction between the past and the future. First, consider
an informal presentation of this argument. There seems to be a
profound asymmetry between the past and the future based on
the direction of the flow of time and the normal direction of
causation. The future is open in a way that the past is not.
It looks as though there is nothing that Allison can now do
about the fact that Booth killed Lincoln, given that Lincoln
was assassinated by Booth in 1865.
This point stands even if we admit the possibility of time
travel. For if time travel is possible, Allison can influence
what the past became, but she cannot literally change the
past. Consider the following argument:
- The proposition "Lincoln was assassinated in 1865" is
true.
- If Allison travels to the past, she could prevent
Lincoln from being assassinated in 1865 (temporarily assumed
for reductio purposes).
- If Allison were to travel to the past and prevent
Lincoln from being assassinated in 1865, the proposition
"Lincoln was assassinated in 1865" would be false.
- A proposition cannot both be true and false.
- Therefore, 2 is false.
So, at most the possibility of time travel allows for
agents to have causal impact on the past, not for agents to
change what has already become the past. The past thus appears
to be fixed and unalterable. However, it seems that the same
is not true of the future, for Allison can have an influence
on the future through her volitions and subsequent actions.
For example, if she were to invent a time machine, then she
could, at some point in the future, get in her time machine
and travel to the past and try to prevent Lincoln from being
assassinated. However, given that he was assassinated, we can
infer that her attempts would all fail. On the other hand, she
could refrain from using her time machine in this way. The
asymmetry between past and future is illustrated by the fact
that we don’t deliberate about the past in the same way that
we deliberate about the future. While Allison might deliberate
about whether a past action was really the best action that
she could have done, she deliberates about the future in a
different way. Allison can question whether her past actions
were in fact the best, but she can both question what future
acts would be best as well as which future acts she should
perform. Thus, it looks like the future is open to Allison, or
up to her, in a way that the past is not. In other words, when
an agent like Allison is using her free will, what she is
doing is selecting from a range of different options for the
future, each of which is possible given the past and the laws
of nature. For this reason, this view of free will is often
called the "Garden of Forking Paths Model."
The Consequence Argument builds upon this view of the fixed
nature of the past to argue that if determinism is true, the
future is not open in the way that the above reflections
suggest. For if determinism is true, the future is as fixed as
is the past. Remember from the above definition that
determinism is the thesis the past (P) and the laws of
nature (L) entail a unique future. Let "F" refer
to any true proposition about the future. The Consequence
argument depends on two modal operators, and two inference
rules. Let the modal operator " " abbreviate "It is
logically necessary that..," so that, when it operates on some
proposition p, "p" abbreviates "It is logically
necessary that p." Let the modal operator
"N" be such that "Np" stands for "p is true and no one has, or
ever had, any choice about whether p was true." Call
the following two inference rules "Alpha" and "Beta:"
Alpha: p implies Np
Beta: {Np and N(p → q)}
implies Nq
According to Alpha, if p is a necessary truth, then
no one has, or ever had, any choice about whether p was
true. Similarly, according to Beta, if no one has, or ever
had, any choice about p being true, and no one has, or
ever had, any choice that p entails q, then no
one has, or ever had, any choice about whether q is
true. To see the plausibility of Beta, consider the following
application. Let p be the proposition "The earth was
struck by a meteor weighing 100 metric tons one billion years
ago," and let q be the proposition "If the earth was
struck by a meteor weighing 100 metric tons one billion years
ago, then thousands of species went extinct." Since I have no
choice about such a meteor hitting in the past, and have no
choice that if such meteor hits, it will cause thousands of
species to go extinct, I have no choice that thousands of
species went extinct. Beta thus looks extremely plausible. But
if Beta is true, then we can construct an argument to show
that if determinism is true, then I have no choice about
anything, including my supposed free actions in the future.
