Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. Life
Hans Reichenbach, born on September 26th 1891 in
Hamburg, Germany, was a leading philosopher of science, a founder of
the Berlin circle, and a proponent of logical positivism (also known
as neopositivism or logical empiricism). He studied physics,
mathematics and philosophy at Berlin, Erlangen, Gottingen and Munich
in 1910s. Among his teachers were the neo-Kantian philosopher Ernst
Cassirer, the mathematician David Hilbert, and the physicists Max
Planck, Max Born and Albert Einstein. Reichenbach received his degree
in philosophy from the University at Erlangen in 1915; his
dissertation on the theory of probability was published in 1916. He
attended Einstein's lectures on the theory of relativity at Berlin in
1917-20; at that time Reichenbach chose the theory of relativity as
the first subject for his own philosophical research. He became a
professor at Polytechnic at Stuttgart in 1920. In the same year he
published his first book on the philosophical implications of the
theory of relativity, The theory of relativity and a priori
knowledge, in which Reichenbach criticized Kantian theory of
synthetic a priori. In the following years he published three books
on the philosophical meaning of the theory of relativity:
Axiomatization of the theory of relativity (1924), From
Copernicus to Einstein (1927) and The philosophy of space and
time (1928); the last in a sense states logical positivism's view
on the theory of relativity. In 1926 Reichenbach became a professor
of philosophy of physics at the University at Berlin. His methods of
teaching philosophy were something of a novelty; students found him
easy to approach (this fact was uncommon in German universities); his
courses were open to discussion and debate. In 1928 he founded the
Berlin circle (named Die Gesellschaft fur empirische Philosophie,
"Society for empirical philosophy"). Among the members of the Berlin
circle were Carl Gustav Hempel, Richard von Mises, David Hilbert and
Kurt Grelling. In 1930 Reichenbach and Carnap undertook the
editorship of the journal Erkenntnis ("Knowledge").
In 1933 Adolf Hitler became Chancellor of Germany. In the same
year Reichenbach emigrated to Turkey, where he became chief of the
Department of Philosophy at the University at Istanbul. In Turkey
Reichenbach promoted a shift in philosophy course; he introduced
interdisciplinary seminars and courses on scientific subjects. In
1935 he published The theory of probability.
In 1938 he moved to the United States, where he became a professor
at the University of California at Los Angeles; in the same year was
published Experience and prediction. Reichenbach's work on
quantum mechanics was published in 1944 (Philosophic foundations
of quantum mechanics). Afterwards he wrote two popular books:
Elements of symbolic logic (1947) and The rise of
scientific philosophy (1951). In 1949 he contributed an essay on
The philosophical significance of the theory of relativity to
Albert Einstein: philosopher-scientist edit by Paul Arthur
Schillp. Reichenbach died on April 9th 1953 at Los Angeles,
California, while he was working on the philosophy of time. Two books
Nomological statements and admissible operations (1954) and
The direction of time (1956) were published posthumously.
2. The Philosophy of Space and Time and the Philosophical Meaning of the Theory of Relativity
a. Space
Euclidean geometry is based on the set of axioms
stated by Greek mathematician Euclid who developed geometry into an
axiomatic system, in which every theorem is derivable from the
axioms. Euclid's work revealed that the truth of geometry depends on
the truth of axioms and therefore the question arose whether the
axioms were true. Many Euclidean axioms were self-evident, but the
axiom of parallels, which states that there is one and only one
parallel to a given line through a given point, was considered not
self-evident, and many mathematicians tried to derive it from the
other axioms. Eventually it was proved the axiom of parallels is not
a logical consequence of the remainder. As a result of this research
non-Euclidean geometries were discovered and mathematicians became
aware of the existence of a plurality of geometries, namely:
Euclidean geometry, in which the axiom of parallels is
true;
geometry of Bolyai and Lobachevsky, also known as hyperbolic
geometry, in which there is an infinite number of parallels to the
given line through the given point (Janos Bolyai b 1802 d 1860,
Hungarian mathematician, published in 1832 the first account of a
non-Euclidean geometry; Nikolay Lobachevsky b 1793 d 1856, Russian
mathematician, independently discovered hyperbolic geometry);
elliptical geometry, in which there exist no parallel.
In Reichenbach opinion, it must be realized that there are two
different kinds of geometry, namely mathematical geometry and
physical geometry. Mathematical geometry, a branch of mathematics, is
a purely formal system and it does not deal with the truth of axioms,
but with the proof of theorems, ie it only search for the
consequences of axioms. Physical geometry is concerned with the real
geometry, ie the geometry which is true in our physical world: it
searches for the truth (or falsity) of axioms, using the methods of
empirical science: experiments, measurements, etc; it is a branch of
physics.
How can physicists discover the geometry of the real world? Look
at the following example, which Reichenbach analyses in The
philosophy of space and time. Two-dimensional intelligent beings
live in a two-dimensional world, on the surface of a sphere, but they
do not know where they live; in their opinion, they might live on a
plane, a sphere or whatever surface. How can they discover where they
live? They could use some mathematical properties that characterize a
geometry; for example, in Euclidean geometry the ratio of the
circumference of a circle to its diameter equals pi (3.14...) while
in elliptical geometry the ratio is variable and it is less than pi;
also in hyperbolic geometry the ratio is variable but greater than
pi. Therefore they could measure the circumference and the diameter
of a circle; if the ratio equals pi the surface is a plane; if the
ratio is less than pi the surface is a sphere. Thus they could
discover where they live with the help of such measurements. This
method, invented by Gauss (Karl Friedrich Gauss, b 1777 d 1855,
German mathematician, was the first to discover a non-Euclidean
geometry although he did not published his work) is suitable for a
two-dimensional world. Riemann (Bernhard Riemann, b 1826 d 1866,
German mathematician, developed both the elliptical geometry and the
generalized theory of metric space in any number of dimension which
Einstein used in his general theory of relativity) invented a method
suitable for a three-dimensional world. There is no reason in
principle why physicists could not use Riemann's method to discover
the geometry of our world.
Riemann's method is based on physical measurements. Reichenbach
carefully examines the epistemological implications of measuring
geometrical entities. The empirical measurement of geometrical
entities depends on physical objects or physical processes
corresponding to geometrical concepts. The process of establishing
such correlation is called a co-ordinative definition.
