As an academic, philosopher, and statesman, Sarvepalli Radhakrishnan
(1888-1975) is one of the most recognized and influential
Indian thinkers in academic circles in the 20th century.
Throughout his life and extensive writing career, Radhakrishnan
sought to define, defend, and promulgate his religion, a
religion he variously identified as
Hinduism, Vedanta, and
the religion of the Spirit. He sought to demonstrate that
his Hinduism was both philosophically coherent and ethically
viable. Radhakrishnan's concern for experience and
his extensive knowledge of the Western philosophical and
literary traditions has earned him the reputation of being
a bridge-builder between India and the West. He often appears
to feel at home in the Indian as well as the Western philosophical
contexts, and draws from both Western and Indian sources
throughout his writing. Because of this, Radhakrishnan has
been held up in academic circles as a representative of
Hinduism to the West. His lengthy writing career and his
many published works have been influential in shaping the
West's understanding of Hinduism, India, and the East.
Rather little detail is known of Radhakrishnan's
earliest childhood and education. Radhakrishnan rarely spoke
about his personal life, and what he does reveal comes to
us after several decades of reflection. Radhakrishnan was
born in Tirutani, Andhra Pradesh into a brahmin family,
likely smarta in religious orientation. Predominantly Hindu,
Tirutani was a temple town and popular pilgrimage center,
and Radhakrishnan's family were active participants
in the devotional activities there. The implicit acceptance
of Śaṅkara's Advaita by the smarta tradition is good
evidence to suggest that an advaitic framework was an important,
though latent, feature of Radhakrishnan's early philosophical
and religious sensibilities.
In 1896, Radhakrishnan was sent to school in the nearby
pilgrimage center of Tirupati, a town with a distinctively
cosmopolitan flavor, drawing bhaktas from all parts of India.
For four years, Radhakrishnan attended the Hermannsburg
Evangelical Lutheran Missionary school. It was there that
the young Radhakrishnan first encountered non-Hindu missionaries
and 19th century Christian theology with its impulse toward
personal religious experience. The theology taught in the
missionary school may have found resonance with the highly
devotional activities connected with the nearby Tirumala
temple, activities that Radhakrishnan undoubtedly would
have witnessed taking place outside the school. The shared
emphasis on personal religious experience may have suggested
to Radhakrishnan a common link between the religion of the
missionaries and the religion practiced at the nearby Tirumala
temple.
Between 1900 and 1904, Radhakrishnan attended Elizabeth
Rodman Voorhees College in Vellore, a school run by the
American Arcot Mission of the Reformed Church in America.
The mandate of the Mission was to preach the gospel, to
publish vernacular tracts, and to educate the "heathen"
masses. It was here, as Robert Minor points out, that Radhakrishnan
was "introduced to the Dutch Reform Theology, which
emphasized a righteous God, unconditional grace, and election,
and which criticized Hinduism as intellectually incoherent
and ethically unsound." At the same time, the Mission
demonstrated an active concern for education, health care,
and social uplift through its participation in famine relief,
the establishment of hospitals, and education for all irrespective
of social status. Such activities were not inconsistent
with the mandate of the Mission as they often served as
incentives for conversion. In was in this atmosphere that
Radhakrishnan encountered what would have appeared to him
as crippling assaults on his Hindu sensibilities. He also
would have witnessed the positive contributions of the social
programs undertaken by the Mission in the name of propagation
of the Christian gospel.
Thus, Radhakrishnan inherited from his upbringing a tacit
acceptance of Śaṅkara's Advaita Vedanta and an awareness
of the centrality of devotional practices associated with
the smarta tradition. His experiences at Tirupati brought
him into contact with Lutheran Christian missionaries whose
theological emphasis on personal religious experience may
have suggested to him a common ground between Christianity
and his own religious heritage. In Vellore, the presence
of a systematic social gospel was intimately bound up with
the religion of those who sought to censure Radhakrishnan's
cultural norms and religious worldview.
Radhakrishnan was married to his wife of over 50 years,
Sivakamuamma, in 1904 while living in Vellore. The couple
went on to have six children: five daughters and a son.
It is in this historical and hermeneutic contexts and with
these experiences informing his worldview that Radhakrishnan
encountered a resurgent Hinduism. Specifically, Radhakrishnan
encountered the writings of Swami Vivekananda and V.D. Savarkar's
The First War of Indian Independence. The Theosophical
Society was also active in the South Arcot area at this
time. The Theosophists not only applauded the ancient wisdom
they claimed to have found in India, but were persistent
advocates of a philosophical, spiritual, and scientific
meeting of East and West. Moreover, the Society's
role in the Indian nationalist movement is evidenced by
Annie Besant's involvement with the Indian National
Congress. While Radhakrishnan does not speak of the Theosophists
presence at this time, it is unlikely that he would have
been unfamiliar with their views.
What Vivekananda, Savarkar, and Theosophy did bring to
Radhakrishnan was a sense of cultural self-confidence and
self-reliance. However, the affirmation Radhakrishnan received
from this resurgence of Hinduism did not push Radhakrishnan
to study philosophy nor to interpret his own religion. It
was only after Radhakrishnan's experiences at Madras
Christian College that he began to put down in writing his
own understanding of Hinduism.
Two key influences on Radhakrishnan at Madras Christian
College left an indelible stamp on Radhakrishnan's sensibilities.
First, it was here that Radhakrishnan was trained in European
philosophy. Radhakrishnan was introduced to the philosophies
of Berkeley,
Leibniz,
Locke, Spinoza,
Kant, J.S. Mill,
Herbert Spencer,
Fichte,
Hegel,
Aristotle,
and Plato
among others. Radhakrishnan was also introduced to the philosophical
methods and theological views of his MA supervisor and most
influential non-Indian mentor, Professor A.G. Hogg. Hogg
was a Scottish Presbyterian missionary who was educated
in the theology of Albrecht Ritschl and studied under the
philosopher Andrew Seth Pringle-Pattison. As a student of
Arthur Titius, himself a student of Albrecht Ritschl, Hogg
adopted the Ritschlian distinction between religious value
judgments, with their emphasis on subjective perception,
and theoretical knowledge, which seeks to discover the nature
of ultimate reality. Religious value judgments give knowledge
which is different from, though not necessarily opposed
to, theoretical knowledge. For Ritschl, and subsequently
for Titius and Hogg, this distinction led to the conclusion
that doctrines and scriptures are records of personal insights
and are therefore necessary for religious, and specifically
Christian, faith. This distinction left its mark on Radhakrishnan's
philosophical and religious thinking and resonates throughout
his writing.
A second key factor shaping Radhakrishnan's sensibilities
during this time is that it was at Madras Christian College
that Radhakrishnan encountered intense religious polemic
in an academic setting. Radhakrishnan later recalled: "The
challenge of Christian critics impelled me to make a study
of Hinduism and find out what is living and what is dead
in it... I prepared a thesis on the Ethics of the Vedanta,
which was intended to be a reply to the charge that the
Vedanta system had no room for ethics" (MST 19).
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1c.
Early Teaching and Writing (1908-1912)
Upon the completion of his MA degree in
1908, Radhakrishnan found himself at both a financial
and professional crossroads. His obligations to his family
precluded him from applying for a scholarship to study
in Britain and he struggled without success to find work
in Madras. The following year, with the assistance of
William Skinner at Madras Christian College, Radhakrishnan
was able to secure what was intended to be a temporary
teaching position at Presidency College in Madras.
At Presidency College, Radhakrishnan lectured
on a variety of topics in psychology as well as in European
philosophy. As a junior Assistant Professor, logic, epistemology
and ethical theory were his stock areas of instruction.
At the College, Radhakrishnan also learned Sanskrit.
During these years, Radhakrishnan was anxious
to have his work published, not only by Indian presses
but also in European journals. The Guardian Press in Madras
published his MA thesis, and scarcely revised portions
of this work appeared in Modern Review and The
Madras Christian College Magazine. While Radhakrishnan's
efforts met with success in other Indian journals, it
was not until his article "The Ethics of the Bhagavadgita
and Kant" appeared in The International Journal of
Ethics in 1911 that Radhakrishnan broke through to
a substantial Western audience. As well, his edited lecture
notes on psychology were published under the title Essentials
of Psychology.
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1d.
