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For a given language, a sentence X is said to be a logical consequence of a
set of sentences K, if and only if, in virtue of logic alone, the sentence X
must be true if every sentence in K is true. This corresponds to the
ordinary notion of a sentence "logically following" from others. Logicians
have attempted to make the ordinary concept more precise relative to a given
language L by sketching a deductive system for L, or by formalizing the
intended semantics for L. Any adequate precise characterization of logical
consequence must reflect its salient features such as those highlighted by
Alfred Tarski: (1) that the logical consequence relation is formal, i.e.,
depends on the forms of the sentences involved, (2) that the relation is a
priori, i.e., it is possible to determine whether or not it holds without
appeal to sense-experience, and (3) that the relation has a modal element.
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Introduction
Logical consequence is arguably the central concept of logic.
The primary aim of logic is to tell us what follows logically from what.
In order to simplify matters we take the logical consequence relation to
hold for sentences rather than for abstract propositions, facts, state of
affairs, etc. Correspondingly, logical consequence is a relation between
a given class of sentences and the sentences that logically follow. One
sentence is said to be a logical consequence of a set of sentences, if and
only if, in virtue of logic alone, it is impossible for the sentences in the
set to be all true without the other sentence being true as well. If
sentence X is a logical consequence of a set of sentences K, then we may
say that K implies or entails X, or that one may correctly infer the truth
of X from the truth of the sentences in K. For example, Kelly is not
at work is a logical consequence of Kelly is not both at home
and at work and Kelly is at home. However, the sentence
Kelly is not a football fan does not follow from All West
High School students are football fans and Kelly is not a West
High School student. The central question to be investigated here is:
What conditions must be met in order for a sentence to be a logical
consequence of others?
One popular answer derives from the work of Alfred Tarski, one
of the preeminent logicians of the twentieth century, in his famous 1936
paper, "The Concept of Logical Consequence." Here Tarski uses his
observations of the salient features of what he calls the common concept
of logical consequence to guide his theoretical development of it.
Accordingly, we begin by examining the common concept focusing on
Tarski's observations of the criteria by which we intuitively judge what
follows from what and which Tarski thinks must be reflected in any
theory of logical consequence. Then two theoretical definitions of
logical consequence are introduced: the model theoretic and the
deductive theoretic definitions. They represent two major approaches to
making the common concept of logical consequence more precise. The
article concludes by highlighting considerations relevant to evaluating
model theoretic and deductive theoretic characterizations of logical
consequence. For more comprehensive presentations of the two
definitions of logical consequence, as well as further critical discussion,
see the entries Logical Consequence,
Model-Theoretic Conceptions and Logical
Consequence, Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions.
2. The Concept of Logical Consequence
a. Tarski's characterization of the common concept of logical consequence
Tarski begins his article, "On the Concept of Logical
Consequence," by noting a challenge confronting the project of making
precise the common concept of logical consequence.
The concept of logical consequence is one of
those whose introduction into a field of strict formal investigation was
not a matter of arbitrary decision on the part of this or that investigator;
in defining this concept efforts were made to adhere to the common
usage of the language of everyday life. But these efforts have been
confronted with the difficulties which usually present themselves in such
cases. With respect to the clarity of its content the common concept of
consequence is in no way superior to other concepts of everyday
language. Its extension is not sharply bounded and its usage fluctuates.
Any attempt to bring into harmony all possible vague, sometimes
contradictory, tendencies which are connected with the use of this
concept, is certainly doomed to failure. We must reconcile ourselves
from the start to the fact that every precise definition of this concept will
show arbitrary features to a greater or less degree. (Tarski 1936, p.
409)
Not every feature of the technical account will be reflected in the
ordinary concept, and we should not expect any clarification of the
concept to reflect each and every deployment of it in everyday language
and life. Nevertheless, despite its vagueness, Tarski believes that there
are identifiable, essential features of the common concept of logical
consequence.
...consider any class K of sentences and a sentence X which follows
from this class. From an intuitive standpoint, it can never happen that
both the class K consists of only true sentences and the sentence X is
false. Moreover, since we are concerned here with the concept of
logical, i.e., formal consequence, and thus with a relation which is to be
uniquely determined by the form of the sentences between which it
holds, this relation cannot be influenced in any way by empirical
knowledge, and in particular by knowledge of the objects to which the
sentence X or the sentences of class K refer. The consequence relation
cannot be affected by replacing designations of the objects referred to in
these sentences by the designations of any other objects. (Tarski 1936,
pp. 414-415)
According to Tarski, the logical consequence relation as it is
employed by typical reasoners is (1) necessary, (2) formal, and (3) not
influenced by empirical knowledge. I now elaborate on (1)-(3) in order to
shape two preliminary characterizations of logical consequence.
i. The logical consequence relation has a modal element
Tarski countenances an implicit modal notion in the common
concept of logical consequence. If X is a logical consequence of K, then
not only is it the case that not all of the elements of K are true and X is
false, but also this is necessarily the case. That is, X follows from K only
if it is not possible for all of the sentences in K to be true with X false.