Usually, a definition is a statement that gives the exact meaning of
a concept; this kind of definition is called an explicit definition.
There is another kind of definition, namely the co-ordinative
definition; it is not a statement, but an ostensive definition. The
co-ordinative definition of a concept is a correlation between a real
object or a physical process and the concept itself. Some geometrical
entities cannot be defined by an explicit definition but they require
a co-ordinative definition. For example, the unit of length, ie the
metre, is defined by a co-ordinative definition; the physical object
corresponding to the metre is the standard rod in Paris (Museum of
weights and measures in Paris houses the units of measure for
International System of Units). Another example is the definition of
straight line which is co-ordinated with a physical process, namely
the path of a light ray.
What is the philosophical meaning of a co-ordinative definition?
Reichenbach proposes the following problem, discussed in The
philosophy of space and time. A measuring rod is moved from one
point of space (say A) to another point (say B). When the measuring
rod is in B, is its length altered? Many physical circumstances can
alter the length, eg if temperature in A differs from temperature in
B. In this example, we can discover whether the temperature is the
same by means of a metallic rod and a wooden rod which are of equal
length when they are in A. Move the two rods to B: if their length
becomes different then the temperature is also different, otherwise
the temperature is the same. This method is suitable because
temperature is a differential force, ie a force that produces
different effects on different substances. But there are universal
forces, which produce the same effect on all type of matter. The
best known universal force is gravity: its effect is the same on all
bodies and therefore all bodies fall with the same acceleration. Now
suppose a universal force alters the length of the measuring rods
when they are moved from A to B; in this instance, we do not observe
any difference between the measuring rods and we cannot know whether
the length is altered. Consequently, if a rod stays in A and the
other is moved to B where a universal force alters its length, we
cannot know their length is different. So we must acknowledge that
there is not any way of knowing whether the length of two measuring
rods, which are equal when they are in the same point of space, is
the same when the two rods are in two different points of space. We
can define the two rods equal in length if all differential forces
are eliminated and disregard universal forces. But we can adopt a
different definition, of course. Thus we must accept - Reichenbach
says - that the geometrical form of a body is not an absolute
fact, but depends on a co-ordinative definition. There is an
astonish consequence of this fact. If a geometry G was proved to be
the real geometry by a set of measurements, we could arbitrarily
choose a different geometry G' and adopt a different set of
co-ordinative definitions so that G' would become the real geometry.
This is the principle of relativity of geometry, which
Reichenbach examines, from a mathematical point of view, in
Axiomatization of the theory of relativity and, from a
philosophical point of view, in The philosophy of space and
time. This principle states that all geometrical systems are
equivalent; it falsifies alleged a priori character of Euclidean
geometry and thus it falsifies the Kantian philosophy of space
too.
At a first glance, the principle of relativity of geometry proves
it is not possible to discover the real geometry of our world. This
is true if we limit ourselves to metric relationships. Metric
relationships are geometric properties of bodies depending on
distances, angles, areas, etc; examples of metric relationships are
"the ratio of circumference to diameter equals pi" and "the volume of
A is greater than the volume of B". But we can study not only
distances, angles, areas but also the order of space, the
topology of space, ie way in which the points of space are
placed in relation to one another; an example of a topological
relationship is "point A is between point B and C". A consequence of
the principle of relativity of geometry is, for instance, that a
plane and a sphere are equivalent with respect to metric. From a
topological point of view, a sphere and a plane are not equivalent
(in topology, two geometrical objects are equivalent if and only if
there is a continuous transformation that assign to every point of
the first object a unique point of the second and vice versa; there
is not any transformation of this kind between a sphere and a plane).
What is the philosophical significance of topology?
Reichenbach examines the following example (The philosophy of
space and time). Measurements of space, performed by a
two-dimensional being, suggest that he lives on a sphere, but, in
spite of such measurements, he believes he lives on a plane. There is
not any difficult, when he limits himself to metric relationships: he
could adopt appropriate co-ordinative definitions and those
measurements would become compatible with a plane. But the surface of
a sphere is a finite surface and he might do a round-the-world tour,
that is he could walk along a straight line from a point A and
eventually he would arrive to the point A itself. Really this is
impossible on a plane and he therefore should assert that this last
point is not the point A, but a different point B which, in all other
respects, is identical to A. Now there are two possibilities: (i) he
changes his theory and acknowledges that he lives on a sphere or (ii)
he maintains his position, but he needs to explain why point B is
identical to A although A and B are different and distant points of
space; he could accomplish his task only fabricating a fictitious
theory of pre-established harmony: everything that occurs in A,
immediately occurs in B.
Reichenbach says the second possibility entails an anomaly in the
law of causality. If we assume normal causality, topology become an
empirical theory and we can discover the geometry of the real world.
This example is another falsification of Kantian theory of synthetic
a priori. Kant believed both the Euclidean geometry and the law of
causality were a priori. But if Euclidean geometry were an a priori
truth, normal causality might be false; if normal causality were an a
priori truth, Euclidean geometry might be false. We arbitrarily can
choose the geometry or we arbitrarily can choose the causality; but
we cannot choose both. Thus the most important implication of the
philosophical analysis of topology is that the theory of space
depends on normal causality.
b. Time
Normal causality is the main principle that underlies
not only the theory of space but also the theory of time. The
solution to the problem of an empirical theory of space was found
when we acknowledged the priority of topological relationships over
metric relationships. Also in the philosophy of time we must
recognize the priority of topology. We must distinguish between two
different concepts which are fundamental to the theory of time,
namely the order of time and the direction of time.
Time order is definable by means of causality (see The philosophy
of space and time). The definition is: event A occurs before
event B (and, of course, event B occurs after event A) if
event A can produce a physical effect on event B. When can event
A affect event B? The theory of relativity states that it is required
a finite time for an effect to go from event A to event B. The
required time is finite because the velocity of light is a speed
limit for all material particles, messages or effects and the
velocity of light is finite. Suppose A and B are two events occurring
in point PA and PB. Event A can affect event B if a light pulse
emitted from PA when event A occurs reaches the point PB before event
B occurs. If the light pulse reaches point PB when event B already
occurred, event A cannot affect event B. If event A cannot affect
event B and event B cannot affect event A, the order of the two
events is indefinite and we could arbitrarily choose the event that
occurs first or we might define the two event simultaneous; therefore
simultaneity depends on a definition.
