The philosophical study of humor has been focused on the development of
a satisfactory definition of humor, which until recently has been
treated as roughly co-extensive with laughter. According to the
standard analysis, humor theories can be classified into three neatly
identifiable groups: incongruity, superiority, and relief theories.
Incongruity theory is the leading approach and includes historical
figures such as Kant, Kierkegaard, and perhaps has its origins in
comments made by Aristotle in the Rhetoric.
Primarily focusing on the object of humor, this school sees humor as a
response to an incongruity, a term broadly used to include ambiguity,
logical impossibility, irrelevance, and inappropriateness. The
paradigmatic Superiority theorist is Thomas Hobbes, who said that humor
arises from a "sudden glory" felt when we recognize our supremacy over
others. Plato and Aristotle are generally considered superiority
theorists, who emphasize the aggressive feelings that fuel humor. The
third group, Relief theory, is typically associated with Freud and
Herbert Spencer, who saw humor as fundamentally a way to release or
save energy generated by repression. In addition, this article will
explore a fourth group of theories of humor: play theory. Play theorists
are not so much listing necessary conditions, as they are asking us to look at
humor as an extension of animal play
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. What is Humor
Almost every major figure in the history of philosophy has proposed a
theory, but after 2500 years of discussion there has been little
consensus about what constitutes humor. Despite the number of thinkers
who have participated in the debate, the topic of humor is currently
understudied in the discipline of philosophy. There are only a few
philosophers currently focused on humor related research, which is most
likely due to two factors: the problems in the field have proved
incredibly difficult, inviting repeated failures, and the subject is
erroneously dismissed as an insignificant concern. Nevertheless, scope
and significance of the study of humor is reflected in the
interdisciplinary nature of the filed, which draws insights from
philosophy, psychology, sociology, anthropology, film, and literature.
It is rare to find a philosophical topic that bares such direct
relevance to our daily lives, our social interactions, and our nature
as humans.
1a. Humor, Laughter, Comedy, and the Holy Grail
The majority of the work on humor has been occupied with the
foundational question – just what is humor? The word "humor" itself is
of relatively recent origin: according to the Oxford English
Dictionary, it arose during the 17th century out of
psycho-physiological scientific speculation on the effects of various
humors that might affect a person's temperament. Much of the earlier
humor research is riddled with equivocations between humor and
laughter, and the problem continues into recent discussions. John Dewey
states one reason to make the distinction: "The laugh is by no means to
be viewed from the standpoint of humor; its connection with humor is
only secondary. It marks the ending [. . .] of a period of suspense, or
expectation, all ending which is sharp and secondary" (John Dewey,
558). We laugh for a variety of reasons – hearing a funny joke,
inhaling laughing gas, being tickled – not all of which result from
what we think of as humor. Attempting to offer a general theory of
laughter and humor, John Morreall makes a finer distinction: laughter
results from a pleasant psychological shift, whereas, humor arises from
a pleasant cognitive shift. Noting the predominance of non-humorous
laughter, researcher Robert Provine argues that laughter is most often
found in non-humorous social interactions, deployed as some sort of
tension relief mechanism. If humor is not a necessary condition of
laughter, then we might ask if it is sufficient. Often humor will
produce laughter, but sometimes it results in only a smile. Obviously,
these relatively distinct phenomena are intimately connected in some
manner, but to understand the relationship we need clearer notions of
both laugher and humor.
Laughter is a fairly well described physiological process that results
in a limited range of characteristic vocal patterns that are only
physiologically possible, as Provine suggests, for bi-pedal creatures
with breath control. If we describe humorous laughter as laughter in
response to humor, then we must answer the question, What is humor?
This topic will be explored in the next few sections, but for starters,
we can say that humor or amusement is widely regarded as a response to
a certain kind of stimulus. The comic, on the other hand, is best
described as a professionally produced source of humor, a generic
element of various artforms. In distinguishing between humorous and
non-humorous laughter we presuppose a working definition of humor,
based partly on the character of our response and partly on the
properties of humorous objects. This is not necessarily to beg the
question about what is humor, but to enter into the real world process
of correctively developing a definition. The first goal of a humor
theory is to look for the basis of our practical ability to identify
humor.
