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Although all skeptics in some way cast doubt on our ability to gain
knowledge of the world, the term 'skeptic' actually covers a wide
range of attitudes and positions. There are skeptical elements in
the views of many Greek philosophers, but the term 'ancient skeptic'
is generally applied either to a member of Plato's Academy during its
skeptical period (c. 273 B.C.E to 1st century B.C.E.) or to a
follower of Pyrrho (c. 365 to 270 B.C.E.). Pyrrhonian skepticism
flourished from Aenesidemus' revival (1st century B.C.E.) to Sextus
Empiricus, who lived sometime in the 2nd or 3rd centuries C.E. Thus
the two main varieties of ancient skepticism: Academic and
Pyrrhonian.
The term 'skeptic' derives from a Greek noun, skepsis, which
means examination, inquiry, consideration. What leads most skeptics
to begin to examine and then eventually to be at a loss as to what
one should believe, if anything, is the fact of widespread and
seemingly endless disagreement regarding issues of fundamental
importance. Many of the arguments of the ancient skeptics were
developed in response to the positive views of their contemporaries,
especially the Stoics and Epicureans, but
these arguments have been highly influential for subsequent
philosophers and will continue to be of great interest as long as
there is widespread disagreement regarding important philosophical
issues.
Nearly every variety of ancient skepticism includes a thesis
about our epistemic limitations and a thesis about suspending
judgment. The two most frequently made objections to skepticism
target these theses. The first is that the skeptic's commitment to
our epistemic limitations is inconsistent. He cannot consistently
claim to know, for example, that knowledge is not possible; neither
can he consistently claim that we should suspend judgment regarding
all matters insofar as this claim is itself a judgment. Either such
claims will refute themselves, since they fall under their own scope,
or the skeptic will have to make an apparently arbitrary exemption.
The second sort of objection is that the alleged epistemic
limitations and/or the suggestion that we should suspend judgment
would make life unlivable. For, the business of day-to-day life
requires that we make choices and this requires making judgments.
Similarly, one might point out that our apparent success in
interacting with the world and each other entails that we must know
some things. Some responses by ancient skeptics to these objections
are considered in the following discussion.
(Hankinson [1995] is a comprehensive and detailed examination of
ancient skeptical views. See Schmitt [1972] and Popkin [1979] for
discussion of the historical impact of ancient skepticism, beginning
with its rediscovery in the 16th Century, and Fogelin [1994] for an
assessment of Pyrrhonian skepticism in light of contemporary
epistemology. The differences between ancient and modern forms of
skepticism has been a controversial topic in recent years-see
especially, Annas [1986], [1996], Burnyeat [1984], and Bett [1993].)
Table of Contents (Clicking on the links below will take you to those parts of this article)
1. The Distinction Between Academic and Pyrrhonian Skepticism
The distinction between Academic and Pyrrhonian skepticism
continues to be a controversial topic. In the Second Century C.E.,
the Roman author Aulus Gellius already refers to this as an old
question treated by many Greek writers (Attic Nights 11.5.6,
see Striker [1981/1996]). The biggest obstacle to correctly making
this distinction is that it is misleading to describe Academic and
Pyrrhonian skepticism as distinctly unified views in the first place
since different Academics and Pyrrhonists seem to have understood
their skepticisms in different ways. So even though the terms
Academic and Pyrrhonian are appropriate insofar as there are clear
lines of transmission and development of skeptical views that unify
each, we should not expect to find a simple account of the
distinction between the two.
2. Academic Skepticism
a. Arcesilaus
Following Plato's death in 347 B.C.E., his nephew Speusippus
became head of the Academy. Next in line were Xenocrates, Polemo and
Crates. The efforts of the Academics during this period were largely
directed towards developing an orthodox Platonic metaphysics. When
Crates died (c. 272 B.C.E.) Arcesilaus of Pitane (c. 318 to 243
B.C.E.) became the sixth head of the Academy. Another member of the
Academy, Socratides, who was apparently in line for the position,
stepped down in favor of Arcesilaus (DL 4.32); so
it seems he was held in high regard by his predecessors, at least at
the time of his appointment. (See Long [1986] for discussion of the
life of Arcesilaus.)
i. Platonic innovator
According to Diogenes
Laertius (=DL), Arcesilaus was
"the first to argue on both sides of a question, and the first to
meddle with the traditional Platonic system [or: discourse,
logos] and by means of question and answer, to make it more of
a debating contest" (4.28, translation after R.D. Hicks).
Diogenes is certainly wrong about Arcesilaus being the first to argue
on both sides of a question. This was a long standing practice in
Greek rhetoric commonly attributed to the Sophists. But
Arcesilaus was responsible for turning Plato's Academy to a
form of skepticism. This transition was probably supported by an
innovative reading of Plato's books, which he possessed and held in
high regard (DL 4.31).
Diogenes' remark that Arcesilaus 'meddled' with Plato's
system and made it more of a debating contest indicates a critical
attitude towards his innovations. Diogenes (or his source)
apparently thought that Arcesilaus betrayed the spirit of Platonic
philosophy by turning it to skepticism.
Cicero, on the other hand, in an approving tone, reports that
Arcesilaus revived the practice of Socrates, which he takes to
be the same as Plato's.
"[Socrates] was in the habit of drawing forth the opinions of those
with whom he was arguing, in order to state his own view as a
response to their answers. This practice was not kept up by his
successors; but Arcesilaus revived it and prescribed that those who
wanted to listen to him should not ask him questions but state their
own opinions. When they had done so, he argued against them. But
his listeners, so far as they could, would defend their own opinion"
(de Finibus 2.2, translated by Long and Sedley, 68J, see
also de Natura Deorum 1.11).
Arcesilaus had (selectively) derived the lesson from Plato's
dialogues that nothing can be known with certainty, either by the
senses or by the mind (de Oratore 3.67, on the topic of Plato
and Socrates as proto-skeptics, see Annas [1992], Shields [1994] and
Woodruff [1986]). He even refused to accept this conclusion; thus he
did not claim to know that nothing could be known (Academica
45).
ii. Attack on the Stoics
In general, the Stoics were
the ideal target for the skeptics; for, their confidence in the areas
of metaphysics, ethics and epistemology was supported by an elaborate
and sophisticated set of arguments. And, the stronger the
justification of some theory, the more impressive is its skeptical
refutation. They were also an attractive target due to their
prominence in the Hellenistic world. Arcesilaus especially targeted
the founder of Stoicism,
Zeno, for refutation. Zeno confidently claimed not only that
knowledge is possible but that he had a correct account of what
knowledge is, and he was willing to teach this to others. The
foundation of this account is the notion of katalêpsis:
a mental grasping of a sense impression that guarantees the truth of
what is grasped. If one assents to the proposition associated with a
kataleptic impression, i.e. if one experiences katalepsis, then the
associated proposition cannot fail to be true. The Stoic sage,
as the perfection and fulfillment of human nature, is the one who
assents only to kataleptic impressions and thus is infallible.
Arcesilaus argued against the possibility of there being any
sense-impressions which we could not be mistaken about. In doing so,
he paved the way for future Academic attacks on Stoicism. To
summarize the attack: for any sense-impression S, received by some
observer A, of some existing object O, and which is a precise
representation of O, we can imagine circumstances in which there is
another sense-impression S', which comes either (i) from something
other than O, or (ii) from something non-existent, and which is such
that S' is indistinguishable from S to A. The first possibility (i)
is illustrated by cases of indistinguishable twins, eggs, statues or
imprints in wax made by the same ring (Lucullus 84-87). The
second possibility (ii) is illustrated by the illusions of dreams and
madness (Lucullus 88-91). On the strength of these examples,
Arcesilaus apparently concluded that we may, in principle, be
deceived about any sense-impression, and consequently that the Stoic
account of empirical knowledge fails. For the Stoics were
thorough-going empiricists and believed that sense-impressions lie at
the foundation of all of our knowledge. So if we could not be
certain of ever having grasped any sense-impression, then we cannot
be certain of any of the more complex impressions of the world,
including what strikes us as valuable. Thus, along with the failure
to establish the possibility of katalepsis goes the failure to
establish the possibility of Stoic wisdom
(see Hankinson [1995], Annas [1990] and Frede [1983/1987] for
detailed discussions of this epistemological debate).
iii. On suspending judgment
In response to this lack of knowledge (whether limited to the
Stoic
variety or knowledge in general), Arcesilaus claimed that we should
suspend judgment. By arguing for and against every position that
came up in discussion he presented equally weighty reasons on both
sides of the issue and made it easier to accept neither side
(Academica 45). Diogenes counts the suspension of judgment as
another of Arcesilaus' innovations (DL4.28) and
refers to this as the reason he never wrote any books (4.32).