Reichenbach examines the consistency of this definition. Suppose
an event A occurs before an event B and, from another point of view,
the event A occurs after the event B. In this circumstance there is a
closed causal chain so that the event A produces an effect on the
event B and the event B produces an effect on the event A. The
definition is consistent only if we assume that there are not closed
causal chains: the order of time depends on normal
causality.
Reichenbach asserts that the relativity of simultaneity is
independent from the relativity of motion. The relativity of
simultaneity is due to the finite velocity of causal propagation. So
it is a mistake - Reichenbach asserts in The philosophy of space
and time and From Copernicus to Einstein - to derive the
relativity of simultaneity from the relative motion of observers.
Reichenbach also cautions against a possible misunderstanding of the
multiplicity of observers in some expositions of the theory of
relativity: observers are used only for convenience; the relativity
of simultaneity has nothing to do with the relativity of observers.
We must recognize - Reichenbach asserts - that the theory of an
absolute simultaneity is a consistent theory although it is a wrong
one. Absolute simultaneity and absolute time does not exist, but they
are clever concepts.
Reichenbach also faces the problem of the direction of
time. All mechanical processes are reversible: if f(t) is a
solution of the equations of classical mechanics then f(-t) is also
an admissible solution; also in the theory of relativity f(-t) is an
admissible solution. Thus neither theory gives a consistent
definition of the direction of time. In fact the direction of time
is definable only by means of irreversible processes, ie
processes that are characterized by an increase of entropy. But the
definition is not straightforward. The second law of thermodynamics,
which states the principle of increase of entropy, is a statistical
law, not a deterministic law. Really the elementary processes of
statistical thermodynamics are reversible, because they are
controlled by the laws of classical mechanics. In fact all
macroscopic processes are also reversible, in a sense: every upgrade
of entropy is naturally followed by a corresponding downgrade; we
cannot control the downgrade and thus we cannot reverse the process.
But statistical thermodynamics asserts that after a large amount of
time the entropy will diminish to the initial value. In an isolated
system, in an infinite time, there are as many downgrades as upgrades
of the entropy. Thus if we observe two states A and B, and the
entropy of B is greater than the entropy of A, we cannot assert that
B is later than A. But if we consider not an isolated system, but
many isolated systems, we realized that the probability that we
observe a decrease of entropy is less than the probability we observe
an increase of entropy. We can therefore use many-system
probabilities to define a direction of time. Reichenbach asserts that
it is possible to define an entropy for the whole universe and the
statistical theory proves that the entropy of the universe first
increases and then decreases; thus we can define a direction of time
only for sections of time, not for the whole time. Reichenbach notes
that this theory of time was stated in 19th century by Boltzmann
(Ludwig Boltzmann, b 1844 d 1906, Austrian physicist, formulated the
statistical theory of entropy).
c. The Special Theory of Relativity
The special theory of
relativity gives an unified theory of space and time in the absence
of gravitational field. One example of the necessity of an unified
theory of space and time is the length contraction, an effect
predicted by the theory; this effect shows that the length of a
moving rod depends on simultaneity. The special theory of relativity
states that the length of a rod measured using a metre that is at
rest with respect to the rod is different from the length measured
using a metre which is moving with respect to the rod. In the first
instance we measure the length of the rod by means of the well-known
method used by classical mechanics. But we use a different method
when the measuring rod is not at rest with respect to the metre. We
measure the length of the moving rod by means of the distance between
the two points occupied at a given time by the two ends of the moving
rod, ie we mark the simultaneous positions of the two ends and we
measure the distance between those positions; thus this method depend
on the definition of simultaneity, which also depends on a
definition. It must be acknowledged that the length of a moving rod
is a matter of definition, but the length contraction is a genuine
physical hypothesis confirmed by experiments. We must also recognize
the priority of time over space: the ability to measure time is a
requisite for the theory of space. Therefore only an unified theory
of space and time is suitable. In spite of the necessity for an
unified theory of space and time, Reichenbach states (in The
philosophy of space and time) that space and time are different
concepts which remain distinct in the theory of relativity. The
real space is three-dimensional and the real time is
one-dimensional: the four-dimensional space-time used in the theory
of relativity is a mathematical artefact. Also the mathematical
formulation of the special theory of relativity acknowledges the
difference between space and time: the equation that defines the
metric is dx^2 + dy^2 + dz^2 - dt^2 = ds^2 and the time coordinate is
distinguishable from the space coordinates by the negative sign. How
can we know the space is three-dimensional? and how can we recognize
the difference between a real space and a mathematical space?
A physical effect is not immediately transmitted from one point to
another distant point but it passes through every point between the
source and the destination. This principle is known as the
principle of local action and it denies the existence of action
at a distance. In three-dimensional space the principle of local
action is true while in a four-dimensional space it is false, so we
can recognize that the real space is three-dimensional. We can also
distinguish between a mathematical space and the real space because
in a mathematical space the principle of local action is false.
Reichenbach says that the truth of the principle of local action is
an empirical fact, not an a priori truth: it could be false. But if
this principle is true then there is only one n-dimensional space in
which it is true; this n-dimensional space is the real space and n is
the number of the dimensions of space. So we recognize that the real
space is three-dimensional while the four-dimensional space used in
the theory of relativity is a mathematical space, not a real one. We
also recognize that the unified theory of space and time depends
on normal causality.
Among the results of the special theory of relativity is time
dilation: the period of a moving clock is greater than the period
of a clock at rest and therefore the moving clock slows. Time
dilation is an empirical hypothesis and Reichenbach says its physical
meaning is that a clock does not measure the time coordinate but it
measures the interval, ie the space-time distance between two
events. In classical mechanics space is Euclidean and Pythagoras'
theorem gives the distance ds between two points: ds^2 = dx^2 + dy^2
+ dz^2; x,y,z are the space coordinates. The distance ds is measured
by rod. Time is an independent coordinate and is measured by clock.
