German philosopher; born at Bautzen (31 m. e.n.e. of Dresden), Saxony, May 21, 1817; died at Berlin July 1, 1881. He studied philosophy and medicine at the University of Leipsic, taking degrees in both subjects, and became extraordinary professor of philosophy there in 1842. He was called to Gottingenin 1844, and to Berlin in 1881, but here he was able to lecture only a part of one semester. Lotze was one of the most influential philosophers of the second half of the nineteenth century, and he has man followers, particularly among theologians. This is explained by the fact that in his speculation ethical and religious needs come into their full rights. His philosophy represents a reaction against the ideological pantheism of Hegel, which seemed to sacrifice all individuality and variety in existence to a formal and abstract scheme of development. Lotze characterized his philosophical standpoint as teleological idealism, and he regarded ethics as the starting-point of metaphysics. While enforcing the mechanical view of nature, he sought to show that mechanism, the relation of cause and effect, is incomprehensible, except as the realization of a world of moral ideas. Thus, each causal series becomes at the same time a teleological series. Lotze worked out this reconciliation of mechanism and teleology by combining with the monads of Leibniz the absolute substance of Spinoza, in which individual things (monads) are grounded, and through whose all-inclusive unity interrelation is possible. Some of Lotze's more important works are: Metaphysik (Leipsic, 1841); Logik (1843); Medizinische Psychologie oder Physiologie der Seele (1852); Mikrokosmus. Ideen zur Naturge8chichte und Geschichte der Menschheit (3 vols., 185"4; Eng. transl., 2 vols., Edinburgh, 1885), his principal work; Geschichte der Aesthetik in Deutschland (Munich, 1868); and the unfinished System der Philosophie (vol. i., Logik, Leipsic, 1874; vol. ii., Metaphysik, 1879; Eng. transl. of both, 2 parts, Oxford, 1884). After Lotze's death appeared Diktate, notes from his lectures on the various philosophical disciplines (8 parts, Leipsic, 1882-84; Eng. transl. by G. T. Ladd, Outline, 6 vols., Boston, 1884-1887); also Kleine Schriften (3 vols., Leipsic, 1885-1894).

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