Sextus Empiricus (Outlines of Pyrrhonism [generally referred
to by the initials of the title in Greek, PH] 1.232) and Plutarch
(Adversus Colotes 1120C) also attribute the suspension of
judgment about everything to him.
Determining precisely what cognitive attitude Arcesilaus
intended by "suspending judgment" is difficult, primarily because we
only have second and third hand reports of his views (if indeed he
endorsed any views, see Dialectical Interpretation below). To
suspend judgment seems to mean not to accept a proposition as true,
i.e. not to believe it. It follows that if one suspends judgment
regarding p, then he should neither believe that p nor should he
believe that not-p (for this will commit him to the truth of not-p).
But if believing p just means believing that p is true, then
suspending judgment regarding everything is the same as not believing
anything. If Arcesilaus endorsed this, then he could not
consistently believe either that nothing can be known or that one
should consequently suspend judgment.
iv. Dialectical Interpretation
One way around this problem is to adopt the dialectical
interpretation (advanced by Couissin [1929]). According to this
interpretation, Arcesilaus merely showed the Stoics that
they didn't have an adequate account of knowledge, not that
knowledge in general is impossible. In other words, knowledge will
only turn out to be impossible if we define it as the Stoics do.
Furthermore, he did not show that everyone should suspend judgment,
but rather only those who accept certain Stoic
premises. In particular, he argued that if we accept the Stoic view
that the Sage never errs, and since katalepsis is not possible, then
the Sage (and the rest of us insofar as we emulate the Sage) should
never give our assent to anything. Thus the only way to achieve
sagehood, i.e. to consistently avoid error, is to suspend judgment
regarding everything and never risk being wrong (Lucullus
66-67, 76-78, see also Sextus Empiricus, Against the Logicians
[generally referred to by the initial M, for the name of the larger
work from which it comes, Adversus Mathematikos] 7.150-57).
But the dialectical Arcesilaus himself neither agrees nor disagrees
with this.
v. Practical Criterion: to eulogon
The biggest obstacle to the dialectical interpretation is
Arcesilaus' practical criterion, to eulogon. Arcesilaus
presented this criterion in response to the Stoic
objection that if we were to suspend judgment regarding everything,
then we would not be able to continue to engage in day to day
activities. For, the Stoics
thought, any deliberate action presupposes some assent, which is to
say that belief is necessary for action. Thus if we eliminate belief
we will eliminate action (Plutarch, Adversus Colotes 1122A-F,
LS 69A).
Sextus remarks that
"inasmuch as it was necessary . . . to investigate also the conduct
of life, which cannot, naturally, be directed without a criterion,
upon which happiness-that is, the end of life-depends for its
assurance, Arcesilaus asserts that he who suspends judgment about
everything will regulate his inclinations and aversion and his
actions in general by the rule of 'the reasonable [to
eulogon],' and by proceeding in accordance with this criterion he
will act rightly; for happiness is attained by means of wisdom, and
wisdom consists in right actions, and the right action is that which,
when performed, possesses a reasonable justification. He, therefore,
who attends to 'the reasonable' will act rightly and be happy"
(M 7.158, translated by Bury).
There is a good deal of Stoic
technical terminology in this passage, including the term eulogon
itself, and this may seem to support the dialectical
interpretation. On this view, Arcesilaus is simply showing the Stoics both
that their account of knowledge is not necessary for virtue, and that
they nonetheless already have a perfectly acceptable epistemic
substitute, to eulogon (see Striker [1980/1996]). But this
raises the question, why would Arcesilaus make such a gift to his Stoic
adversaries? It would be as if, Maconi's words, "Arcesilaus first
knocked his opponent to the ground and then gave him a hand up again"
(1988: 248). Such generosity would seem to be incompatible with the
purely dialectical purpose of refutation. Similarly, if he had been
arguing dialectically all along, there seems to be no good reason for
him to respond to Stoic
objections, for he was not presenting his own views in the first
place. On the other hand, the proponent of the dialectical view
could maintain that Arcesilaus has not done any favors to the Stoics by
giving them the gift of to eulogon; rather, this 'gift' may
still be seen as a refutation of the Stoic view
that a robust knowledge is necessary for virtue.
An alternative to the dialectical view is to interpret to
eulogon as Arcesilaus' own considered opinion regarding how one
may live well in the absence of certainty. This view then encounters
the earlier difficulty of explaining how it is consistent for
Arcesilaus to endorse suspending judgment on all matters while at the
same time believing that one may attain wisdom and happiness by
adhering to his practical criterion.
b. Carneades
Arcesilaus was succeeded by Lacydes (c. 243 B.C.E.), and then
Evander and Hegesinus in turn took over as heads of the Academy.
Following Hegesinus, Carneades of Cyrene (c. 213 to 129 B.C.E.),
perhaps the most illustrious of the skeptical Academics, took charge.
Rather than merely responding to the dogmatic positions that were
currently held as Arcesilaus did, Carneades developed a wider array
of skeptical arguments against any possible dogmatic position,
including some that were not being defended. He also elaborated a
more detailed practical criterion, to pithanon. As was the
case with Arcesilaus, he left nothing in writing, except for a few
letters, which are no longer extant (DL 4.65).
i. Socratic Dialectic
Carneades employed the same dialectical strategies as
Arcesilaus (Academica 45, Lucullus 16), and similarly
found his inspiration and model in Plato's Socrates. The Socratic
practice which Carneades employed, according to Cicero, was to try to
conceal his own private opinion, relieve others from deception and in
every discussion to look for the most probable solution (Tusculan
Disputations 5.11, see also de Natura Deorum 1.11).
In 155 B.C.E., nearly one hundred years after Arcesilaus' death in
243, Carneades is reported to have gone as an Athenian ambassador to
Rome. There he presented arguments one day in favor of justice and
the next he presented arguments against it. He did this not because
he thought that justice should be disparaged but rather to show its
defenders that they had no conclusive support for their view
(Lactantius, LS 68M). Similarly, we find Carneades arguing against
the Stoic
conception of the gods, not in order to show that they do not exist,
but rather to show that the Stoics had
not firmly established anything regarding the divine (de Natura
Deorum 3.43-44, see also 1.4). It seems then that Carneades was
motivated primarily by the Socratic goal of relieving others of the
false pretense to knowledge or wisdom and that he pursued this goal
dialectically by arguing both for and against philosophical positions.
ii. On ethical theory
But whereas Arcesilaus seemed to limit his targets to
positions actually held by his interlocutors, Carneades generalized
his skeptical attack, at least in ethics and epistemology. The main
task of Hellenistic ethics was to determine the summum bonum,
the goal at which all of our actions must aim if we are to live
good, happy lives. Carneades listed all of the defensible
candidates, including some that had not actually been defended, in
order to argue for and against each one and show that no one in fact
knows what the summum bonum is, if indeed there is one (de
Finibus 5.16-21). He may have even intended the stronger
conclusion that it is not possible to acquire knowledge of the
summum bonum, assuming his list was exhaustive of all the
serious candidates.
iii. On the Stoic sage
As with Arcesilaus, Carneades also focused much of his
skeptical energy on the Stoics,
particularly the views of the scholarch Chrysippus (DL 4.62).
The Stoics
had developed a detailed view of wisdom as life in accordance with
nature. The Stoic sage
never errs, he never incorrectly values the goods of fortune, he
never suffers from pathological emotions, and he always remains
tranquil. His happiness is completely inviolable since everything he
does and everything he experiences is precisely as it should be; and
crucially, he knows this to be true. Even though the Stoics were
extremely reluctant to admit that anyone had so far achieved this
extraordinary virtue, they nonetheless insisted that it was a real
possibility (Luc. 145, Tusc. 2.51, Seneca Ep.
42.1, M 9.133, DL 7.91).