The mathematical formulation of the special theory of relativity uses
a four-dimensional space-time known as the Minkowski space
(mathematician Hermann Minkowski, b 1864 d 1909, gave a mathematical
formulation of Einstein's special theory of relativity), in which
three coordinates are the space coordinates and one coordinate is the
time coordinate. The distance ds between two points of Minkowski
space is: ds^2 = dx^2 + dy^2 + dz^2 - dt^2; t is the time coordinate
and ds (or ds^2) is the interval. A positive (negative) ds^2 is
called a spacelike (timelike) interval. Suppose A and B are two
events, interval ds^2 is negative and S is an inertial frame of
reference moving with constant velocity v so that both events A and B
occurs at the origin O of S, and suppose there is a clock in O; the
time measured by the clock, called characteristic time, equals
the interval ds. When the interval is positive, there is an inertial
frame of reference S' with respect to which the two events are
simultaneous; in this instance, the interval ds is realized by a
measuring rod with the two ends coinciding with the events A and B
and at rest with respect to S'. Time dilation shows an important
difference between the special theory of relativity and classical
mechanics; the special theory asserts that clocks and rods measure
the interval while classical mechanics asserts they measure
coordinates.
I briefly mention also Reichenbach's view on the velocity of
light. He asserts that there is no way of measuring the velocity of
light and proving it is constant, because the measurement of the
velocity of light requires the definition of simultaneity which
depends on the speed of light. Einstein - Reichenbach says - does not
prove the speed of light is constant, but the special theory of
relativity assumes it is constant, ie it is constant by
definition.
d. The General Theory of Relativity
Newton's second law of
motion states that the acceleration a of a body is
proportional to the force F applied, so that F = m *
a, where m is the inertial mass which represents the
resistance to acceleration (force and acceleration are vectors and I
use bold face as indicator of vector). Newton's law of gravitation
asserts that every particle attracts every other particle with a
force F proportional to the product of gravitational
masses: F = G (m * m') / r^2; r is the
distance between the two particles, m and m' are the gravitational
mass which represent the response to the gravitational force. In
classical mechanics, gravitational mass and inertial mass are
equivalent; this principle of equivalence accounts for the law
of free fall which states that the acceleration of every falling body
is the same. The principle of equivalence is one of the principle of
the general theory of relativity and its consequences are very
important.
Suppose a physicist is into a closed elevator and he observers a
body attached to a spring; he find the spring is stretched. There are
two different although equivalent explanations.
First explanation. The body is attracted by the Earth and the
gravitational force accounts for the stretching of the
spring.
Second explanation. The elevator is in empty space so there is
not any gravitational force, but the elevator is accelerated and
the inertia of the body causes the stretching of the spring.
The two explanation are indistinguishable because of the
equivalence between gravitational and inertial mass. This thought
experiment shows that an accelerated frames of reference can simulate
a gravitational field. Now suppose that in another thought experiment
the body does not exert any force on the spring. Also in this
instance there are two explanations.
First explanation. The elevator is at rest in empty space so
there is not any force.
Second explanation. The elevator is free falling in a
gravitational field so its acceleration equals gravitational
acceleration; the body is falling but also the spring, the
elevator and the physicist are falling with the same acceleration
and therefore they are relatively at rest and there is not any
force.
The consequence of this second thought experiment is that a
gravitational field can be eliminated by means of an accelerated
frame of reference. The theory of general relativity states that free
falling accelerated frames of reference are inertial systems.
Reichenbach says that this hypothesis is not a consequence of the
principle of equivalence; it is a genuine physical hypothesis which
goes beyond experience. There is an important consequence of this
hypothesis. The special theory of relativity is true in inertial
frames of reference, so in every inertial system the motion of a
light ray is represented by a straight line. But the general theory
of relativity states that a free falling frame of reference is an
inertial system, so the light moves in a straight line with respect
to this frame of reference; with respect to a frame of reference
which is at rest on Earth (in this system there is a gravitational
field) the light rays are curved. The consequence is that light is
curved by gravity. Another consequence of the hypothesis that a free
falling frame of reference is an inertial system is the time dilation
in the presence of a gravitational field.
The general theory of relativity gives an unified theory of space,
time and gravitation; it requires a non-Euclidean four-dimensional
geometry, known as Riemannian geometry. Reichenbach explains the main
properties of this kind of geometry and the main differences between
Euclidean geometry and Riemannian geometry. In Euclidean geometry the
distance between two points is given by a simple function of
coordinates; also in Minkowski four-dimensional space-time the
interval is calculable by means of coordinates. In Euclidean geometry
the coordinates have both a metric and topological significance; this
is true also in the special theory of relativity. In Riemannian
geometry the four coordinates perform a topological function, not a
metric one. This means that we cannot calculate the distance between
two points by means of coordinates. The metric functions is performed
by the metric tensor g; it is a mathematical entity
represented by 16 components. The geometry of four-dimensional
space-time depends on the metric tensor g; for example, if the
components of g are
|
1
|
0
|
0
|
0
|
|
0
|
1
|
0
|
0
|
|
0
|
0
|
1
|
0
|
|
0
|
0
|
0
|
1
|
then the geometry is a Minkowski geometry (ie the geometry of the
special theory). Thus the tensor g expresses the geometry. But
g is determined by the gravitational field, because the metric
tensor also expresses the acceleration of the frame of reference and
the effects of an acceleration are equivalent to the effects of a
gravitational field. The metric tensor g expresses both the
physical geometry and the gravitational field. The consequence is
astonishingly: the geometry of the universe is produced by
gravitational fields. Therefore the general theory of relativity
does not reduce gravitation to geometry; on the contrary, geometry is
based on gravitation. The properties of space and time are empirical
properties caused by gravitational fields.
e. The Reality of Space and Time
Reichenbach asserts (in
The philosophy of space and time) that the reality of space
and time is an unquestionable result of the epistemological analysis
of the theory of relativity. With respect to the problem of
reality, space and time are not different from the other physical
concepts. But the reality of space and time does not imply the
concept of an absolute space and time. Space and time are relational
concepts and we can study their properties because of the existence
of physical objects, eg clocks, that realize relationships between
space-time entities. Reichenbach also emphasizes the causal theory of
space and time: causality is the basis of both philosophical and
physical theory of space and time.
3. Quantum Mechanics
a. Interpretation of Quantum Physics: Part I
The main thesis
of Reichenbach's work on quantum mechanics (Philosophic
foundations of quantum mechanics) is that there is not any
exhaustive interpretation of quantum mechanics which is free from
causal anomalies. A causal anomaly is a violation of the
principle of local action; this principle states that the action at a
distance does not exist. We have found the principle of local action
and causal anomalies in Reichenbach's philosophy of space and
time.