The argument begins with the definition of determinism given
above:
(1) {(P and L) →
F}
Using a valid logical rule of inference (exportation), we
can transform 1 into 2:
(2) {P → (L →
F)}
Applying Alpha, we can derive 3:
(3) N{P → (L →
F)}
The second premise in the Consequence Argument is called
the "fixity of the past." No one has, or ever had, a choice
about the true description P of the universe at some point in
the distant past:
(4) NP
From 3, 4 and Beta, we can deduce 5:
(5) N(L → F)
The final premise in the argument is the fixity of the laws
of nature. No one has, or ever had, a choice about what the
laws of nature are (try as I might, I cannot make the law of
universal gravitation not be a law of nature):
(6) NL
And from 5 and 6, again using Beta, we can infer that no
one has, or ever had, a choice about F:
(7) NF
Given that F was any true proposition about the
future, the Consequence Argument concludes that if determinism
is true, then no one has or ever had a choice about any aspect
of the future, including what we normally take to be our free
actions. Thus, if determinism is true, we do not have free
will.
b. The Origination Argument
The second general set of arguments for the incompatibility
of free will and determinism builds on the importance of the
source of a volition for free will. Again, it will be helpful
to begin with an informal presentation of the argument before
considering a formal presentation of it. According to this
line of thought, an agent has free will when her volitions
issue from the agent herself in a particular sort of way (say,
her beliefs and desires). What is important for free will,
proponents of this argument claim, is not simply that the
causal chain for an agent’s volition goes through the agent,
but that it originates with the agent. In other words,
an agent acts with free will only if she originates her
action, or if she is the ultimate source or first cause of her
action [see Kane (1998)].
Consider again the claim that free will is a necessary
condition for moral responsibility. What reflection on cases
of coercion and manipulation suggests to us is that even if a coerced
or manipulated agent is acting on her beliefs and desires,
this isn’t enough for moral responsibility. We normally assume
that coercion and certain forms of manipulation undercut an
agent’s moral responsibility precisely because a coerced or
manipulated agent isn’t the originator of her coerced action.
If Allison is coerced into walking her dog via brainwashing,
then her walking of the dog originates in the brainwashing,
and not in Allison herself. Consider, then, the similarities
between cases of coercion and manipulation, on the one hand,
and the implications of the truth of determinism on the other.
If determinism were true, it might be true that Allison chooses
to walk her dog because of her beliefs and desires, but those
beliefs and desires would themselves be the inevitable
products of causal chains that began millions of years ago.
Thus, a determined agent is at most a source, but not the
ultimate source, of her volitions. According to proponents of
this sort of argument for incompatibilism, the truth
of determinism would mean that agents don’t cause their
actions in the kind of way needed for free will and,
ultimately, moral responsibility.
We can represent a formal version of the argument, called
the "Origination Argument," as follows:
- An agent acts with free will only if she is the
originator (or ultimate source) of her actions.
- If determinism is true, then everything any agent does
is ultimately caused by events and circumstances outside her
control.
- If everything an agent does is ultimately caused by
events and circumstances beyond her control, then the agent
is not the originator (or ultimate source) of her actions.
- Therefore, if determinism is true, then no agent is the
originator (or ultimate source) of her actions.
- Therefore, if determinism is true, no agent has free
will.
The Origination Argument is valid. So, in evaluating its
soundness, we must evaluate the truth of its three premises.
Premise 3 is clearly true, since for an agent to be an
originator just is for that agent not to be ultimately
determined by anything outside of herself. Premise 2 of this
argument is true by the definition of determinism. To reject the conclusion
of the argument, one must therefore reject premise 1.
Earlier we briefly noted one account of free will which
implicitly denies premise 1, namely the hierarchical model of
free will. According to this model, an agent acts with free
will so long as the causal chain for that action goes through
the agent’s 1st- and 2nd-order desires. One way of emphasizing
the need for origination over-against such a hierarchical
model is to embrace agent-causation. If premise 1 is true,
then the agent’s volition cannot be the product of a
deterministic causal chain extended beyond the agent. What
other options are there? Two options are that volitions are
uncaused, or only caused indeterministically. It is difficult
to see how an agent could be the originator or ultimate source
of volitions if volitions are uncaused. Similarly, for reasons
we saw above when discussing the free will pessimist, it looks
as if indeterministic causation would undermine, rather than
enhance, an agent’s control over her volitions. For these
reasons, some incompatibilists favor looking at the causation
involved in volitions in a new light. Instead of holding that
a volition is caused by a previous event (either
deterministically or indeterministically), these
incompatibilists favor saying that volitions are caused
directly by agents. [For an extended defense of this view, see
O’Connor, (2000).] They hold that there are two irreducibly
different kinds of causation, event-causation and
agent-causation, and the latter is involved in free will.
Proponents of agent-causation propose that agents are enduring
substances that directly possess the power to cause volitions.