The War, Tagore, and Mysore (1914-1920)
By 1914, Radhakrishnan's reputation
as a scholar was beginning to grow. However, the security
of a permanent academic post in Madras eluded him. For
three months in 1916 he was posted to Anantapur, Andhra
Pradesh, and in 1917 he was transferred yet again, this
time to Rajahmundry. Only after spending a year in Rajahmundry
did Radhakrishnan find some degree of professional security
upon his acceptance of a position in philosophy at Mysore
University. This hiatus in his occupational angst would
be short lived. His most prestigious Indian academic appointment
to the George V Chair in Philosophy at Calcutta University
in February of 1921 would take him out of South India
for the first time only two and a half years later.
Between 1914 and 1920, Radhakrishnan continued
to publish. He authored eighteen articles, ten of which
were published in prominent Western journals such as The
International Journal of Ethics, The Monist,
and Mind. Throughout these articles, Radhakrishnan
took it upon himself to refine and expand upon his interpretation
of Hinduism.
There is a strong polemical tenor to many
of these articles. Radhakrishnan was no longer content
simply to define and defend Vedanta. Instead, he sought
to confront directly not only Vedanta's Western
competitors, but what he saw as the Western philosophical
enterprise and the Western ethos in general.
Radhakrishnan's polemical sensibilities
during these years were heightened in no small part by
the political turmoil both on the Indian as well as on
the world stage. Radhakrishnan's articles and books during
this period reflect his desire to offer a sustainable
philosophical response to the unfolding discontent he
encountered. World War One and its aftermath, and in particular
the events in Amritsar in the spring of 1919, further
exacerbated Radhakrishnan's patience with what he saw
as an irrational, dogmatic, and despotic West. Radhakrishnan's
1920 The Reign of Religion in Contemporary Philosophy
is indicative of his heightened polemical sensibilities
during this period.
A more positive factor in Radhakrishnan's
life during these years was his reading of Rabindranath
Tagore, the Bengali poet. Radhakrishnan joined the rest
of the English-speaking world in 1912 in reading Tagore's
translated works. Though the two had never met at this
time, Tagore would become perhaps Radhakrishnan's
most influential Indian mentor. Tagore's poetry
and prose resonated with Radhakrishnan. He appreciated
Tagore's emphasis on aesthetics as well as his appeal
to intuition. From 1914 on, both of these notions -- aesthetics
and intuition -- begin to find their place in Radhakrishnan's
own interpretations of experience, the epistemological
category for his philosophical and religious proclivities.
Over the next five decades, Radhakrishnan would repeatedly
appeal to Tagore's writing to support his own philosophical
ideals.
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1e.
Calcutta and the George V Chair (1921-31)
In 1921, Radhakrishnan took up the prestigious
George V Chair in Philosophy at Calcutta University. As
an honored, though hesitant, heir to Brajendranath Seal,
Radhakrishnan's appointment to the chair was not
without its dissenters who sought a fellow Bengali for
the position. In Calcutta, Radhakrishnan was for the first
time out of his South Indian element -- geographically,
culturally, and linguistically.
However, the isolation Radhakrishnan experienced
during his early years in Calcutta allowed him to work
on his two volume Indian Philosophy, the first of which
he began while in Mysore and published in 1923 and the
second followed four years later. Throughout the 1920s,
Radhakrishnan's reputation as a scholar continued to grow
both in India and abroad. He was invited to Oxford to
give the 1926 Upton Lectures, published in 1927 as The
Hindu View of Life, and in 1929 Radhakrishnan delivered
the Hibbert Lectures, later published under the
title An Idealist View of Life. The later of
these two Views is Radhakrishnan's most sustained, non-commentarial
work. An Idealist View of Life is frequently
seen as Radhakrishnan's mature work and has undoubtedly
received the bulk of scholarly attention on Radhakrishnan.
While Radhakrishnan enjoyed a growing scholarly
repute, he was also confronted in Calcutta with growing
conflict and confrontation. The events of Amritsar in
1919 did little to encourage positive relations between
Indians and the British Raj; and Gandhi's on again-off
again Rowlatt satyagraha was proving ineffective
in cultivating a united Indian voice. The ambiguity of
the Montagu-Chelmsford Reforms with their olive branch
for "responsible government" further fragmented an already
divided Congress. The Khalifat movement splintered the
Indian Muslim community, and aggravated the growing animosity
between its supporters and those, Muslim or otherwise,
who saw it as a side issue to swaraj (self-rule).
But the racial paternalism of the 1927 Simon Commission
prompted a resurgence of nationalist sentiment. While
Indian solidarity and protest received international attention,
due in no small part to the media coverage of Gandhi's
Salt March, such national unity was readily shaken. Indian
political consensus, much less swaraj, proved elusive.
Communal division and power struggles on the part of Indians
and a renewed conservatism in Britain crippled the London
Round Table Conferences of the early 1930s, reinforcing
and perpetuating an already highly fragmented and politically
volatile India.
With the publication of An Idealist
View of Life, Radhakrishnan had come into his own
philosophically. In his mind, he had identified the "religious"
problem, reviewed the alternatives, and posited a solution.
An unreflective dogmatism could not be remedied by escaping
from "experiential religion" which is the true basis of
all religions. Rather, a recognition of the creative potency
of integral experience tempered by a critical scientific
attitude was, Radhakrishnan believed, the only viable
corrective to dogmatic claims of exclusivity founded on
external, second-hand authority. Moreover, while Hinduism
(Advaita Vedanta) as he defined it best exemplified his
position, Radhakrishnan claimed that the genuine philosophical,
theological, and literary traditions in India and the
West supported his position.
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1f.
The 1930s and 1940s
Radhakrishnan was knighted in 1931, the
same year he took up his administrative post as Vice Chancellor
at the newly founded, though scarcely constructed, Andhra
University at Waltair. Sir Radhakrishnan served there
for five years as Vice Chancellor, when, in 1936, not
only did the university in Calcutta affirm his position
in perpetuity but Oxford University appointed him to the
H.N. Spalding Chair of Eastern Religions and Ethics. In
late 1939, Radhakrishnan took up his second Vice Chancellorship
at Benares Hindu University (BHU), and served there during
the course of the second world war until mid-January 1948,
two weeks before Gandhi's assassination in New Delhi.
Shortly after his resignation from BHU,
Radhakrishnan was named chairman of the University Education
Commission. The Commission's 1949 Report assessed
the state of university education and made recommendations
for its improvement in the newly independent India. Though
co-authored by others, Radhakrishnan's hand is felt
especially in the chapters on The Aims of University Education
and Religious Education.
During these years, the
question
of nationalism occupied Radhakrishnan's attention. The
growing communalism Radhakrishnan had witnessed in the
1920s was further intensified with the ideological flowering
of the Hindu Mahasabha under the leadership of Bhai Parmanand
and his heir V.D. Savarkar. Likewise, Muhammad Iqbal's
1930 poetic vision and call for Muslim self-assertion
furnished Muhammad Jinnah with an ideological template
in which to lay claim to an independent Pakistan. This
claim was given recognition at the Round Table Conferences
in London early that decade. If the Montagu-Chelmsford
Reforms had in the 1920s served to fracture already fragile
political alliances, its 1935 progeny as the Government
of India Act with its promise for greater self-government
further crowded the political stage and divided those
groups struggling for their share of power. During these
years, the spectrum of nationalist vision was as broad
as Indian solidarity was elusive.
The issues of education and nationalism
come together for Radhakrishnan during this period. For
Radhakrishnan, a university education which quickened
the development of the whole individual was the only responsible
and practical means to the creation of Indian solidarity
and clarity of national vision. Throughout the 1930s and
1940s, Radhakrishnan expressed his vision of an autonomous
India. He envisioned an India built and guided by those
who were truly educated, by those who had a personal vision
of and commitment to raising Indian self-consciousness.
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1g.
Post-Independence: Vice-Presidency and Presidency
The years following Indian independence
mark Radhakrishnan's increasing involvement in Indian
political as well as in international affairs. The closing
years of the 1940s were busy ones. Radhakrishnan had been
actively involved in the newly incorporated UNESCO (United
Nations Educational, Scientific, and Cultural Organization),
serving on its Executive Board as well as leading the
Indian delegation from 1946-1951. Radhakrishnan also served
for the two years immediately following India's
independence as a member of the Indian Constituent Assembly.
Radhakrishnan's time and energy to UNESCO and the
Constituent Assembly had also to be shared by the demands
of the University Commission and his continuing obligations
as Spalding Professor at Oxford.