Two main interpretations of quantum mechanics are involved with
the wave-particle duality. Wave interpretation states that
atomic entities are waves or things that resemble waves; it grew out
of the discovery of the wave-like nature of light and it is supported
by many experiments, for example the two-slit experiment. In this
experiment a beam of electrons is direct towards a screen with two
slits and an interference pattern is produced behind the screen,
showing that electrons act as waves. The corpuscolar
interpretation regards atomic entities as particles; it is
supported by a long standing tradition and by the fact that atomic
entities show corpuscular properties, eg mass and momentum. Both wave
and corpuscular interpretation entail causal anomalies. For example
corpuscular interpretation cannot fully explain the two-slit
experiment. An electron acting as a particle goes through only one
slit and its behaviour is independent of the existence of another
slit in a different point of space. In fact, if one slit is open and
the other is close, the interference pattern is not produced:
electrons behave as if they were informed whether the other slit is
open. But wave interpretation cannot fully explain a slightly
different experiment. An electron can be localized by a detector put
near a slit and the electron is detected as particle. However for
every event in quantum realm there is an interpretation by means of
particles or waves but there is not a unique interpretation for all
events. Both corpuscular and wave interpretation are not verifiable;
they are not matter of experience but they are matter of
definition.
There are two models that are free of causal anomalies; they are
restricted interpretations, ie they exclude the admissibility of
certain statements. One is Bohr-Heisenberg interpretation
(Niels Bohr, b 1885 d 1962, Danish physicist winner of Nobel prize in
1922, gave the first account of the quantum theory of atoms; Werner
Karl Heisenberg, b 1901 d 1976, German physicist winner of Nobel
prize in 1932, formulated matrix mechanics and proved the
principle of indeterminacy according to which there is no way
of measuring both position and momentum of atomic particles). This
interpretation states that speaking about values of not measured
physical quantities is meaningless. In the two-slit experiment, when
the two slits are open and electrons interfere with themselves, the
position of electrons cannot be measured; thus a statement about the
position of electrons is meaningless and the particle interpretation
is forbidden. There are two main faults - Reichenbach says - in
Bohr-Heisenbergh interpretation: (i) Heisenberg indeterminacy
principle becomes a meta-statement on the semantics of the language
of physics and (ii) it implies the presence of meaningless statements
in physics.
The other interpretation depends on three-valued logic, ie a
formal system that acknowledges three truth values: true, false and
indeterminate.
b. Mathematical Formulation of Quantum Mechanics
Reichenbach
carefully examines and explains the mathematical formulation of
quantum mechanics. It is based on the notion of quantum
operator; a quantum operator is a mathematical entity
corresponding to a given classical quantity. For example, the quantum
operator energy correspond to the energy in classical physics.
A quantum operator can only assume discrete values while the
corresponding classical quantity assumes continuous values. Note that
an operator is not a function; it indicates a set of operation to be
performed on a function.
Let U be a classical quantity; U depends on position Q and
momentum P, that is U=F[Q,P] (position
and momentum are vectors and I use bold face as indicator of vector;
I use square brackets to show that a function depends on given
quantities). The quantum operator corresponding to U is called Uop
and is defined by the following statements.
1. For every function F[Q], substitute
'multiply by F[Q]' to 'F[Q]'.
2. Substitute 'multiply the first partial derivative with
respect to Q by C' to 'P', where C=h/(2*pi*i), h is
the Planck constant, pi equals 3.14..., i is the square root of
-1.
3. Substitute 'multiply the second partial derivative with
respect to Q by C^2' to 'P', where C=h/(2*pi*i), h
is the Planck constant, pi equals 3.14..., i is the square root of
-1.
c. Examples of Quantum Operators
Let T be the kinetic energy;
in classical mechanics, the kinetic energy is given by the ratio of
the square of momentum P to twice the mass m, that is
T=P^2 / 2m. Quantum operator Top is given by Top=C^2 * (1/2m)
* D" (I use symbol D' to indicate the first partial derivative
with respect to position and D" to indicate the second partial
derivative with respect to position).
Let H be the mechanical energy, ie the sum of the kinetic energy T
and the potential energy V: H=T+V[Q]; therefore
Hop=Top+Vop=C^2 * (1/2m) * D" + V[Q]. If F is a
given function, the result (indicated by Hop F) of performing the
operations described by operator Hop on function F is C^2 * (1/2m) *
D" F + V * F.
Classical and Quantum Physical Quantities; Schrodinger
Equations
Quantum operators are useful to describe quantum
systems; they transform physical quantities defined in classical
mechanics into quantum quantities. Let U and Uop be a physical
quantity and the corresponding operator; the very simple rule is
(E1) Uop F = U * F.
In equation E1 the function F is a parameter and the function U is
the variable; functions F satisfying equation E1 are called
eigenfunctions. When F is an eigenfunction, the variable U
satisfying equation E1 is called an eigenvalue. Usually
eigenvalues do not belong to a continuous interval but they are
discrete values and they represent the admissible values of quantity
U. The first Schrodinger equation can be derived from equation E1
substituting the energy H to the general function U.
(S1) Hop F = H * F that is
(S1) C^2 * (1/2m) * D" F + V * F = H * F.
The physical meaning of first Schrodinger equations is that the
energy H of an atomic particle, eg an electron, can only assume
values satisfying the equation; these values are discrete and belong
to a set of fixed values. A given function F satisfying equation S1
is a wave function and describe a stationary state. The amplitude of
the wave function F gives the probability to find the particle in a
given point of space. The second Schrodinger equation is:
(S2) Hop PSI = (ih/2*pi) * PSI'
where PSI is a linear combination of wave functions and PSI' is
the first partial derivative with respect to time. Equation S2
describe a quantum system by means of function PSI; this function is
the infinite sum of eigenfunctions.
(S3) PSI = K1 * F1 + K2 * F2 + K3 * F3 + K4 * F4 + ...
where Kn is a series of coefficients and Fn is the series of
eigenfunctions satisfying equation E1. The square of coefficient Kn
gives the probability that the system is in the state described by
Fn, ie the square of Kn is the probability that the value of U equals
the eigenvalue corresponding to Fn. The second Schrodinger equations
is a deterministic equation, ie if we know the wave function PSI in a
given time t, we can calculate PSI in every time. Note that PSI does
not fully describe the quantum system; it only gives the probability
(by means of coefficients Kn) that the energy of the quantum system
equals a specific value. Suppose a measurement of U gives the value
Un, which is the eigenvalue corresponding to the eigenfunction Fn;
then PSI = Fn. A measurement of U therefore changes the function PSI
so that PSI = Fn, for an appropriate eigenfunction Fn.
d. Heisenberg Indeterminacy Principle
Let Pop and
Qop the quantum operator corresponding to momentum and
position. It is easy to verify that for every function F
(H) Pop Qop F - Qop Pop F = C
* F
and the equation H is a mathematical formulation of Heisenberg
indeterminacy principle. The proof of equation H is
straightforward.