Although many philosophers question whether agent-causation is
coherent, if it were coherent, then it would provide support
for premise 1 of the Origination Argument.
c. The Relation between the
Arguments
The above way of delineating the Consequence and
Origination Arguments may unfortunately suggest that the two
kinds of arguments are more independent from each other than
they really are. A number of incompatibilists have argued that
agents originate their actions in the way required by premise
1 of the Origination Argument if and only if they have a choice about
their actions in the way suggested by the Consequence
Argument. In other words, if my future volitions are not the
sort of thing that I have a choice about, then I do not
originate those volitions. And as the above arguments contend,
the truth of causal determinism threatens both our control
over our actions and volitions, and our ability to originate
those same actions and volitions. For if causal determinism is
true, then the distant past, when joined with the laws of
nature, is sufficient for every volition that an agent makes,
and the causal chains that lead to those volitions would not
begin within the agent. Thus, most incompatibilists think that
having a choice and being a self-determiner go hand-in-hand.
Robert Kane, for instance, argues that if agents have
"ultimate responsibility" (his term for what is here
called "origination" or "self-determination"), then they will
also have alternative possibilities open to them. According to
this line of argumentation, the power to cause one’s own
actions is not a distinct power from the power to choose and
do otherwise. Thus, the two different kinds of arguments for
incompatibilism may simply be two sides of the same coin [see
Kane (1996) and (2005)].
5. Arguments for Compatibilism (or Arguments
against Incompatibilism)
Having laid out representatives of the two most prominent
arguments for incompatibilism, let's consider arguments in
favor of compatibilism. In considering these kinds of arguments, it is
pedagogically useful to approach them by using the arguments
for incompatibilism. So, this section begins by considering
ways that compatibilists have responded to the arguments given
in the preceding section.
a. Rejecting the Incompatibilist
Arguments
As noted above, the Origination Argument for
incompatibilism is valid, and two of its premises are above
dispute. Thus, the only way for the compatibilist to reject
the conclusion of the Origination Argument is to reject its
first premise. In other words, given the definition of
determinism, compatibilists must reject that free will
requires an agent being the originator or ultimate source of
her actions. But how might this be done? Most frequently,
compatibilists motivate a rejection of the "ultimacy
condition" of free will by appealing to either a hierarchical
or reasons-responsive view of what the will is [see Frankfurt,
(1971) and Fischer and Ravizza, (1998)]. If all that is
required for free will, for example, is that a certain mesh
between an agent’s 1st-order volitions and 2nd-order desires,
then such an account does not require that an agent be the
originator of those desires. Furthermore, since the truth of
determinism would not entail that agents don’t have 1st and
2nd-order desires and volitions, a hierarchical account of the
will is compatible with the truth of determinism. Similarly,
if an agent has free will if she has the requisite level of
reasons-responsiveness such that she would have willed
differently had she had different reasons, ultimacy is again
not required. Thus, if one adopts certain accounts of the
will, one has reason for rejecting the central premise of the
Origination Argument.
Compatibilists have a greater number of responses available
to them with regard to the Consequence Argument. One way of
understanding the N operator that figures in the
Consequence Argument is in terms of having the ability to do
otherwise. That is, to say that Allison has no choice about a
particular action of hers is to say that she could not have
performed a different action (or even no action at all).
Incompatibilists can easily account for this ability to do
otherwise. According to incompatibilists, an agent can be free
only if determinism is false. Consider again the case of
Allison. If determinism is false, even though Allison did
choose to walk her dog, she could have done otherwise than
walk her dog since the conjunction of P and L is
not sufficient for her taking her dog for a walk.
Compatibilists, however, can give their own account of the
ability to do otherwise. For them, to say that Allison could
have done otherwise is simply to say that Allison would have
done otherwise had she willed or chosen to do so [see, for
example, Chisholm (1967)]. Of course, if determinism is true,
then the only way that Allison could have willed or chosen to
do otherwise would be if either the past or the laws were
different than they actually are. In other words, saying that
an agent could have done otherwise is to say that the agent
would have done otherwise in a different counterfactual
condition. But saying this is entirely consistent with one way of understanding the
ability to do otherwise. Thus, these compatibilists are saying
that Allison has the ability to do something such that, had
she done it, either the past or the laws of nature would have
been different than they actually are. If P and
L entail that the agent does some action A, then
the agent’s doing otherwise than A entails that either
P or L would have been different than they actually are. Some compatibilists
favor saying that agent’s have this counterfactual power over
the past, while others favor counterfactual power over the
laws of nature [Compare Lewis (1981) and Fischer (1984)].