Most definitions of humor are essentialist in that they try to list the
necessary and sufficient conditions something must meet in order to be
counted as humor. Some theories isolate a common element supposedly
found in all humor, but hold back from making claims about the
sufficient conditions. Many theorists seem to confuse offering the
necessary conditions for a response to count as humor with explaining
why we find one thing funny rather than another. This second question,
what would be sufficient for an object to be found funny, is the Holy
Grail of humor studies, and must be kept distinct from the goals of a
definition of the humor response. The Holy Grail is often confused with
a question regarding the sufficient conditions for our response to
count as humorous amusement, but a crucial distinction needs to be
made: identifying the conditions of a response is different from the
isolating the features something must possess in order to provoke such
a response. The first task is much different from suggesting what
features are sufficient to provoke a response of humorous amusement.
What amounts to a humor response is different from what makes something
humorous. The noun (humor) and adjectival (humorous) senses of the term
are difficult to keep distinct due to the imprecision of our language
in this area. Much of the dissatisfaction with traditional humor
theories can be traced back to an equivocation between these two senses
of the term.
1b. Problems Classifying Theorists
The standard analysis, developed by D. H. Monro, that classifies humor
theories into superiority, incongruity, and relief theories sets up a
false expectation of genuine competition between the views. Rarely do
any of the historical theorists in any of these schools state their
theories as listing necessary of sufficient conditions for something to
count as humor, much less put their views in competition with others. A
further problem concerns just what the something is that might be
called humor. Some theories address the object of humor, whereas others
are concerned primarily with the characteristics of the response, and
other theories discuss both.
The popular reduction of humor theories into three groups --
Incongruity, Relief, and Superiority theories -- is an over
simplification. Several scholars have identified over 100 types of
humor theories, and Patricia Keith-Spiegel's classification of humor
theories into 8 major types (biological, superiority, incongruity,
surprise, ambivalence, release, configuration, and psychoanalytic
theories) has been fairly influential. Jim Lyttle suggests that, based
on the question they are primarily addressing humor, theories can be
classified into 3 different groups. He argues that, depending on their
focus, humor theories can be grouped under these categories:
functional, stimuli, and response theories. (1) Functional theories of
humor ask what purpose humor has in human life. (2) Stimuli theories
ask what makes a particular thing funny. (3) Response theorists ask why
we find things funny. A better way to phrase this concern is to say
that response theorists ask what is particular about feelings of humor.
A little probing shows that Lyttle's grouping is strained, since many
of the humor theories address more than one of these questions, and an
answer to one often involves an answer to the other questions. For
instance, though focused on the function of humor, relief theories
often have something to say about all three questions: humor serves as
a tension release mechanism, the content often concerns the subject of
repressed desires, and finding these funny involves a feeling of relief.
Regardless of the classificatory scheme, when analyzing the tradition
of humor theories we need to consider how each of the traditionally
defined schools answers the major questions that occupy the bulk of the
discussion. The primary questions of humor theory include:
1. Humor question: What is humor?
An answer to this question often entails answers to questions regarding
the object and the response. This is the central question of any humor
theory.
2. Object Feature Questions:
a) Are there any features frequently found in what is found funny?
b) Are there any features necessary for something to have in order to be found funny?
c) Are there any features that by themselves or considered jointly are
sufficient for something to be found funny? Answering this question
affirmatively would amount to discovering the holy grail of humor
theory.
3. Response Question: Is there anything psychologically or cognitively
distinctive or characteristic about finding something funny?
4. Laughter question: How is humor related to laughter?
Given this list, we may ask what would a theory of humor amount to? To
count as a humor theory and not just an approach to humor, a theory
must attempt an answer to question 1 – What is humor? Like the relief
theories, most humor theorists do not attempt to answer this question
head on, but discuss some important or necessary characteristics of
humor. Since the various theories of humor are addressing different
sets of questions within this cluster as well as related question in
the general study of humor, it is often difficult to put them in
competition with each other. Accepting this limitation, we can proceed
to explore a few of the major humor theories listed in the widely
influential standard analysis.
2. Theories of Humor
2a. Superiority Theory
We can give two forms to the claims of the superiority theory of humor:
(1) the strong claim holds that all humor involves a feeling of
superiority, and (2) the weak claim suggests that feelings of
superiority are frequently found in many cases of humor. It is not
clear that many superiority theorists would hold to the strong claim if
pressed, but we will evaluate as a necessary condition nonetheless.