Pop Qop F - Qop Pop F =
Pop (Q * F) - Qop (C * D' F) =
C * (D' (Q * F) - Q * (D' F) =
C * (D' Q * F + Q * D' F - Q *
D' F) =
C * F
Reichenbach explains the physical meaning of equation H. Equation
H proves that the eigenvalues of position and momentum are different.
Now suppose a physicist measures both position and momentum of a
particle; let Fp be the eigenfunction corresponding to the measured
momentum and Fq be the eigenfunction corresponding to the measured
position. From the measurement of position: PSI = Fp; from the
measurement of momentum: PSI = Fq. Therefore Fp = Fq and the
eigenvalues are the same; but the eigenvalues are different. So
position and momentum of a particle cannot be simultaneously
measured. Reichenbach asserts that Heisenberg indeterminacy principle
is not due to the alleged interference an observer exerts on
particles (the explanation of indeterminacy principle in terms of an
interference is due to Heisenberg). This principle is an objective
law of nature, and it can be stated without reference to
observers.
e. The Interpretation of Quantum Physics: Part II
After the
mathematical formulation of quantum mechanics, Reichenbach states the
basic assumption of the different interpretation of quantum
mechanics. Corpuscolar interpretation relies on the following
definition. If a measurement of U equals Um, then Um is the values
of U not only at the time of measurement but also immediately before
and immediately after. If a physicist measures the position of an
electron and immediately after its momentum, than he know both
position and momentum of the electron. In this interpretation atomic
particles have both momentum and position, so they are real
particles; a physicist can also measure both momentum and position.
The knowledge of both position and momentum is unusable because of
the difference between the eigenfunctions: if PSI equals the
eigenfunction "position" the knowledge of momentum is totally unused
while if PSI equals the eigenfunction "momentum" the knowledge of
position is totally unused.
Wave interpretation states that the value of a measured
quantity exists after the measurement but before the measurement the
quantity assumes simultaneously all possible values. The effect
of the measurement is the collapse of wave function.
Bohr-Heisenberg interpretation asserts that the value of
a physical quantity exists only after the measurement; a statement
about this value before the measurement is therefore
meaningless.
The interpretation based on three-valued logic states that
a statement about a not measured physical quantity can be neither
true nor false: it can be indeterminate. The following tables
show the properties of logical connectives in the three-valued logic
suggested by Reichenbach (symbols used in these tables differ from
symbols used by Reichenbach).
negation: cyclic (-) diametrical (?) complete (^))
|
A
|
-A
|
?A
|
^A
|
|
T
|
I
|
F
|
I
|
|
I
|
F
|
I
|
T
|
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
or (v) and (&)
implication: standard (>) alternative (#) quasi (*)
equivalence: standard (=) alternative (<=>)
|
A
|
B
|
(AvB)
|
(A&B)
|
(A>B)
|
(A#B)
|
(A*B)
|
(A=B)
|
(A<=>B)
|
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
|
T
|
I
|
T
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
|
T
|
F
|
T
|
F
|
F
|
F
|
F
|
F
|
F
|
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
|
I
|
I
|
I
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
|
I
|
F
|
I
|
F
|
I
|
T
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
F
|
F
|
|
F
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
|
F
|
F
|
F
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
Suppose P is the statement "the momentum of the particle is p" and
Q is the statement "the position of the particle is q"; then
Heisenberg indeterminacy principle is expressed by the following
statement: (Pv-P) # --Q. The following table is the truth-table of
this sentence.
|
P
|
Q
|
-P
|
Pv-P
|
-Q
|
--Q
|
(Pv-P) # --Q
|
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
T
|
I
|
F
|
F
|
|
T
|
I
|
I
|
T
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
|
T
|
F
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
F
|
|
I
|
T
|
F
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
T
|
|
I
|
I
|
F
|
I
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
|
I
|
F
|
F
|
I
|
T
|
I
|
T
|
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
F
|
F
|
|
F
|
I
|
T
|
T
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
|
F
|
F
|
T
|
T
|
T
|
I
|
F
|
The truth of (Pv-P) # --Q implies that the situations described in
1st, 3rd, 7th and 9th row of the truth-table are forbidden.
Reichenbach explains how the three-valued interpretation hides causal
anomalies. Look at the two-slit experiment. Suppose the two slits are
open and the interference pattern is produced. Let P(A) be the
probability that an electron goes through the first slit; let P(B) be
the probability that an electron goes through the second slit; let
P(A,C) be the probability that an electron gone through the first
slit hits the screen in point C; let P(B,C) be the probability that
an electron gone through the second slit hits the screen in point C;
let P(C) the probability that an electron hits the screen in point C.
Corpuscular interpretation suggests that
(E2) P(C)=P(A)*P(A,C)+P(B)*P(B,C)
In fact P(C) is not given by equation E2: this is the origin of
causal anomalies. Equation E2 can be expressed by the following
statement: (AvB)#C, where A is "the electron goes through the first
slit", B is "the electron goes through the second slit" and C is E2.
We know that (i) if an electron goes through the first slit then it
does not go through the second slit and vice versa, ie A # -B and B #
-A; (ii) if an electron does not go through a slit then it goes
through the other slit, ie -A # B and -B # A. In classical logic, (i)
and (ii) imply AvB, ie [(A # -B)&(B # -A)&(-A #
B)&(-B # A)] # AvB is true (look at the following table).
|
A
|
B
|
[((A # -B)
|
&
|
(B # -A))
|
&
|
((-A # B)
|
&
|
(-B # A))]
|
#
|
AvB
|
|
F
|
F
|
F T T
|
T
|
F T T
|
F
|
T F F
|
F
|
T F F
|
T
|
F
|
The truth-table is restricted to one combination of truth-values
because in the other combinations the consequence AvB is true and the
statement Z # (AvB) is true for all Z. In corpuscular interpretation
of two-slit experiment the statement (A # -B)&(B # -A)&(-A #
B)&(-B # A) is true; in classical logic the statement [(A #
-B)&(B# -A)&(-A # B)&(-B # A)] # AvB is true and thus
also AvB is true; therefore E2 is true. But E2 does not give the
correct formula for the probability and so there is a causal anomaly.