Regardless, adopting either strategy provides the
compatibilist with a way of avoiding the conclusion of the
Consequence Argument by denying either premise 4 or premise 6
of that argument. Furthermore, having such a power is not a
hollow victory, for it demarcates a plausible difference
between those actions an agent would have done even if she
didn’t want to (as in the case of coercion or manipulation)
from those actions that an agent only would have done had she
had certain beliefs and desires about that action. This view
thus differentiates between those actions that were within the
agent’s power to bring about from those that were not.
A second compatibilist response to the Consequence Argument
is to deny the validity of the inference rule Beta the
argument uses. While there are several approaches to this,
perhaps the most decisive is the following, called the
principle of Agglomeration [see McKay and Johnson (1996)].
Using only the inference rules Alpha, Beta and basic rule of
logical replacement, one can show that
(1) Np
and
(2) Nq
would entail
(3) N(p and q)
if Beta were valid. 1 and 2 do not entail 3, so Beta must
be invalid.
To see why 3 does not follow from 1 and 2, consider the
case of a coin-toss. If the coin-toss is truly random, then
Allison has no choice regarding whether the coin (if flipped)
lands heads. Similarly, she has no choice regarding whether
the coin (again, if flipped) lands tails. For purposes of
simplicity, let us stipulate that the coin cannot land on its
side and, if flipped, must land either heads or tails. Let p
above represent ‘the coin doesn’t land heads’ and q represent
‘the coin doesn’t land tails’. If Beta were valid, then 1 and
2 would entail 3, and Allison would not have a choice about
the conjunction of p and q; that is, she wouldn’t have a
choice about the coin not landing heads and the coin not
landing tails. If Allison didn’t have a choice about the coin
not landing heads and didn’t have a choice about the coin not
landing heads, then she wouldn’t have a choice about the coin
landing either heads or tails. But Allison does have a choice
about this—after all, she can ensure that the coin lands
either heads or tails by simply flipping the coin. So Allison
does have a choice about the conjunction of p and q. Since
Alpha and the relevant rules of logical replacement in the
transformation from Np and Np to N(p and
q) are beyond dispute, Beta must be invalid. Thus, the
Consequent Argument for incompatibilism is invalid. [For an
incompatibilist reply to the argument from Agglomeration, see
Finch and Warfield (1998).]
b. Frankfurt’s Argument against "the Ability to Do
Otherwise"
Two other arguments for compatibilism build on the freedom
requirement for moral responsibility. If one can show that
moral responsibility is compatible with the truth of
determinism, and if free will is required for moral
responsibility, one will have implicitly shown that free will
is itself compatible with the truth of determinism. The first
of these arguments for compatibilism rejects the understanding
of having a choice as involving the ability to do otherwise
mentioned above. While most philosophers have tended to accept
that an agent can be morally responsible for doing an action
only if she could have done otherwise, Harry Frankfurt has
attempted to show that this requirement is in fact false.
Frankfurt gives an example in which an agent does an action in
circumstances that lead us to believe that the agent acted
freely [Frankfurt (1969); for recent discussion, see Widerker
and McKenna (2003)]. Yet, unbeknown to the agent, the
circumstances include some mechanism that would bring about
the action if the agent did not perform it on her own. As it
happens, though, the agent does perform the action freely and
the mechanism is not involved in bringing about the action. It
thus looks like the agent is morally responsible despite not
being able to do otherwise. Here is one such scenario:
Allison is contemplating whether to walk her dog
or not. Unbeknown to Allison, her father, Lloyd, wants to
insure that that she does decide to walk the dog. He has
therefore implanted a computer chip in her head such that if
she is about to decide not to walk the dog, the chip will
activate and coerce her into deciding to take the dog for a
walk. Given the presence of the chip, Allison is unable not
to decide to walk her dog, and she lacks the ability to do
otherwise. However, Allison does decide to walk the dog on
her own.