For example, the supposition that All West High School students are
football fans and that Kelly is not a West High School
student does not rule out the possibility that Kelly is a football fan.
Hence, the sentences All West High School students are football
fans and Kelly is not a West High School student do not
entail Kelly is not a football fan, even if she, in fact, isn't a
football fan. Also, Most of Kelly's male classmates are football
fans does not entail Most of Kelly's classmates are football
fans. What if the majority of Kelly's class is composed of females
who are not fond of football?
We said above that Kelly is not both at home and at
work and Kelly is at home jointly imply Kelly is not at
work. Note that it doesn't seem possible for the first two sentences
to be true and Kelly is not at work false. But it is hard to see
what this comes to without further clarification of the relevant notion of
possibility. For example, consider the following pairs of sentences.
Kelly kissed her sister at 2:00pm
2:00pm is not a time during which Kelly and
her sister were 100 miles
apart
|
Kelly is a female
Kelly
is not the US President
|
There is a chimp in Paige's house
There is a primate in Paige's house |
Ten is a prime number
Ten is
greater than nine |
For each pair of sentences, there is a sense in which it is not possible
for the first to be true and the second false. At the very least an account
of logical consequence must distinguish logical possibility from other
types of possibility. Should truths about physical laws, US political
history, zoology, and mathematics constrain what we take to be possible
in determining whether or not the first sentence of each pair could
logically be true with the second sentence false? If not, then this seems
to mystify logical possibility (e.g., how could ten be a prime number?).
To paraphrase questions asked by G.E. Moore (1959, pp. 231-238),
given that I know that George W. Bush is US President and that he is not
a female named Kelly, isn't it inconsistent for me to grant the
logical possibility of the truth of Kelly is a female and the falsity
of Kelly is not the US President? Or should I ignore my present
state of knowledge in considering what is logically possible? Tarski
does not derive a clear notion of logical possibility from the common
concept of logical consequence. Perhaps there is none to be had, and we
should seek the help of a proper theoretical development in clarifying the
notion of logical possibility. Towards this end, let's turn to the other
features of logical consequence highlighted by Tarski, starting with the
formality criterion of logical consequence.
ii. The logical consequence relation is formal
Tarski observes that logical consequence is a formal
consequence relation. And he tells us that a formal consequence relation
is a consequence relation that is uniquely determined by the form of the
sentences between which it holds. Consider the following pair of
sentences
(1) Some children are both lawyers and peacemakers.
(2) Some children are peacemakers
Intuitively, (2) is a logical consequence of (1). It appears that this
fact does not turn on the subject matter of the sentences. Replace
'children', 'lawyers', and 'peacemakers' in (1) and (2) with the variables
S, M, and P to get the following.
(1') Some S are both M and P
(2') Some S are P
(1') and (2') are forms of (1) and (2), respectively. Note that there is
no interpretation of S, M, and P according to
which the sentence that results from (1') is true and the resulting instance
of (2') is false. Hence, (2) is a formal consequence of (1) and on each
interpretation of S, M, and P the resulting (2')
is a formal consequence of the sentence that results from (1') (e.g.,
Some clowns are sad is a formal consequence of Some
clowns are both lonely and sad). Tarski's observation is that for any
sentence X and set K of sentences, X is a logical consequence of K only
if X is a formal consequence of K. The formality criterion of logical
consequence can work in explaining why one sentence doesn't entail
another in cases where it seems impossible for the first to be true and the
second false. For example, (3) is false and (4) is true.
(3) Ten is a prime number
(4) Ten is greater than nine
Does (4) follow from (3)? One might think that (4) does not follow
from (3) because being a prime number does not necessitate
being greater than nine. However, this does not require one to
think that ten could be a prime number and less than or equal to nine,
which is probably a good thing since it is hard to see how this is possible.
Rather, we take
(3') a is a P
(4') a is R than b
to be the forms of (5) and (6) and note that there are interpretations
of 'a', 'b', 'P', and 'R' according to which the first is true and the second
false (e.g. let 'a' and 'b' name the numbers two and ten, respectively, and
let 'P' mean prime number, and 'R' greater). Note that
the claim here is not that formality is sufficient for a consequence
relation to qualify as logical but only that it is a necessary condition. I
now elaborate on this last point by saying a little more about forms of
sentences (i.e., sentential forms) and formal consequence.
Distinguishing between a term of a sentence replaced with a
variable and one held constant determines a form of the sentence. In
Some children are both lawyers and peacemakers we may
replace 'Some' with a variable and treat all the other terms as constant.
Then
(1'') D children are both lawyers and
peacemakers
is a form of (1), and each sentence generated by assigning a meaning
to D shares this form with (1). For example, the following three
sentences are instances of (1''), produced by interpreting D as
'No', 'Many', and 'Few'.