Neither Plato nor Aristotle
makes clear pronouncements about the essence of humor, though their
comments are preoccupied with the role of feelings of superiority in
our finding something funny. In the "Philebus," Plato tries to expose
the "mixture of pleasure and pain that lies in the malice of
amusement." He argues that ignorance is a misfortune that when found in
the weak is considered ridiculous. In comedy, we take malicious
pleasure from the ridiculous, mixing pleasure with a pain of the soul.
Some of Aristotle's brief comments in the Poetics
corroborate Plato's view of the pleasure had from comedy. Tragedy deals
with subjects who are average or better than average; however, in
comedy we look down upon the characters, since it presents subjects of
lesser virtue than, or "who are inferior to," the audience. The
"ludicrous," according to Aristotle, is "that is a failing or a piece
of ugliness which causes no pain of destruction" (Poetics, sections 3 and 7). Going beyond the subject of comedy, in the Rhetoric (II, 12) Aristotle defines wit as "educated insolence," and in the Nicomachean Ethics
(IV, 8) he describes jokes as "a kind of abuse" which should ideally be
told without producing pain. Rather than clearly offering a superiority
theory of humor, Plato and Aristotle focus on this common comic
feature, bringing it to our attention for ethical considerations.
Thomas Hobbes
developed the most well known version of the Superiority theory. Giving
emphatic expression to the idea, Hobbes says "that the passion of
laughter is nothing else but sudden glory arising from some sudden
conception of some eminency in ourselves, by comparison with the
infirmity of others, or with our own formerly" (Human Nature,
ch. 8). Motivated by the literary conceit of the laugh of triumph,
Hobbes's expression the superiority theory looks like more of a theory
of laughter than a theory of humor. Baudelaire offers an interesting
variation on Hobbes' superiority theory, mixing it with mortal
inferiority. He argues that that "laughter is satanic" -- an expression
of dominance over animals and a frustrated complaint against our being
merely mortal.
Critically reversing the superiority theory, Robert Solomon offers an
"inferiority theory" of humor. He thinks that self-recognition in the
silly antics and self-deprecating behavior of the Three Stooges is
characteristic of a source of humor based in inferiority or modesty.
Rather than comparing our current with our former inferior selves,
Solomon sees the ability to not take yourself seriously, or to see
yourself as less than ideal, as a source of virtuous modesty and
compassion. Solomon's analysis of the Three Stooges is not a full-blown
theory of humor, in that it does not make any pronouncements about the
necessary or sufficient conditions of humor; however, it is a theory of
humor in the sense that it suggests a possible source of humor or what
humor can be and how it might function.
Solomon's "inferiority theory" of humor raises a central objection
against the Superiority theory, namely, that a feeling of superiority
is not a necessary condition of humor. Morreall offers several
examples, such as finding a bowling ball in his refrigerator, that
could be found funny, but do not clearly involve superiority. If
feelings of superiority are not necessary for humor, are they
sufficient? Undoubtedly, this is not the case. As an 18th century
critic of Hobbes, Francis Hutcheson, points out, we can feel superior
to lots of things, dogs, cats, trees, etc, without being amused: "some
ingenuity in dogs and monkeys, which comes near to some of our own
arts, very often makes us merry; whereas their duller actions, in which
the are much below us, are no matter of jest at all" (29). However, if
we evaluate the weaker version of the superiority theory – that humor
is often fueled by feelings of superiority – then we have a fairly well
supported empirical claim, easily confirmable by first hand observation.
2b. Relief Theory
Relief theories attempt to describe humor along the lines of a
tension-release model. Rather than defining humor, they discuss the
essential structures and psychological processes that produce laughter.
The two most prominent relief theorists are Herbert Spencer and Sigmund
Freud. We can consider two version of the relief theory: (1) the strong
version holds that all laughter results from a release of excessive
energy; (2) the weak version claims that it is often the case that
humorous laughter involves a release of tension or energy. Freud
develops a more specific description of the energy transfer mechanism,
but the process he describes is not essential to the basic claims of
the relief theory of humor.