In such a case, Frankfurt thinks that Allison is morally
responsible for her decision since the presence of Lloyd and
his computer chip play no causal role in her decision. Since
she would have been morally responsible had Lloyd not been
prepared to ensure that she decide to take her dog for a walk,
why think that his mere presence renders her not morally
responsible? Frankfurt concludes that Allison is morally
responsible despite lacking the ability to do otherwise. If
Frankfurt is right that such cases are possible, then even if
the truth of determinism is incompatible with a kind of
freedom that requires the ability to do otherwise, it is
compatible with the kind of freedom required for moral
responsibility.
c. Strawson’s Reactive Attitudes
In an influential article, Peter Strawson argues that the
many of the traditional debates between compatibilists and
incompatibilists (such as how to understand the ability to do
otherwise) are misguided [P. Strawson (1963)]. Strawson thinks
that we should instead focus on what he calls the reactive
attitudes—those attitudes we have toward other people based on
their attitudes toward and treatment of us. Strawson says that
the hallmark of reactive attitudes is that they are
“essentially natural human reactions to the good or ill will
or indifference of others toward us, as displayed in
their attitudes and actions.” Examples of reactive
attitudes include gratitude, resentment, forgiveness and love.
Strawson thinks that these attitudes are crucial to the
interpersonal interactions and that they provide the basis for
holding individuals morally responsible. Strawson then argues
for two claims. The first of these is that an agent’s reactive
attitudes would not be affected by a belief that determinism
was true:
The human commitment to participation in
ordinary interpersonal relationships is, I think, too
thoroughgoing and deeply rooted for us to take seriously the
thought that a general theoretical conviction might so
change our world that, in it, there were no longer such
things as inter-personal relationships as we normally
understand them.… A sustained objectivity of inter-personal
attitude, and the human isolation which that would entail,
does not seem to be something of which human beings would be
capable, even if some general truth were a theoretical
ground for it.
Furthermore, Strawson also argues for a normative claim:
the truth of determinism should not undermine our reactive
attitudes. He thinks that there are two kinds of cases where
it is appropriate to suspend our reactive attitudes. One
involves agents, such as young children or the mentally
disabled, who are not moral agents. Strawson thinks
that we should not have reactive attitudes toward non-moral
agents. The second kind of case where it is appropriate to
suspend our reactive attitudes are those in which while the
agent is a moral agent, her action toward us is not connected
to her agency in the correct way. For instance, while I might
have the reactive attitude of resentment towards someone who
bumps into me and makes me spill my drink, if I were to find
out that the person was pushed into me, I would not be
justified in resenting that individual. The truth of
determinism, however, would neither entail that no agents are
moral agents nor that none of an agent’s actions are connected
to her moral agency. Thus, Strawson thinks, the truth of
determinism should not undermine our reactive attitudes. Since
moral responsibility is based on the reactive attitudes,
Strawson thinks that moral responsibility is compatible with
the truth of determinism. And if free will is a requirement
for moral responsibility, Strawson’s argument gives support to
compatibilism.
6. Related Issues
The above discussion should help explain the perennial
attraction philosophers have to the issues surrounding free
will, particularly as it relates to causal determinism.
However, free will is also intimately related to a number of
other recurrent issues in the history of philosophy. In this
final section, I will briefly articulate two other kinds of
determinism and show how they are connected to free will.
a. Theological Determinism
The debate about free will and causal determinism
parallels, in many ways, another debate about free will, this
one stemming from what is often called ‘theological
determinism’. Some religious traditions hold that God is
ultimately responsible for everything that happens. According
to these traditions, God’s willing x is necessary and
sufficient for x. But if He is ultimately responsible
for everything in virtue of what He wills, then He is ultimately responsible for all the
actions and volitions performed by agents. God’s willing that
Allison take the dog for a walk is thus necessary and
sufficient for Allison taking the dog for a walk. But if this
is true, it is hard to see how Allison could have free will.
The problem becomes especially astute when considering
tradition doctrines of eternal punishment. The traditional
Christian doctrine of Hell, for example, is that Hell is a
place of eternal punishment for non-repentant sinners. But if
theological determinism is true, then whether or not agents
repent is ultimately up to God, not to the agents themselves.
This worry over free will thus gives rise to a particular
version of the problem of evil: why does God not will that all
come to faith, when His having such a will is sufficient for
their salvation? [For a discussion of these, and related
issues, see Helm, (1994).]