No children are both lawyers and peacemakers
Many children are both lawyers and peacemakers
Few children are both lawyers and peacemakers
Whether X is a formal consequence of K then turns on a prior
selection of terms as constant and others replaced with variables.
Relative to such a determination, X is a formal consequence of K if and
only if (iff) there is no interpretation of the variables according to which
each of the K are true and X is false. So, taking all the terms, except for
'Some', in (1) Some children are both philosophers and
peacemakers and in (2) Some children are peacemakers as
constants makes the following forms of (1) and (2).
(1'') D children are both lawyers and peacemakers
(2'') D children are peacemakers
Relative to this selection, (2) is not a formal consequence of (1)
because replacing 'D' with 'No' yields a true instance of (1'') and a false
instance of (2'').
Consider the following pair.
(5) Kelly is female
(6) Kelly is not US
President
(6) is a formal consequence of (5) relative to replacing 'Kelly' with a
variable. Given current U.S. political history, there is no individual
whose name yields a true (5) and a false (6) when it replaces 'Kelly'.
This is not, however, sufficient reason for seeing (6) as a logical
consequence of (5). There are two ways of thinking about why, a
metaphysical consideration and an epistemological one. First the
metaphysical consideration. It seems possible for (5) to be true and (6)
false. The course of U.S. political history could have turned out
differently. One might think that the current US President
could--logically--have been a female named, say, 'Sally'. Using 'Sally' as a
replacement for 'Kelly' would yield in that situation a true (5) and a false
(6). Also, it seems possible that in the future there will be a female US
President. In order for a formal consequence relation from K to X to
qualify as logical it has to be the case that it is necessary that
there is no interpretation of the variables in K and X according to which
the K-sentences are true and X is false.
The epistemological consideration is that one might think that
knowledge that X follows logically from K should not essentially depend
on being justified by experience of extra-linguistic states of affairs.
Clearly, the determination that (6) follows formally from (5) essentially
turns on empirical knowledge, specifically knowledge about the current
political situation in the US. This leads to the final highlight of Tarski's
rendition of the intuitive concept of logical consequence: that logical
consequence cannot be influenced by empirical knowledge.
iii. The logical consequence relation is a priori
Tarski says that by virtue of being formal, knowledge that X follows
logically from K cannot be affected by knowledge of the objects that X
and the sentences of K are about. Hence, our knowledge that X is a
logical consequence of K cannot be influenced by empirical knowledge.
However, as noted above, formality by itself does not insure that the
extension of a consequence relation is not influenced by empirical
knowledge. So, let's view this alleged feature of logical consequence as
independent of formality. We characterize empirical knowledge in two
steps as follows. First, a priori knowledge is knowledge "whose
truth, given an understanding of the terms involved, is ascertainable by a
procedure which makes no reference to experience" (Hamlyn 1967, p.
141). Empirical, or a posteriori, knowledge is knowledge that is
not a priori, i.e., knowledge whose validation necessitates a
procedure that does make reference to experience. We can safely read
Tarski as saying that a consequence relation is logical only if knowledge
that something falls in its extension is a priori, i.e., only if the
relation is a priori. Knowledge of physical laws, a determinant
in people's observed sizes, is not a priori and such knowledge is
required to know that there is no interpretation of k, h,
and t according to which (7) is true and (8) false.
(7) k kissed h at time t
(8) t is not a time during which k and h were 100
miles apart
So (8) cannot be a logical consequence of (7). However, my
knowledge that Kelly is not Paige's only friend follows from
Kelly is taller than Paige's only friend is a priori since
I know a priori that nobody is taller than herself.
Let's summarize and tie things together. We began by asking,
for a given language L, what conditions must be met in order for a
sentence X of L to be a logical consequence of a class K of L-sentences?
Tarski thinks that an adequate response must reflect the common concept
of logical consequence, i.e., the concept as it is ordinarily employed. By
the lights of this concept, an adequate account of logical consequence
must reflect the formality and necessity of logical consequence, and must
also reflect the fact that knowledge of what follows logically from what
is a priori. Tying the criteria together, in order to fix what
follows logically from what in a given language L, we must select a class
of constants that determines a formal consequence relation that is both
necessary and known, if at all, a priori. Such constants are
called logical constants, and we say that the logical form of a sentence is
a function of the logical constants that occur in the sentence and the
pattern of the remaining expressions. As was illustrated above, the notion
of formality does not presuppose a criterion of logical
constancy. A consequence relation based on any division between
constants and terms replaced with variables will automatically be formal
with respect to the latter.
b. Logical and non-logical terminology
Tarski's basic move from his rendition of the common concept of
logical consequence is to distinguish between logical terms and
non-logical terms and then say that X is a logical consequence of K only if
there is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terms of the
language L that makes all of the sentences in K true and X false. The
choice of the right terms as logical will reflect the modal element in the
concept of logical consequence, i.e., will insure that there is no 'possible'
interpretation of the variable, non-logical terms of the language L that
makes all of the K true and X false, and will insure that this is known
a priori. Of course, we have yet to spell out the modal notion
in the concept of logical consequence. Tarski pretty much left this
underdeveloped in his (1936). Lacking such an explanation hampers our
ability to clarify the rationale for a selection of terms to serve as the
logical ones.