In "The Physiology of Laughter," Spencer develops a theory of laughter
that is intimately related to his "hydraulic" theory of nervous energy,
whereby excitement and mental agitation produces energy that "must
expend itself in some way or another." He argues that "nervous
excitation always tends to beget muscular motion." As a form of
physical movement, laughter can serve as the expressive route of
various forms of nervous energy. Spencer did not see his theory as a
competitor to the incongruity theory of humor; rather, he tried to
explain why it is that a certain mental agitation arising from a
"descending incongruity" results in this characteristically purposeless
physical movement. Spencer never satisfactorily answers this specific
question, but he presents the basic idea that laughter serves to
release pent up energy.
One criticism of Spencer's theory of energy relief is that it does not
seem to describe most cases of humor that occur quickly. Many instances
of jokes, witticisms, and cartoons do not seem to involve a build up of
energy that is then released. Perhaps Spencer thinks that the best
explanation for laughter, an otherwise purposeless expenditure of
energy, must be that it relieves energy produced from humor. However,
since most of our experiences of humor do not seem to involve an energy
build up, and humor does not seem forthcoming when we are generally
agitated, a better explanation might be that laughter is not as
purposeless as it seems or that all expenditures of energy, purposeful
or not, need involve a build up.
Spencer might reply that everyone is continuously building up energy
simply through the process of managing everyday stress. As such, most
people have excess energy, a form of energy potential, waiting to be
released by humor. For example, one often hears it said that humor
allows one to "blow off steam" after a stressful day at work. The
problem with this line of argument is that those who are most "stressed
out" seem the least receptive to humor. Not only do attempts at humor
frequently fall flat on the hurried, the amusement that results is
typically minimal. Perhaps Spencer could argue that at a certain
threshold the pent up energy jams the gates such that humor is unable
to provide a release. This line of defense might be plausible, but the
tension release theory starts to look a bit ad hoc when you have to
posit things such as jammed energy release gates and the like.
In "Jokes and Their Relation to the Unconscious," Freud
develops a more fine grained version of the relief theory of laughter,
that amounts to a restatement of Spencer's theory with the addition of
a new process. He describes three different sources of laughter –
joking, the comic, and humor – which all involve the saving of some
psychic energy that is then discharged through laughter. In joking, the
energy that would have been used to repress sexual and hostile feelings
is saved and can be released in laughter. In the comic, cognitive
energy to be used to solve an intellectual challenge is left over and
can be released. The humorous involves a saving of emotional energy,
since what might have been an emotion provoking situation turns out to
be something we should treat non-seriously. The energy building up for
the serious emotional reaction can then be released.
The details of Freud's discussions of the process of energy saving, are
widely regarded as problematic. His notion of energy saving is unclear,
since it is not clear what sense it makes to say that energy which is
never called upon is saved, rather than saying that no energy was
expended. Take his theory of jokes, where the energy that otherwise
would have been used to repress a desire is saved by joking which
allows for aggression to be released. Morreall and Carroll make a
similar criticism of this theory of energy management. We may have an
idea of what it is like to express pent up energy, but we have no
notion of what it would be to release energy that is used to repress a
desire. Beyond the claim of queerness, this theory of joking does not
result in the expected empirical observations. On Freud's explanation,
the most inhibited and repressed people would seem to enjoy joking the
most, though the opposite is the case.
Relief theories of laughter do not furnish us a way to distinguish
humorous from non-humorous laughter. Freud's saved energy is
perceptually indistinguishable with other forms of energy. As we saw
with Spencer, Relief theories must be saddled to another theory of
humor. Freud's attempt to explain why we laugh is also an effort to
explain why we find certain tendentious jokes especially funny, though
it is not clear what he is getting at in his account of the saving of
energy. He commits the fundamental mistake of relief theorists -- they
erroneously assume that since mental energy often finds release in
physical movement, any physical movement must be explainable by an
excess of nervous energy.
2c. Incongruity Theory
The incongruity theory is the reigning theory of humor, since it seems
to account for most cases of perceived funniness, which is partly
because "incongruity" is something of an umbrella term. Most
developments of the incongruity theory only try to list a necessary
condition for humor – the perception of an incongruity – and they stop
short of offering the sufficient conditions.
In the Rhetoric
(III, 2), Aristotle presents the earliest glimmer of an incongruity
theory of humor, finding that the best way to get an audience to laugh
is to setup an expectation and deliver something "that gives a twist."