b. Logical Determinism
In addition to the causal and theological forms of
determinism, there is also logical determinism. Logical
determinism builds off the law of excluded middle and holds
that propositions about what agents will do in the future
already have a truth value. For instance, the proposition
"Allison will take the dog for a walk next Thursday" is
already true or false. Assume that it is true. Since token
propositions cannot change in truth value over time, it was
true a million years ago that Allison would walk her dog next
Thursday. But the truth of the relevant proposition is
sufficient for her actually taking the dog for a walk (after
all, if it is true that she will walk the dog, then she will
walk the dog). But then it looks like no matter what
happens, Allison will in fact take her dog for a walk next
Thursday and that this has always been the case. However, it
is hard to see how Allison’s deciding to walk the dog can be a
free decision since she must (given that the relevant token
proposition is true and was true a million years
ago) decide to walk him. In response to this problem, some
philosophers have attempted to show that free will is
compatible with the existence of true propositions about what
we will do in the future, and others have denied that
propositions about future free actions have a truth value,
that is, that the law of excluded middle fails for some
propositions. [For an introduction to these issues, see Finch
and Warfield, (1999) and Kane, (2002).] If God is a being who
knows the truth value of every proposition, this debate also
connects with the debate over the relationship between divine
foreknowledge and free will.
From this brief survey, we see that free will touches on
central issues in metaphysics, philosophy of human nature,
action theory, ethics and the philosophy of religion.
Furthermore, we’ve seen that there are competing views
regarding virtually every aspect of free will (including
whether there is, or even could be, such a thing). Perhaps
this partially explains the perennial philosophical interest
in the topic.
7. References and Further Reading
Anglin, W. S. (1990). Free Will and the Christian
Faith (Clarendon Press).
Broad, C. D. (1952). “Determinism, Indeterminism, and
Libertarianism,” in Ethics and the History of
Philosophy (Routledge and Kegan Paul).
Chisholm, Roderick (1967). “He Could Have Done Otherwise,”
Journal of Philosophy 64: 409-417.
Descartes, René (1998). Discourse on Method and
Meditations on First Philosophy, 4th edition (Hackett
Publishing Company).
Ekstrom, Laura Waddell (1999). Free Will: A
Philosophical Study (HarperCollins Publishers).
Finch, Alicia and Ted Warfield (1994). “Fatalism: Logical
and Theological,” Faith and Philosophy 16.2: 233-238.
Finch, Alicia and Ted Warfield (1998). “The Mind
Argument and Libertarianism,” Mind 107: 515-528. Fischer, John Martin (1984). “Power Over the Past,” Pacific
Philosophical Quarterly 65: 335-350.
Fischer, John Martin (1994). The Metaphysics of Free
Will (Blackwell).
Fischer, John Martin and Mark Ravizza (1998).
Responsibility and Control: A Theory of Moral
Responsibility (Cambridge University Press).
Frankfurt, Harry (1969). “Alternate Possibilities and Moral
Responsibility,” reprinted in Pereboom, (1997), pages 156-166.
Frankfurt, Harry (1971). “Freedom of the Will and the
Concept of a Person,” reprinted in Pereboom (1997), pages
167-183.
Ginet, Carl (1966). “Might We Have No Choice,” in Keith
Lehrer, ed., Freedom and Determinism (Random House),
pages 205-224.
Helm, Paul (1994). The Providence of God
(InterVarsity Press).
Honderich, Ted (2002). How Free are You?, 2nd
edition (Oxford University Press).
Kane, Robert (1998). The Significance of Free Will
(Oxford University Press).
Kane, Robert, ed. (2001). Free Will (Blackwell).
Kane, Robert, ed. (2002). The Oxford Handbook of Free
Will (Oxford University Press).
Kane, Robert (2005). A Contemporary Introduction to Free
Will (Oxford University Press).
Lewis, David (1981). “Are We Free to Break the Laws?”
Theoria 47): 113-121.
McKay, Thomas and David Johnson (1996). “A Reconsideration
of an Argument against Compatibilism,” Philosophical
Topics 24: 113-122.
O’Connor, Timothy (2000). Persons and Causes: The
Metaphysics of Free Will (Oxford University Press).
Pereboom, Derk, ed. (1997). Free Will (Hackett).
Pereboom, Derk (2001). Living Without Free Will
(Cambridge University Press).
Smilansky, Saul (2000). Free Will and Illusion
(Clarendon Press).
Strawson, Galen (1994). “The Impossibility of Moral
Responsibility,” Philosophical Studies 75: 5-24.
Strawson, Peter (1963). “Freedom and Resentment,” reprinted
in Pereboom (1997), pages 119-142.
Stump, Eleonore (2003). Aquinas (Routledge).
Van Inwagen, Peter (1983). An Essay on Free Will
(Clarendon Press).
Widerker, David and Michael McKenna (2003). Moral
Responsibility and Alternative Possibilities: Essays on the
Importance of Alternative Possibilities (Ashgate).
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