Traditionally, logicians have regarded sentential connectives
such as and, not, or, if...then,
the quantifiers all and some, and the identity predicate
'=' as logical terms. Remarking on the boundary between logical and
non-terms, Tarski (1936, p. 419) writes the following.
Underlying this characterization of logical
consequence is the division of all terms of the language discussed into
logical and extra-logical. This division is not quite arbitrary. If, for
example, we were to include among the extra-logical signs the
implication sign, or the universal quantifier, then our definition of the
concept of consequence would lead to results which obviously contradict
ordinary usage. On the other had, no objective grounds are known to me
which permit us to draw a sharp boundary between the two groups of
terms. It seems to be possible to include among logical terms some
which are usually regarded by logicians as extra-logical without running
into consequences which stands in sharp contrast to ordinary usage.
Tarski seems right to think that the logical consequence relation
turns on the work that the logical terminology does in the relevant
sentences. It seems odd to say that Kelly is happy does not
logically follow from All are happy because the second is true
and the first false when All is replaced with Few.
However, by Tarski's version of the ordinary concept of logical
consequence there is no reason not to treat say taller than as a
logical term along with not and, therefore, no reason not to take
Kelly is not taller than Paige as following logically from
Paige is taller than Kelly. Also, it seems plausible to say that I
know a priori that there is no possible interpretation of
Kelly and is mortal according to which it is
necessary that Kelly is mortal is true and Kelly is mortal is
false. This makes Kelly is mortal a logical consequence of
it is necessary that Kelly is mortal. Given that taller
than and it is necessary that, along with other terms, were
not generally regarded as logical terms by logicians of Tarski's day, the
fact that they seem to be logical terms by the common concept of logical
consequence, as observed by Tarski, highlights the question of what it
takes to be a logical term. Tarski says that future research will either
justify the traditional boundary between the logical and the non-logical
or conclude that there is no such boundary and the concept of logical
consequence is a relative concept whose extension is always relative to
some selection of terms as logical (p. 420). For further discussion of
Tarski's views on logical terminology and contemporary views see Logical Consequence, Model-Theoretic
Conceptions: Section 5.3.
How, exactly, does the terminology usually regarded by
logicians as logical work in making it the case that one sentence follows
from others? In the next two sections two distinct approaches to
understanding the nature of logical terms are sketched. Each approach
leads to a unique way of characterizing logical consequence and thus
yields a unique response to the above question.
i. The nature of logical constants explained in terms of their semantic properties
Consider the following metaphor, borrowed from Bencivenga (1999).
The locked room metaphor
Suppose that you are locked in a dark windowless room
and you know everything about your language but nothing about the
world outside. A sentence X and a class K of sentences are presented to
you. If you can determine that X is true if all the sentences in K are, X is
a logical consequence of K.
Ignorant of US politics, I couldn't determine the truth of
Kelly is not US President solely on the basis of Kelly is a
female. However, behind such a veil of ignorance I would be able
to tell that Kelly is not US President is true if Kelly is female
and Kelly is not US President is true. How? Short answer: based on
my linguistic competence; longer answer: based on my understanding of
the semantic contribution of and to the determination of the
truth conditions of a sentence of the form P and Q. For any
sentences P and Q, I know that P and Q is true just in case P is
true and Q is true. So, I know, a priori, if P and Q is
true, then Q is true. As noted by one philosopher, "This really is
remarkable since, after all, it's what they mean, together with the facts
about the non-linguistic world, that decide whether P or Q
are true" (Fodor 2000, p.12).
Taking not and and to be the only logical
constants in (9) Kelly is not both at home and at work, (10)
Kelly is at home, and (11) Kelly is not at work, we
formalize the sentences as follows, letting k mean
Kelly, H mean is at home, and W
mean is at work.
(9') not-(Hk and Wk)
(10') Hk
(11') not-Wk
There is no interpretation of k, H, and
W according to which (9') and (10') are true and (11') is false.
The reason why turns on the semantic properties of and and
not, which are knowable a priori. Suppose (9') and
(10') are true on some interpretation of the variable terms. Then the
meaning of not in (9') makes it the case that Hk and Wk
is false, which, by the meaning of and requires that Hk
is false or Wk is false. Given (10'), it must be that Wk
is false, i.e., not-Wk is true. So, there can't be an interpretation
of the variable terms according to which (9') and (10') are true and (11')
is false, and, as the above reasoning illustrates, this is due exclusively to
the semantic properties of not and and. So the reason
that it is impossible that an interpretation of k, H, and
W make (9') and (10') true and (11') false is that the supposition
otherwise is inconsistent with the semantic functioning of not
and and. Compare: the supposition that there is an
interpretation of k according to which k is a female is
true and k is not US President is false does not seem to violate
the semantic properties of the constant terms. If we identify the
meanings of the predicates with their extensions in all possible worlds,
then the supposition that there is a female U.S. President does not violate
the meanings of female and US President for surely it is
possible that there be a female US President. But, supposing that (9') and
(10') could be true with (11') false on some interpretation of k,
H, and W, violates the semantic properties of either
and or not.