After discussing the power of metaphors to produce a surprise in the
hearer, Aristotle says that "[t]he effect is produced even by jokes
depending upon changes of the letters of a word; this too is a
surprise. You find this in verse as well as in prose. The word which
comes is not what the hearer imagined." These remarks sound like a
surprise theory of humor, similar to that later offered by Descartes,
but Aristotle continues to explain how the surprise must somehow "fit
the facts," or as we might put it today, the incongruity must be
capable of a resolution.
In the Critique of Judgment (I, I, 54), Kant
gives a clearer statement of the role of incongruity in humor: "In
everything that is to excite a lively laugh there must be something
absurd (in which the understanding, therefore, can find no
satisfaction). Laughter is an affection arising from the sudden
transformation of a strained expectation into nothing."
Schopenhauer offers a more specific version of the incongruity theory,
arguing that humor arising from a failure of a concept to account for
an object of thought. When the particular outstrips the general, we are
faced with an incongruity. Schopenhauer also emphasizes the element of
surprise, saying that "the greater and more unexpected [. . .] this
incongruity is, the more violent will be his laughter."
As stated by Kant and Schopenhauer, the incongruity theory of humor
specifies a necessary condition of the object of humor. Focusing on the
humorous object, leaves something out of the analysis of humor, since
there are many kinds of things that are incongruous which do not
produce amusement. A more robust statement of the incongruity theory
would need to include the pleasurable response one has to humorous
objects. John Morreall attempts to find sufficient conditions for
identifying humor by focusing on our response. He defines humorous
amusement as taking pleasure in a cognitive shift. The incongruity
theory can be stated as a response focused theory, claiming that humor
is a certain kind of reaction had to perceived incongruity.
Henri Bergson's essay "Laughter" is perhaps the one of the most
influential and sophisticated theories of humor. Bergson's theory of
humor is not easily classifiable, since it has elements of superiority
and incongruity theories. In a famous phrase, Bergson argues that the
source of humor is the "mechanical encrusted upon the living" (Bergson,
84) According to Bergson "the comic does not exist outside of what is
strictly human." He thinks that humor involve an incongruous
relationship between human intelligence and habitual or mechanical
behaviors. As such, humor serves as a social corrective, helping people
recognize behaviors that are inhospitable to human flourishing. A large
source of the comic is in recognizing our superiority over the
subhuman. Anything that threatens to reduce a person to an object –
either animal or mechanical – is prime material for humor. No doubt,
Bergson's theory accounts for much of physical comedy and bodily humor,
but he seems to over-estimate the necessity of mechanical encrustation.
It is difficult to see how his theory can accommodate most jokes and
sources of humor coming from wit.
Three major criticisms of the incongruity theory are that it is too
broad to be very meaningful, it is insufficiently explanatory in that
it does not distinguish between non-humorous incongruity and basic
incongruity, and that revised versions still fail to explain why some
things, rather than others, are funny. We have already addressed the
third criticism: it confuses the object of humor with the response.
What is at issue is the definition of humor, or how to identify humor,
not how to create a humor-generating algorithm. The incongruity
theorist has a response to this criticism as well, since they can claim
that humor is pleasure in incongruity.
2d. Play Theories
Describing play theories of humor as an independent school or approach
might overstate their relative importance, although they do serve as a
good representative of theories focused on the functional question. By
looking at the contextual characteristic, play theories try to classify
humor as a species of play. In this general categorization effort, the
play theorists are not so much listing necessary conditions, as they
are asking us to look at humor as an extension of animal play. They try
to call our attention to the structural similarities between play
contexts and humorous context, to suggest that what might be true of
play, might be true of humor as well.
Play theorists often take an ethological approach to studying humor,
tracing it back through evolutionary development. They look at laughter
triggers like tickling, that are found in other species, to suggest
that in humor ontogeny recapitulates phylogeny. In The Enjoyment of Laughter,
Max Eastman develops a play theory of humor with an adaptive story. He
thinks we can find analogies of humor in the behavior of animals,
especially in the proto-laughter of chimps to tickling. He goes so far
as to argue that the wagging tail of a happy dog is a form of humorous
laughter, since Eastman wants to broaden the definition of laughter to
encompass other rhythmic responses to pleasure. Speaking more
specifically of humor, he argues that "we come into the world endowed
with an instinctive tendency to laugh and have this feeling in response
to pains presented playfully" (Eastman, 45). On Eastman's account, what
is central to humor and play is that both require taking a
disinterested attitude towards what might otherwise be seen as serious.