With the Report of the Universities Commission
complete in 1949, Radhakrishnan was appointed by then
Prime Minister Jawaharlal Nehru as Indian Ambassador to
Moscow, a post he held until 1952. The opportunity for
Radhakrishnan to put into practice his own philosophical-political
ideals came with his election to the Raja Sabha, in which
he served as India's Vice-President (1952-1962)
and later as President (1962-1967).
Radhakrishnan saw during his terms in office
an increasing need for world unity and universal fellowship.
The urgency of this need was pressed home to Radhakrishnan
by what he saw as the unfolding crises throughout the
world. At the time of his taking up the office of Vice-President,
the Korean war was already in full swing. Political tensions
with China in the early 1960s followed by the hostilities
between India and Pakistan dominated Radhakrishnan's
presidency. Moreover, the Cold War divided East and West
leaving each side suspicious of the other and on the defensive.
Radhakrishnan challenged what he saw as
the divisive potential and dominating character of self-professed
international organizations such as the League of Nations.
Instead, he called for the promotion of a creative internationalism
based on the spiritual foundations of integral experience.
Only then could understanding and tolerance between peoples
and between nations be promoted.
Radhakrishnan retired from public life in
1967. He spent the last eight years of his life at the
home he built in Mylapore, Madras. Radhakrishnan died
on April 17, 1975.
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2.
The Philosophy of Sarvepalli Radhakrishnan
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2a.
Metaphysics
Radhakrishnan located his metaphysics within
the Advaita (non-dual) Vedanta tradition (sampradaya).
And like other Vedantins before him, Radhakrishnan wrote
commentaries on the Prasthanatraya (that is, main primary
texts of Vedanta ): the Upanisads (1953), Brahma
Sutra (1959), and the Bhagavadgita (1948).
As an Advaitin, Radhakrishnan embraced a
metaphysical idealism. But Radhakrishnan's idealism was
such that it recognized the reality and diversity of the
world of experience (prakṛti) while at the same
time preserving the notion of a wholly transcendent Absolute
(Brahman), an Absolute that is identical to the self (Atman).
While the world of experience and of everyday things is
certainly not ultimate reality as it is subject to change
and is characterized by finitude and multiplicity, it
nonetheless has its origin and support in the Absolute
(Brahman) which is free from all limits, diversity, and
distinctions (nirguṇa). Brahman is the source
of the world and its manifestations, but these modes do
not affect the integrity of Brahman.
In this vein, Radhakrishnan did not merely
reiterate the metaphysics of Śaṅkara (8th century C.E.),
arguably Advaita Vedanta's most prominent and enduring
figure, but sought to reinterpret Advaita for present
needs. In particular, Radhakrishnan reinterpreted what
he saw as Śaṅkara's understanding of maya strictly
as illusion. For Radhakrishnan, maya ought not
to be understood to imply a strict objective idealism,
one in which the world is taken to be inherently disconnected
from Brahman, but rather maya indicates, among
other things, a subjective misperception of the world
as ultimately real. [See Donald Braue, Maya in Radhakrishnan's
Thought: Six Meanings Other Than Illusion (1985)
for a full treatment of this issue.]
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2b.
Epistemology: Intuition and the Varieties of Experience
This section deals with Radhakrishnan's
understanding of intuition and his interpretations of
experience. It begins with a general survey of the variety
of terms as well as the characteristics Radhakrishnan
associates with intuition. It then details with how Radhakrishnan
understands specific occurrences of intuition in relation
to other forms of experience -- cognitive, psychic, aesthetic,
ethical, and religious.
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2b.i.
Intuition
Radhakrishnan associates a vast constellation
of terms with intuition. At its best, intuition is an
"integral experience". Radhakrishnan uses
the term "integral" in at least three ways.
First, intuition is integral in the sense that it coordinates
and synthesizes all other experiences. It integrates all
other experiences into a more unified whole. Second, intuition
is integral as it forms the basis of all other experiences.
In other words, Radhakrishnan holds that all experiences
are at bottom intuitional. Third, intuition is integral
in the sense that the results of the experience are integrated
into the life of the individual. For Radhakrishnan, intuition
finds expression in the world of action and social relations.
At times Radhakrishnan prefers to emphasize
the "mystical" and "spiritual"
quality of intuition as attested to by the expressions
"religious experience" (IVL 91), "religious
consciousness" (IVL 199), "mystical experience"
(IVL 88), "spiritual idealism" (IVL 87), "self-existent
spiritual experience" (IVL 99), "prophetic
indications" and "the real ground in man's
deepest being" (IVL 103), "spiritual apprehension"
(IVL 103), "moments of vision" (IVL 94), "revelation"
(IVL 210), "supreme light" (IVL 206), and
even "faith" (IVL 199). But it is the creative
potency of intuition, designated by Radhakrishnan's
reference to the "creative center" of the
individual (IVL 113), "creative intuition"
(IVL 205), "creative spirit" (IVL 206), and
"creative energy" (IVL 205), that is the lynchpin
for Radhakrishnan's understanding of intuition.
As Radhakrishnan understands it, all progress is the result
of the creative potency of intuition.
For Radhakrishnan, intuition is a distinct
form of experience. Intuition is of a self-certifying
character (svatassiddha). It is sufficient and
complete. It is self-established (svatasiddha),
self-evidencing (svāsaṃvedya), and self-luminous
(svayam-prakāsa) (IVL 92). Intuition entails
pure comprehension, entire significance, complete validity
(IVL 93). It is both truth-filled and truth-bearing (IVL
93). Intuition is its own cause and its own explanation
(IVL 92). It is sovereign (IVL 92). Intuition is a positive
feeling of calm and confidence, joy and strength (IVL
93). Intuition is profoundly satisfying (IVL 93). It is
peace, power and joy (IVL 93).
Intuition is the ultimate form of experience
for Radhakrishnan. It is ultimate in the sense that intuition
constitutes the fullest and therefore the most authentic
realization of the Real (Brahman). The ultimacy of intuition
is also accounted for by Radhakrishnan in that it is the
ground of all other forms of experience.
Intuition is a self-revelation of the divine.
Intuitive experience is immediate. Immediacy does not
imply in Radhakrishnan's mind an "absence
of psychological mediation, but only non-mediation by
conscious thought" (IVL 98). Intuition operates
on a supra-conscious level, unmediated as it is by conscious
thought. Even so, Radhakrishnan holds that there is "no
such thing as pure experience, raw and undigested. It
is always mixed up with layers of interpretation"
(IVL 99). One might object here that Radhakrishnan has
conflated the experience itself with its subsequent interpretation
and expression. However, Radhakrishnan's comment
is an attempt to deny the Hegelian interpretation of Hinduism's
"contentless" experience, affirming instead
that intuition is the plenitude of experience.
Finally, intuition, according to Radhakrishnan,
is ineffable. It escapes the limits of language and logic,
and there is "no conception by which we can define
it" (IVL 96). In such experiences "[t]hought
and reality coalesce and a creative merging of subject
and object results" (IVL 92). While the experience
itself transcends expression, it also provokes it (IVL
95). The provocation of expression is, for Radhakrishnan,
testimony to the creative impulse of intuition. All creativity
and indeed all progress in the various spheres of life
is the inevitable result of intuition.
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2b.ii.
The Varieties of Experience
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2b.ii.a. Cognitive
Experience
Radhakrishnan recognizes three categories
of cognitive experience: sense experience, discursive
reasoning, and intuitive apprehension. For Radhakrishnan
all of these forms of experience contribute, in varying
degrees, to a knowledge of the real (Brahman), and as
such have their basis in intuition.
Sense Experience
Of the cognitive forms of knowledge, Radhakrishnan suggests
that sensory knowledge is in one respect closest to intuition,
for it is in the act of sensing that one is in "direct
contact" with the object. Sense experience "helps
us to know the outer characters of the external world.
By means of it we acquire an acquaintance with the sensible
qualities of the objects" (IVL 134). "Intuitions,"
Radhakrishnan believes, "are convictions arising
out of a fullness of life in a spontaneous way, more akin
to sense than to imagination or intellect and more inevitable
than either" (IVL 180). In this sense, sense perception
may be considered intuitive, though Radhakrishnan does
not explicitly describe it as such.
Discursive Reasoning
Discursive reasoning, and the logical knowledge
it produces, is subsequent to sensory experience (perception).