In sum, our first-step characterization of logical consequence is
the following. For a given language L,
X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there is
no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of L
according to which all the sentence in K are true and X is
false.
A possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the
language L according to which sentences are true or false is a reading of
the non-logical terms according to which the sentences receive a
truth-value (i.e., is either true or false) in a situation that is not
ruled out by the
semantic properties of the logical constants. The philosophical locus of
the technical development of 'possible interpretation' in terms of models
is Tarski (1936). A model for a language L is the theoretical
development of a possible interpretation of non-logical terminology of L
according to which the sentences of L receive a truth-value. Models have
become standard tools for characterizing the logical consequence
relation, and the characterization of logical consequence in terms of
models is called the Tarskian or model-theoretic characterization of
logical consequence. We say that X is a model-theoretic consequence of
K if and only if all models of K are models of X. This relation may be
represented as
K  X. If model-theoretic consequence is
adequate as a representation of logical consequence, then it must reflect
the salient features of the common concept, which, according to Tarski
means that it must be necessary, formal and a priori.
For further discussion of this conception of logical consequence,
see the article, Logical Consequence, Model-Theoretic
Conceptions.
ii. The nature of logical constants explained in terms of their inferential properties
We now turn to a second approach to understanding logical constants.
Instead of understanding the nature of logical constants in terms of their
semantic properties as is done on the model-theoretic approach, on the
second approach we appeal to their inferential properties conceived of in
terms of principles of inference, i.e., principles justifying steps in
deductions. We begin with a remark made by
Aristotle. In his study of logical consequence, Aristotle comments that
A syllogism is discourse in which, certain things
being stated, something other than what is stated follows of
necessity from their being so. I mean by the last phrase that they
produce the consequence, and by this, that no further term is
required from without in order to make the consequence
necessary. (Prior Analytics, p. 24b)
Adapting this to our X and K, we may say that X is a logical
consequence of K when the sentences of K are sufficient to produce X.
How are we to think of a sentence being produced by others? One way
of developing this is to appeal to a notion of an actual or possible
deduction. X is a deductive consequence of K if and only if there is a
deduction of X from K. In such a case, we say that X may be correctly
inferred from K or that it would be correct to conclude X from K. A
deduction is associated with a pair ; the set K of sentences
is the basis of the deduction, and X is the conclusion. A deduction from
K to X is a finite sequence S of sentences ending with X such that each
sentence in S (i.e., each intermediate conclusion) is derived from a
sentence (or more) in K or from previous sentences in S in accordance
with a correct principle of inference.
For example, intuitively, the following inference seems correct.
| Kelly is
not both at home and at work |
|
Kelly is at home
|
|
(therefore) | Kelly is not at work |
The set K of sentences above the line is the basis of the inference and
the sentence X below is the conclusion. We represent their logical
forms, again, as follows.
|
(9')
not-(Hk and Wk) |
| (10')
Hk
|
|
(therefore) | (11')
not-Wk |
Consider the following deduction of (11') from (10') and (9').
Deduction: Assume that (12') Wk. Then from
(10') and (12') we may deduce that (13') Hk and Wk. (13')
contradicts (9') and so (12'), our initial assumption, must be false. We
have deduced not-Wk from not-(Hk and Wk) and
Hk.
Since the deduction of not-Wk from not-(Hk and
Wk) and Hk did not depend on the interpretation of
k, W, and H, the deductive relation is formal.
Furthermore, my knowledge of this is a priori because my
knowledge of the underlying principles of inference in the above
deduction is not empirical. For example, letting P and Q be any
sentences, we know a priori that P and Q may be
inferred from the set K={P, Q} of basis sentences. This principle
grounds the move from (10') and (12') to (13'). Also, the deduction
appeals to the principle that if we deduce a contradiction from an
assumption, then we may infer that the assumption is false. The
correctness of this principle seems to be an a priori matter.
Let's look at another example of a deduction.
|
(1) Some children are both lawyers and
peacemakers
|
|
(therefore) | (2) Some children are
peacemakers |
The logical forms are, again, the following.
|
(1') Some S are both M and P |
|
(therefore) | (2') Some S are P |
Again, intuitively, (2') is deducible from (1').
Deduction: The basis tells us that at least one
S--let's call this S 'a'--is both an M and
a P. Clearly, a is a P may be deduced from a is both an M and a
P. Since we've assumed that a is an S, what we derive with
respect to a we derive with respect to some S. So our
derivation of a is a P is a derivation of Some S is a P,
which is our desired conclusion.