Eastman considers humor to be a form of play, because humor involves a
disinterested stance, certain kinds of humor involve mock aggression
and insults, and because some forms of play activities result in
humorous amusement. Since Eastman defines play as the adoption of this
disinterested attitude, humor would count as a form of play on his
definition, but this seems both too restrictive and too vague to serve
as an adequate definition of play. In Homo Ludens,
John Huizinga criticizes identifying play with laughter or the comic.
Though both seem to involve "the opposite of seriousness," there are
crucial asymmetries. Laughter, he argues, is particular to humans,
whereas, play is found in other mammals and birds. Also, if we allow
for certain types of competitive play, then a non-serious attitude is
not essential to play, as it seems to be for humor. Identifying the
comic, or humor, with play is problematic, since "in itself play is not
comical for either for the player or public" (Homo Ludens,
6). Huizinga questions whether humor and play share any necessary
conditions, a requirement of the relationship if humor is a subtype of
play. This will, of course, depend on how we describe humor and play,
two equally elusive notions.
Play theorists are primarily concerned with the problem of determining
the function of humor in order to explain how it might have adaptive
value, a task taken up by other biological theories of humor. They
argue that similarities between play and humor suggest that the
adaptive value of play might be similar to that of humor. Other
researchers focused on the functional questions have described humor as
having value in cognitive development, social skill learning, tension
relief, empathy management, immune system benefits, stress relief, and
social bonding. Though these questions are primarily addressed by
psychologists, sociologist, anthropologists, and medical researchers,
their studies rely on and contribute to an evolving notion of just what
counts as humor. Though the functional question is foremost in these
theories, play theory tries to give humor a genus by offering some
differentiating characteristics, essential to humor.
2e. Summary of Humor Theories
We discussed four different schools of humor theories, and noted how
each reveals aspects common, if not necessary, to humor. Presenting
these theories as rivals is misleading since, as we have seen,
theorists in each classification focus on different problems and may
draw upon the answers to different questions from another school. For
instance, while focusing on why we find something funny, Spencer offers
a functional explanation and relies on the answer incongruity theorists
give to the question of what we find funny. Relief theories and Play
theories tend to focus on the function humor serves in human life,
though the functional question cannot be separated from characterizing
amusement, or the humor response. Superiority theorists tend to focus
on what feelings are necessary for there to be humor, or why we find
some things funny. Incongruity theories have the most to say about the
object of humor, though variants identify humor with the way we respond
to a perceived incongruity. Though the functional, stimuli, and
response questions are not neatly separated, the differing schools tend
to assume that one question is more basic than the others.
3. References and Further Reading
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Bergson, Henri. "Laughter." Trans. Wylie Sypher, in Comedy, eds. Wylie Sypher. Baltimore; Johns Hopkins UP, 1980.
Berman, Merrie. "How Many Feminists Does It Take To Make A Joke? Sexist Humor and What's Wrong With It." Hypatia vol. 1, no. 1 (Spring 1986), 63-82.
Caplow, Theodore. Two Against One: Coalitions in Triads. Englewood Cliffs: Prentice Hall, 1968.
Carroll, Noel., Ed. Beyond Aesthetics: Philosophical Essays. New York: Cambridge UP, 2001.
Carroll, Noel. "Horror and Humor" in Carroll 2001, 235-253.
Carroll, Noel. "Moderate Moralism" in Carroll 2001, 293- 306.
Carroll, Noel. "Notes on the Sight Gag" in Noel Carroll Theorizing the Moving Image. New York, Cambridge UP, 1996.
Carroll, Noel. "On Jokes" in Carroll 2001, 317-334.
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Dundes, Alan. Cracking Jokes: Studies of Sick Humor Cycles and Stereotypes. Berkeley: Ten Speed Press, 1987.
Dwyer, Tom. "Humor, Power, and Change in organizations." Human Relations, vol. 44, no. 1, 1991, 1-19.
Eastman, Max. Enjoyment of Laughter. New York: Halcyon House, 1936.
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Freud, S. (1928). Humor. International Journal of Psychoanalysis, 9, 1-6.
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