"Logical knowledge is obtained by the processes
of analysis and synthesis. Unlike sense perception which
Radhakrishnan claims to be closer to direct knowledge,
logical knowledge "is indirect and symbolic in its
character. It helps us to handle and control the object
and its workings" (IVL 134). There is a paradoxical
element here. Radhakrishnan seems to be suggesting that
the direct proximity to an external object one encounters
in sense perception is compromised when the perception
is interpreted and subsequently incorporated into a more
systematic, though presumably higher, form of knowledge
through discursive reasoning.
For Radhakrishnan, discursive reasoning
and the logical systems they construct possess an element
of intuition. The methodical, mechanical working through
of logical problems and the reworking of rational systems
cannot be divorced from what Radhakrishnan might call
an "intuitive hunch" that such a course of
action will bear positive results; "In any concrete
act of thinking the mind's active experience is
both intuitive and intellectual" (IVL 181-182).
Intuitive Apprehension
Radhakrishnan argues against what he sees
as the prevalent (Western) temptation to reduce the intuitive
to the logical. While logic deals with facts already known,
intuition goes beyond logic to reveal previously unseen
connections between facts. "The art of discovery
is confused with the logic of proof and an artificial
simplification of the deeper movements of thought results.
We forget that we invent by intuition though we prove
by logic" (IVL 177). Intuition not only clarifies
the relations between facts and seemingly discordant systems,
but lends itself to the discovery of new knowledge which
then becomes an appropriate subject of philosophical inquiry
and logical analysis.
Claiming to take his cue from his former
adversary Henri Bergson, Radhakrishnan offers three explanations
to account for the tendency to overlook the presence of
intuition in discursive reasoning. First, Radhakrishnan
claims, intuition presupposes a rational knowledge of
facts. "The insight does not arise if we are not familiar
with the facts of the case.... The successful practice
of intuition requires previous study and assimilation
of a multitude of facts and laws. We may take it that
great intuitions arise out of a matrix of rationality"
(IVL 177). Second, the intuitive element is often obscured
in discursive reasoning because facts known prior to the
intuition are retained, though they are synthesized, and
perhaps reinterpreted, in light of the intuitive insight.
"The readjustment [of previously known facts] is so easy
that when the insight is attained it escapes notice and
we imagine that the process of discovery is only rational
synthesis" (IVL 177). Finally, intuition in discursive
reasoning is often overlooked, disguised as it is in the
language of logic. In short, the intuitive is mistaken
for the logical. "Knowledge when acquired must be thrown
into logical form and we are obliged to adopt the language
of logic since only logic has a communicable language."
This last is a perplexing claim since elsewhere Radhakrishnan
clearly recognizes that meaning is conveyed in symbols,
poetry, and metaphors. Perhaps what Radhakrishnan means
is that logic is the only valid means by which we are
able to organize and systematize empirical facts. Regardless,
according to Radhakrishnan, the presentation of facts
in logical form contributes to "a confusion between discovery
and proof" (IVL 177).
Conversely, Radhakrishnan offers a positive
argument for the place of intuition in discursive reasoning.
"If the process of discovery were mere synthesis,
any mechanical manipulator of prior partial concepts would
have reached the insight and it would not have taken a
genius to arrive at it" (IVL 178). A purely mechanical
account of discursive reasoning ignores the inherently
creative and dynamic dimension of intuitive insight. In
Radhakrishnan's view the mechanical application
of logic alone is creatively empty (IVL 181).
However, Radhakrishnan holds that the "creative
insight is not the final link in a chain of reasoning.
If it were that, it would not strike us as "inspired
in its origin" (IVL 178). Intuition is not the end,
but part of an ever-developing and ever-dynamic process
of realization. There is, for Radhakrishnan, a continual
system of "checks and balances" between intuition
and the logical method of discursive reasoning. Cognitive
intuitions "are not substitutes for thought, they
are challenges to intelligence. Mere intuitions are blind
while intellectual work is empty. All processes are partly
intuitive and partly intellectual. There is no gulf between
the two" (IVL 181).
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2b.ii.2) Psychic
Experience
Perhaps the most understudied dimension
of Radhakrishnan's interpretations of experience
is his recognition of "supernormal" experiences.
As early as his first volume of Indian Philosophy (1923),
Radhakrishnan affirms the validity of what he identifies
as "psychic phenomena". Radhakrishnan accounts
for such experiences in terms of a highly developed sensitivity
to intuition. "The mind of man," Radhakrishnan
explains, "has the three aspects of subconscious,
the conscious, and the superconscious, and the ‘abnormal'
psychic phenomena, called by the different names of ecstasy,
genius, inspiration, madness, are the workings of the
superconscious mind" (IP1 28). Such experiences
are not "abnormal" according to Radhakrishnan,
nor are they unscientific. Rather, they are the products
of carefully controlled mental experiments. In the Indian
past, "The psychic experiences, such as telepathy
and clairvoyance, were considered to be neither abnormal
nor miraculous. They are not the products of diseased
minds or inspiration from the gods, but powers which the
human mind can exhibit under carefully ascertained conditions"
(IP1 28). Psychic intuitions are not askew with Radhakrishnan's
understanding of the intellect. In fact, they are evidence
of the remarkable heights to which the undeveloped, limited
intellect is capable. They are, for Radhakrishnan, accomplishments
rather than failures of human consciousness.
As highly developed powers of apprehension,
psychic experiences are a state of consciousness "beyond
the understanding of the normal, and the supernormal is
traced to the supernatural" (IVL 94). Moreover,
in what Radhakrishnan might recognize as an "intuitive
hunch" in the articulation of a new scientific hypothesis,
psychic premonitions, as partial or momentary as they
may be, lend themselves to the "psychic hypothesis"
that the universal spirit is inherent in the nature of
all things (IVL 110). For Radhakrishnan, psychic intuitions
are suprasensory: "We can see objects without the
medium of the senses and discern relations spontaneously
without building them up laboriously. In other words,
we can discern every kind of reality directly" (IVL
143). In a bold, albeit highly problematic, declaration,
Radhakrishnan believes that the "facts of telepathy
prove that one mind can communicate with another directly"(IVL
143).
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2b.ii.3) Aesthetic
Experience
"All art," Radhakrishnan declares,
"is the expression of experience in some medium"
(IVL 182). However, the artistic experience should not
be confused with its expression. While the experience
itself is ineffable, the challenge for the artist is to
give the experience concrete expression. "The success
of art is measured by the extent to which it is able to
render experiences of one dimension into terms of another.
(IVL 187) For Radhakrishnan, art born out of a "creative
contemplation which is a process of travail of the spirit
is an authentic "crystallization of a life process"
(IVL 185). At its ultimate and in its essence, the "poetical
character is derived from the creative intuition (that is,
integral intuition) which holds sound, suggestion and
sense in organic solution" (IVL 191).
In Radhakrishnan's view, without the
intuitive experience, art becomes mechanical and a rehearsal
of old themes. Such "art" is an exercise in
(re)production rather than a communication of the artist's
intuitive encounter with reality. "Technique without
inspiration," Radhakrishnan declares, "is
barren. Intellectual powers, sense facts and imaginative
fancies may result in clever verses, repetition of old
themes, but they are only manufactured poetry" (IVL
188). It is not simply a difference of quality but a "difference
of kind in the source itself" (IVL 189). For Radhakrishnan,
true art is an expression of the whole personality, seized
as it was with the creative impulse of the universe.
Artistic intuition mitigates and subdues
rational reflection. But "[e]ven in the act of composition,"
Radhakrishnan believes, "the poet is in a state
in which the reflective elements are subordinated to the
intuitive. The vision, however, is not operative for so
long as it continues, its very stress acts as a check
on expression" (IVL 187).
For Radhakrishnan, artistic expression is
dynamic. Having had the experience, the artist attempts
to recall it. The recollection of the intuition, Radhakrishnan
believes, is not a plodding reconstruction, nor one of
dispassionate analysis. Rather, there is an emotional
vibrancy: "The experience is recollected not in tranquility...
but in excitement" (IVL 187). To put the matter somewhat
differently, the emotional vibrancy of the aesthetic experience
gives one knowledge by being rather than knowledge by
knowing (IVL 184).
Art and Science
There is in Radhakrishnan's mind a
"scientific" temperament to genuine artistic
expression. In what might be called the science of art,
Radhakrishnan believes that the "experience or the
vision is the artist's counterpart to the scientific
discovery of a principle or law" (IVL 184). There
is a concordance of agendas in art and science. "What
the scientist does when he discovers a new law is to give
a new ordering to observed facts. The artist is engaged
in a similar task. He gives new meaning to our experience
and organizes it in a different way due to his perception
of subtler qualities in reality" (IVL 194).