Since the deduction is formal, we have shown not merely that (2) can
be correctly inferred from (1), but we have shown that for any
interpretation of S, M, and P it is correct to
infer (2') from (1').
Typically, deductions leave out steps (perhaps because they are
too obvious), and they usually do not justify each and every step made in
moving towards the conclusion (again, obviousness begets brevity). The
notion of a deduction is made precise by describing a mechanism for
constructing deductions that are both transparent and rigorous (each step
is explicitly justified and no steps are omitted). This mechanism is a
deductive system (also known as a formal system or as a formal proof
calculus). A deductive system D is a collection of rules that govern
which sequences of sentences, associated with a given , are
allowed and which are not. Such a sequence is called a proof in D (or,
equivalently, a deduction in D) of X from K. The rules must be such that
whether or not a given sequence associated with qualifies
as a proof in D of X from K is decidable purely by inspection and
calculation. That is, the rules provide a purely mechanical procedure for
deciding whether a given object is a proof in D of X from K.
We say that a deductive system D is correct when for any K and
X, proofs in D of X from K correspond to intuitively valid deductions.
For example, intuitively, there are no correct principles of inference
according to which it is correct to conclude
Some animals are both mammals and
reptiles
on the basis of the following two sentences.
Some animals are mammals
Some animals are reptiles
Hence, a proof in a deductive system of the former sentence from the
latter two is evidence that the deductive system is incorrect. The point
here is that a proof in D may fail to represent a deduction if D is
incorrect.
A rich variety of deductive systems have been developed for
registering deductions. Each system has its advantages and
disadvantages, which are assessed in the context of the more specific
tasks the deductive system is designed to accomplish. Historically, the
general purpose of the construction of deductive systems was to reduce
reasoning to precise mechanical rules (Hodges 1983, p. 26). Some view a
deductive system defined for a language L as a mathematical model of
actual or possible chains of correct reasoning in L. Sundholm (1983)
offers a thorough survey of three main types of deductive systems. For a
shorter, excellent introduction to the concept of a deductive system see
Henkin (1967). A deductive system is developed in detail in the
accompanying article, Logical Consequence,
Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions.
If there is a proof of X from K in deductive system D, then we
may say that X is a deductive consequence in D of K, which is
sometimes expressed as K  D X.
Relative to a correct
deductive system D, we characterize logical consequence in terms of
deductive consequence as follows.
X is a logical consequence of K if and only if X is a
deductive consequence in D of K, i.e., there is an actual or possible proof
in D of X from K.
This is called the deductive-theoretic (or proof-theoretic)
characterization of logical consequence.
3. Model-Theoretic and Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions of Logic
We began with Tarski's observations of the common or ordinary concept of
logical consequence that we employ in daily life. According to Tarski, if X
is a logical consequence of a set of sentences, K, then, in virtue of the
logical forms of the sentences involved, if all of the members of K are
true, then X must be true, and furthermore, we know this a priori. The
formality criterion makes the logical constants the essential determinant of
the logical consequence relation. The logical consequence relation is fixed
exclusively in terms of the nature of the logical terminology. We have
highlighted two different approaches to the nature of a logical constant:
(1) in terms of its semantic contribution to sentences in which it occurs
and (2) in terms of its inferential properties. The two approaches yield
distinct conceptions of the notion of necessity inherent in the common
concept of logical consequence, and lead to the following characterizations
of logical consequence.
(1) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there
is no possible interpretation of the non-logical terminology of the
language according to which all the sentences in K are true and X is
false.
(2) X is a logical consequence of K if and only if X is
deducible from K.
We make the notions of possible interpretation in (1)
and deducibility in (2) precise by appealing to the technical
notions of model and deductive system. This leads to
the following theoretical characterizations of logical consequence.
(1) The model-theoretic characterization of logical
consequence: X is a logical consequence of K iff all models of K are
models of X.
(2) The deductive- theoretic characterization of logical
consequence: X is a logical consequence of K iff there is a
deduction in a correct deductive system of X from K.
Following Shapiro (1991, p. 3) define a logic to be a language L
plus either a model-theoretic or a deductive-theoretic account of logical
consequence. A language with both characterizations is a full logic just
in case both characterizations coincide. A soundness proof establishes K
D X only if K X, and a completeness proof
establishes K D X if K X. These proofs together establish
that the two characterizations coincide, and in such a case the deductive
system D is said to be complete and sound with respect to the
model-theoretic consequence relation defined for the relevant language L.
We said that the primary aim of logic is to tell us what follows
logically from what. These two characterizations of logical consequence
lead to two different orientations or conceptions of logic (see Tharp
1975, p. 5).
Model-theoretic approach: Logic is a theory
of possible interpretations. For a given language the class of
situations that can--logically--be described by that language.
Deductive-theoretic approach: Logic is a theory
of formal deductive inference.