In three-valued logic, (i) and (ii) do not imply AvB; this fact is
proved by means of the following table.
|
A
|
B
|
[((A # -B)
|
&
|
(B # -A))
|
&
|
((-A # B)
|
&
|
(-B # A))]
|
#
|
AvB
|
|
I
|
I
|
I T F
|
T
|
I T F
|
T
|
F T I
|
T
|
F T I
|
F
|
I
|
Thus we cannot assert E2 and there is not any causal anomaly.
4. Reichenbach's Epistemology
a. The Structure of Science and the Verifiability Principle
A
scientific theory is a formal system which requires a physical
interpretation by means of co-ordinative definitions. Reichenbach's
philosophical research on the theory of relativity and quantum
mechanics implicitly depends on this view. For example, the
distinction between mathematical geometry and physical geometry
entails the distinction between a purely formal system and a system
interpreted by means of definitions. Co-ordinative definitions are
true by convention and cannot be verified, but they are not
meaningless; in fact scientific theories require them to acquire an
empirical significance. The acknowledgement of the existence of
meaningful and not verifiable sentences is very important for a right
interpretation of the epistemology of logical positivism. The
verifiability principle is often regarded as the most
important principle of logical positivism; it states that the meaning
of a sentence is its method of verification and a sentence which
cannot be verified is meaningless. According to this principle,
co-ordinative definitions might be meaningless; on the contrary, in
Reichenbach opinion, they are not only meaningful but also required
by scientific theories. Note that Reichenbach explicit agrees with
verifiability principle. In 'The philosophical significance of the
theory of relativity' (1949) he says that the meaning of a sentence
is reducible to its method of verification; he also says that a
physicist can fully understand the Michelson's experiment only if he
adopts the verifiability theory of meaning. In the same essay,
Reichenbach says that the logic foundation of the theory of
relativity is the discovery that many problems are not verifiable;
these problems can be solved by means of co-ordinative definitions.
Thus co-ordinative definitions are meaningful and not verifiable. So
we must acknowledge that Reichenbach agrees with the verifiability
principle and, at the same time, asserts that in scientific theories
there are meaningful sentences, namely co-ordinative definitions,
that are not verifiable. Why these sentences are not meaningless?
Because they belong to scientific theories that are verifiable. For
example, Reichenbach states that (i) the Euclidean geometry is not
verifiable, (ii) the co-ordinative definitions of geometrical
entities are not verifiable but (iii) the Euclidean geometry plus the
co-ordinative definitions of geometrical entities is verifiable.
The theory must be verifiable, the individual statements belonging
to the theory can be not verifiable.
b. Conventionalism vs. Empiricism
In Reichenbach opinion,
among the purposes of the philosophy of science is the search for a
distinction between empirical and conventional sentences. The
separation of empirical from conventional sentences is not only
possible but also necessary for a full understanding of scientific
theories. Philosophical research on modern science clearly shows that
conventional elements are present in scientific knowledge. The
description of our world is not uniquely determined by observations,
but there is a plurality of equivalent descriptions; for example, we
can use different geometry for describing the same space. But
conventionalism is in error. For example, conventionalism states that
we can always adopt the Euclidean geometry by means of appropriate
definitions. But if we adopt a set of definitions so that the
geometry on the Earth is Euclidean, it is possible that in another
point of the universe the same set of definitions entails a
non-Euclidean geometry; so we can discover an objective difference
between different points of space. Note that Reichenbach does not
state that scientific knowledge can be proved by means of experience.
On the contrary, he asserts that scientific theories are based on
physical hypotheses which are not a logical consequence of
experiments, eg the general theory of relativity is based on
Einstein's hypothesis that free falling frames of reference are
inertial systems; we cannot prove this hypothesis, but we can verify
its consequences. Scientific theories cannot be proved, but we can
test their forecasts.
c. Causality
Causality plays a central role in Reichenbach's
philosophy of science. Reichenbach uses the theory of causality as a
key to provide access to modern physics and understanding of the
philosophical significance of both the theory of relativity and
quantum mechanics. According to Reichenbach, the causal theory of
space and time is the basis for both the theory of relativity and the
philosophy of space and time. In the theory of relativity it is
always possible to choose a set of co-ordinative definitions
satisfying normal causality. Therefore different geometrical systems
are not equivalent and they can be divided into two groups, one group
satisfying normal causality while the other entails causal anomalies.
Only geometrical systems belonging to the first group are admissible.
It is the experience that decides whether a given geometry belongs to
the first group; thus conventionalism's view on geometry is wrong. In
quantum mechanics there is not any set of co-ordinative definitions
which is free from causal anomalies and satisfies classical logic. In
fact, a three-valued logic is required to give an interpretation
satisfying normal causality.
d. Science and Philosophy
First of all, we must acknowledge
his scientific seriousness and physical-mathematical skill. His deep
knowledge of modern physics is unquestionable. Reichenbach's positive
attitude towards scientific knowledge was influenced not only by his
teachers but also by his own philosophical views. In his opinion,
modern physics is concerned with problems that, until the late 19th
century, were regarded as philosophical problems, eg the nature of
space and time, the source of gravitation, the real extent of
causality. In 17th and 18th century - Reichenbach says - philosophers
were usually interested in science and many of them were also
mathematicians and physicists, eg Descartes and Leibniz; Kant's
epistemology was based on scientific knowledge. But since 18th
science became extraneous to philosophy. Nowadays - Reichenbach wrote
in 1928 - there is an almost complete separation of philosophy from
physical sciences; philosophical researches into epistemology are
fruitless, because of this separation. On the other hand, scientists
cannot explicitly help the progress of epistemology: they are too
much involved in technical researches. There is only one way to
overcome this difficulty: philosophers, who are not concerned with
technical subjects but deal with genuine philosophical problems, must
dedicate themselves to the philosophical analysis of modern physics,
so they can clearly express the implicit philosophical content of
scientific theories. In fact, modern physics is rich in philosophical
consequences: there is more philosophy in Einstein's work than in
many philosophical systems.