As a dialectician, Carneades carefully examined this
conception of the sage. Sometimes he argued, contrary to the Stoic view,
that the sage would in fact assent to non-kataleptic impressions and
thus that he was liable to error (Luc. 67); for he might form
opinions even in the absence of katalepsis (Luc. 78). But he also
apparently argued against the view that the sage will hold mere
opinions in the absence of katalepsis (Luc. 112). Presumably
he didn't himself endorse either position since the issue that had to
be decided first was whether katalepsis was even possible. In other
words, if certainty is possible, then of course the sage
should not settle for mere opinion. But if it is not possible, then
perhaps he will be entitled to hold mere opinions, provided they are
thoroughly examined and considered.
iv. On epistemology
Just as Carneades generalized his skeptical attack on ethical
theories, he also argued against all of his predecessors'
epistemological theories (M 7.159). The main task of
Hellenistic epistemology was to determine the criterion (standard,
measure or test) of truth. If the criterion of truth is taken to be
a sort of sense-impression, as in the Stoic
theory, then we will not be able to discover any such impression that
could not in principle appear true to the most expertly trained and
sensitive perceiver and yet still be false (M 7.161-65, see
Arcesilaus' 'Attack on the
Stoics' above). But if we can discover no criterial
sense-impression, then neither will the faculty of reason alone be
able to provide us with a criterion, insofar as we accept the
empiricist view (common among Hellenistic philosophers) that nothing
can be judged by the mind that hasn't first entered by the senses.
We have no evidence to suggest that Carneades also argued
against a rationalist, or a priori approach to the criterion.
v. Practical criterion: to pithanon
According to Sextus, after arguing against all the available
epistemological theories, Carneades himself needed to advance a
criterion for the conduct of life and the attainment of happiness (M
7.166). Sextus does not tell us why it was necessary for Carneades
to do so, but it was probably for the same reason that Arcesilaus had
presented his practical criterion-namely, in response to the
objection that if there were no epistemic grounds on which to prefer
one impression over another then, despite all appearances, we cannot
rationally govern our choices. Thus, Carneades expounded his
practical criterion, to pithanon.
First he noted that every sense impression exists in two distinct
relations: one relative to the object from which it comes, the
"impressor", and the other relative to the perceiver. The first
relation determines what we ordinarily think of as truth: does the
impression correspond to its object or not? The second relation
determines plausibility: is the impression convincing to the
perceiver or not? Rather than relying on the first relation,
Carneades adopted the convincing impression [pithanê
phantasia] as the criterion of truth, even though there will be
occasions on which it fails to accurately represent its object. Yet,
he apparently thought that these occasions are rare and so they do
not provide a good reason for distrusting the convincing impressions.
For such impressions are reliable for the most part, and in actual
practice, life is regulated by what holds for the most part (M
7.166-75, LS 69D).
Sextus also reports the refinements Carneades made to his criterion.
If we are considering whether we should accept some impression as
true, we presumably have already found it to be convincing, but we
should also consider how well it coheres with other relevant
impressions and then thoroughly examine it further as if we were
cross-examining a witness. The amount of examination that a
convincing impression requires is a function of its importance to us.
In insignificant matters we make use of the merely convincing
impression, but in weighty matters, especially those having to do
with happiness, we should only rely on the convincing impressions
that have been thoroughly explored (M 7.176-84).
Cicero
translates Carneades' pithanon with the Latin terms
probabile and veri simile, and he claims that this
criterion is to be employed both in everyday life and in the Academic
dialectical practice of arguing for and against philosophical views
(Luc. 32, see also Contr.Ac. 2.26, and Glucker
[1995]). The novel feature of this criterion is that it does not
guarantee that whatever is in accordance with it is true. But if it
is to play the dialectical role explicitly specified by Cicero and
suggested by Sextus' report, then it must have some connection with
truth. This is especially clear in the case of sense-impressions:
the benefit of thoroughly examining sense-impressions is that we may
rule out the deceptive ones and accept the accurate ones. And we may
make a similar case, as Cicero does,
for the dialectical examination of philosophical views. A major
difficulty in interpreting Carneades' pithanon in this way is
that it requires some explanation for how we are able to identify
what resembles the truth (veri simile) without being able to
identify the truth itself (Luc. 32-33).
vi. Dialectical skeptic or fallibilist?
Even if the fallibilist interpretation of Carneades' criterion is
correct, it remains a further issue whether he actually endorsed his
criterion himself, or whether he merely developed it dialectically as
a possible view. Indeed, even Carneades' student Clitomachus was
unable to determine what, if anything, Carneades endorsed (Luc.
139, see also Striker [1980/1996]). A number of difficulties
arise if he did endorse his criterion. First, Carneades argued that
there is absolutely no criterion of truth (M 7.159) and that
would presumably include to pithanon. Second, Clitomachus
claims that Carneades endured a nearly Herculean labor "when he cast
assent out of our minds, like a wild and savage beast, that is mere
opinion and thoughtlessness" (Luc. 108). Thus it would seem
to be inconsistent for him to accept a moderate, fallible form of
assent if it leads to holding opinions.
We may more simply deal with Carneades' criterion by noting that
sometimes he argued so zealously in support of some view that people
reasonably, but incorrectly, assumed that he accepted it himself
(Luc. 78, Fin. 5.20). Thus we may say that Carneades
only advanced views dialectically but remained uncommitted to any of
them. His criterion in this case would be the disappointing
consequence of Stoic
epistemological commitments-disappointing (as in the case with the
dialectical reading of Arcesilaus' eulogon) because the Stoics
believed these same commitments led to a much more robust criterion.
On the other hand, Cicero endorses
a fallibilist interpretation of to pithanon which he seems to
think was also endorsed by Carneades himself. This interpretation
was developed by another of Carneades' students, Metrodorus, and by
Cicero's
teacher, Philo. We also have evidence that Carneades made an
important distinction between assent and approval that he may have
appealed to in this context (Luc. 104, see Bett [1990]). He limits
assent to the mental event of taking a proposition to be true and
adopts the term 'approval' for the more modest mental event of taking
a proposition to be convincing but without making any commitment to
its truth. If this distinction is viable it would allow Carneades to
approve of his epistemological criterion without committing himself
at any deeper theoretical level. In other words Carneades could
appeal to his criterion for his very adoption of that criterion: it
is pithanon but not certain that to pithanon is the
criterion for determining what we should approve of. Cicero claims
that Carneades made just this sort of move in the case of his
rejection of the possibility of Stoic
katalepsis: it is probabile (= pithanon), but not certain,
that katalepsis is not possible (Luc. 110, see Thorsrud
[2002]).
c. Philo and Antiochus
According to Sextus Empiricus, most people divide the Academy
into three periods: the first, the so-called Old Academy, is
Plato's; the second is the Middle Academy of Arcesilaus; and the
third is the New Academy of Carneades. But, he remarks, some also
add a fourth Academy, that of Philo, and a fifth Academy, Antiochus'
(PH 1.220). Philo was head of the Academy from about 110 to
79 B.C.E. His interpretation of Academic skepticism as a mitigated
form that permits tentative approval of the view that survives the
most dialectical scrutiny is recorded and examined in Cicero's
Academica, and in the earlier version of this dialogue, the
Lucullus. The Lucullus is just one of the two books
that constituted the earlier version. The second book, now lost was
called Catulus, after one of the main speakers. Cicero later
revised these books, dividing them into four; but only part of the
first of those four, what is usually referred to as the Academica
posteriora, has survived. Nevertheless, we have enough of these
books to get a pretty good sense of the whole work (see Griffin
[1997], Mansfeld [1997]).
Philo apparently claimed that some sense-impressions very well may be
true but that we nonetheless have no reliable way to determine which
ones these are (Luc. 111, see also 34). Similarly, Sextus
attributes to Philo the view that "as far the Stoic
standard (i.e. apprehensive appearance [= kataleptic impression]) is
concerned, objects are inapprehensible, but as far as the nature of
the objects themselves is concerned they are apprehensible"
(PH 1.235, translated by Annas and Barnes). He may have made
these remarks in order to underwrite the Academic practice of
accepting certain views as resembling the truth; for there must be
some truth in the first place-even if we don't have access to it-in
order for something to resemble it.
Under the pressure of Stoic
objections to his fallibilist epistemology Philo apparently made some
controversial innovations in Academic philosophy. Cicero refers
to these innovations but doesn't discuss them in any detail (Luc.