The article now concludes by highlighting three considerations
relevant to evaluating a particular deployment of the model-theoretic or
deductive-theoretic definition in defining logical consequence. These
considerations emerge from the above development of the two theoretic
definitions from the common concept of logical consequence.
4. Conclusion
The two theoretical characterizations of logical consequence do
not provide the means for drawing a boundary in a language L between
logical and non-logical terms. Indeed, their use presupposes that a list of
logical terms is in hand. Hence, in evaluating a model-theoretic or
deductive-theoretic definition of logical consequence for a language L
the issue arises whether or not the boundary in L between logical and
non-logical terms has been correctly drawn. This requires a response to
a central question in the philosophy of logic: what qualifies as a logical
constant? Tarski gives a well-reasoned response in his (1986). (For
more recent discussion see McCarthy 1981 and 1998, Hanson 1997, and
Warbrod 1999.)
A second thing to consider in evaluating a theoretical account of
logical consequence is whether or not its characterization of the
logical terminology is accurate. For example, model-theoretic
and deductive accounts of logical consequence are inadequate unless
they reflect the semantic and inferential properties of the logical terms,
respectively. So a model-theoretic account is inadequate unless it gets
right the semantic contributions of the logical terms to the truth
conditions of the sentences formed using them. For a particular deductive
system D, the question arises whether or not D's rules of inference reflect
the inferential properties of the logical terms. (For further discussion of
the semantic and inferential properties of logical terms see Haack 1978
and 1996, Read 1995, and Quine 1986.)
A third consideration in assessing the success of a theoretical
definition of logical consequence is whether or not the definition, relative
to a selection of terms as logical, reflects the salient features of the
common concept of logical consequence. There are criticisms of the
theoretical definitions that claim that they are incapable of reflecting the
common concept of logical consequence. Typically, such criticisms are
used to question the status of the model-theoretic and deductive-theoretic
approaches to logic.
For example, there are critics who question the model-theoretic
approach to logic by arguing that any model-theoretic account lacks the
conceptual resources to reflect the notion of necessity inherent in the
common concept of logical consequence because such an account does
not rule out the possibility of there being logically possible situations in
which sentences in K are true and X is false even though every model of
K is a model of X. Kneale (1961) is an early critic, Etchemendy (1988,
1999) offers a sustained and multi-faceted attack. Also, it is
argued that the model-theoretic approach to logic makes knowledge of
what follows from what depend on knowledge of the existence of
models, which is knowledge of worldly matters of fact. But logical
knowledge should not depend on knowledge about the extra-linguistic
world (recall the locked room metaphor in 2.2.1). This standard logical
positivist line has been recently challenged by those who see logic
penetrated and permeated by metaphysics (e.g., Putnam 1971, Almog
1989, Sher 1991, Williamson 1999).
The status of the deductive-theoretic approach to logic is not
clear for, as Tarski argues in his (1936), deductive-theoretic accounts are
unable to reflect the fact that, according to the common concept, logical
consequence is not compact. Relative to any deductive system D, the
D-consequence relation is
compact if and only if for any
sentence X and set K of sentences, if K D X, then K'
D X, where K' is a finite subset
of sentences from K. But
there are intuitively correct principles of inference according to which
one may infer a sentence X from a set K of sentences, even though it is
incorrect to infer X from any finite subset of K. This suggests that the intuitive
notion of deducibility is not completely captured by any compact
consequence relation. We need
to weaken
X is a logical consequence of K if and only if there is a
proof in a correct deductive system of X from K,
given above, to
X is a logical consequence of K if there is a proof in a
correct deductive system of X from K.
In sum, the issue of the nature of logical consequence, which
intersects with other areas of philosophy, is still a matter of debate.
Tarski's analysis of the concept is not universally accepted; philosophers
and logicians differ over what the features of the common concept are.
For example, some offer accounts of the logical consequence relation
according to which it is not a priori (e.g., see Koslow 1999,
Sher 1991 and see Hanson 1997 for criticism of Sher) or deny that it
even need be strongly necessary (Smiley 1995, 2000, section 6). The
entry Logical Consequence, Model-Theoretic
Conceptions gives a model-theoretic definition of logical
consequence. For a detailed development of a deductive system see the
entry Logical Consequence,
Deductive-Theoretic Conceptions. The critical discussion in both articles
deepens and extends points made in the conclusion of this article.
5. Suggestions for Further Reading
Almog, J. (1989): "Logic and the World", pp. 43-65 in Themes
From Kaplan, ed. J. Almog, J. Perry, J., and H. Wettstein. New
York: Oxford UP.
Aristotle. (1941): Basic Works, ed. R. McKeon. New York:
Random House.
Bencivenga, E. (1999): "What is Logic About?", pp. 5-19 in Varzi
(1999).
Etchemendy, J. (1983): "The Doctrine of Logic as Form",
Linguistics and
Philosophy 6, pp. 319-334.