Despite this synthetic impulse, Radhakrishnan
is careful to explain that the two disciplines are not
wholly the same. The difference turns on what he sees
as the predominantly aesthetic and qualitative nature
of artistic expression. "Poetic truth is different
from scientific truth since it reveals the real in its
qualitative uniqueness and not in its quantitative universality"
(IVL 193). Presumably, Radhakrishnan means that, unlike
the universal laws with which science attempts to grapple,
art is much more subjective, not in its creative origin,
but in its expression. A further distinction between the
two may lend further insight into Radhakrishnan's
open appreciation for the poetic medium. "Poetry,"
he believes, "is the language of the soul, while
prose is the language of science. The former is the language
of mystery, of devotion, of religion. Prose lays bare
its whole meaning to the intelligence, while poetry plunges
us in the mysterium tremendum of life and suggests the
truths that cannot be stated" (IVL 191).
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2b.ii.4) Ethical
Experience
Not surprisingly, intuition finds a place
in Radhakrishnan's ethics. For Radhakrishnan, ethical
experiences are profoundly transformative. The experience
resolves dilemmas and harmonizes seemingly discordant
paths of possible action. "If the new harmony glimpsed
in the moments of insight is to be achieved, the old order
of habits must be renounced" (IVL 114). Moral intuitions
result in "a redemption of our loyalties and a remaking
of our personalities" (IVL 115).
That Radhakrishnan conceives of the ethical
development of the individual as a form of conversion
is noteworthy as it underscores Radhakrishnan's
identification of ethics and religion. For Radhakrishnan,
an ethical transformation of the kind brought about by
intuition is akin to religious growth and heightened realization.
The force of this view is underscored by Radhakrishnan's
willing acceptance of the interchangeability of the terms
"intuition" and "religious experience".
Of course, not all ethical decisions or actions possess
the quality of being guided by an intuitive impulse. Radhakrishnan
willingly concedes that the vast majority of moral decisions
are the result of conformity to well-established moral
codes. However, it is in times of moral crisis that the
creative force of ethical intuitions come to the fore.
In a less famous, though thematically reminiscent analogy,
Radhakrishnan accounts for growth of moral consciousness
in terms of the creative intuitive impulse: "In
the chessboard of life, the different pieces have powers
which vary with the context and the possibilities of their
combination are numerous and unpredictable. The sound
player has a sense of right and feels that, if he does
not follow it, he will be false to himself. In any critical
situation the forward move is a creative act" (IVL
196-197).
By definition, moral actions are socially
rooted. As such the effects of ethical intuitions are
played out on the social stage. While the intuition itself
is an individual achievement, Radhakrishnan's view
is that the intuition must be not only translated into
positive and creative action but shared with others. There
is a sense of urgency, if not inevitability, about this.
Radhakrishnan tells us one "cannot afford to be
absolutely silent" (IVL 97) and the saints "love
because they cannot help it" (IVL 116).
The impulse to share the moral insight provides
an opportunity to test the validity of the intuition against
reason. The moral hero, as Radhakrishnan puts it, does
not live by intuition alone. The intuitive experience,
while it is the creative guiding impulse behind all moral
progress, must be checked and tested against reason. There
is a "scientific" and "experimental"
dimension to Radhakrishnan's understanding of ethical
behavior. Those whose lives are profoundly transformed
and who are guided by the ethical experience are, for
Radhakrishnan, moral heroes. To Radhakrishnan's
mind, the moral hero, guided as he or she is by the ethical
experience, who carves out an adventurous path is akin
to the discoverer who brings order into the scattered
elements of a science or the artist who composes a piece
of music or designs buildings" (IVL 196). In a sense,
there is very much an art and science to ethical living.
Radhakrishnan's moral heroes, having developed
a "large impersonality" (IVL 116) in which the joy, freedom
and bliss of a life uninhibited by the constraints of
ego and individuality are realized, become "self-sacrificing"
exemplars for others. "Feeling the unity of himself and
the universe, the man who lives in spirit is no more a
separate and self-centered individual but a vehicle of
the universal spirit" (IVL 115). Like the artist, the
moral hero does not turn his back on the world. Instead,
"[h]e throws himself on the world and lives for its redemption,
possessed as he is with an unshakable sense of optimism
and an unlimited faith in the powers of the soul" (IVL
116). In short, Radhakrishnan's moral hero is a conduit
whose "world-consciousness" delights "in furthering the
plan of the cosmos" (IVL 116).
Radhakrishnan believes that ethical intuitions
at their deepest transcend conventional and mechanically
constructed ethical systems. Moral heroes exemplify Radhakrishnan's
ethical ideal while at the same time provoking in those
who accept the ethical status quo to evaluate and to reconsider
less than perfect moral codes. As the moral hero is "fighting
for the reshaping of his own society on sounder lines
[his] behavior might offend the sense of decorum of the
cautious conventionalist" (IVL 197). The contribution
of ethically realized individuals is their promotion of
moral progress in the world. "Though morality commands
conformity, all moral progress is due to nonconformists"
(IVL 197). The moral hero is no longer guided by external
moral codes, but by an "inner rhythm" of harmony
between self and the universe revealed to him in the intuitive
experience. "By following his deeper nature, he
may seem to be either unwise or unmoral to those of us
who adopt conventional standards. But for him the spiritual
obligation is more of a consequence than social tradition"
(IVL 197).
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2b.ii.5) Religious
Experience
For the sake of clarity, we must at the
outset make a tentative distinction between religious
experience on the one hand and integral experience on
the other. Radhakrishnan's distinction between "religion"
and "religions" will be helpful here. At its most basic,
religions, for Radhakrishnan, represent the various interpretations
of experience, while integral experience is the essence
of all religions. "If experience is the soul of religion,
expression is the body through which it fulfills its destiny.
We have the spiritual facts and their interpretations
by which they are communicated to others" (IVL 90). "It
is the distinction between immediacy and thought. Intuitions
abide, while interpretations change" (IVL 90). But the
interpretations should not be confused with the experiences
themselves. For Radhakrishnan, "[c]onceptual expressions
are tentative and provisional... [because] the intellectual
accounts... are constructed theories of experience" (IVL
119). And he cautions us to "distinguish between the immediate
experience or intuition which might conceivably be infallible
and the interpretation which is mixed up with it" (IVL
99).
For Radhakrishnan, the creeds and theological
formulations of religion are but intellectual representations
and symbols of experience. "The idea of God,"
Radhakrishnan affirms, "is an interpretation of
experience" (IVL 186). It follows here that religious
experiences are, for Radhakrishnan, context relative and
therefore imperfect. They are informed by and experienced
through specific cultural, historical, linguistic and
religious lenses. Because of their contextuality and subsequent
intellectualization, experiences in the religious sphere
are limited. It is in this sense that we may refer to
experiences which occur under the auspices of one or other
of the religions as "religious experiences".
Radhakrishnan spends little time dealing with "religious
experiences" as they occur in specific religious
traditions. And what little he does say is used to demonstrate
the theological preconditioning and "religious"
relativity of such experiences. However, "religious
experiences" have value for Radhakrishnan insofar
as they offer the possibility of heightening one's
religious consciousness and bringing one into ever closer
proximity to "religious intuition".
Much to the confusion and chagrin of readers
of Radhakrishnan, Radhakrishnan uses "religious
experience" to refer to such "sectarian"
religious experiences (as discussed immediately above)
as well as to refer to "religious intuitions"
which transcend narrow sectarian and religious boundaries
and are identical to intuition itself (taken up in the
section on "Intuition" above (B.I.) and revisited
immediately below).
Radhakrishnan is explicit and emphatic in
his view that religious intuition is a unique form of
experience. Religious intuition is more than simply the
confluence of the cognitive, aesthetic, and ethical sides
of life. However vital and significant these sides of
life may be, they are but partial and fragmented constituents
of a greater whole, a whole which is experienced in its
fullness and immediacy in religious intuition.
To Radhakrishnan's mind, religious intuition
is not only an autonomous form of experience, but a form
of experience which informs and validates all spheres
of life and experience. Philosophical, artistic, and ethical
values of truth, beauty, and goodness are not known through
the senses or by reason. Rather, "they are apprehended
by intuition or faith..." (IVL 199-200). For Radhakrishnan,
religious intuition informs, conjoins, and transcends
an otherwise fragmentary consciousness.