11-12), nor did he accept them himself, preferring Philo's
earlier view of the Academy and the dialectical practices of
Carneades. Philo's innovation may have been to commit himself to the
metaphysical claim that some impressions are indeed true by providing
arguments to that effect. So rather than rely on the likelihood that
some impressions are true he may have sought to establish this more
firmly. He then may have lowered the standard for knowledge by
giving up the internalist requirement that one be able to identify
which impressions are true and adopted instead the externalist
position that just having true impressions, as long as they have the
right causal history, is enough for one to have knowledge (see
Hankinson [1997] for this interpretation, see also Tarrant [1985] and
Brittain [2001]).
After Philo, Antiochus (c. 130 to c. 68 B.C.E.) led the Academy
decidedly back to a form of dogmatism. He claimed that the Stoisc and
Peripatetics had more accurately understood Plato and thus he sought
to revive these views, including primarily Stoic
epistemology and ethics, in his Academy (Cicero examines
Antiochus' views in de Finibus 5. Glucker [1978] is a
groundbreaking study of Antiochus.).
d. Cicero
Cicero was a
lifelong student and practitioner of Academic philosophy and his
philosophical dialogues are among the richest sources of information
about the skeptical Academy. Although he claims to be a mere
reporter of other philosophers' views (Att. 12.52.3), he went
to some trouble in arranging these views in dialogue form and most
importantly in supplying his own words to express them. In some
cases he coined the words he needed thereby teaching philosophy to
speak Latin. His philosophical coinages-e.g. essentia, qualitas,
beatitudo-have left a lasting imprint on Western philosophy.
He is generally not considered to be an original thinker but it is
difficult to determine the extent to which this is true since
practically none of the books he relied on have survived and so we do
not know how much, or whether, he modified the views he presented.
Nevertheless, despite questions of originality, his dialogues express
a humane and intelligent view of life. Plutarch, in his biography,
claims that Cicero often
asked his friends to call him a philosopher because he had chosen
philosophy as his work, but merely used oratory to achieve his
political ends (Life of Cicero
32.6, Colish [1985] is a comprehensive survey of Cicero's
philosophical dialogues, so too MacKendrick [1989], and see Powell
[1995] for more recent essays on Cicero's
philosophy).
3. Pyrrhonian Skepticism
Pyrrho of Elis (c. 360 to c. 270 BCE), the founder of Pyrrhonian
skepticism, is a shadowy figure who wrote nothing himself. What
little we know of him comes, for the most part, from fragments of his
pupil Timon's poems and from Diogenes Laertius' biography (9.61-108)
which is based on a book by Antigonus of Carystus, an associate of
Timon. There seem to have been no more disciples of Pyrrho after
Timon, but much later in the 1st Century B.C.E., Aenesidemus proposed
a skeptical view that he claimed to be Pyrrhonian. Later still in
the 2nd Century C.E., Sextus Empiricus recorded a battery of
skeptical arguments aimed at all contemporary philosophical views.
As with Aenesidemus, Sextus claimed Pyrrho as the founder, or at
least inspiration, for the skepticism he reports. The content of
these skeptical views, the nature of Pyrrho's influence, and the
relations between succeeding stages of Pyrrhonism are controversial
topics.
a. Pyrrho and Timon
The anecdotal evidence for Pyrrho tends to be sensational.
Diogenes reports, for example, that Pyrrho mistrusted his senses to
such an extent that he would have fallen off cliffs or been run over
by carts and savaged by dogs had his friends not followed close by
(9.62). He was allegedly indifferent to certain norms of social
behavior, taking animals to market, washing a pig and even cleaning
the house himself (9.66). For the most part we find his indifference
presented as a positive characteristic. For example, while on a ship
in the midst of a terrible storm he was able to maintain a state of
tranquility (9.68). Similarly, Timon presents Pyrrho as having
reached a godlike state of calm, having escaped servitude to mere
opinion (9.64-5, see also the fragments of Timon's prose works, as
recorded by Aristocles, LS 2A and 2B). He was also held in such high
regard by his native city that he was appointed as high priest and
for his sake they made all philosophers exempt from taxation (9.64).
We also find a tantalizing report of a journey to India where Pyrrho
mingled with, and presumably learned from, certain naked sophists and
magi (9.61, the connection with Indian Buddhism is explored by
Flintoff [1980]).
Generally, the anecdotal evidence in Diogenes, and elsewhere,
is unreliable, or at least highly suspect. Such reports are more
likely colorful inventions of later authors attributed to Pyrrho to
illustrate, or caricature, some part of his philosophical view.
Nevertheless, he is consistently portrayed as being remarkably calm
due to his lack of opinion, so we may cautiously accept such
accounts.
The most important testimony to the nature of Pyrrho's
skepticism comes from Aristocles, a Peripatetic philosopher of the
2nd Century C.E.:
It is supremely necessary to investigate our own capacity for
knowledge. For if we are so constituted that we know nothing, there
is no need to continue enquiry into other things. Among the ancients
too there have been people who made this pronouncement, and Aristotle
has argued against them. Pyrrho of Elis was also a powerful
spokesman of such a position. He himself has left nothing in
writing, but his pupil Timon says that whoever wants to be happy must
consider these three questions: first, how are things by nature?
Secondly, what attitude should we adopt towards them? Thirdly, what
will be the outcome for those who have this attitude? According to
Timon, Pyrrho declared that [1] things are equally indifferent,
unmeasurable and inarbitrable. For this reason [2] neither our
sensations nor our opinions tell us truths or falsehoods. Therefore,
for this reason we should not put our trust in them one bit, but we
should be unopinionated, uncommitted and unwavering, saying
concerning each individual thing that it no more is than is not, or
it both is and is not, or it neither is nor is not. [3] The outcome
for those who actually adopt this attitude, says Timon, will be first
speechlessness, and then freedom from disturbance . . . (Aristocles
apud Eusebius, Praeparatio evangelica 14.18.1-5,
translated by Long and Sedley, 1F).
Let us consider Pyrrho's questions and answers in order. First, what
are things like by nature? This sounds like a straightforward
metaphysical question about the way the world is, independent of our
perceptions. If so, we should expect Pyrrho's answer, [1] that
things are equally indifferent, unmeasurable and inarbitrable, to be
a metaphysical statement. But this will lead to difficulties, for
how can Pyrrho arrive at the apparently definite proclamation that
things are indefinite? I.e. doesn't his metaphysical statement
refute itself by implicitly telling us that things are decidedly
indeterminate? If we take this view we may defend Pyrrho by allowing
his claim to be exempt from its own scope-so we can determine only
this much: every property of every thing is indeterminate (see Bett
[2000] for this defense). Alternatively, we may allow Pyrrho to
embrace the apparent inconsistency and assert that his claim is
itself neither true nor false, but is inarbitrable. The former
option seems preferable insofar as the latter leaves Pyrrho with no
definite assertion whatsoever and it thus becomes unclear how he
could draw the inferences he does from [1] to [2].
On the other hand, we may seek to avoid these difficulties by
interpreting Pyrrho's first answer as epistemological. After all,
the predicates he uses suggest an epistemological claim is being
made. And further, Aristocles introduces this passage by noting that
we must investigate our capacity for knowledge and he claims that
Pyrrho was a spokesman for the view that we know nothing. Bett
[2000] argues against the epistemological reading on the grounds that
it doesn't make good sense of the passage as it stands. For if we
assume the epistemological reading of [1], that we are unable to
determine the natures of things, then it would be pointless to infer
from that that [2] our senses lie. It would make much more sense to
reverse the inference: one might reasonably argue that our senses
lie and thus we are unable to determine the natures of things. Some
have proposed emending the text from 'for this reason (dia
touto)' to 'on account of the fact that (dia to)' to
capture this reversal of the inference. But if we read the text as
it stands, we may still explain Aristocles' epistemological focus by
pointing out that if [1] things are indeterminate, then the
epistemological skepticism will be a consequence: things are
indeterminable.
Second, in what way ought we to be disposed towards things? Since
things are indeterminate (assuming the metaphysical reading) then no
assertion will be true, but neither will any assertion be false. So
we should not have any opinion about the truth or falsity of any
statement (with the exception perhaps of these meta-level skeptical
assertions). Instead, we should only say and think that something no
more is than is not, or both is and is not, or neither is nor is not,
because in fact that's the way things are. So for example, having
accepted [1] (and assuming the predicative reading of 'is' in [2]), I
will no longer believe that this book is red, but neither will I
believe that it is not red. The book is no more red than not-red, or
similarly, it is as much red as not-red.