5. Bibliography
Reichenbach's Main Works, arranged in Chronological Order..
1916 Der Begriff der Wahrscheinlichkeit fur die mathematische
Darstellung der Wirklichkeit, dissertation, Erlangen, 1915
1920 Relativitatstheorie und Erkenntnis apriori (English
translation The theory of relativity and a priori knowledge,
Berkeley : University of California Press, 1965)
1921 'Bericht uber eine Axiomatik der Einsteinschen
Raum-Zeit-Lehre' in Phys. Zeitschr., 22
1922 'Der gegenwartige Stand der Relativitatsdiskussion' in
Logos, X (English translation 'The present state of the
discussion on relativity' in Modern philosophy of science :
selected essays by Hans Reichenbach, London : Routledge &
Kegan Paul ; New York : Humanities press, 1959)
1924 Axiomatik der relativistischen Raum-Zeit-Lehre
(English translation Axiomatization of the theory of
relativity, Berkeley : University of California Press, 1969)
1924 'Die Bewegungslehre bei Newton, Leibniz und Huyghens' in
Kantstudien, 29 (English translation 'The theory of motion
according to Newton, Leibniz, and Huyghens' in Modern philosophy
of science : selected essays by Hans Reichenbach, London :
Routledge & Kegan Paul ; New York : Humanities press, 1959)
1925 'Die Kausal-strukture der Welt und der Unterschied von
Vergangenheit und Zukunft' in Sitzungsber d. Bayer. Akad. d.
Wiss., math-naturwiss.
1927 Von Kopernikus bis Einstein. Der Wandel unseres
Weltbildes (English translation From Copernicus to
Einstein, New York : Alliance book corp., 1942)
1928 Philosophie der Raum-Zeit-Lehre (English translation
The philosophy of space and time, New York : Dover
Publications, 1958)
1929 'Stetige Wahrscheinlichkeits folgen' in Zeitschr. f.
Physik, 53
1929 'Ziele und Wege der physikalische Erkenntnis' in Handbuch
der Physik ed. by Hans Geiger and Karl Scheel, Bd IV, Berlin :
Julius Springer
1930 Atom und kosmos. Das physikalische Weltbild der
Gegenwart (English translation Atom and cosmos; the world of
modern physics, London : G. Allen & Unwin, ltd., 1932)
1931 Ziele und Wege der heutigen Naturphilosophie (English
translation 'Aims and methods of modern philosophy of nature' in
Modern philosophy of science : selected essays, Westport :
Greenwood Press, 1959)
1933 'Kant und die Naturwissenschaft', Die
Naturwissenschaften, 33-34
1935 Wahrscheinlichkeitslehre : eine Untersuchung uber die
logischen und mathematischen Grundlagen der
Wahrscheinlichkeitsrechnung (English translation The theory of
probability, an inquiry into the logical and mathematical foundations
of the calculus of probability, Berkeley : University of
California Press, 1948)
1938 Experience and prediction: an analysis of the foundations
and the structure of knowledge, Chicago : University of Chicago
Press
1944 Philosophic foundations of quantum mechanics, Berkeley
and Los Angeles : University of California press
1947 Elements of symbolic logic, New York, Macmillan
Co.
1948 Philosophy and physics, 'Faculty research lectures,
1946', Berkeley, Univ. of California Press
1949 'The philosophical significance of the theory of relativity'
in Albert Einstein: philosopher-scientist, edit by P. A.
Schillp, Evanston : The Library of Living Philosophers
1951 The rise of scientific philosophy, Berkeley :
University of California Press
1953 'Les fondaments logiques de la mechanique des quanta' in
Annales de l'Istitut Henri Poincare', Tome XIII Fasc II
1954 Nomological statements and admissible operations,
Amsterdam : Nort Holland Publishing Company
1956 The direction of time, Berkeley : University of
California Press
Collected works (in German).
Gesammelte Werke : in 9 Banden ; herausgegeben von Andreas
Kamlah und Maria Reichenbach, Wiesbaden : Vieweg
1977 Bd. 1: Der Aufstieg der wissenschaftlichen
Philosophie
1977 Bd. 2: Philosophie der Raum-Zeit-Lehre
1979 Bd. 3: Die philosophische Bedeutung der
Relativitatstheorie
1983 Bd. 4: Erfahrung und Prognose : eine Analyse der
Grundlagen und der Struktur der Erkenntnis
1989 Bd. 5: Philosophische Grundlagen der Quantenmechanik und
Wahrscheinlichkeit
1994 Bd. 7: Wahrscheinlichkeitslehre : eine Untersuchung uber
die logischen und mathematischen Grundlagen der
Wahrscheinlichkeitsrechnung
Other sources.
1959 Modern philosophy of science : selected essays by Hans
Reichenbach, London : Routledge & Kegan Paul ; New York :
Humanities press
1959 Modern philosophy of science : selected essays by Hans
Reichenbach, Westport, Conn. : Greenwood Press
1978 Selected writings, 1909-1953 : with a selection of
biographical and autobiographical sketches, 'Vienna circle
collection', Dordrecht ; Boston : D. Reidel Pub.
1979 Hans Reichenbach, logical empiricist, 'Synthese
library', Dordrecht ; Boston : D. Reidel Pub.
1991 Erkenntnis orientated : a centennial volume for Rudolf
Carnap and Hans Reichenbach, Dordrecht ; Boston : Kluwer Academic
Publishers
1991 Logic, language, and the structure of scientific theories
: proceedings of the Carnap-Reichenbach centennial, University of
Konstanz, 21-24 May 1991, Pittsburgh : University of Pittsburgh
Press ; [Konstanz] : Universitasverlag Konstanz
Erkenntnis was published between 1930 and 1940. Its name was
Erkenntnis - im Auftrage der Gesellschaft fur empirische
Philosophie, Berlin und des Vereins Ernst Mach in Wien, hrsg. v. R.
Carnap und H. Reichenbach (Knowledge - in agreement with Society
for empirical philosophy, Berlin and Ernst Mach Association at
Vienna, edit by R. Carnap and H. Reichenbach). In 1939-40 its name
changed into The Journal of unified science (Erkenntnis), edit
by O. Neurath, R. Carnap, Charles Morris, published by University of
Chicago Press.
| 