Informing Radhakrishnan's interpretation
of religious intuition is his affirmation of the identity
of the self and ultimate reality. Throughout his life,
Radhakrishnan interpreted the Upaniṣadic mahavakya, tat
tvam asi, as a declaration of the non-duality (advaita)
of Atman and Brahman. His advaitic interpretation allows
him to affirm the ineffability of the truth behind the
formula. Radhakrishnan readily appropriates his acceptance
of the non-dual experience to his interpretation of religious
intuition. Radhakrishnan not only claimed to find support
for his views in the Upaniṣads, but believed that, correctly
understood, the ancient sages expounded his interpretation
of religious intuition. Any attempt at interpretation
of the intuition could only approximate the truth of the
experience itself. As the ultimate realization, religious
intuition must not only account for and bring together
all other forms of experience, but must overcome the distinctions
between them. Radhakrishnan goes so far as to claim that
intuition of this sort is the essence of religion. All
religions are informed by it, though all fail to varying
degrees to interpret it. "Here we find the essence
of religion, which is a synthetic realization of life.
The religious man has the knowledge that everything is
significant, the feeling that there is harmony underneath
the conflicts and the power to realize the significance
and the harmony" (IVL 201).
With this, the present discussion of intuition
and the varieties of experience has come full circle.
Radhakrishnan identifies intuition -- in all its contextual
varieties -- with integral experience. The two expressions
are, for Radhakrishnan, synonymous. Integral experience
coordinates and synthesizes the range of life's
experiences. It furnishes the individual with an ever-deepening
awareness of and appreciation for the unity of Reality.
As an intuition, integral experience is not only the basis
of all experience but the source of all creative ingenuity,
whether such innovation be philosophical, scientific,
moral, artistic, or religious. Moreover, not only does
integral experience find expression in these various spheres
of life, but such expression, Radhakrishnan believes,
quickens the intuitive and creative impulse among those
it touches.
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2c.
Religious Pluralism
Radhakrishnan's hierarchy of religions is
well-known. "Hinduism," Radhakrishnan affirms, "accepts
all religious notions as facts and arranges them in the
order of their more or less intrinsic significance": "The
worshippers of the Absolute are the highest in rank; second
to them are the worshippers of the personal God; then
come the worshippers of the incarnations like Rama, Kṛṣṇa,
Buddha; below them are those who worship ancestors, deities
and sages, and the lowest of all are the worshippers of
the petty forces and spirits" (HVL 32).
Radhakrishnan uses his distinctions between
experience and interpretation, between religion and religions,
to correlate his brand of Hinduism (that is, Advaita Vedanta
) with religion itself. "Religion," Radhakrishnan holds,
is "a kind of life or experience." It is an insight into
the nature of reality (darsana), or experience
of reality (anubhava). It is "a specific attitude
of the self, itself and not other" (HVL 15). In a short,
but revealing passage, Radhakrishnan characterizes religion
in terms of "personal experience." It is "an independent
functioning of the human mind, something unique, possessing
and autonomous character. It is something inward and personal
which unifies all values and organizes all experiences.
It is the reaction to the whole of man to the whole of
reality. [It] may be called spiritual life, as distinct
from a merely intellectual or moral or aesthetic activity
or a combination of them" (IVL 88-89).
For Radhakrishnan, integral intuitions are
the authority for, and the soul of, religion (IVL 89-90).
It is here that we find a critical coalescence of ideas
in Radhakrishnan's thinking. If, as Radhakrishnan
claims, personal intuitive experience and inner realization
are the defining features of Advaita Vedanta , and those
same features are the "authority" and "soul"
of religion as he understands it, Radhakrishnan is able
to affirm with the confidence he does: "The Vedanta
is not a religion, but religion itself in its most universal
and deepest significance" (HVL 23).
For Radhakrishnan, Hinduism at its Vedantic
best is religion. Other religions, including what Radhakrishnan
understands as lower forms of Hinduism, are interpretations
of Advaita Vedanta . Religion and religions are related
in Radhakrishnan's mind as are experience and interpretation.
The various religions are merely interpretations of his
Vedanta. In a sense, Radhakrishnan "Hinduizes"
all religions. Radhakrishnan appropriates traditional
exegetical categories to clarify further the relationship:
"We have spiritual facts and their interpretations
by which they are communicated to others, śruti or what
is heard, and smṛti or what is remembered. Śaṅkara equates
them with pratyakṣa or intuition and anumana or inference.
It is the distinction between immediacy and thought. Intuitions
abide, while interpretations change" (IVL 90).
The apologetic force of this brief statement
is clear. For Radhakrishnan, the intuitive, experiential
immediacy of Advaita Vedanta is the genuine authority
for all religions, and all religions as intellectually
mediated interpretations derive from and must ultimately
defer to Advaita Vedanta . Put succinctly: "While
the experiential character of religion is emphasized in
the Hindu faith, every religion at its best falls back
on it" (IVL 90).
For Radhakrishnan, the religions are not
on an even footing in their approximations and interpretations
of a common experience. To the extent that all traditions
are informed by what Radhakrishnan claims to be a common
ground of experience (that is, Advaita Vedanta ), each
religion has value. At the same time, all religions as
interpretations leave room for development and spiritual
progress. "While no tradition coincides with experience,
every tradition is essentially unique and valuable. While
all traditions are of value, none is finally binding"
(IVL 120). Moreover, according to Radhakrishnan, the value
of each religion is determined by its proximity to Radhakrishnan's
understanding of Vedanta.
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2d.
Authority of Scripture and the Scientific Basis of Hinduism
Radhakrishnan argues that Hinduism, as he
understands it, is a scientific religion. According to
Radhakrishnan, "[i]f philosophy of religion is to
become scientific, it must become empirical and found
itself on religious experience" (IVL 184). True
religion, argues Radhakrishnan, remains open to experience
and encourages an experimental attitude with regard to
its experiential data. Hinduism more than any other religion
exemplifies this scientific attitude. "The Hindu
philosophy of religion starts from and returns to an experimental
basis" (HVL 19). Unlike other religions, which set
limits on the types of spiritual experience, the "Hindu
thinker readily admits of other points of view than his
own and considers them to be just as worthy of attention"
(HVL 19). What sets Hinduism apart from other religions
is its unlimited appeal to and appreciation for all forms
of experience. Experience and experimentation are the
origin and end of Hinduism, as Radhakrishnan understand
it.
Radhakrishnan argues that a scientific attitude
has been the hallmark of Hinduism throughout its history.
In a revealing passage, Radhakrishnan explains: "The truths
of the ṛṣis are not evolved as the result of logical reasoning
or systematic philosophy but are the products of spiritual
intuition, dṛṣti or vision. The ṛṣis
are not so much the authors of the truths recorded in
the Vedas as the seers who were able to discern the eternal
truths by raising their life-spirit to the plane of universal
spirit. They are the pioneer researchers in the realm
of the spirit who saw more in the world than their followers.
Their utterances are not based on transitory vision but
on a continuous experience of resident life and power.
When the Vedas are regarded as the highest authority,
all that is meant is that the most exacting of all authorities
is the authority of facts" (IVL 89-90).
If the ancient seers are, as Radhakrishnan suggests, "pioneer
researchers," the Upaniṣads are the records of their
experiments. "The chief sacred scriptures of the
Hindus, the Vedas register the intuitions of the perfected
souls. They are not so much dogmatic dicta as transcripts
from life. They record the spiritual experiences of souls
strongly endowed with the sense of reality. They are held
to be authoritative on the ground that they express the
experiences of the experts in the field of religion"
(HVL 17).
Radhakrishnan's understanding of scripture
as the scientific records of spiritual insights holds
not only for Hinduism, but for all religious creeds. Correctly
understood, the various scriptures found in the religions
of the world are not an infallible revelation, but scientific
hypotheses: "The creeds of religion correspond to theories
of science" (IVL 86). Radhakrishnan thus recommends that
"intuitions of the human soul... should be studied by
the methods which are adopted with such great success
in the region of positive science" (IVL 85). The records
of religious experience, of integral intuitions, that
are the world's scriptures constitute the "facts" of the
religious endeavor. So, "just as there can be no geometry
without the perception of space, even so there cannot
be philosophy of religion without the facts of religion"
(IVL 84).