Third, what will be the result for those who are so disposed? The
first result is speechlessness (literally, not saying anything)-but
this is odd given that we are encouraged to adopt a form of speech in
[2]. Perhaps speechlessness follows after initially saying
only that things are no more this than that, etc.; then finally,
freedom from disturbance follows. Presumably, the recognition that
things are no more to be sought after than not sought after is
instrumental in producing tranquility, for if nothing is
intrinsically good or bad, we have no reason to ever be distressed,
or to be exuberantly joyful. But then it seems we would not be able
to even choose one thing over another. Pyrrho's tranquility thus
begins to look like a kind of paralysis and this is probably what
prompted some of the sensational anecdotes.
Diogenes notes, however, that according to Aenesidemus, Pyrrho
exercised foresight in his day-to-day activities, and that he lived
to be ninety (9.62). So it seems his tranquility did not paralyze
him after all. This may be either because Pyrrho (or Timon) was
disingenuous about what he was up to intellectually, or more
charitably because he followed appearances (9.106) without ever
committing himself to the truth or falsity of what appeared. (See
'Sextus on the skeptical life' below for further discussion).
b. Aenesidemus
We know practically nothing about Aenesidemus except that he lived
sometime in the 1st Century B.C.E., and that he dedicated one of his
written works to a Lucius Tubero, a friend of Cicero's who
was also a member of the Academy. This has led most scholars to
suppose that Aenesidemus was a member of the Academy, probably during
the period of Philo's leadership, and that his revival of Pyrrhonian
skepticism was probably a reaction to Philo's tendency towards
fallibilism. Although this is plausible, it makes the fact that Cicero never
mentions him quite puzzling.
i. Revival of Pyrrhonism
Aenesidemus' Pyrrhonian Discourses (Pyrrhoneia), like the
rest of his works, have not survived, but they are summarized by a
ninth century Byzantine patriarch, Photius, who is remarkable in his
own right. In his Bibliothêkê (= Bib. ), he
summarized 280 books, including the Pyrrhoneia, apparently
from memory. It is clear from his summary that he thinks very little
of Aenesidemus' work. This is due to his view that Aenesidemus'
skepticism makes no contribution to Christian dogma and drives from
our minds the instinctive tenets of faith (Bib. 170b39-40).
Nevertheless, a comparison of his summaries with the original texts
that have survived reveal that Photius is a generally reliable source
(Wilson [1994]). So despite his assessment of Aenesidemus'
skepticism, the consensus is that he provides an accurate summary of
the Pyrrhoneia. The proper interpretation of that summary,
however, is disputed.
Aenesidemus was a member of Plato's Academy, apparently
during the period of Philo's leadership. Growing dissatisfied with
what he considered the dogmatism of the Academy, he sought to
revitalize skepticism by moving back to a purer form inspired by
Pyrrho. His specific complaint against his contemporary Academics
was that they confidently affirm some things, even Stoic
beliefs, and unambiguously deny other things. In other words, the
Academics, in Aenesidemus' view, were insufficiently impressed by our
epistemic limitations.
His alternative was to 'determine nothing', not even the
claim that he determines nothing. Instead, the Pyrrhonist says that
things are no more one way than another. This form of speech is
ambiguous (in a positive sense, from Aenesidemus' perspective) since
it neither denies nor asserts anything unconditionally. In other
words, the Pyrrhonist will only assert that some property belongs to
some object relative to some observer or relative to some set of
circumstances. Thus, he will conditionally affirm some things but he
will absolutely deny that any property belongs to anything in every
possible circumstance. This seems to be what Aenesidemus meant by
'determining nothing', for his relativized assertions say nothing
definite about the nature of the object in question. Such
statements take the form: it is not the case that X is by nature F.
This is a simple denial that X is always and invariably F, though of
course X may be F in some cases. But such statements are importantly
different from those of the form: X is by nature not-F. For these
sorts of statements affirm that X is invariably not-F and that there
can be no cases of X that exhibit the property F. The only
acceptable form of expression for Aenesidemus then seems to be
statements that may sometimes be false (See Woddruff [1988] for this
interpretation, also Bett 2000).
ii. The Ten Modes
The kinds of conclusion that Aenesidemus countenanced as a
Pyrrhonist can more clearly be seen by considering the kinds of
arguments he advanced to reach them. He apparently produced a set of
skeptical argument forms, or modes, for the purpose of refuting
dogmatic claims regarding the natures of things. Sextus Empiricus
discusses one such group, the Ten Modes, in some detail (PH
1.35-163, M 7.345, see also Diogenes
Laertius' account of the Ten Modes at 9.79-88, and the partial
account in Philo of Alexandria, On Drunkenness 169-205, and
see Annas and Barnes [1985] for detailed and critical discussion of
all ten modes).
The first mode is designed to show that it is not reasonable
to suppose that the way the world appears to us humans is more
accurate than the incompatible ways it appears to other animals. This
will force us to suspend judgment on the question of how these things
are by nature, in and of themselves, insofar as we have no rational
grounds on which to prefer our appearances and insofar as we are not
willing to accept that something can have incompatible properties by
nature. If, for example, manure appears repulsive to humans and
delightful to dogs, weare unable to say that it really is, in its
nature, either repulsive or delightful, or both repulsive and
delightful. It is no more delightful than not-delightful, and no
more repulsive than not-repulsive, (again, in its nature).
Just as the world appears in incompatible ways to members of
different species, so too does it appear incompatibly to members of
the same species. Thus, the second mode targets the endless
disagreements among dogmatists. But once again, we will find no
rational ground to prefer our own view of things, for if an
interested party makes himself judge, we should be suspicious of the
judgment he reaches, and not accept it.
The third mode continues the line of reasoning developed in
the first two. Just as the world appears in incompatible ways to
different people, it also appears incompatibly to the different
senses of one and the same person. So, for example, painted objects
seem to have spatial dimensions that are not revealed to our sense of
touch. Similarly, perfume is pleasant to the nose but disgusting to
the tongue. Thus, perfume is no more pleasant than not-pleasant.
The fourth mode shows that differences in the emotional or
physical state of the perceiver affects his perception of the world.
Being in love, calm and warm, one will experience the cold wind that
comes in with his beloved quite differently than if he is angry and
cold. We are unable to adjudicate between these incompatible
experiences of the cold wind because we have no rational grounds on
which to prefer our experience in one set of circumstances to our
experience in another. One might say that we should give preference
to the experiences of those who are healthy, sane and calm as that is
our natural state. But in response, we may employ the second mode to
challenge the notion of a single, healthy condition that is
universally applicable.
The fifth mode shows that differences in location and
position of an observed object relative to the observer will greatly
affect the way the object appears. Here we find the oar that appears
bent in water, the round tower that appears square from a distance,
and the pigeon's neck that changes color as the pigeon moves. These
features are independent of the observer in a way that the first four
modes are not. But similar to the first four, in each case we are
left without any rational grounds on which to prefer some particular
location or position over another. Why should we suppose, for
example, that the pigeon's neck is really green rather than blue?
And if we should propose some proof, or theory, in support of it
being really blue, we will have to face the skeptic's demand for
further justification of that theory, which will set off an infinite
regress.
The sixth mode claims that nothing can be experienced in its
simple purity but is always experienced as mixed together with other
things, either internally in its composition or externally in the
medium in which it is perceived. This being the case, we are unable
to ever experience the nature of things, and thus are unable to ever
say what that nature is.
The seventh mode appeals to the way different effects are
produced by altering the quantity and proportions of things. For
example, too much wine is debilitating but the right amount is
fortifying. Similarly, a pile of sand appears smooth, but individual
grains appear rough. Thus, we are led to conclude that wine is no
more debilitating than fortifying and sand is no more smooth than
rough, in their natures.
The eighth mode, from relativity, is a paradigm for the whole
set of modes. It seeks to show, in general, that something appears
to have the property F only relative to certain features of the
perceiving subject or relative to certain features of the object.
And, once again, insofar as we are unable to prefer one set of
circumstances to another with respect to the nature of the object, we
must suspend judgment about those natures.
The ninth modes points out that the frequency of encountering
a thing affects the way that thing appears to us. If we see
something that we believe to be rare it will appear more valuable.