Etchemendy, J. (1988): "Tarski on truth and logical consequence",
Journal of Symbolic Logic 53, pp. 51-79.
Etchemendy, J. (1999): The Concept of Logical
Consequence. Stanford: CSLI Publications.
Fodor, J. (2000): The Mind Doesn't Work That Way.
Cambridge: The MIT Press.
Gabbay, D. and F. Guenthner, eds. (1983): Handbook of
Philosophical Logic, Vol 1. Dordrecht: D. Reidel Publishing
Company.
Haack, S. (1978): Philosophy of Logics . Cambridge:
Cambridge University Press.
Haack, S. (1996): Deviant Logic, Fuzzy Logic. Chicago:
The University of Chicago Press.
Hodges, W. (1983): "Elementary Predicate Logic", in Gabbay, D.
and F. Guenthner (1983).
Hamlyn, D.W. (1967): "A Priori and A Posteriori", pp.105-109 in
The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Vol. 1, ed. P. Edwards. New
York: Macmillan & The Free Press.
Hanson, W. (1997): "The Concept of Logical Consequence", The
Philosophical Review 106, pp. 365-409.
Henkin, L. (1967): "Formal Systems and Models of Formal
Systems", pp. 61-74 in The Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Vol. 8,
ed. P. Edwards. New York: Macmillan & The Free Press.
Kneale, W. (1961): "Universality and Necessity", British Journal
for the Philosophy of Science 12, pp. 89-102.
Koslow, A. (1999): "The Implicational Nature of Logic: A
Structuralist Account", pp. 111-155 in Varzi (1999).
McCarthy, T. (1981): "The Idea of a Logical Constant", Journal
of Philosophy 78, pp. 499-523.
McCarthy, T. (1998): "Logical Constants", pp. 599-603 in
Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy, Vol. 5, ed. E. Craig.
London: Routledge.
McGee, V. (1999): "Two Problems with Tarski's Theory of
Consequence", Proceedings of the Aristotelean Society 92, pp.
273-292.
Moore, G.E., (1959): "Certainty", pp. 227-251 in Philosophical
Papers. London: George Allen & Unwin.
Priest. G. (1995): "Etchemendy and Logical Consequence",
Canadian Journal of Philosophy 25, pp. 283-292.
Putnam, H. (1971): Philosophy of Logic. New York: Harper
& Row.
Quine, W.V. (1986): Philosophy of Logic, 2nd ed..
Cambridge: Harvard UP.
Read, S. (1995): Thinking About Logic. Oxford: Oxford
UP.
Shapiro, S. (1991): Foundations without Foundationalism: A
Case For Second-Order Logic. Oxford: Clarendon Press.
Shapiro, S. (1993): " Modality and Ontology", Mind 102, pp.
455-481.
Shapiro, S. (1998): "Logical Consequence: Models and Modality",
pp. 131-156 in The Philosophy of Mathematics Today, ed.
Matthias Schirn. Oxford, Clarendon Press.
Shapiro, S. (2000): Thinking About Mathematics , Oxford:
Oxford University Press.
Sher, G. (1989): "A Conception of Tarskian Logic", Pacific
Philosophical Quarterly 70, pp. 341-368.
Sher, G. (1991): The Bounds of Logic: A Generalized
Viewpoint, Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
Sher, G. (1996): "Did Tarski commit 'Tarski's fallacy'?" Journal
of Symbolic Logic 61, pp. 653-686.
Sher, G. (1999): "Is Logic a Theory of the Obvious?", pp. 207-238 in
Varzi (1999).
Smiley, T. (1995): "A Tale of Two Tortoises", Mind 104,
pp. 725-36.
Smiley, T. (1998): "Consequence, Conceptions of", pp. 599-603 in
Routledge Encyclopedia of Philosophy, vol. 2, ed. E. Craig.
London: Routledge.
Sundholm, G. (1983): "Systems of Deduction", in Gabbay and
Guenthner (1983).
Tarski, A. (1933): "Pojecie prawdy w jezykach nauk dedukeycyjnych",
translated as "On the Concept of Truth in Formalized Languages", pp. 152-278
in Tarski (1983).
Tarski, A. (1936): "On the Concept of Logical Consequence", pp.
409-420 in Tarski (1983).
Tarski, A. (1983): Logic, Semantics, Metamathematics, 2nd
ed. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing.
Tarski, A. (1986): "What are logical notions?" History and
Philosophy of Logic 7, pp. 143-154.
Tharp, L. (1975): "Which Logic is the Right Logic?"
Synthese 31, pp. 1-21.
Warbrod, K., (1999): "Logical Constants" Mind 108, pp.
503-538.
Williamson, T. (1999): "Existence and Contingency",
Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society Supplementary Vol. 73,
pp. 181-203.
Varzi, A., ed. (1999): European Review of Philosophy, Vol. 4:
The Nature of Logic, Stanford: CSLI Publications.
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