Religious claims, in Radhakrishnan's
mind, are there for the testing. They ought not be taken
as authoritative in and of themselves, for only integral
intuitions validated by the light of reason are the final
authority on religious matters. "It is for philosophy
of religion to find out whether the convictions of the
religious seers fit in with the tested laws and principles
of the universe" (IVL 85). "When the prophets
reveal in symbols the truths they have discovered, we
try to rediscover them for ourselves slowly and patiently"
(IVL 202).
The scientific temperament demanded by "Hinduism"
lends itself to Radhakrishnan's affirmation of the
advaitic Absolute. The plurality of religious claims ought
to be taken as "tentative and provisional, not because
there is no absolute, but because there is one. The intellectual
accounts become barriers to further insights if they get
hardened into articles of faith and forget that they are
constructed theories of experience" (IVL 199).
For Radhakrishnan, the marginalization of
intuition and the abandonment of the experimental attitude
in matters of religion has lead Christianity to dogmatic
stasis. "It is an unfortunate legacy of the course
which Christian theology has followed in Europe that faith
has come to connote a mechanical adherence to authority.
If we take faith in the proper sense of truth or spiritual
conviction, religion is faith or intuition" (HVL
16). The religious cul de sac in which Europe and Christian
theology find themselves testifies to their reluctance
to embrace the Hindu maxim that "theory, speculations,
[and] dogma change from time to time as the facts become
better understood" (IVL 90). For the value of religious
"facts" can only be assessed "from their
adequacy to experience" (IVL 90). Just as the intellect
has dominated Western philosophy to the detriment of intuition,
so too has Christianity followed suit in its search for
a theological touchstone in scripture.
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2e.
Practical Mysticism and Applied Ethics
Radhakrishnan's appeal to intuition
underlies his vision for an ethical Hinduism, a Hinduism
free from ascetic excesses. The ethical potency of intuition
affirms the validity of the world. "Asceticism,"
Radhakrishnan emphasizes, "is an excess indulged
in by those who exaggerate the transcendent aspect of
reality." Instead, the rational mystic "does
not recognize any antithesis between the secular and the
sacred. Nothing is to be rejected; everything is to be
raised" (IVL 115).
Radhakrishnan's ethical mystic does
not simply see the inherent value of the world and engage
in its affairs. Rather, the ethical individual is guided
by an intuitive initiative to move the world forward creatively,
challenging convention and established patterns of social
interaction. For Radhakrishnan, this ethically integrated
mode of being presents a positive challenge to moral dogmatism.
The positive challenge to moral convention, according
to Radhakrishnan, is the creative promotion of social
tolerance and accommodation. Just as Radhakrishnan's
Hinduism rejects absolute claims to truth and the validity
of external authority, so too has Hinduism "developed
an attitude of comprehensive charity instead of a fanatic
faith in an inflexible creed" (HVL 37).
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2e.i.
The Ethics of Caste
Radhakrishnan affirms that the caste system,
correctly understood, is an exemplary case of ethical
tolerance and accommodation born out of an intuitive consciousness
of reality. "The institution of caste illustrates the
spirit of comprehensive synthesis characteristic of the
Hindu mind with its faith in the collaboration of races
and the co-operation of cultures. Paradoxical as it may
seem, the system of caste is the outcome of tolerance
and trust" (HVL 93) Based not on the mechanical fatalism
of karma, as suggested by Hinduism's critics, but on a
recognition of Hinduism's spiritual values and ethical
ideals, caste affirms the value of each individual to
work out his or her own spiritual realization, a spiritual
consciousness Radhakrishnan understands in terms of integral
experience. Just as Radhakrishnan sees his ranking of
religions as affirming the relative value of each religion
in terms of its proximity to Vedanta, the institution
of caste is a social recognition that each member of society
has the opportunity to experiment with his or her own
spiritual consciousness free from dogmatic restraints.
In Radhakrishnan's eyes, herein lies the ethical potency
and creative genius of integral experience. Caste is the
creative innovation of those "whose lives are characterized
by an unshakable faith in the supremacy of the spirit,
invincible optimism, ethical universalism, and religious
toleration" (IVL 126). [For a discussion of the democratic
basis of caste in Radhakrishnan's thinking, see Robert
Minor, Radhakrishnan: A Religious Biography (1989).]
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3.
Criticism
There are numerous criticisms that may be
raised against Radhakrishnan's philosophy. What follows
is not an exhaustive list, but three of the most common
criticisms which may be levied against Radhakrishnan.
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3a.
Epistemic Authority
The first is a criticism regarding the locus
of epistemic authority. One might ask
the question:
Does the test for knowledge lie in scripture or in experience? Radhakrishnan's view is that knowledge comes from intuitive
experience (anubhava). Radhakrishnan makes this claim
on the basis of scripture, namely the Upaniṣads. The
Upaniṣads, according to Radhakrishnan, support a monistic
ontology. Radhakrishnan makes this claim on the basis
that the Upaniṣads are the records of the personal experiences
of the ancient sages. Thus, the validity of one's experience
is determined by its proximity to that which is recorded
in the Upaniṣads. Conversely, the Upaniṣads are authoritative
because they are the records of monistic experiences.
There is a circularity here. But this circularity is one
with which Radhakrishnan himself would likely not only
acknowledge, but embrace. After all, Radhakrishnan might
argue, intuitive knowledge is non-rational. An intuitive
experience of Reality is not contrary to reason but beyond
the constraints of logical analysis.
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3b.
Cultural and Religious Constructions
A second criticism of Radhakrishnan's views
surrounds his characterizations of the "East"
and the "West." Radhakrishnan characterizes
the West, as well as Christianity, as inclined to dogmatism,
the scientific method whose domain is limited to exploration
of the outer natural world, and a reliance upon second-hand
knowledge. The East, by contrast, is dominated by an openness
to inner experience and spiritual experimentation. The
West is rational and logical, while the East is predominantly
religious and mystical. As pointed out by numerous scholars
working in the areas of post-colonial studies and orientalism,
Radhakrishnan's constructions of "West" and
"East" (these categories themselves being constructions)
accept and perpetuate orientalist and colonialist forms
of knowledge constructed during the 18th and 19th centuries.
Arguably, these characterizations are "imagined"
in the sense that they reflect the philosophical and religious
realities of neither "East" nor "West."
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3c.
Selectivity of Evidence
A separate but related criticism that might
be levied against Radhakrishnan's views has to do with
his theory of religious pluralism and his treatment of
the religious traditions with which he deals.
First, Radhakrishnan minimizes the contributions
of the monistic philosophers and religious mystics of
the West. While Radhakrishnan acknowledges the work of
such thinkers as Henri Bergon, Goethe, and a variety of
Christian, Jewish, and Muslim mystics, he seems to imply
that such approaches to religious and philosophical life
in the West are exceptions rather than the rule. In fact,
Radhakrishnan goes so far as to suggest that such figures
are imbued with the spirit of the East, and specifically
Hinduism as he understands it.
Second, while Radhakrishnan readily acknowledges
the religious diversity within "Hinduism," his
treatment of Western traditions is much less nuanced.
In a sense, Radhakrishnan homogenizes and generalizes
Western traditions. In his hierarchy of religions (see
Section 2c above), one or another
form of Hinduism may be located within each of his religious
categories (monistic, theistic, incarnational, ancestoral,
and natural). By contrast, Radhakrishnan seems to imply
that the theistic (second) and the incarnational (third)
categories are the domains of Unitarian and Trinitarian
Christianity respectively.
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4.
List of Abbreviations
HVL - The Hindu View of Life (1927)
IP1 - Indian Philosophy: Volume 1
(1923)
IVL - An Idealist View of Life
(1929)
MST - My Search for Truth (1937)
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5.
References and Further Reading
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5a.
Primary Sources by Radhakrishnan
The Ethics of the Vedanta and Its Metaphysical
Presuppositions. Madras: The Guardian Press, 1908.
"Karma and Freewill" in Modern Review.
(Calcutta) Vol. III (May 1908), pp. 424-428.
"Indian Philosophy: The Vedas and the Six
Systems" in The Madras Christian College Magazine.
III (New Series), pp. 22-35.
"'Nature' and ‘Convention' in Greek
Ethics" in The Calcutta Review, CXXX (January
1910), pp. 9-23.
"Egoism and Altruism: The Vedanta Solution"
in East and West (Bombay) IX (July 1910), pp.
626-630.
"The Relation of Morality to Religion" in
The Hindustan Review (September 1910), pp. 292-297.
"Morality and Religion in Education" in
The Madras Christian College Magazine. X (1910-1911),
pp. 233-239.