And when we encounter some beautiful thing for the first time it will
seem more beautiful or striking than it appears after we become
familiar with it. Thus, we must conclude, for example, that a
diamond is no more valuable than worthless.
Finally, the tenth mode, which bears on ethics, appeals to
differences in customs and law, and in general, to differences in the
ways we evaluate the world. For some, homosexuality is acceptable
and good, and to others it is unacceptable and bad. In and of
itself, homosexuality is neither good nor bad, but only relative to
some way of evaluating the world. And again, since we are unable to
prefer one set of values to another, we are led to the conclusion
that we must suspend judgment, this time with respect to the
intrinsic value of things.
In each of these modes, Aenesidemus seems to be advancing a
sort of relativism: we may only say that some object X has property
F relative to some observer or set of circumstances, and not
absolutely. Thus his skepticism is directed exclusively at a version
of Essentialism; in this case, the view that some object has property
F in any and every circumstance. A further question is whether
Aenesidemus intends his attack on Essentialism to be ontological or
epistemological. If it is epistemological, then he is claiming that
we simply cannot know what the nature or essence of some thing is, or
even whether it has one. This seems most likely to have been
Aenesidemus' position since Photius' summary begins with the remark
that the overall aim of the Pyrrhoneia is to show that there
is no firm basis for cognition. Similarly, the modes seem to be
exclusively epistemological insofar as they compel us to suspend
judgment; they are clearly designed to force the recognition that no
perspective can be rationally preferred to any other with respect to
real natures, or essences. By contrast, the ontological view that
there are no essences, is not compatible with suspending judgment on
the question.
iii. Tranquility
We do not have enough evidence to determine precisely why
Aenesidemus found inspiration in Pyrrho. One important point,
however, is that they both promote a connection between tranquility
and an acceptance of our epistemic limitations (see Bett [2000] for
an elaboration of this view). Diogenes
Laertius attributes the view to both Anesidemus and the followers
of Timon that as a result of suspending judgment, freedom from
disturbance (ataraxia) will follow as a shadow (DL 9.107-8).
Similarly, Photius reports Aenesidemus' view that those who follow
the philosophy of Pyrrho will be happy, whereas by contrast, the
dogmatists will wear themselves out in futile and ceaseless
theorizing (Bib. 169b12-30, LS 71C). Although there seem to
be important differences in what Pyrrho and Aenesidemus understood by
our epistemic limitations, they both promoted tranquility as the
goal, or at least end product. In general terms the idea is clear
enough: the way to a happy, tranquil existence is to live in
accordance with how things seem, including especially our evaluative
impressions of the world. Rather than trying to uncover some hidden
reality, we should accept our limitations, operate in accordance with
custom and habit, and not be disturbed by what we cannot know (see
Striker [1990/1996]).
c. Sextus Empiricus
We know very little about Sextus Empiricus, aside from the fact
that he was a physician. He may have been alive as early as the 2nd
Century C.E. or as late as the 3rd Century C.E. We cannot be certain
as to where he lived, or where he practiced medicine, or where he
taught, if indeed he did teach. In addition to his philosophical
books, he also wrote some medical treatises (referred to at M
7.202, 1.61) which are no longer extant.
There are three philosophical works that have survived. Two of these
works are grouped together under the general heading, Adversus
Mathematikos-which may be translated as Against the Learned, or
Against the Professors, i.e. those who profess to know something
worth teaching. This grouping is potentially misleading as the first
group of six books (chapters, by current standards) are complete and
form a self-contained whole. In fact Sextus refers to them with the
title Skeptical Treatises. Each of these books target some
specific subject in which people profess to be experts, thus:
grammar, rhetoric, mathematics, geometry, astrology and music. These
are referred to as M 1 through 6, respectively.
There are five additional books in the second set grouped under the
heading Adversus Mathematikos: two books containing
arguments against the Logicians (M 7, 8), two books against the
Physicists (M 9, 10), and one book against the Ethicists (M
11). This set of books is apparently incomplete since the opening of
M 7 refers back to a general outline of skepticism that is in
none of the extant books of M.
The third work is the Outlines of Pyrrhonism, in three books.
The first book provides an outline summary of Pyrrhonian skepticism
and would correspond to the missing portion of M. Books 2 and
3 provide arguments against the Logicians, Physicists and Ethicists,
corresponding to M 7 through 11. The discussion in PH
tends to be much more concise and carefully worded, though there is
greater detail and development of many of the same arguments in M.
The nature of the relation between these three works is much
disputed, especially since the view presented in PH seems to
be incompatible with large portions of M (see Bett [1997]).
The following discussion is limited to the views presented in PH.
i. General Account of Skepticism
Sextus begins his overview of Pyrrhonian skepticism by
distinguishing three fundamental types of philosopher: dogmatists,
who believe they have discovered the truth; Academics (negative
dogmatists), who believe the truth cannot be discovered; and
skeptics, who continue to investigate, believing neither that anyone
has so far discovered the truth nor that it is impossible to do so.
Although his characterization of Academics is probably polemical and
unfair, the general distinctions he makes are important.
Sextus understands the skeptic, at least nominally as Pyrrho and
Aenesidemus do, as one who by suspending judgment determines nothing,
and enjoys tranquility as a result. But, as we will see, his
conception of suspending judgment is considerably different from his
predecessors'.
ii. The path to skepticism
According to Sextus, one does not start out as a skeptic, but
rather stumbles on to it. Initially, one becomes troubled by the
kinds of disagreements focused on in Aenesidemus' modes and seeks to
determine which appearances accurately represent the world and which
explanations accurately reveal the causal histories of events. The
motivation for figuring things out, Sextus asserts, is to become
tranquil, i.e. to remove the disturbance that results from
confronting incompatible views of the world. As the proto-skeptic
attempts to sort out the evidence and discover the privileged
perspectiveor the correct theory, he finds that for each account that
purports to establish something true about the world there is
another, equally convincing account, that purports to establish an
opposed and incompatible view of the same thing. Being faced with
this equipollence, he is unable to assent to either of the opposed
accounts and thereby suspends judgment. This, of course, is not what
he set out to do. But by virtue of his intellectual integrity, he is
simply not able to arrive at a conclusion and so he finds himself
without any definite view. What he also finds is that the
tranquility that he originally thought would come only by arriving at
the truth, follows upon his suspended judgment as a shadow follows a
body.
Sextus provides a vivid story to illustrate this process. A
certain painter, Apelles, was trying to represent foam on the mouth
of the horse he was painting. But each time he applied the paint he
failed to get the desired effect. Growing frustrated, he flung the
sponge, on which he had been wiping off the paint, at the picture,
inadvertently producing the effect he had been struggling to achieve
(PH 1.28-29). The analogous point in the case of seeking the
truth is that the desired tranquility only comes indirectly, not by
giving up the pursuit of truth, but rather by giving up the
expectation that we must acquire truth to get tranquility. It is a
strikingly Zen-like point: one cannot intentionally acquire a
peaceful, tranquil state but must let it happen as a result of giving
up the struggle. But again, giving up the struggle for the skeptic
does not mean giving up the pursuit of truth. The skeptic continues
to investigate in order to protect himself against the deceptions and
seductions of reason that lead to our holding definite views.
Arriving at definite views is not merely a matter of intellectual
dishonesty, Sextus thinks; more importantly, it is the main source of
all psychological disturbance. For those who believe that things are
good or bad by nature, are perpetually troubled. When they lack what
they believe to be good their lives must seem seriously deficient if
not outright miserable, and they struggle as much as possible to
acquire those things. But when they finally have what they believe
to be good, they spend untold effort in maintaining and preserving
those things and live in fear of losing them (PH 1.27).
Sextus' diagnosis is not limited to evaluative beliefs, however.
This is clear by virtue of the fact that he provides extensive
arguments against physical and logical (broadly speaking, scientific
and epistemological) theories also. How, then, do such beliefs
contribute to the psychological disturbances that Sextus seeks to
eliminate? The most plausible reply is that any such belief that we
find Sextus arguing against in PH is one that will inevitably
contribute to one's evaluations of the world and thus will contribute
to the intense strivings that characterize disturbance. An
examination of a sample of the logical and physical theses that
Sextus' discusses bears this out. Many of these beliefs played
foundational roles in the Epicurean or Stoic
systems, and thus were employed to establish ethical and evaluative
beliefs. Believing that the physical world is composed of invisible
atoms, for example, would not, by itself, produce any disturbance
since we must draw inferences from this belief in order for it to
have any significance for us with respect to choice and avoidance.
So it is more appropriate to look past the disturbance that may be
produced by individual, isolated beliefs, and consider instead the
effect of accepting a system of interrelated, mutually supporting
dogmatic claims.
iii. The Modes of Agrippa
As a supplement to the Ten Modes of Aenesidemus (as well as his
Eight Modes aimed at causal explanations, see PH 1.180-85, and
Hankinson [1998]), Sextus offers a set of Five Modes (PH
1.164-77) and Two Modes (PH 1.178-79) employed by 'more recent
skeptics'. We may gather from Diogenes (9.88) that the more recent
skeptic referred to is Agrippa. It is important to point out that
Sextus merely reports these modes, he does not endorse them at a
theoretical level. That is, he does not claim that they possess any
sort of logical standing, e.g. that they are guaranteed to reveal a
flaw in dogmatic positions, or that they represent some ideal form of
reasoning. Instead, we should think of these modes as part of the
general account of skepticism, with which the skeptic's practice
coheres (PH 1.16-17). In other words, these modes simply
describe the way Sextus and his fellow skeptics behave dialectically.
Agrippa's Five Modes relies on the prevalence of dispute and
repeats the main theme of Aenesidemus' Modes: we are frequently
faced with dissenting opinions regarding the same matter and yet we
have no adequate grounds on which to prefer one view over another.
Should a dogmatist offer an account of such grounds, the skeptic may
then request further justification, thereby setting off an infinite
regress. And presumably, we should not be willing to accept an
explanation that is never complete, i.e. one that requires further
explaining itself. Should the dogmatist try to put a stop to the
regress by means of a hypothesis, the skeptic will refuse to accept
the claim without proof, perhaps citing alternative, incompatible
hypotheses. And finally, the skeptic will refuse to allow the
dogmatist to support his explanation by what he is supposed to be
explaining, disallowing any circular reasoning. And of course the
skeptic may also avail himself of the observation that what is being
explained only appears as it does relative to some relevant
conditions, and thus, contrary to the dogmatist's presumption, there
is no one thing to be explained in the first place (see Barnes
[1990]).
iv. Skepticism versus relativism
Sextus employs these skeptical modes towards quite a different
goal from Aenesidemus'. Aenesidemus, as we have seen, countenances
relativistic assertions of the form, X is no more F than not F. This
is to say that although X is not really, in its nature, F, it is
still genuinely F in some particular circumstance. And it is
acceptable for the Aenesidemean skeptic to believe that this is the
case. But for Sextus, the skeptical refrain, 'I determine nothing'
excludes relativistic beliefs as well. It is not acceptable for
Sextus to believe that X is F, even with relativistic disclaimers.
Instead, Sextus would have us refrain from believing even that X is
no more F than not-F. Thus, suspension of judgment extends farther
for Sextus than it does for Aenesidemus.
v. The skeptical life
So, skepticism is an ability to discover opposed arguments of
equal persuasive force, the practice of which leads first to
suspension of judgment and afterwards, fortuitously, to tranquility.
This makes Sextus' version of Pyrrhonian skepticism dramatically
different from other Western philosophical positions, for it is a
practice or activity rather than a set of doctrines. Indeed, insofar
as the skeptic is supposed to live without belief
(adoxastôs), he could not consistently endorse any
philosophical doctrine. But how is it possible to live without
beliefs?
The short answer is that one may simply follow appearances
and withhold judgment as to whether the world really is as it
appears. This seems plausible with respect to physical perceptions,
but appearances for Sextus include evaluations, and this creates a
complication. For how can the skeptic say "this appears good (or
bad) to me, but I don't believe that it is really good or bad"? It
seems that there is no difference between evaluative appearances and
evaluative beliefs.
One possible response to this problem is to say that Sextus
only targets sophisticated, philosophical theories about value, or
about physics or logic, but allows everyday attitudes and beliefs to
stand. On this view, skepticism is a therapy designed to cure the
disease of academics and theoreticians. But it seems that Sextus
intends his philosophical therapy to be quite widely applicable. The
skeptical life, as he presents it, is an achievement and not merely
the recovering of a native innocence lost to philosophical
speculation. (See Burnyeat and Frede [1997], Brennan [1999] for the
debate regarding what the skeptic is supposed to suspend judgment
about.)
Any answer to the question about how the skeptic may live
without beliefs will depend on what sort of beliefs we think the
skeptic avoids. Nevertheless, an elaboration on living in accordance
with appearances comes in the form of the fourfold observances.
Rather than investigate the best way to live or even what to do in
some particular circumstance, Sextus remarks that the skeptic will
guide his actions by (1) nature, (2) necessitation by feelings, (3)
laws and customs, and (4) kinds of expertise (PH 1.23-24).
Nature provides us with the capacity for perception and thought, and
we may use these capacities insofar as they don't lead us to dogmatic
belief. Similarly, hunger and thirst will drive us towards food and
drink without our having to form any explicit beliefs regarding those
physical sensations. One need not accept any nutritional theories to
adequately and appropriately respond to hunger and thirst. Laws and
customs will inform us of the appropriate evaluations of things. We
need not actually believe that the gods exist and that they are
benevolent to take part in religious ceremonies or even to act in a
manner that is (or at least appears) pious. But note that the
skeptic will neither believe that the gods exist nor that they do not
exist-he is neither a theist nor an atheist, but agnostic in a very
robust sense. And finally, the skeptic may practice some trade or
profession without accepting any theories regarding his practice.
For example, a carpenter need not have any theoretical or geometrical
views about doors in order to be skillful at hanging them.
Similarly, a doctor need not accept any physiological theories to
successfully heal his patients. The further question, recalling the
dispute explored in Burnyeat and Frede [1997], is whether the skeptic
merely avoids sophisticated, theoretical beliefs in employing these
observances, or whether he avoids all beliefs whatsoever.
4. Skepticism and the Examined Life
A unifying feature of the varieties of ancient skepticism is that
they are all concerned with promoting, in some manner of speaking,
the benefits of recognizing our epistemic limitations. Thus, ancient
skeptics nearly always have something to say about how one may live,
and indeed live well, in the absence of knowledge.
The fallibilism that developed in Plato's Academy should be seen in
this light. Rather than forego the potential benefits of an
examination aimed at acquiring better beliefs, the later Academics
opted for a less ambitious criterion, one that would give them merely
reliable beliefs. Nonetheless, they maintained a thoroughly
skeptical attitude towards the possibility of attaining certainty,
but without claiming to have conclusively ruled it out.
The more radical skepticism that we find in Sextus'
Outlines of Pyrrhonism suggests a move in a different
direction. Rather than explain how or why we should trust the
skeptical employment of reason, Sextus avoids the problem altogether
by, in effect, refusing to answer. Instead, he would suggest that we
consider the reasons in support of some particular answer and the
reasons opposed in accordance with the skeptical ability so that we
may regain tranquility.
5. Greek and Latin texts, commentaries, and translations
General:
Long and Sedley, eds. (1987), The Hellenistic
Philosophers, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press), is a good
place to start. These volumes contain selections from the primary
sources grouped by topic. See volume 1, sections 68-72 and the
following commentaries (pp. 438-488) for readings on Academic and
Pyrrhonian skepticism, and sections 1-3 with commentaries (pp. 13-24)
for readings on Pyrrho. Volume 2 contains the original Greek and
Latin texts corresponding to the translations in volume 1.
Inwood and Gerson, eds. (1988), Hellenistic Philosophy:
Introductory Readings, Indianapolis: Hackett), also contains
translated selections from the primary sources for Academic and
Pyrrhonian skepticism.
Annas and Barnes, eds. (1985), The Modes Of Scepticism,
(Cambridge: Cambridge University Press), is a very useful
arrangement and translation of the texts that discuss the different
varieties of Pyrrhonian argumentation.
For the Greek edition of Photius' summary of Aenesidemus,
see R. Henry, ed. (1962), Photius: Bibliothêque,
Tome III, (Paris). For a very readable translation, informative
introduction and notes, see N.G. Wilson (1994), Photius: The
Bibliotheca, (London: Duckworth).