"The Ethics of the Bhagavadgita and Kant"
in The International Journal of Ethics. XXI,
Number 4 (July 1911), pp. 465-475.
Essentials of Psychology. London:
Oxford University Press, 1912.
"The Ethics of the Vedanta" in The International
Journal of Ethics. XXIV, Number 2 (January 1914),
pp. 168-183.
"The Vedanta Philosophy and the Doctrine
of Maya" in The International Journal of Ethics.
XXIV, Number 4 (April 1914), pp. 431-451.
"A View of India on the War" in Asiatic
Review. (London), VI (May 1915), pp. 369-374.
Religion and Life, Leaflet No.
15, The Theistic Endeavor Society of Madras. November
1915.
"The Vedantic Approach to Reality" in The
Monist. XXVI, Number 2 (April 1916), pp. 200-231.
"Religion and Life" in The International
Journal of Ethics. XXVII, Number 1 (October 1916),
pp. 91-106.
"Bergson's Idea of God" in The Quest.
(London), VII (October 1916), pp. 1-8.
"The Philosophy of Rabindranath Tagore
– I" in The Quest. (London) VIII, Number
3 (April 1917), pp. 457-477.
"The Philosophy of Rabindranath Tagore
– II" in The Quest. (London) VIII, Number
4 (July 1917), pp. 592-612.
"Vedantamum Mayavadamum in Cittantam" in
Siddhantam: Journal of the Saiva Siddhanta Association.
V, pp. 159-163.
The Philosophy of Rabindranath Tagore.
London: Macmillan & Co., 1918.
"James Ward's Pluaralistic Theism: I" in
The Indian Philosophical Review. II, Number 2
(October 1918), pp. 97-118.
"James Ward's Pluaralistic Theism: II"
in The Indian Philosophical Review. II, Number
3 (December 1918), pp. 210-232.
"Bergson and Absolute Idealism – I"
in Mind. (New Series) XXVII (January 1919), pp.
41-53.
"Bergson and Absolute Idealism –
II" in Mind. (New Series) XXVII (July 1919),
pp. 275-296.
The Reign of Religion in Contemporary
Philosophy. London: Macmillan & Co., 1920.
"The Future of Religion" in The Mysore
University Magazine. IV, (1920), pp. 148-157.
"Review of Bernard Bosanquet's ‘Implication
and Linear Inference'" in The Indian Philosophical
Review. III, Number 3 (July 1920), p. 301.
"The Metaphysics of the Upanisads –
I" in The Indian Philosophical Review. III, Number
3, (July 1920), pp. 213-236.
The Metaphysics of the Upanisads –
II in The Indian Philosophical Review. III, Number
4, (October 1920), pp. 346-362.
"Gandhi and Tagore" in The Calcutta
Review. (Third Series), I (October 1921), pp. 14-29.
"Religion and Philosophy" in The Hibbert
Journal. XX, Number 1 (October 1921), pp. 35-45.
"Tilak as Scholar" in The Indian Review.
XXII (December 1921), pp. 737-739.
"Contemporary Philosophy" in The Indian
Review. XXIII (July 1922), pp. 440-443.
"The Heart of Hinduism" in The Hibbert
Journal. XXI, Number 1 (October 1922), pp. 5-19.
"The Hindu Dharma" in The International
Journal of Ethics. XXXIII, Number 1 (October 1922),
pp. 1-22.
Indian Philosophy: Volume 1. London:
George Allen & Unwin, Ltd., 1923.
"Islam and Indian Thought" in The Indian
Review. XXIV (Novermber 1923), pp. 53-72.
"Religious Unity" in The Mysore University
Magazine. VII, pp. 187-198.
The Philosophy of the Upanisads.
London: George Allen & Unwin, Ltd., 1924.
"Hindu Thought and Christian Doctrine"
in The Madras Christian College Magazine. (Quarterly
Series) (January 1924), pp. 18-34.
"The Hindu Idea of God" in The Quest.
(London) XV, Number 3 (April 1924), pp. 289-310.
"Indian Philosophy: Some Problems" in Mind.
(New Series) XXV (April 1926), pp. 154-180.
The Hindu View of Life. London:
George Allen & Unwim, Ltd., 1927.
"The Role of Philosophy in the History
of Civilization" in Edgar Shefield Brightman (ed.) Proceedings
of the Sixth International Congress of Philosophy.
New York: Longmans, Green and Co., 1927. pp. 543-550.
"The Doctrine of Maya: Some Problems" in
Edgar Shefield Brightman (ed.) Proceedings of the
Sixth International Congress of Philosophy. New York:
Longmans, Green and Co., 1927. pp. 683-689.
Indian Philosophy: Volume 2. London:
George Allen & Unwin, Ltd., 1927.
"Presidential Address" in Proceedings
of the III Indian Philosophical Congress. Calcutta:
Calcutta University, 1927. pp. 19-30.
"Educational Reform" in The Calcutta
Review. (May 1927), pp. 143-154.
The Religion We Need. London:
Ernest Benn, Ltd., 1928.
The Vedanta According to Śaṅkara and
Ramanuja. London: George Allen & Unwin, Ltd.,
1928.
"Indian Philosophy (To the Editor of Mind)"
in Mind. (New Series) XXXVII (January 1928),
pp. 130-131.
Buddhism in Prabuddha Bharata.
XXXIII, Number 8 (August 1928), pp. 349-354.
"Evolution and Its Implications" in The
New Era. I (November 1928), pp. 102-111.
Kalki or The Future of Civilization.
London: Kegan, Paul, Trench & Co. Ltd., 1929.
An Idealist View of Life. London:
George Allen & Unwin Ltd., 1929.
"Indian Philosophy" in Encyclopedia
Britannica. (14th edition) Volume XII, New York,
pp. 242-243.
Prof. Radhakrishnan's Reply in The
Modern Review. XLV, Number 2 (February 1929), pp.
208-213.
Prof. Radhakrishnan's Reply in The
Modern Review. XLV, Number 3 (March 1929), pp. 321-322.
"Review of John Baillie's ‘The Interpretation
of Religion'" in The Hibbert Journal. XXVIII,
Number 4 (July 1930), 740-742.
""Foreword"" in Abhay Kumer Majumdar, The
Sāṃkhya Conception of Personality. Calcutta: Calcutta
University Press, 1930. pp. ix-xii.
"The Hindu Idea of God" in The Spectator.
May 30, 1931 (Number 51370), pp. 851-853.
"Intuition and Intellect" in Ramananda
Chatterjee (ed.) The Golden Book of Tagore: A Hommage
to Rabindranath Tagore from India and the World in Celebration
of His Seventieth Birthday. Calcutta: Golden Book
Committee, pp. 310-313.
""Foreword"" in Nalini Kanta Brahma, The
Philosophy of Hindu Sadhana. London: Kegan, Paul,
Trench & Co., pp. ix-x.
"Presidential Address" in H.D. Bhattacharyya
(ed.) Proceedings of the Eighth Indian Philosophical
Congress: The University of Mysore. Calcutta: N.C.
Ghosh, pp. v-xvi.
"Sarvamukti (Universal Salvation) - A Symposium"
in H.D. Bhattacharyya (ed.) Proceedings of the Eighth
Indian Philosophical Congress: The University of
Mysore. Calcutta: N.C. Ghosh, pp. 314-318.
East and West in Religion. London:
George Allen & Unwin, Ltd., 1933.
"Intellect and Intuition in Sankara's Philosophy"
in Triveni. VI, Number 1 (July-August 1933),
pp. 8-16.
The Teaching of the Buddha: Being the
Inaugural Lecture under the Alphina Ratnayaka Trust Delivered
by Sir Sarvepalli Radhakrishnan at Columbo, 2nd October,
1933. Columbo: The Public Trust of Ceylon, 1933.
"The Teaching of the Buddha by Speech and
by Silence" in The Hibbert Journal. XXXII, Number
3 (April 1934), pp. 342-356.
""Foreword"" in Perviz N. Peerozshaw Dubash
Hindu Art in its Social Setting. Madras: National
Literature Publishing Co. Ltd., 1934. pp. iv-v.
Freedom and Culture. Madras: G.A.
Natesan & Co., 1936.
The Heart of Hindusthan. Madras:
G.A. Natesan & Co., 1936.
"The Spirit in Man" in Sarvepalli Radhakrishnan
and J.H. Muirhead (eds.) Contemporary Indian Philosophy.