There have been some recently updated and much improved translations
and commentaries on Sextus Empiricus.
Annas, J. and J. Barnes (1994), Sextus Empiricus: Outlines of
Scepticism, (Cambridge:
Cambridge University Press.
Bett, R. (1997), Sextus Empiricus: Against the Ethicists
(Adversus Mathematikos XI), (Oxford:
Oxford University Press).
Blank, D. (1998), Sextus Empiricus: Against the Grammarians
(Adversus Mathematikos I),
(Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Greaves, D.D. (1986), Sextus Empiricus: Against the Musicians
(Adversus Mathematikos VI),
(Lincoln: University of Nebraska Press).
Mates, B. (1996), The Skeptic Way: Sextus Empiricus's Outlines of
Pyrrhonism, Translated with
Introduction and Commentary, (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Many of the primary texts can be found in the Loeb series, which
contains facing pages of text in the original language and
translation. Among the most important are (all published by Harvard
University Press):
Bury, R.G. (1933), trans., Sextus Empiricus: Outlines of
Pyrrhonism.
____. (1935), trans., Sextus Empiricus: Against the Logicians
____. (1936), trans., Sextus Empiricus: Against the Physicists,
Against the Ethicists.
____. (1949), trans., Sextus Empiricus: Against the Professors.
Hicks, R.D. (1925), trans., Diogenes Laertius: Lives of Eminent
Philosophers, vols. 1 and 2.
Rackham, H. (1933), trans., Cicero: De Natura Deorum, Academica.
____. (1914), trans., Cicero: De Finibus Bonorum et Malorum.
6. Select bibliography of secondary literature
Annas, J., (1996), 'Scepticism, Old and New', in M. Frede and G.
Striker, eds., Rationality in Greek Thought, (Oxford: Clarendon).
____. (1993), The Morality of Happiness, (Oxford: Oxford
University Press).
____. (1992), 'Plato the Sceptic', in J. Klagge and N. Smith, eds.,
Oxford Studies in
Ancient Philosophy, Supp. Vol., 43-72.
____. (1990), 'Stoic
Epistemology', in S. Everson, ed., Epistemology, (Cambridge:
Cambridge University Press).
____. (1986), 'Doing Without Objective Values: Ancient and Modern
Strategies', in M. Schofield, et. al., eds., Norms of Nature
(Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Barnes, J. (1990), The Toils of Scepticism, (Cambridge:
Cambridge University Press).
Bett, R. (2000), Pyrrho, his antecedents, and his legacy,
(Oxford: Oxford University Press).
____. (1990), 'Carneades' Distinction Between Approval and Assent',
Monist 73.1:
3-20.
____. (1993), 'Scepticism and Everyday Attitudes in Ancient and
Modern Philosophy', Metaphilosophy 24.4: 363-81.
____. (1989), 'Carneades' pithanon: A Reappraisal of its Role
and Status', Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy 7: 59-94.
Brennan, T. (1999), Ethics and Epistemology in Sextus Empiricus,
(New York: Garland).
Brittain, C. (2001), Philo of Larissa, (Oxford: Oxford
University Press).
Burnyeat, M. (1984), 'The Sceptic in his Place and Time', in Rorty,
Schneewind and Skinner, eds., Philosophy in History,
(Cambridge: Cambridge University Press), 225-54, reprinted in
Burnyeat and Frede, eds. (1997).
Burnyeat, M. and M. Frede, Eds. (1997), The Original Sceptics: A
Controversy, (Indianapolis: Hackett).
Burnyeat, M., Ed. (1983), The Skeptical Tradition, (Berkeley:
University of California Press).
Colish, M. (1985), The Stoic
Tradition From Antiquity to the Early Middle Ages, vol. 1,
(Leiden: Brill).
Couissin, P. (1929), 'Le Stoicisme de
la nouvelle Academie', Revue d'historie de la philosophie 3:
241-76, tr. by Jennifer Barnes and M. Burnyeat as 'The Stoicism of
the New Academy', in M. Burnyeat, Ed. (1983) 31-63.
Flintoff, E. (1980), 'Pyrrho and India', Phronesis 25: 88-108.
Fogelin, R. (1994), Pyrrhonian Reflections on Knowledge and
Justification, (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Frede, D. (1996) 'How Sceptical Were the Academic Sceptics?', in R.H.
Popkin, ed.,
Scepticism in the History of Philosophy: A Pan-American Dialogue,
1-26, (Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic).
Frede, M. (1987), Essays in Ancient Philosophy, (Minneapolis:
University of Minnesota Press).
____. (1983/1987), 'Stoics and
Skeptics on Clear and Distinct Impressions' in M. Burnyeat, ed.,
(1983), reprinted in Frede (1987), 151-78.
Griffin, M. (1997), 'The Composition of the Academica:
Motives and Versions' in Inwood and Mansfeld, eds. (1997), 1-35.
Glucker, J. (1995), 'Probabile, Veri Simile, and Related
Terms', in J.G.F. Powell, ed., Cicero the
Philosopher: Twelve Papers, (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
____. (1978), Antiochus and the Late Academy, (Gottingen:
Vandenhoeck und
Ruprecht).
Hankinson, R.J. (1998), Cause and Explanation in Ancient Greek
Thought, (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
____. (1997), 'Natural Criteria and the Transparency of Judgement:
Antiochus, Philo and Galen on Epistemological Justification', in B.
Inwood and J. Mansfeld, Eds. (1997), 161-216.
____. (1995), The Sceptics, (London: Routledge).
Inwood, B., and J. Mansfeld, Eds. (1997), Assent and Argument:
Studies in Cicero's
Academic Books, (Leiden: Brill).
Long, A.A. (1974), Hellenistic Philosophy: Stoics, Epicureans and
Sceptics, (Berkeley: University of California Press).
____. (1986), 'Diogenes Laertius' Life of Arcesilaus',
Elenchos 7: 432-49.
____. (1988), 'Socrates in Hellenistic Philosophy', Classical
Quarterly 38: 150-71.
MacKendrick, P. (1989), The Philosophical Books of Cicero,
(New York: St. Martin's Press).
Maconi, H. (1988), 'Nova non philosophandi philosophia: A
review of Anna Maria Ioppolo, Opinione e Scienza', Oxford Studies
in Ancient Philosophy 6: 231-253.
Mansfeld, J. (1997), 'Philo and Antiochus in the Lost Catulus',
Mnemosyne 50.1: 45-74.
Popkin, R. (1979), The History of Scepticism from Erasmus to
Spinoza, (Berkeley: University of California Press).
Powell, J.G.F. (1995), Cicero the
Philosopher: Twelve Papers, (Oxford: Oxford University Press).
Schmitt, C. (1972), Cicero
Scepticus, (The Hague: Nijhoff).
Shields, C. (1994), 'Socrates Among the Sceptics', in P. Vander
Waerdt, Ed. (1994), The Socratic Movement, (Ithaca: Cornell
University Press).
Sihvola, J., ed. (2000), Ancient Scepticism and the Sceptical
Tradition, (Helsinki : Philosophical Society of Finland).
Striker, G. (1996), Essays on Hellenistic Epistemology and Ethics,
(Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
____. (1990/1996), 'Ataraxia: Happiness as Tranquility'
Monist 73: 97-110, repr. in Striker (1996), 183-195.
____. (1981/1996), 'Uber den Unterschied zwischen den Pyrrhoneern
und den Akademikern', Phronesis 26: 153-71, repr. and transl.
by M.M. Lee as 'On the Difference Between the Pyrrhonists and the
Academics' in Striker (1996), 135-49.
____. (1980/1996), 'Sceptical Strategies', in M. Schofield, M.
Burnyeat, and J. Barnes, Eds. (1980), Doubt and Dogmatism,
54-83, repr. in Striker (1996), 92-115.
Tarrant, H. (1985), Scepticism or Platonism: the Philosophy of the
4th Academy, (Cambridge: Cambridge University Press).
Thorsrud, H. (2002), 'Cicero on His
Academic Predecessors: the Fallibilism of Arcesilaus and Carneades',
Journal of the History of Philosophy 40: 1-18.
Woodruff , P. (1988), 'Aporetic Pyrrhonism', Oxford Studies in
Ancient Philosophy 6: 139-68.
____. (1986), 'The Skeptical Side of Plato's Method', Revue
International de Philosophie 156-57: 22-37.
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